A preeminent scholar, classicist and a first-rate analytic and synthetic thinker, Zhu Xi (Chu Hsi) created the supreme synthesis of Song-Ming dynasty (960-1628 CE) Neo-Confucianism. Moreover, by selecting the essential classical Confucian texts--the Analects (Lunyu) of Confucius, the Book of Mencius (Mengzi, the Great Learning (Daxue) and the Doctrine of the Mean (Zhongyong)—then editing and compiling them, with commentary, as the Four Books (Sishu). In doing so, Zhu redefined the Confucian tradition and outlook. He restored its original focus on moral cultivation and realization from the more bureaucratic stance of Confucians of the preceding Han and Tang dynasty (206 BCE-905 CE) who concentrated on the Five Classics (Wujing) of classical antiquity. The Four Books became required reading for the imperial examination system from the Yuan dynasty (1280-1341) until the system was abolished near the end of the Qing dynasty (1644-1911) in 1908. In his philosophical work, Zhu fused the concepts of the principal Northern Song (960-1126 CE) thinkers, Shao Yong (1011-77), Zhou Dunyi (1017-73), Zhang Zai (Chang Tsai, 1020-77) and the brothers Cheng Yi (1033-1107) and Cheng Hao (1032-85) into a rich, grand synthesis.
Zhu Xi's thought has been the starting point for intellectual discourse and the focus of disputation for the last 800 years. His influence spread to Korea and Japan, which adopted Confucianism and the imperial examination system and were enamored of Zhu's intellectual achievements. To study traditional Chinese philosophy, especially Confucian thought, one must engage the ideas and works of Zhu Xi.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Life and Work
Zhu
Xi was born in Youqi in Fujian province, China in 1130. A precocious
child, he asked what lay beyond Heaven at age five and grasped the
import of the Classic of Filiality (Xiaojing) at age eight.
After losing his father, Zhu Song (1097-1143), in his youth, he was
raised in the company of several eclectic scholars, including
Buddhists. A prodigy, he passed the top-level jinshi exam (the
“presented scholar” exam) at the young age of nineteen,
drawing on Chan
Buddhist notions in his answers. He continued to nurture
an eclectic interest in Daoism
and Buddhism until he became the student of the Neo-Confucian master
Li Tong (1093-1163) in 1160. Zhu’s father had
recommended that he study under Li, but Zhu delayed seeing him until
age 30, when he had spiritual doubts. A master in the tradition of
the Cheng brothers, Li convinced Zhu of the superiority of the
Confucian Way and cultivation, to which Zhu devoted himself for the
next forty years. Having passed the jinshi examination, Zhu
was qualified to hold office and was assigned to several prefectural
administrative posts. But Zhu was critical of central court policy on
several key issues and preferred temple guardianships, which gave him
leisure to read, write and teach. (This also shielded him from the
cutthroat politics at court where his frankness would have been
literally fatal to him.) He thus became a productive scholar who made
lasting contributions to classicism, historiography, literary
criticism and philosophy. He was also a master of elegant prose and
poetry.
As
a renowned teacher, Zhu taught the classics and Neo-Confucianism to
hundreds, if not thousands, of students. His oral teachings are
preserved in the Classified Dialogues of Master Zhu (Zhuzi
yulei). He also published critical, annotated editions of several
classics, including the Book of Change (Yijing) and the Book
of Odes (Shijing), of specific Neo-Confucianism works, including
the works of Zhou Dunyi, Zhang Zai and the Cheng brothers, and a more
encompassing Neo-Confucian anthology, Reflections on Things at
Hand (Jinsi lu). Devoted to his work, he kept busy virtually to
his last breath when he was rethinking and discussing the Great
Learning. Throughout life, he sought to reestablish the
fundamental principles and ideals of Confucianism in order to restore
the vitality of China’s cultural and political integrity as a
Confucian society, since those seeking spiritual guidance and solace
were inclined to favor Daoism and Buddhism over the spiritually
impoverished alternative of bureaucratic Confucianism. Moreover, he
thought the empire needed the spiritual élan of authentic
Confucian values to meet the challenge of barbarian encroachers. His
patriotism, commitment to the tradition and devotion to scholarship
and education remain an inspiration to this day in East Asia and
throughout the world.
