Margaret Cavendish (1623—1673)

Margaret Lucas Cavendish, the Duchess of Newcastle, was a philosopher, poet, playwright and essayist. Her philosophical writings were concerned mostly with issues of metaphysics and natural philosophy, but also extended to social and political concerns. Like Hobbes and Descartes, she rejected what she took to be the occult explanations of the Scholastics. Against Descartes, however, she rejected dualism and incorporeal substance of any kind. Against Hobbes, on the other hand, she argued for a vitalist materialism, according to which all things in nature were composed of self-moving, animate matter. Specifically, she argued that the variety and orderliness of natural phenomena cannot be explained by blind mechanism and atomism, but instead require the parts of nature to move themselves in regular ways, according to their distinctive motions. And in order to explain that, she argued for panpsychism, the view that all things in nature possess minds or mental properties. Indeed, she even argued that all bodies, including tables and chairs, as well as parts of the bodies of organisms, such as the human heart or liver, know their own distinctive motions and are thereby able to carry it out. These different parts of nature, each knowing and executing their distinctive motions, create and explain the harmonious and varied order of it. In several ways, Cavendish can be seen as one of the first philosophers to take up several interesting positions against the mechanism of the modern scientific worldview of her time. Thus it is possible to add that she presages thinkers such as Spinoza and Leibniz.

When she turned to discuss political and social issues, Cavendish’s metaphysical commitments seem to remain. Cavendish was a staunch royalist and aristocrat; perhaps not surprisingly, then, she argued that each person in society has a particular place and distinctive activity and that, furthermore, social harmony only arises when people know their proper places and perform their defining actions. She was therefore critical of social mobility and unfettered political liberty, seeing them as a threat to the order and harmony of the state. Even so, her writings also contain nuanced and complex discussions of gender and religion, among a variety of other topics.

Despite her conservative political tendencies, Cavendish herself can be seen as a model for later women writers. She wrote dozens of books, at least five of which alone were on natural philosophy, under her own name, a feat which may make her the most published female author of the seventeenth century and one of the most prolific women philosophers in the early modern period. In addition to writing much on natural philosophy, she wrote on a dizzying array of other topics and, perhaps most impressively, in a wide range of genres. Her philosophically informed poetry, plays, letters and essays are at times as philosophically valuable as her treatises of natural philosophy.

Life and Works
Natural Philosophy
Political Philosophy
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Works

Margaret Lucas was born in 1623 in Colchester into a family of aristocrats and staunch royalists. She received little formal education, being tutored at home with her seven siblings, of which she was the youngest. She reports having spent much time in conversation with one of her brothers, John, who considered himself a scholar and who would become a founding member of the Royal Society. She joined the Queen’s court and served as a maid to Queen Henrietta Maria, following her into exile in 1644, during the English Civil War. While in exile she met William Cavendish, then Marquess and later Duke of Newcastle. They were married in 1645.

While in exile in Paris and Antwerp, she reports discussing philosophy and natural science with her husband and his younger brother, Sir Charles Cavendish, who held a regular salon attended by Thomas Hobbes, Kenelm Digby and occasionally René Descartes, Marin Mersenne and Pierre Gassendi. Margaret herself reports having attended several dinners, at which these philosophers were present, though she denies having spoken to them about any, but the most superficial of matters.

While her husband remained in exile, she returned in 1651 and again in 1653 to England. This was during the reign of Commonwealth, during which her husband, were he to have returned, would have had to renounce his royalism and swear fealty to the Commonwealth, as was required by the republican parliament of the time. The parliament did not extend that requirement to women, claiming that women were not capable of such political acts. Thus Margaret was allowed to return to England without swearing fealty to the Commonwealth.

During her 1653 visit, she arranged for the publication of her first collection of writings, Poems and Fancies and Philosophical Fancies. She reports having delivered the second philosophical treatise a few days too late to have it included with the first in a single publication, which had been her original intention. The publisher was Martin and Allestyre, at the Bell in St. Paul’s Churchyard, which was a well-regarded publisher, who later became the official publisher for the Royal Society. It is truly remarkable that she was able to secure their publication, as few women published philosophy in England in the seventeenth century, much less under their own name and while in exile.

The same publishing house would publish The World’s Olio and Philosophical and Physical Opinions in 1655 and Nature’s Pictures in 1656. The second work of 1655, Philosophical and Physical Opinions, contained five parts and 210 chapters, the first part of which, consisting of 58 chapters, was in fact a reprinting of her earlier Philosophical Fancies. With her 1655 Philosophical and Physical Opinions, she added a number of epistles and her “Condemning Treatise on Atoms” to the front matter and also extended the work beyond the earlier Philosophical Fancies significantly.

With the Restoration of Charles II to the throne, she returned to England with her husband and continued to write. In addition to publishing on natural philosophy, she also wrote essays on a remarkable variety of other topics, including the nature of poetry, the proper way to hold a feast, fame, women’s roles in society and many others. She also wrote many plays and poems, as well as a fantastic utopia, The Description of a New World, Called the Blazing World in 1668.

There may have been some controversy over a woman publishing works on natural philosophy, as she felt the need to include several epistles, both from herself and from her husband and brother-in-law, attesting to the fact that she had written these works herself. Indeed, she returns to defend herself as an author and natural philosopher at a number of different places in her work, often in epistles to the reader. She also defends the propriety of her being so bold as to write in her own name and to think her thoughts worthy of publication. Her several discussions of fame are worth noting in this context.

She continued to write on natural philosophy, among other topics, to growing attention. She sent her works to many of the well-known philosophers then operating in England, as well as to the faculties at Cambridge and Oxford. Indeed, after she had published her most famous work of natural philosophy, Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy in 1666, she was invited to attend a meeting of the Royal Society, a privilege rarely granted to women at the time.

In all, she may be the most prolific woman writer of early modern Europe and certainly the most prolific woman philosopher. Depending on how one counts, she published over a dozen and perhaps as many as twenty works, at least five of which are works on natural philosophy and many more contain essays with substantive philosophical content.

2. Natural Philosophy

Cavendish wrote half a dozen of works on natural philosophy. Indeed, natural philosophy constituted the largest part of her philosophical output and a large part of her writing as a whole. Her philosophical commitments can be described as materialist, vitalist and panpsychist. In what follows, her philosophical discussions will be grouped around several recurring themes and arguments.

a. Materialism

Like Hobbes, Descartes or Bacon, Cavendish regularly motivates her position by attacking the Aristotelianism of the schools, mocking those whom her husband calls the “gown-tribe.” She criticized what she took to be their commitment to occult powers and incorporeal beings in nature and offers her materialism as an alternative. She explains that her intent is to provide a philosophical system accessible to all, without special training. From her earliest work, Philosophical Fancies, published in 1653, Cavendish argued for materialism in nature. In the first two chapters of that work, which she reprinted in Philosophical and Physical Opinions in 1655, she claims that nature is one infinite material thing, which she sometimes describes as “the substance of infinite matter” (“Condemning Treatise of Atomes”). This infinite material substance is composed of an infinite number of material parts, with infinite degrees of motion. Similarly, this motion is all of the same kind, differing from instance to instance only in swiftness or direction. In other words, the natural world is entirely constituted by a single type of stuff, which she calls matter and a single force, which she calls motion. She distinguishes the objects and events in nature from one another by the varying parts of matter, bearing different motions, within that one infinite material substance. She explicitly extends this materialist doctrine to the human mind in chapter 2 of the Philosophical Fancies, where she says that the forms of the gown-tribe, as well as human minds, are nothing but “matter moving, or matter moved.” Furthermore, she remained committed to this materialism throughout her career, such as in her Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy first published in 1666, claiming that all actions of sense or of reason are corporeal. Thus we see from the very beginning of her first work that she is a materialist.

The exact nature of her materialism develops over time, however. In her earliest work from 1653, she allows for an atomist account of nature and matter, though by 1656 she is already arguing against atomism in her “Condemning Treatise of Atomes”. Later, in her Observations from 1666, she provides at least two arguments against atomism. First, she argues that the concept of an extended yet indivisible body is incoherent, saying, “whatsoever has body, or is material, has quantity; and what has quantity, is divisible” (Ch. 31, 125); this is an argument that was commonly employed against atomism in the seventeenth century. She also argues that composite bodies, each with their own motions, could not account for the unity of the complex body, but would instead be like a swarm of bees or a school of fish. Atomism, she argues, cannot explain organic unity. She says, “[w]herefore, if there should be a composition of atoms, it would not be a body made of parts, but of so many whole and entire single bodies, meeting together as a swarm of bees…and the concourse of them would rather cause a confusion, than a conformity in nature” (Ch. 31, 129). Instead of atomism, Cavendish proposes that matter is both infinite in extension and always further divisible. Furthermore, for Cavendish, complex beings such as animals are composed of distinctive matter in motion, which she takes to provide them with their unity. Even so, her primary targets are not atomist materialism, as much as both the occultism of the Schools and the mechanism of some of her contemporaries.

She also applies her materialism to the human mind. In her early works, she suggests that there is nothing of the human being that is not material. For example, in her first work, she wrote a brief dialogue between body and mind, in which she claims that the only way the mind can attain any sort of life after the death of the body is by fame, that is, by being thought well of by others. Indeed, she elsewhere claims that “all the actions of sense and reason…are corporeal” and “sense and reason are the same in all creatures and all parts of nature” (Ch. 31, 128), as well as, “knowledge, being material, consists of parts” (Ch. 37, 160).

Cavendish seems to qualify her materialism with regard to the human soul later in her career, when she clarifies that her previously strong and consistent commitment to materialism only applies to the natural world. For example, in Observations, she claims that humans have both a material mind and, in addition, a supernatural, immaterial soul. She argues that the way, in which this supernatural soul is related to the material mind and body is itself supernatural. After all, she suggests, place is a property belonging only to bodies and thus, could not belong to an immaterial soul. Therefore, the way, in which the immaterial soul is related to the material person is itself a supernatural, that is, miraculous phenomenon. Unfortunately, she offers little explanation for this immaterial soul and refrains from explaining whether or how the immortal soul might interact at all with anything in nature, instead implying that it does not. To make matters even more confusing, she seems to amend her view in 1668 when claiming that only God is immaterial and all other things are material. It may be that she had changed her mind as to whether or not human beings have immaterial, supernatural souls, but the texts themselves do not seem to speak definitively.

Throughout her work, however, Cavendish did claim that human beings possess a material soul. She explains the material, natural soul in the same way, in which she explains the mind, through her distinction among the different degrees of motion in matter, as mentioned above. Briefly, she claims that matter may have differing degrees of motion, such that some matter is relatively inert and gross, that is, being composed of larger pieces of matter, which she sometimes calls “dull matter”. In contrast, there is also a finer and more rare matter, which possesses more motion. This faster and lighter matter infuses dull matter. The natural, material, human soul or mind, she explains, is the finer, rarer matter within our grosser, cruder material bodies. Scholars have noted the similarity this view bears to Stoic doctrine, in that the rarer, more quickly moving matter resembles the Stoic pneuma.

Just like the Stoics, she also explicitly states in her later works—and suggests at times in her earlier works—that all bodies are completely infused with varying degrees of this active matter. Indeed, it is this matter that accounts for the regularity of natural phenomena across all of nature. She says that “there can be no order, method or harmony, especially such as appears in the actions of nature, without there be reason to cause that order and harmony” (Ch 6, 207). She claims, for example, that animals possess motions visible externally, such as jumping or running, whereas vegetables and minerals possess and exhibit motions only detectable internally, such as contracting or dilating. She refers to the motions found in animals, vegetables and minerals to varying degrees as sensitive spirits, a term that calls to mind Descartes’ animal spirits. But even minerals and vegetables and also animals and humans possess a further, yet finer and more quickly moving form of matter, which she calls “rational spirits.” These rational spirits are the quickly moving, but rare pneuma-like matter described above, which ultimately explain the various motions and behaviors of the natural objects. Ultimately, though, these motions and the matter they infuse are of the same fundamental kind, differing only in their degree of motion. This view, coupled with her radical claims that “all motion is life” and “knowledge is motion” will lead to her vitalism and panpsychism.

Another of Cavendish’s distinctive commitments about the nature of matter is this: matter bears an infinite degree of motion and, crucially, it bears that motion eternally. In other words, if a bit of matter has a certain degree of motion, according to Cavendish, it cannot lose that degree of motion nor communicate it to another piece of matter. We might say that, for Cavendish, the particular degree of motion that a part of matter bears is essential to that part. Thus, the cruder and grosser matter that bears a lesser degree of matter does so by its nature and cannot lose or gain a degree of motion. Similarly, the more quickly moving, finer parts of matter also bear their greater degree of motion by nature and cannot gain, lose or communicate the motion either. This view is related to another major theme of Cavendish’s work, one that we might call vitalism.

b. Vitalism and the Variability Argument

In addition to her commitment to materialism, Cavendish took pains to reject a position that was often associated with materialism in the seventeenth century, namely that of mechanism. Mechanism can be understood as the view that the natural world, as well as human beings, are made up of uniform material components that interact according to laws of motion and collision. One statement of this view, with which Cavendish was familiar, can be found in the opening chapters of Thomas Hobbes’ Leviathan. René Descartes, too, provided a mechanistic account of the natural world—apart from his commitment to the existence of the immaterial souls of human beings, of course.

Cavendish argued that mechanism could not be an accurate account of the natural world, because it could not properly explain the world that we observe. She claimed that two notable features of the natural world are variety and orderliness. The world around us is full of a vast array of different sorts of creatures and things, each performing distinctive activities or bearing distinct properties. Despite the natural world’s plentitude, it was also orderly. If we understand the nature of a particular creature or substance, we could predict successfully how it might behave or react to certain stimuli. Cavendish reasoned that if the world was ultimately constituted by uniform matter, passively receiving and transferring motion, according to mathematical laws of collision, then the universe should be either entirely homogenous or entirely chaotic. In other words, if passive, uniform matter communicating motion was really all we had to explain nature, we would not be able to account for its variety and orderliness—it would lack one or the other.