2. Philosophy of Human Nature and Approach to Self-Cultivation
Zhu's
complex theory of human nature registered the possibility of evil as
well as that of sagehood. On his theory, while (following Mencius,
372-289 BCE) people are fundamentally good (that is, originally
sensitive and well-disposed), how one manifests this original nature
will be conditioned by one's specific qi endowment (one's
native talents and gifts), and one's family and social environment.
These together yield one's empirical personality, intelligence and
potential for cultivation and success. Zhu thought difference in
individual disposition, character and aptitude for moral
self-realization are due to variations in qi endowments and
environments.
Preceding generations of Neo-Confucian scholars had tended not to
register the complexity of human nature and the wide range of
individual differences and advocated relatively straightforward
approaches to self-cultivation as purifying the mind to elicit the
natural responses of one’s original goodness. They tended to
understand this process in itself to constitute self-realization.
For example, Zhu's teacher Li Tong had strongly advocated a form of
meditation called "quiet sitting," the efficacy of which
the active young Zhu had doubted from the outset, at least for
himself. Several years later, Zhu held discussions with Zhang Shi
(1133-80), a follower of Hu Hong (1106-61), who had advocated
“introspection in action.” Zhu initially embraced this
approach, but soon found that it was not viable for himself. He found
that such introspection in the heat of action could not inform or
guide action. It tended to impede the flow of effective deliberate
action by making one too self-conscious.
Zhu
Xi's ingenious solution was a two-pronged approach to cultivation
that involved nurturing one's feeling of reverence (jing)
while investigating things to discern their defining patterns (li).
Reverence, a virtue taught by Confucius (551-479 BCE) and the
classics, serves to purify the mind, attune one to the promptings of
the original good nature and impel one to act with appropriateness
(yi). At the same time, by grasping the defining, interactive
patterns that constitute the world, society, people and upright
conduct, one gains the key to acting appropriately. The mind that is
imbued with a feeling of reverence and comprehends these patterns
will develop into a good will (zhuzai) dedicated to rectitude
and appropriate conduct.
Interestingly,
in later life, Zhu regarded this conception of cultivation and
realization as too complicated, gradual and difficult to complete.
Like Confucius, he came to accept that one must, on embarking on
moral self-cultivation, establish the resolve (lizhi) to
realize the Confucian virtues and become an exemplary person (junzi),
a master of appropriateness in human conduct and interpersonal
affairs.
3. Moral Cosmic Synthesis
In
"A Treatise on Humanity" (Renshuo), Zhu Xi
articulates and systematizes the classical Confucian ideal of
humanity (ren) in simultaneously cosmic and human perspective.
At the same time, he effectively criticizes competing accounts of
"humanity" on logical, semantic and ethical grounds.
Following early tradition, Zhu associates humanity with cosmic
creativity. At its root, humanity is the impulse of "heaven and
earth" (the cosmos) to produce things. It is manifested vividly
in the cycle of seasons and the fecundity of nature. (The settled
Chinese terrain and climate were moderate and productive, supporting
the view that nature generally was fecund and afforded suitable
conditions for human flourishing.) This impulse to produce is
instilled in all of the myriad creatures, but in man it is sublimated
into the virtue of “humanity” ("authoritative
personhood"), which, when fully realized, involves being caring
and responsible to others in due degree. Zhu Xi similarly correlates
the four stages of creativity and production in the cosmos and nature
-- origination, growth, flourishing and firmness -- that were first
indicated in the Book of Change, with the four cardinal
virtues enunciated by Confucius -- humanity, appropriateness, ritual
conduct and wisdom. He thus portrays the realized person as both a
vital participant in cosmic creativity and a catalyst for the
flourishing and self-realization of others. On this basis, Zhu goes
on to formulate the definitive definition of ren (humanity,
authoritative personhood) for the subsequent tradition: "the
essential character of mind" and "the essential pattern of
love." The virtue of ren grounds the disposition of mind
as commiserative and describes the core of moral self-realization as
love for others (other-directed concern), appropriately manifested.