Instead, she claimed, different parts of the infinite material substance bear different degrees of motion by nature. They cannot directly transfer motion from one body to another, since motion is a property of the body that possesses it and not as something that can exist apart from its body. Thus individual bodies cannot give or receive their motions. Hence, the phenomena we observe are not to be explained by reference to uniform pieces of matter exchanging motion via collision. Rather, she explains, what we see is like a dance, in which each body moves according to its own, distinctive, internal principle, such that a pattern might be created by the dancers on the dance floor. She explicitly offers this dance metaphor in her first work of 1653 and again in 1655. For example, when she explains perception, she claims that the rational spirits flow in and out of the body through the eyes and touch upon the object being perceived, intermixing with the rational spirits found therein. The object, possessing its own distinctive spirits and motions, dances a pattern before the rational spirits, which flow back into the eyes. These rational spirits then take up the dance themselves, flowing back into the brain and continuing the dance, which she takes to be sufficient for the mind’s perceiving the object in virtue of the mind’s containing the distinctive dance or pattern. In these early works, she further explains that the rational spirits copy these dances based on a “natural sympathy” among adjacent bodies, particularly between the rational spirits of the perceiver and object perceived. Note that, throughout this account of perception, motion is never transferred from one body to another. Instead, motions and “dances” are taken up from the internal activity of the rational spirits, that is, from the nature of the moving matter. The matter moves itself according to its own nature and initiates changes in its own motion via natural sympathy.

By the 1660s, though, she largely replaces the dance metaphor with the terms “imitation” and “figuring out”, the latter in the sense of tracing or copying a shape or distinctive pattern of motion. Even so, the account is largely the same. Her argument from the Observations could be reconstructed as follows:

Bodies move in orderly and infinitely variable ways.
Either they are moved by spirits or they are moved by bodies.
But not spirits because that is mysterious, so bodies.
If bodily motion issues from the body, then, it must issue from either inanimate matter (mechanism) or animate matter (vitalism).
But not inanimate matter (mechanism), for the mechanistic account of bodily motion, (such as animals spirits and inanimate fine particles that transmit force), cannot account for the infinite variety and orderliness of the activity in nature.
So the bodily cause of motion must be the body’s animate matter, which (it is alleged) has an ability to produce an infinite variety of orderly effects.

This is what might be called the argument from the variability and regularity of nature for self-moving matter. Premise 5 implies the argument that if the world was ultimately constituted by uniform matter, passively receiving and transferring motion, according to mathematical laws of collision, then the universe should be either entirely homogenous or entirely chaotic. In this argument for self-moving matter, many of the central themes of Cavendish’s natural philosophy are visible: her materialist rejection of incorporeal causes, her denial of mechanistic explanation and her resulting vitalism.

Another significant feature of her natural philosophy, and one that appears especially clearly when she critiques mechanism, is her refusal to take mathematical physics as an exemplar. Whereas Cartesian and Hobbesian natural philosophy could be described as attempts to understand nature with metaphors and modes of explanation taken from the new, mathematical physics, Cavendish instead draws from other sources, especially her personal experiences with country life and, less directly, the life sciences. When explaining natural phenomena, she often makes reference to the behaviors of animals and humans, as well as her awareness of botanical phenomena. She in fact reported in the 1650s that Gerald’s Herbal, a botanical reference book, was the only scientific work she had read. Perhaps because of this, she often explained the behaviors of an animal’s or plant’s rational spirits in terms of their macro-level behaviors, rather than in terms of atomic or corpuscular, mathematical explanation. By the 1660s, at least, we know that she had read and engaged the work of other vitalist and anti-mechanists, such as the alchemist Johannes Baptista Van Helmont. However, even before that time, her preference for biological metaphors over those of mathematical physics was evident.

Cavendish’s preference for biological modes of explanation can also be seen in her organicism. Not only does she deny atomism, but she also argues that the parts of bodies in part possess their distinctive motions and natures in virtue of the larger, organic systems, in which they are located. She says, “[f]or example: an eye, although it be composed of parts, and has a whole and perfect figure, yet it is but part of the head, and could not subsist without it” (Observations, Ch. 31). This is not an argument for organicism; instead, she means it as an analogy to illustrate her views on individuals more generally.

Despite the similarities of her vitalism to that of Van Helmont or perhaps Henry More, Cavendish also departs from them in her commitment to materialism. Indeed, she accounts for life in nature by claiming that “[a]ll motion is life,” even in her first work of 1653. Human beings are alive, she says, because they are material beings composed of matter with varying degrees of motion moving in a distinctive pattern. For Cavendish that is all that is needed for something to be alive. Note, though, that all things in nature, from humans and animals and plants down to minerals and artifacts, are the things they are, because they are composed of matter with distinctive patterns and degrees of motion. In this regard, she resembles Hobbes, even though she will ultimately reject his mechanistic view of matter, especially with her view that all matter is self-moving. We might therefore say that Cavendish’s natural philosophy is committed to pan-vitalism or animism, or even, as Cudworth would later say, hylozoism. But we must remember that her view departs from the Cambridge Platonists and Van Helmont in denying that the principles of life are to be explained by reference to incorporeal powers, entities or properties. All matter is to some extent alive and all of nature is infused with a principle of life, but this principle of life is simply motion.

Thus Cavendish provides a fairly deflationary account of life as motion and in this regard her natural philosophy may resemble Hobbes or Descartes. Despite this similarity, Cavendish again rejects their mechanism in her denial of determinism, even with regards to bodily interaction. Though she often appeals to the orderliness and regularity of nature in defending her theory of self-moving matter, she also recognizes the presence of disorder in nature, such as in disease. In fact, she explains illness or disease as the rebellion of a part of the body against the whole, explaining that some bits of matter have freely chosen alternative motions and thus disrupted the harmonious all. In short, Cavendish ascribes a libertarian freedom not only to human agents but even to the parts of matter themselves, explaining the behaviors of organisms with a social ‘body politic’ metaphor. We might say, then, that she draws from experiences of the biological and botanical world to explain her metaphysics, but she also incorporates a Hobbesian sense of the body politic into her metaphysics and in so doing reinforces her rejection of the mechanistic worldview.

However, Cavendish does not stop at explaining the principle of life by reference to degrees of motion in matter, because she also claims to explain mental representation and ultimately knowledge in this way. When a particular pattern of motion occurs in the brain, say, via perception, the person perceives the object; for the person to have an idea of the object is just for her brain to contain its distinctive motion. More generally, she takes the presence of such patterned motions in matter to mean that said matter has knowledge, at least in some sense. Yet she also argues that such motions can be found throughout all of nature, every body possessing its own distinctive motions. For these reasons, her vitalist materialism fits nicely with her panpsychism.

c. Panpsychism

In saying that all motion is life and that all things in nature are composed of matter with a degree of motion, Cavendish affirms that life permeates all of the natural world, including what we might call inanimate objects. For Cavendish, inanimate objects are alive, because they possess motion, though they might have a lesser degree of motion, and thus a lesser degree of life, than an animal or human being. Indeed, she also believes that knowledge is similarly diffused across all of nature to greater and lesser degrees. For these reasons, we might call Cavendish an incremental naturalist with regard to knowledge and life. That is, she takes distinctively human traits such as knowledge and life to be natural properties that are present to varying degrees throughout all of nature.

Throughout her work, Cavendish argues that whatever has motion has knowledge and that knowledge is innate or internally directed motion. In her Philosophical Fancies of 1653, she explains that

the touch of the heel, or any part of the body else, is the like motion, as the thought thereof in the head; the one is the motion of the sensitive spirits, the other in the rational spirits, as touch from the sensitive spirits, for thought is only a strong touch, and touch a weak thought. So sense is a weak knowledge, and knowledge a strong sense, made by the degrees of the spirits (Chapter 45).

In the next chapter she continues to argue that all matter exhibits regular motion, which occurs because all matter is infused with sensitive spirits; but to have sensitive spirits is to be able to sense; thus all matter senses things.

Now, in her earliest work, she offers at best a “who knows so why not” sort of argument that matter thinks, saying, “[i]f so, who knows, but vegetables and minerals may have some of those rational spirits, which is a mind or soul in them, as well as man?” and “if their [vegetables and minerals] knowledge be not the same knowledge, but different from the knowledge of animals, by reason of their different figures, made by other kind of motion on other tempered matter, yet it is knowledge” (Chapter 46).

Later, for example in her Observations, she argues that the regularity of nature can best—or perhaps only—be explained by admitting that all material bodies possess knowledge. She argues that matter and material beings exhibit regular motion and then argues that “there can be no regular motion without knowledge, sense, and reason” (Observations, 129). Furhtermore, she argues that each part of the body and each object in nature exhibits a distinctive activity. The brain thinks; the stomach digests; the loins produce offspring—and they do so in regular and consistent ways. Indeed, each of these organs or parts of the body are themselves also composite, made up of an infinite number of smaller bodies. What unites them, however, is their distinctive motions, producing their distinctive behaviors. And Cavendish takes each of these distinctive motions to be a kind of knowledge.

She argues that we ought to think of these distinctive motions as knowledge, because that is the best, or perhaps only, way to explain the regularity and stability of these composites. If these parts are to do these things, they must know what they do, especially given the regular and consistent ways in which they do them. Indeed, without matter knowing its own distinctive motions, she argues, perception would be impossible. She says, “[s]elf-knowledge is the ground, or fundamental cause of perception: for were there not self-knowledge, there could not be perception” (Observations, 155). In short, all material entities, which is to say all things in nature, possess knowledge. The view that all things in nature possess mind or mental properties is panpsychism, to which Cavendish is committed here.

Even so, she uses the concept of knowledge in an unusual way. When she ascribes knowledge to a rock, or to my liver for example, but she neither necessarily means that the rock or my liver have mental states like ours nor that they can perceive their environments in the same way we do. For Cavendish, the knowledge of a thing like a mirror is, indeed, conditioned by the sort of motions that constitute the mirror, the motions that make it the thing it is; as such, mirror-knowledge and mirror-perception are very different from their human analogues. Even so, the mirror’s perception and knowledge are in some ways analogous to human perception and knowledge; both involve the object’s patterning out its own matter in a way, which copies or resembles an external object. Despite this similarity between a mirror and a human, the human being is composed of matter capable of many different kinds of perception and knowledge, whereas the mirror has a very limited ability to pattern out or reflect its environment. And the human has sufficient amounts of rational spirits uniting its parts to be able to conduct rational inquiry, whereas the rational matter of a mirror is very limited indeed.

This might sound as though she is walking back her commitment to panpsychism, but in fact she is not. For these parts or degrees of matter that possess varying levels of awareness are in fact entirely intermixed together in all things. She says, “there is a double perception in all parts of nature, to wit, rational and sensitive…. I believe there is sense and reason, or sensitive and rational knowledge, not only in all creatures, but in every part of every particular creature” (Ch. 36). Thus the rock, though it possesses a great deal of duller matter, also possesses sensitive and even rational spirits within. So Cavendish says,

self-motion is the cause of all the various…actions of nature; these cannot be performed without perception: for all actions are knowing and perceptive; and, were there no perceptions, there could not possibly be any such actions: for, how should parts agree, either in generation, composition, or dissolution of composed figures, if they had no knowledge or perception of each other? (Ch. 37, 167).

In short, Cavendish’s natural philosophy is materialist, vitalist and panpsychist, as well as anti-atomist and anti-mechanist. Unlike many of her opponents who favor mathematical physics, she takes the living things—and the limited awareness of the life sciences—as a model for her natural philosophy, as evidenced in her organicism, as well as her particular use of metaphor. In other words, she agrees with Descartes and Hobbes against the occult explanations of the Scholastics, with More and Van Helmont against the reductive mechanism of Hobbes and Descartes and with Hobbes and Stoic materialism against the incorporeal principles of More and Van Helmont.

d. God

Cavendish’s views on God are puzzling. She regularly repeats that we cannot assert the existence of things that are not observable material objects in the natural world and she does so in a way that might suggest to the modern reader that she does not believe in the immortality of the soul or the existence of an immaterial God. This would likely be a mistake, however, as there are several passages where she instead explains that she does not include God in her speculations, because we cannot speak with any degree of confidence about God’s nature. Though God is mostly absent from her work in the 1650s, in the Observations she says, “there is an infinite difference between divine attributes, and natural properties; wherefore to similize [sic] our reason, will, understanding, faculties, passions and figures etc. to God, is too high a presumption, and in some manner a blasphemy” (“Further Observations”, Ch 10, 215) and “God is incomprehensible, and above nature: but inasmuch as can be known, to wit, his being [i.e., that he exists]; and that he all-powerful…eternal, infinite, omnipotent, incorporeal, individual, immovable being” (*Further Observations*, Ch 11, 216-17). This certainly suggests that she takes God to exist or, at least, that she takes questions of his existence and nature to lie largely outside of the realm of natural philosophy and instead, perhaps, to be a matter of faith alone.

Nevertheless, we might speculate on the details of her views. As mentioned above, her views on the existence of a supernatural soul seem to be in tension with her other metaphysical commitments. Similarly, her views on the existence of an immaterial God seem similarly in tension. Interestingly, she attaches an erratum on the final page of her first work, Philosophical Fancies, apologizing to the reader for having omitted the appropriate pieties and references to God in her natural philosophical system. What is even stranger is that, when she would reprint and re-write that system in her 1656 Philosophical and Physical Opinions, she would again omit any references to God and instead include the same erratum a second time.