4. Metaphysical Synthesis
Zhu
Xi erected a metaphysical
synthesis that has been compared broadly to the systems of Plato,
Aristotle, Thomas
Aquinas and Whitehead. These “Great Chain”
systems are hierarchical and rooted in the distinction between form
and matter. Zhu advanced Zhou Dunyi's dynamic conception of reality
as shown in the "Diagram of the Supreme Polarity" (Taiji
tu), in order to conceive the Cheng brother's concept of li
(pattern, principle) and Zhang Zai's notion of qi (cosmic
vapor) as organically integrated in a holistic system. In Zhou's
treatise, Explanation of the Diagram of the Supreme Polarity
(Taiji tu shuo), Zhu discerned a viable account of the formation of
the world in stages from the original unformed qi, to yin
and yang, the five phases -- earth, wood, fire, water and
metal -- and on to heaven, earth and the ten thousand things. Zhu
blended this conception with ideas from the Book of Change and
its commentaries in setting forth a comprehensive philosophy of
cosmic and human creativity, providing philosophical grounds for the
received Confucian concepts of human nature and self-cultivation.
Zhu's penchant for thinking in polarities—li and qi,
in particular—has continued to stir critics to regard him as a
dualist who used two concepts to explain reality. For his part, any
viable account of the complexity of phenomena must involve two or
more facets in order to register their complexity and changes.
5. Key Interpreters of Zhu Xi
Zhu Xi was an active scholar-intellectual who held discussions and
disputes with other scholars, both in correspondence and in person.
He can be known by contrast with others as well as through his
positive views. For example, his series of letters with Zhang Shi on
the topic of self-cultivation, preserved in the Collected Writings
of Master Zhu (Zhuzi wenji), provides an enlightening record of
these dedicated Confucians’ quest for a well-grounded,
effective approach to self-cultivation. He debated with Lu Zuqian
(1134-1181) on the nature of education. Zhu focused on the Confucian
Way and moral practice, while Lu argued for a broader-based
humanities approach. He held a series of debates with Lu Jiuyuan
(Xiangshan, 1139-93) on the nature of realization and moral conduct.
Whereas Zhu advocated regimens of study, reflection, observation and
practice, Lu spoke simply of reflecting on the self and clarifying
the mind, considering that once the mind was clear one would know
spontaneously what to do in any situation. Zhu also corresponded with
the “utilitarian” Confucian scholar Chen Liang (1143-94),
who disputed Zhu’s focus on individual moral realization and
the received “Way” with a broader institutional approach
that was more sensitive to empirical facts and conditions. Zhu
generally eclipsed all of the other scholars of his day, partly
because he outlived them and had so many students, but mainly because
his system was so compelling. It was comprehensive yet nuanced,
tightly reasoned yet accommodating of individual differences. It
preserved the essential Confucian Way yet ramified it to meet the
challenges of Buddhism and Daoism as spiritual teachings. Zhu’s
influence rose at the end of the Southern Song dynasty and became
decisive during the Yuan dynasty, which adopted his edition of the
Four Books as the basis of the imperial examination system
arranged by scholars trained in his approach.
While
raising his standing in pedagogy, this focus on the Four Books
at the expense of Zhu’s deeper, more nuanced texts and
dialogues opened the door to philosophic criticism. A schematic
presentation of Zhu’s cosmic theory of pattern (li) and
qi lay in the background of his commentary to the Four
Books, which easily opened him to charges of dualism and of
reading abstract categories into the essentially practical ancient
texts. Because his commentary was focused on reading and
understanding the meaning, intent and cultivation message of the Four
Books, critics generalized that Zhu and his method were
essentially scholastic and would be myopic and stilted in facing real
situations. Anyone who peruses the corpus of Zhu’s writings
and dialogues, however, will find that his ontology is not a crude
dualism but a holism built of mutually implicative elements that
never exist in separation. Also, his reflections are always informed
by knowledge of history, current events and practical observation, as
his method of observation applies generally to objects (and self) and
phenomena while respecting but not privileging texts. Even his
comments on Confucius and Mencius often refer back to the person and
the speech context, and, thus, are not entirely scholastic. His
method of observation opened the door to breakthroughs beyond the
“verities” of the classics, though he was careful not to
play up this fact because most of his colleagues sought the truth in
the texts, thinking empirical facts were distractions from the
essential Heavenly-patterning (tianli) reflected more
adequately in the canonical texts.