Even so, it is unlikely she thought of herself as an atheist. Perhaps, as some scholars have interpreted Thomas Hobbes, she simply believed that she had no business discussing the nature of God’s existence as that was not a matter of rational inquiry but mere faith. It should be noted, however, that her several discussions of fame suggest that she was not convinced that she would have an existence after her own death.

3. Political Philosophy

In addition to her substantial work on natural philosophy, Cavendish also wrote many other works in a variety of genres, from essays on social issues to poems and plays, even the fantastic utopian fiction The Blazing World. Unlike her work on natural philosophy, however, in which she sets out her views in relatively systematic ways and in philosophical treatises, her thoughts on social or political issues appear in works of fiction or in essays strongly conditioned by rhetorical devices. For example, in Orations of Divers Sorts, she speaks in a variety of voices, imagining several fictional interlocutors who present a number of positions on issues, without indicating the author’s own views. Similarly, in her fiction, she often has several characters advocate for philosophical positions, which complicates any attribution of that view we might make to the author herself. Indeed, in The Blazing World Margaret Cavendish, the Duchess of Newcastle, appears as a character, who advises the Empress of the Blazing World on how her society ought to be governed. In this case, we might feel fairly confident that the views espoused by the character of Cavendish accord with the author’s own, but such attributions should be made only tentatively. Despite the challenges presented by the genres, in which she chose to address these issues, we might still attribute certain general views to her. Among the recurring issues she addressed are aristocracy, gender and fame.

a. Religious Liberty

To see the difficulty in ascribing unambiguous views to Cavendish in these works, consider her thoughts on liberty and stability. In her 1666 fictional work The Blazing World, an Empress restructured her subjects into professional scientific societies. In the story, this change results in a breakdown of social harmony; the old institutions, by which the society had harmoniously functioned, begin to fail, there is strife and faction, and anarchy and civil war loom. Into this situation arrives the character of Margaret Cavendish who advises the formation of a single state sponsored religion. She further instructs the Empress in architectural details, indicating that an imposing cathedral be built from a magical burning stone found in this fictional world. Made, again, by some magical device, to float above the city, with a voice issuing from the Church with booming decrees that the old ways be reinstated, with everyone being born into and retaining the stations. The character of Cavendish proposes that doing so will cow the factious citizens and make them agree, so that cobblers will beget cobblers, soldiers give rise to soldiers and so on. When the Empress executes this plan social harmony is restored. This suggests to the reader that the author Cavendish opposes the sort of political progress that the Empress had proposed; the reader might also conclude that Cavendish supports the institution of a strong state Church.

Yet in her 1662 Orations of Divers Sorts, she states in one of her orations that, if the people have already adopted a variety of religious views, then the government should grant liberty of conscience—that is, freedom of religion—because doing so is the only way to maintain peace. Indeed she says explicitly there that the government should grant this liberty, because a failure to do so will result in anarchy. Then, in the next oration immediately after, she argues from a different perspective, claiming instead that liberty of conscience would lead to liberty in the state, which in turn would result in anarchy. Political liberty, she claims, undermines the rule of law, without which there can be no justice and thus there will be anarchy. Finally, she presents a third oration in defense of a middle view. There she argues that liberty of conscience is acceptable if it concerns only private devotions, but not if it disrupts the public. In other words, if their religious beliefs do neither violate any laws nor harm the public, then those beliefs are to be allowed. We might speculate that she intends this final, middle view to be taken as the author’s own, but it is not always clear, especially when, rather than presenting two views and concluding with a compromise, she instead presents six or seven different opinions, as she does on the question of whether women are equal to men. Even so, the reader may suspect that, in this case, the compromise view is closest to Cavendish’s own.

One feature that unites these varied discussions, however, is Cavendish’s fundamental commitment to the importance of political stability. In each of the above cases, she motivates her position by assuming that social and political stability must be preserved above all. All the orations, as well as the character of Cavendish in The Blazing World, seem to assume that political stability is the goal and that the sovereign ought to employ whatever means will be successful in securing it. Like Hobbes, then, Cavendish takes the primary function of the State to provide stability. This attitude recurs in her defenses of royalism and aristocracy.

b. Royalism and Aristocracy

Cavendish came from a family of royalists, served as a maid in waiting to Queen Henrietta Maria during her and Charles the Second’s exile from England at the hands of the republican revolutionaries of Cromwell and married one of Charles’s staunchest royalist supporters, William Cavendish, Duke of Newcastle. Her commitment to royalism and, more generally, to aristocracy, appears frequently in her writing. When she discusses how a country ought to be governed, she is unwavering in her view that states are best ruled by a King or Queen, who should come from the aristocracy.

One can draw an interesting analogy between her natural philosophy and her politics here. When discussing the distinction between health and illness in animals, Cavendish describes the organism as a body politic; the healthy body is one, in which each part of the body plays its role appropriately, whereas a diseased body is one, in which one or more parts are in rebellion, acting against their natures, to the detriment of the whole organism. Indeed, given her vitalism and panpsychism, she might describe disease in the human body and political unrest or rebellion in remarkably similar terms. In both cases, the whole body is composed of a variety of different parts, each with its own distinctive activity or motion. Each part knows its role, its place, in the body politic, yet each part is free to direct its motions in a way contrary to its natural activity. If a part chooses to do so, it will throw the orderly harmony of the whole out of balance. To expand upon this metaphysical account, we might say that, for Cavendish, people have certain stations—roles and places—in society from birth by nature and social harmony is achieved when the citizens conduct themselves according to their knowledge of their own distinctive activities. As long as the cobblers cobble, the soldiers defend, the judges judge and the rulers rule, social harmony will be maintained and each person can cultivate themselves accordingly.

Indeed, this seems to be one of the central features of Cavendish the character’s advice to the Empress in The Blazing World. Being a fantastical and quasi-science fictional story, The Blazing World features citizens of a variety of animal species, all sentient, capable of human language and so on. Originally, each species has their own distinctive roles, belonging to their own, species-specific guilds. It is to this world that Cavendish urges the Empress to return, one where the citizens are like different species, each with their own peculiar skills and roles received in virtue of what sorts of people their parents were. If the people of The Blazing World simply accepted the stations into which they were born, social harmony would be regained. It is difficult not to see this as a parable of the Restoration of Charles II and the English aristocracy; peace is restored to England by the return of the aristocracy. Moreover, in 1665, the year before The Blazing World was published, her family was restored their lands and her husband was advanced to Dukedom for his service to the King during the Civil Wars.

c. Gender

Cavendish is also described at times as an early feminist. To be sure, her own remarkable life as an author and philosopher leads many to take her as an exemplar; one might say she was a feminist in deed, if not always in word.

Beyond that, though, some scholars argue that her writings are feminist as well. For many of the reasons cited above, such claims can be complicated. Consider the seven orations on women in her Orations of Divers Sorts. There she presents seven speeches that take up a variety of positions. She begins by lamenting the fact that men possess all the power and women entirely lack it. In a subsequent oration, she speculates that women lack power in society, due to natural inferiority. She then counters in the next oration that women might be able to achieve as much as men were they given the opportunity to engage in traditionally masculine activities. But the next speaker claims that, were women to imitate men in this way, they would become “hermaphroditical.” Instead, this orator suggests, women should cultivate feminine virtues such as chastity and humility. In the very next oration, however, the orator suggests that feminine virtues are inferior to masculine, so women should pursue masculine virtues instead. She concludes the series of orations on this topic with a new position, arguing that women are in fact superior to men because women, through their beauty, can control men.

What is the reader to make of this series of orations? It seems likely that Cavendish affirms the following empirical facts about her society: women lack power; women could gain fame and even perhaps power if they pursued masculine virtues; they might even be equally capable as men in cultivating these virtues; yet women would be despised if they did pursue these virtues; if women cultivated feminine virtues, they would not be despised and could even acquire a kind of indirect power, but such a state of affairs is ultimately inferior to the power men possess. What is less clear is whether Cavendish really believes that the pursuit of so-called masculine virtues would somehow harm women by causing them to deny their natures. In other words, it is not clear from these orations whether Cavendish thinks women are naturally inferior to men. In her earlier Worlds Olio, on the other hand, she seems less ambivalent, claiming that women are in general inferior to men at rhetoric. Some women may cultivate skill in rhetoric to rival and even exceed that of men, but they are few, she claims, in this work.

Some readers might point to The Blazing World, and to the power of the Empress or the success of the character of Cavendish as a political adviser. It is true that the Empress leads her people in a successful naval battle, defeating a mortal enemy of her homeland. A similar event occurs in her story Bell in Campo. Even so, the considerations above suggest that social harmony is restored because she returns to aristocratic values. After all, the notion that a woman might lead an empire, even into war, would not be so foreign to an English subject in the 1660s, given that Queen Elizabeth ruled just a few decades before and had overseen the important naval defeat of the Spanish Armada.

From her first work and throughout her career, Cavendish engaged the issue of women in her writing, reflecting on her own experience as a woman and how, or whether, it shaped her writing or philosophy. Thus, with her impressive life and regular consideration of the relevance of gender to her thought, Cavendish can be seen as an important precursor for later more explicitly feminist writers, even if she herself might not be aptly so described.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Cavendish’s Works in the 17th Century

Only the first publication is listed for each work; Cavendish revised and reprinted several of her works multiple times over the years. So, for example, Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy first appeared in 1666 but reappeared, with the addition of The Blazing World, in 1668. And Grounds of Natural Philosophy is a substantially revised version of her earlier Philosophical and Physical Opinions, itself, which contained her early Philosophical Fancies as its first part.

Cavendish, Margaret, Philosophical Fancies, London: printed by Thomas Roycroft for J. Martin and J. Allestrye, 1653.
Cavendish, Margaret, The World’s Olio, London: printed for J. Martin and J. Allestrye, 1655.
Cavendish, Margaret, Philosophical and Physical Opinions, London: printed for J. Martin and J. Allestrye, 1655.
Cavendish, Margaret, Nature’s Pictures, London: printed for J. Martin and J. Allestrye, 1656.
Cavendish, Margaret, Plays, London: printed for J. Martin, J. Allestrye and T. Dicas, 1662.
Cavendish, Margaret, Orations of Divers Sorts, Accommodated to Divers Places, London: printed by W. Wilson, 1662.
Cavendish, Margaret, ‘Bell in Campo’, in Playes, London: J. Martin, J. Allestrye and T. Dicas, 1662.
Cavendish, Margaret, Sociable Letters, London: printed by William Wilson, 1664.
Cavendish, Margaret, Philosophical Letters, London: possibly printed by David Maxwell, 1664.
Cavendish, Margaret, Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy, London: printed by Anne Maxwell, 1666.
Cavendish, Margaret, The Description of a New World, Called the Blazing World, London: printed by A. Maxwell, 1666.
Cavendish, Margaret, Life of William, London: printed by A. Maxwell, 1667.
Cavendish, Margaret, Grounds of Natural Philosophy, London: printed by A. Maxwell, 1668.

b. Modern Editions of Her Works

Cavendish, Margaret, The Description Of A New World, Called The Blazing World And Other Writings, ed, Kate Lilley. London: William Pickering, 1992.
Cavendish, Margaret, Paper Bodies: A Margaret Cavendish Reader, eds. Sylvia Bowerbank and Sara Mendelson. Peterborough, ON: Broadview Press, 2000.
Cavendish, Margaret, Observations upon Experimental Philosophy, ed. Eileen O’Neill. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
Cavendish, Margaret, Margaret Cavendish: Political Writings, ed. Susan James. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.