Whereas
early generations of Zhu’s followers were acquainted with his
broader learning, style and spirit, Confucians of the Ming and Qing
dynasties knew him mostly through his edition of the Four Books,
through which they targeted their criticisms of his thought. Zhu’s
most eminent critic was the Ming scholar-official Wang
Yangming (Wang Yang-ming, 1472-1529). In youth, Wang had
admired Zhu’s learning and once even attempted to try out his
approach to observation, “investigate things to discern their
defining patterns.” But, after diligently “observing”
bamboo for several days, Wang became ill and got no special insight
into the pattern or meaning of bamboo or anything else. He therefore
rejected Zhu’s approach to observation as too objective, as
outward rather than inward. In the twentieth century, Qian Mu
observed that Zhu would only make such observations with guiding
questions in mind, around which to focus his observations; he never
would have countenanced just looking, which would turn up nothing
that wasn’t obvious. For example, having heard a monk claim
that bean sprouts grow faster by night than by day, Zhu measured the
growth of some bean plants after twelve hours of daylight and of
nocturnal darkness, respectively, and found that the plants exhibited
the same rate of growth day and night. (The monk’s claim had
been based on Mencius’ idea that the qi was more vital
at night.) For his part, Wang transformed Zhu’s theory of
observation into a pragmatic theory, thereby gearing observation
directly to discernment and response—knowing how to act. Thus,
Wang formulated a famous slogan that “knowledge and action form
a unity.” Later, he argued that knowledge is not essentially
objective and factual, but rooted in an inborn moral sensitivity
(liangzhi), which is elicited by clarifying the mind so that
one becomes actively responsive to one’s moral impulses
(liangneng). It could be said that, in his criticisms, Wang
was reacting more to the scholastic attitudes fostered by the
examination system than to Zhu Xi himself. Wang ultimately respected
Zhu and went on to compile a text attempting to show that in later
life Zhu had changed his approach in a subjective, practical way that
anticipated Wang’s approach.
Scholars
of the late Ming through early Qing period (mid-seventeenth to early
eighteenth century), notably, Wang Fuzhi (1619-92) and Dai
Zhen (Tai Chen, 1723-77), disputed Zhu on
philosophical and textual grounds. Whereas Zhu had insisted on the
priority of “pattern” over qi, (roughly, form over
matter), Wang and Dai followed the Northern Song thinker Zhang Zai in
affirming the priority of qi, viewing patterns as a
posteriori evolutionary realizations of qi interactions.
They thought this account dissolved the threat of any hint of dualism
in cosmology, ontology and human nature. For his part, Zhu Xi would
have responded that, fundamentally, “pattern” is
implicated in the very make-up and possible configurations of qi;
which is why the regular a posteriori patterns can emerge.
“Pattern” provides for the standing orders and processes,
based on the steady interactions of yin-yang, five phases, etc., that
give rise to the heaven-earth world order, with its full complement
of ten thousand things. The fundamental a priori patterns are
thus necessary to the world order and provide the fecund context in
which the a posteriori forms emerge continuously. Wang and
Dai’s qi-based view could not account for existence and
the world order in this sense. At the same time, Zhu did not think
that “patterns” were absolutely determinative. They just
set certain “possibilities of order” that are realized
when the necessary qi conditions obtain. For the most part,
he registered the range of randomness and free flow in qi
activity that is best exemplified in the randomness of weather
systems and seismic events.
As
to textual grounds, Wang and Dai argued that Zhu was so enamored of
his metaphysics of pattern and qi that he constantly read them
into the classical texts. For example, Dai said Zhu blandly
associated Confucius’ term tian (heaven) with his own
notion of li (pattern; principle), quoting Analects 11:9
where Confucius, in sorrow over the death of his disciple Yan Hui,
cried that “Heaven had forsaken” him. Could Zhu
reasonably claim that Confucius was crying that li had
forsaken him? Critics tend to find Dai’s counter-intuitive
example against Zhu’s approach compelling. However, consulting
Zhu’s original commentary, we find that he noted that this
phrase expressed Confucius’ utmost sorrow, that he felt Yan
Hui’s death as if it was his own, without mentioning “pattern.”