c. Secondary Literature

Battigelli, Anna, 1998, Margaret Cavendish and The Exiles of the Mind, Lexington: The University Press of Kentucky.
- An overview of Cavendish’s life and works from a scholar of English literature, with discussions on genre and rhetorical devices in her works.
Boyle, Deborah, 2006,“Fame, Virtue, and Government: Margaret Cavendish on Ethics and Politics,” Journal of the History of Ideas, 67: 251–289.
- One of the few discussions of Cavendish’s ethics, with a productive focus on fame.
Boyle, Deborah, 2013, “Margaret Cavendish on Gender, Nature, and Freedom,” Hypatia 28 (3): 516-532.
- An excellent account of the complexities of Cavendish on gender.
Broad, Jacqueline, 2002, Women Philosophers of the Seventeenth Century, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- This text contains a chapter on Cavendish.
Clucas, Stephen, 1994, “The Atomism of the Cavendish Circle: A Reappraisal,” The Seventeenth Century, 9: 247–273.
- Clucas argues that Cavendish never really gave up atomism.
Cunning, David, 2006, “Cavendish on the Intelligibility of the Prospect of Thinking Matter,” History of Philosophy Quarterly, 23: 117–136.
- A discussion of Cavendish and the notion of thinking matter, with connections to contemporary philosophy of mind.
Cunning, David, 2010, “Margaret Lucas Cavendish,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Detlefsen, Karen, 2006, “Atomism, Monism, and Causation in the Natural Philosophy of Margaret Cavendish,” in Daniel Garber and Steven Nadler (eds.), Oxford Studies in Early Modern Philosophy, 3: 199–240
- A long and thorough exploration of some themes in Cavendish’s metaphysics. She refutes Clucas on atomism and provides an insightful analysis on causation.
Detlefsen, Karen, 2007, “Reason and Freedom: Margaret Cavendish on the Order and Disorder of Nature,” Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie, 89: 157–191.
- Detlefsen notes that matter itself must be free of necessity, in order to explain the disorder in nature that Cavendish allows for, especially in disease, in part via a ‘body politic’ analogy.
Detlefsen, Karen, 2009, “Margaret Cavendish on the Relationship Between God and World,” Philosophy Compass, 4: 421–438.
- An overview of Cavendish’s views on God.
Duncan, Stewart, 2013, “Cavendish and the Divine, Supernatural, Immaterial Soul,” The Mod Squad: A Group Blog in Modern Philosophy, Accessed November 4, 2014.
- A discussion and consideration of the nature and role of the supernatural soul in Cavendish’s metaphysics.
Duncan, Stewart, 2012, “Debating Materialism: Cavendish, Hobbes, and More,” History of Philosophy Quarterly 29 (4): 391-409.
- An analysis of Cavendish that clarifies and contextualizes her materialism vis-à-vis Hobbes and More, with whom her thought shares some important similarities.
Hutton, Sarah, 1997, “In Dialogue with Thomas Hobbes: Margaret Cavendish’s natural philosophy,” Women’s Writing, 4: 421–432.
- Cavendish’s debt, and response, to Hobbes’s metaphysics.
James, Susan, 1999, “The Philosophical Innovations of Margaret Cavendish,” British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 7: 219–244.
- An excellent overview of the major themes in Cavendish’s metaphysics.
James, Susan, 2003, “Introduction,” in Margaret Cavendish: Political Writings, ed. Susan James, Cambridge: Cambridge UP (2003).
- An overview of Cavendish’s social and political themes.
Kroetsch, Cameron, 2013, “List of Margaret Cavendish’s Texts, Printers, and Booksellers,” The Digital Cavendish Project, Accessed November 4, 2014.
- A detailed account of the printing and publishing of Cavendish’s works.
Lascano, Marcy. “An Introduction to Margaret Cavendish, or ‘Why You Should Include Margaret Cavendish in Your Early Modern Course and Buy the Book.’” The Mod Squad, A Group Blog in Early Modern Philosophy. Accessed July 14, 2014.
- Lascano makes a compelling case for the inclusion of Cavendish in Early Modern Philosophy survey courses.
Lewis, Eric, 2001, “The Legacy of Margaret Cavendish,” Perspective on Science, 9: 341–365.
- An overview of Cavendish’s reception, both among her contemporaries and ours. Valuable in part for its identification of lacunae in recent scholarship.
Michaelian, Kourken, 2009, “Margaret Cavendish’s Epistemology,” British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 17: 31–53.
- The only extended discussion of Cavendish’s epistemology, with a special focus on her distinction of internal and external knowledge.
O’Neill, Eileen, 1998, “Disappearing Ink: Early Modern Women Philosophers and Their Fate in History,” in Janet A. Kourany (ed.), Philosophy in a Feminist Voice, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
- The locus classicus for discussion of the way in which women philosophers were written out of histories in the past two centuries.
O’Neill, Eileen, 2001, “Introduction,” in Margaret Cavendish, Observations Upon Experimental Philosophy, Eileen O’Neill (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, x-xxxvi.
- An excellent account of Cavendish’s mature thought, in what is arguably her greatest work.
Sarasohn, Lisa, 2010, The Natural Philosophy of Margaret Cavendish: Reason and Fancy During the Scientific Revolution, Baltimore, MA: The Johns Hopkins University Press.
- An examination of Cavendish’s natural philosophy by an historian of science.
Whitaker, Katie, 2002, Mad Madge: The Extraordinary Life of Margaret Cavendish, Duchess of Newcastle, the First Woman to Live by Her Pen, New York: Basic Books.
- An entertaining biography of Cavendish.

Author Information

Gwendolyn Marshall
Email: eumarsha@fiu.edu
Florida International University
U. S. A.

Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646-1716)

Widely hailed as a universal genius, Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz was one of the most important thinkers of the late 17^th and early 18^th centuries. A polymath and one of the founders of calculus, Leibniz is best known philosophically for his metaphysical idealism; his theory that reality is composed of spiritual, non-interacting “monads,” and his oft-ridiculed thesis that we live in the best of all possible worlds. Though these ideas may make his philosophy seem exceedingly abstract, Leibniz had keen interest in less abstract fields, such as empirical physics and jurisprudence. He also made great contributions to logic, with some considering him the greatest logician since Aristotle.

Due to his belief in a rationally ordered universe, his commitment to the principle of sufficient reason, and his acceptance of innate ideas, Leibniz is rightly ranked along with Descartes and Spinoza as one of the seminal early modern rationalists. Leibniz stands out in this tradition, however, for his novel efforts to find compatibility between classical and modern thought. He retained ancient and scholastic notions such as substantial form and final cause, while at the same time attempting to improve upon the mechanical philosophies of Hobbes, Spinoza, and Descartes. He also hoped his comprehensive philosophical system would serve as a common ground for uniting the determinedly divided Christian denominations in Europe. Such irenic pursuits make Leibniz a unique transitional figure in the history of philosophy. He has been called both the last in the lineage of great Christian Platonists and the first thinker to tackle the intellectual problems of modern Europe. After an introduction to his life and works, this article examines the key elements of Leibniz’s ambitious philosophical program.

Life and Writings
Key Principles
Metaphysics
Theodicy
Epistemology
Ethics
1. Intellect and Will
2. Justice and Charity
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources: Leibniz Texts and Translations
2. Secondary Sources

1. Life and Writings

Leibniz was born on 1 July 1646, during the waning years of the Thirty Years’ War, in the Lutheran town of Leipzig. His father, Friedrich, was professor of moral philosophy at the University in Leipzig. His mother, Catherina Schmuck, was the daughter of a law professor. Leibniz grew up in an educated, and by all accounts, orthodox Lutheran environment. Between the books of his father, those of his maternal grandfather, and the contributions of Friedrich’s bookselling former father-in-law, Leibniz had access to an impressive library. At a young age, he gained a love for classical literature and the writings of the Church Fathers.

From 1661-63, Leibniz pursued university studies in Leipzig, with a brief stay at the university in Jena in 1663. At the time, the curriculum at these universities was still largely scholastic with some pedagogical practices bearing traces of the Ramist encyclopedic tradition. Leibniz’s main teachers, Jakob Thomasius in Leipzig and Erhard Weigel in Jena, were Aristotelians with eclectic interests. Leibniz had his own eclectic interests, having gained some, mostly second-hand, familiarity with modern mechanical philosophy. Later in his life, he recounted a fateful stroll through the Rosental in Leipzig in which he debated the respective merits of scholastic and modern thinking. “Mechanism finally prevailed,” he recalled, “and led me to apply myself to mathematics” (G III, 606). Though steeped in classical and scholastic learning, Leibniz at quite a young age fashioned himself a man of the times.

Leibniz went on to pursue a degree in law, earning his doctorate from the University in Altdorf in 1666. His writings from his student years include his bachelor’s dissertation, A Metaphysical Disputation on the Principle of Individuation, an early work in combinatorial logic titled A Dissertation on the Art of Combinations, and works on legal theory.