This example does not prove Wang and Dai’s claim. It
illustrates that Zhu’s commentary was nuanced and sensitive to
pragmatic, situational usages despite his penchant to see his own
notion of “pattern” in some of Confucius’ usages of
“heaven.” Moreover, the classicist Daniel Gardner shows
that Zhu’s commentary was not intended as simply a glossary
with comments. It was intended as a guide to self-cultivation.
Hence, Zhu sometimes recast passages in the Analects more
generally to show their broader implications for self-cultivation and
realization, often with the isolated countryside student in mind.
Gardner shows that Zhu thus had enriched the text as a vital tool for
self-cultivation, whereas the earlier commentaries of the Han and
Tang dynasties had just given glosses necessary for answering
examination questions.
Known
in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries in the West due to the
work of Jesuits in China, Zhu Xi’s thought and texts were made
more widely available to western scholarship in the late nineteenth
century. Early in the twentieth century, a Chinese student of John
Dewey (1859-1951) at Cornell, Hu Shi (1891-1962), initially followed
the empirical, textual Qing scholars in viewing Zhu as a scholastic
metaphysician. But, after reading Zhu’s Dialogues in old
age, Hu contended that Zhu’s method of observation was not
scholastic but essentially scientific in nature. J.C. Bruce, who
translated a book of Zhu’s collected writings in the 1920s,
viewed Zhu’s notion of li (pattern; principle) in light
of Stoic natural law. From the 1930s, the eminent historian of
Chinese philosophy, Feng Youlan, interpreted li along the
lines of platonic Forms making Zhu Xi appear to be an idealist and
abstract thinker. In the 1950s, Carsun Chang naturalized the notion
of li by aligning it with the Aristotelian “nature”
or “essence,” thereby locking Zhu’s thought into a
sort of descriptive metaphysics.
From
the 1960s, Mou Zongsan interpreted and criticized Zhu’s
ontology and ethics on Kantian grounds, saying he erected an a
priori framework but then illicitly sought to derive further a
priori knowledge (of patterns) by a posteriori means
(observation). In the 1970s, the intellectual historian, Qian Mu
examined and explained Zhu Xi’s thought directly on its own
terms, without reading western concepts and logical patterns into his
system. Scholars wanting to read Zhu Xi on his own terms, unmediated
by western thought, turn to the five volume Zhu Xi anthology edited
by Qian Mu as a rich starting point.
In
1956, Joseph Needham, a scientist, made a highly significant
breakthrough by interpreting Zhu’s system in terms of a process
philosophy, Whitehead’s organic naturalism. Needham
successfully recast much of Zhu’s language in naturalistic
rather than metaphysical terms. The cultural, moral dimension of
Needham’s account has been developed by Cheng-ying Cheng and
John Berthrong, while the scientific dimension has been examined by
Yung Sik Kim. In the 1980s, A.C. Graham offered the most insightful
and apt account of Zhu’s terminology and pattern of thought in,
“What Was New in the Ch’eng-Chu Theory of Human Nature?”
and other writings. Graham showed decisively that the term li
refers to an embedded contextual “pattern,” rather than
to any sort of abstract form or principle. He reminded us that the
term li never figures in propositions or logical sequences, as
would be natural for “principle.” Rather, li are
always conceived as structuring, balancing, modulating, guiding
phenomena, processes, reflection and human discernment and response.
For example, one never finds moral syllogisms in Zhu Xi’s
writings. Everything he says is about moral emotional intelligence:
attunement, sensitivity, discernment, and response. Kirill Thompson
has explored and extended Graham’s interpretation in a series
of studies. Joseph Adler examines the roles played by the Book of
Change and Zhou Dunyi in Zhu’s thought, while Thomas Wilson
and Hoyt Tillman have shown the extent to which Zhu Xi re-visioned,
revised and recast the Confucian Way. Wilson is interested in Zhu’s
account of the Way as a sort of educational-ideological revision, and
Tillman is interested in how Zhu’s account of the Way
eventually snuffed out other competing versions that might have
offered more practical and liberal openings in late imperial China.
In summary, the depth and range of Zhu Xi’s thought were
unparalleled in the tradition. Zhu Xi studies continue to be vital,
wide-ranging and contentious, drawing growing global, cross-cultural
interest.
6. References and Further Reading
Adler,
Joseph (1998). “Response and Responsibility: Chou Tun-I and
Confucian Resources for Environmental Ethics” in Mary Tucker
and John Berthrong ed. Confucianism and Ecology: The
Interpretation of Heaven, Earth, and Humans, Cambridge: Harvard
UP. (Expansion and application of Zhou Tunyi and Zhu Xi’s
ideas to frame a cogent environmental ethic. Clear and thoughtful.)
(1999).
“Chu Hsi’s Use of the I ching” in Kidder
Smith, ed., Sung Dynasty Uses of the I ching, Princeton:
Princeton UP. (Readable and informative survey. Complements the
following text.)
(2002).
“Introduction to the Classic of Change” by Chu Hsi:
Translation with introduction and notes, Provo: Global Scholarly
Publications. (Zhu Xi’s guide to understanding and using the
Book of Change. Fascinating. Clear translation and
commentary. A major contribution to Zhu Xi and Book of Change
studies.)
Berthrong,
John H. (1994). Concerning Creativity: A Comparison of Chu Hsi,
Whitehead, and Neville, Albany: SUNY Press. (Well-developed
“process philosophy” interpretation of Zhu’s
speculative thought; see Needham 1956a and 1956b.)
Bruce,
J. Percy (1923). Chu Hsi and His Masters: An Introduction to the
Sung School of Chinese Philosophy, London: Probsthain.
(Pioneering historical study.)
Chan,
Wing-tsit (1963). “The Great Synthesis in Chu Hsi,” in A
Source Book In Chinese Philosophy, Princeton: Princeton UP,
605-63. (Translations of Zhu’s principal essays and statements
on key terms, drawn primarily from Zhuzi quanshu; clear and
thoroughly annotated.)
(1966).
Reflections on Things at Hand: The Neo-Confucian Anthology
Compiled by Chu Hsi and Lu Tsu-ch’ien, New York: Columbia
UP. (Zhu’s compendium of important early Neo-Confucian
pronouncements; clear and well annotated.)
(ed.)
(1986). Chu Hsi and Neo-Confucianism. Honolulu: Hawaii UP.
(Detailed studies of key issues in Zhu Xi scholarship; for the
specialist.)
(1987).
Chu Hsi: Life and Thought. Hong Kong: Hong Kong UP. (General
essays; clear and accessible.)
(1989).
Chu Hsi: New Studies. Honolulu: Hawaii UP. (Detailed studies
of key issues in Zhu Xi scholarship; for the specialist.)
Chang,
Carsun (1957). “Chu Hsi, The Great Synthesizer,” in The
Development of Neo-Confucian Thought, vol. 1, New York: Bookman,
243-332. (Aristotelian account of Zhu’s philosophy, viewed in
contrast to Zhu’s rivals’ opinions. Attempted corrective
of Feng’s platonic reading of Zhu Xi; see next entry. )
Feng,
Youlan (1953). “Chu Hsi,” trans. D. Bodde in A History
of Chinese Philosophy, 2 vols., Princeton: Princeton UP, vol. 2,
533-71. (Highly influential pioneering platonic account of Zhu’s
thought in English; technical but clearly presented..)
Gardner,
Daniel (1986). Chu Hsi and Ta-hsueh: Neo-Confucian
Reflection on the Confucian Canon, Cambridge: Harvard UP.
(Translation of Zhu’s commentary on the “Great Learning,”
a major classical cultivation text; with excellent commentary and
supporting essays.)
(1990).
Learning to Be a Sage: Selections from the Conversations of
Master Chu, Arranged Topically, Berkeley: California UP.
(Zhu’s teachings on learning and study as a method of
self-cultivation; very clear and accessible.)
(2003).
Zhu Xi’s Reading of the Analects: Canon, Commentary
and the Classical Tradition, New York: Columbia UP. (Insightful,
corrective study of Zhu’s mission and accomplishment in writing
this commentary.)
Graham,
A.C. (1986) “What was New in the Ch’eng-Chu Theory of
Human Nature?” in Wing-tsit Chan (ed) Chu Hsi and
Neo-Confucianism, Honolulu: Hawaii UP, 138-157. (Ground-breaking
study; corrective reinterpretation of Zhu’s main concepts and
ethical thought.)
Kim,
Yung Sik (2000). The Natural Philosophy of Chu Hsi 1130-1200,
Philadelphia: American Philosophical Society. (Clear and multifaceted
study of Zhu’s proto-scientific efforts and achievements; see
Thompson 2002b for critical analysis.)
Lovejoy,
Arthur O. (1936 & 1964) The Great Chain of Being: A Study of
the History of an Idea, Cambridge: Harvard UP. (Brilliant account
of hierarchical systems in the West, to which Zhu’s system is a
distant cousin; see Thompson 1994 for discussion.)
Needham,
Joseph (1956a). “The Neo-Confucians,” in Science and
Civilisation in China, vol. 2, History of Scientific Thought,
Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 455-95. (Highly influential organismic
account of Zhu’s thought; lucid and fascinating.)
(1956b).
“Chu Hsi, Leibniz, and the Philosophy of Organism,” in
the preceding book, 496-505. (Highly influential organismic account
of Zhu’s thought; lucid and fascinating.)
Schirokauer,
Conrad (1962). “Chu Hsi’s Political Career: A Study in
Ambivalence,” in A. Wright and D. Twichert (eds) Confucian
Personalities, Stanford: Stanford UP, 162-88. (Detailed but
engaging account.)
Thompson,
Kirill O. (1988) “Li and Yi as Immanent: Chu
Hsi’s Thought in Practical Perspective,” Philosophy
East and West 38 (1): 30-46. (Corrective account of Zhu’s
ontology and ethical theory; lucid and informative.)
(1991).
“How to Rejuvenate Ethics: Suggestions from Chu Hsi,”
Philosophy East and West (41): 493-513. (Examination of how
Zhu Xi’s thought could rejuvenate contemporary western ethics.)
(1994).
“Hierarchy of Immanence: Chu Hsi’s Pattern of Thought,”
Humanitas Taiwanica (Wen-shih-che hsueh-pao, National Taiwan
University (42): 1-30. (Examines parallels and differences between
Zhu’s philosophy and Great Chain philosophies of the western
tradition, in order to reveal strengths and special features of Zhu’s
system.)
(2002a).
“Ethical Insights from Chu Hsi,” in M. Barnhart, ed.,
Varieties of Ethical Reflection, New York and London:
Lexington Books. (Presentation of Zhu’s method of ethical
thinking, with applications to some difficult issues in Western
ethics.)
(2002b).
“Review article of “Yung Sik Kim, The Natural
Philosophy of Chu Hsi 1130-1200,” China Review
International (9): 165-80. (Critical examination of Kim’s
study of Zhu’s proto-scientific thought.)
(2007).
“The Archery of Wisdom in the Stream of Life: Zhu Xi’s
Reflections on the Four Books,” Philosophy East and
West, vol. 56, no. 3 (July). (Study of Confucius and Mencius’
fascinating notion of wisdom in the light of Zhu Xi’s salient
reflections.)
Tillman,
Hoyt (1992). Confucian Discourse and Chu Hsi’s Ascendancy,
Honolulu: Hawaii UP. (Detailed historical study that situates Zhu in
the context of the intellectual issues and debates of the day.)
Wilson,
Thomas A. (1995) Genealogy of the Way: the construction and uses
of the Confucian tradition in late imperial China, Stanford:
Stanford UP. (New approach that sees politics and ideology in the
competing accounts of the Confucian Way.)
Wittenborn,
Allen (1991). Further Reflections at Hand: A Reader, New York:
University Press of America. (Useful compendium of Zhu’s
philosophic pronouncements; clear translation with detailed
commentary.)
Zhu
Xi (1130-1200). Zhuzi yulei (Classified Dialogues of Master
Zhu), trans. J.P. Bruce, The Philosophy of Human Nature,
London: Probstain, 1922. [Compendium of Zhu’s moral psychology
drawn from Zhuzi quanshu (“Complete” Works of
Master Zhu), abstruse.] Other translated selections can be found in
Chan 1963, 1966; Gardner 1986, 1990, 2003; Wittenborn 1991.
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