After short stints in Nuremburg and Frankfurt, Leibniz took his first major employment in the Catholic court of the Prince-Archbishop of Mainz, Johann Philipp von Schӧnborn in 1668. Leibniz was tasked with reforming legal codes and statutes. During his time in Mainz, Leibniz struck up an important relationship with Baron Johann Christian von Boineburg, the central statesman in the Mainz court. Boineburg appreciated Leibniz’s considerable talents and set before him the task of solving the day’s most pressing philosophical and theological questions. Through his association with Boineburg, Leibniz began to see the challenges modern philosophy, especially the materialism of Gassendi and Hobbes, posed to belief in the immortality of the soul, to belief in God and natural law, and to both Catholic and Lutheran understandings of the Eucharist. Leibniz thus from 1668-70 began working on a number of preliminary studies meant to be part of a comprehensive work entitled Catholic Demonstrations. Though this dreamed-of magnum opus never materialized, Leibniz never abandoned his goal of developing a modern philosophy congenial to Christian theology. In addition to his Catholic Demonstrations writings, Leibniz’s Elements of Natural Law, written between 1669 and 1671, also contributed to these efforts. Furthermore, during this period Leibniz intensified his interest in physics, writing the Theory of Abstract Motion and the New Physical Hypothesis, and penning an unanswered letter to Thomas Hobbes on the Englishman’s physical theory as it relates to the philosophy of mind. Leibniz in hindsight found these youthful physical works unimpressive, but they attest to the diversity of his interests.

Mainz opened Leibniz to an extraordinarily broad range of philosophical concerns; his most intense period of intellectual development soon followed. In 1672, Leibniz was dispatched to Paris on a diplomatic mission as well as on personal business for Boineburg. Paris exposed Leibniz to learning, resources, and interlocutors the likes of which he had never seen. He had access to the unpublished writings of Descartes and Pascal. He met with leading Parisian intellectuals Antoine Arnauld and Nicholas Malebranche. He studied mathematics under the Dutch mathematician Christiaan Huygens. He twice visited London, in 1673 and 1676, meeting with the mathematicians and physicists of the Royal Society. Leibniz’s friend Walther von Tschirnhaus, though forbidden from showing Leibniz an advanced copy, apprised Leibniz of many of the contents of Spinoza’s Ethics. This led Leibniz, upon leaving Paris in 1676, to make an excursion to The Hague to visit Spinoza.

Paris and London offered Leibniz the opportunity to establish himself as a rising star in the European intellectual orbit and Leibniz did not squander his chance. By 1675 he had developed the infinitesimal calculus, only three years after he started the serious study of contemporary mathematics. He also continued to write on a wide range of philosophical topics. His Confession of a Philosopher of 1672-3 was his first response to the problem of evil and to the question of determinism. His most important collection of metaphysical papers from the period, De summa rerum, contains some of Leibniz’s early responses to Spinoza’s monism, with budding reflections on the relationship between mind and body, on the nature of the continuum, and on universal harmony.

In 1676, Leibniz accepted a position in the court of Duke Johann Friedrich of Hanover, employed mainly to serve as court librarian and to consult on engineering projects in the Harz mines. After his taste of the intellectual scenes in Paris and London, Leibniz found life in Hanover a disappointment. Despite his lack of professional prospects, Leibniz would in the ensuing decade sharpen his intellectual vision. He published a number of important essays on mathematics, epistemology, and physics in the new journal Acta Eruditorum. In 1686, while it snowed in the Harz, Leibniz composed “a little discourse on metaphysics.” Now published without the diminutive “little,” the Discourse on Metaphysics is widely considered Leibniz’s first mature philosophical statement. Leibniz sent a summary of the Discourse to Arnauld, sparking an extended and illuminating correspondence between them on issues of freedom, causality, and occasionalism.

In 1689, Leibniz travelled to Italy on official business, researching possible ancestral ties to the Guelf Dukes of Hanover. Leibniz, never one to let official duties interfere with his own intellectual agenda, used the opportunity to pitch his metaphysics to leading Catholic intellectuals. He also wrote works on cosmology in efforts to exonerate the Copernican system from Vatican censure.

Leibniz returned in 1690 to Hanover, which remained his home base until his death. Leibniz continued to write prodigiously and we can mention here only a small sample of his works. 1695 saw the publication of the first part of his Specimen of Dynamics and his New System of Nature. The former work included Leibniz’s reflections on the nature of force, and in many ways was developed in response to Newton’s Principia Mathematica; the latter was Leibniz’s first public presentation of his theory of pre-established harmony. In 1703, Leibniz began work on The New Essays on Human Understanding, a book-length dialogue in response to Locke’s Essay on Human Understanding. The only book Leibniz published during his lifetime, the Theodicy, was released in 1710. In this work, Leibniz defends his thesis that we live in best of all possible worlds and defends the reasonableness of Christianity against the fideism and skepticism of Pierre Bayle. In 1714, Leibniz wrote the Monadology, the last comprehensive summary statement of his philosophical views.

Throughout his years in Hanover, Leibniz maintained a stunning number of epistolary correspondents. Notable among these were Samuel Clark, Burchard de Volder, Johann Bernoulli, Bartholomew Des Bosses, and Christian Wolff. Leibniz also corresponded and often met with Sophie, Electress of Hanover, and her daughter Sophie Charlotte, Queen of Prussia. These women encouraged, and in many ways made possible, Leibniz’s philosophical pursuits while employed at the court.

Leibniz’s final years were clouded by charges that he stole ideas from the papers of Isaac Newton when developing the calculus in the 1670s. Leibniz has been cleared of the charges and it is now accepted that the two men developed the calculus independently. Leibniz died on 14 November 1716 after struggles with gout and arthritis.

Unlike the other major philosophical lights of his era, and despite having written more than any of them, Leibniz produced no magnum opus. He seemed most at home in dialogue, in correspondence, and in controversy. The Discourse on Metaphysics and Monadology are his most commonly studied works in metaphysics. Scholars disagree about the extent to which the two works are in accord, but they together provide a solid grounding in Leibniz’s thought. The Theodicy is a classic of philosophical theology and the New Essays provides the fullest account of Leibniz’s epistemology. This article will summarize Leibniz’s philosophy mainly as it is presented in these works. It would be a mistake, however, to think that one can get a full picture of Leibniz’s interests from these works and the reader is encouraged to consult the many excellent edited selections of Leibniz’s texts.

2. Key Principles

Several key principles form the core of Leibniz’s philosophy. Though Leibniz never lists these serially in the manner of, for instance, the axioms of Spinoza’s Ethics, the principles nonetheless shape Leibniz’s thinking and ground his major claims. He refers to them throughout his writings and we shall refer to them throughout our discussion. Though each of these principles merits further analysis in its own right, we introduce them only briefly here. Truly unique to Leibniz is not so much these principles in themselves as the use to which he collectively puts them.

In the Monadology, Leibniz writes that we reason “based on two great principles” (M 30). The first of these is the principle of contradiction, which deems every contradiction to be false. Classically stated, the principle of contradiction holds that something cannot be both “x” and “not x” at the same time and in the same respect. Aristotle claimed that all logic and reasoning presupposes the principle of contradiction and Leibniz sees no reason to think otherwise.

The second great principle of reason is the principle of sufficient reason, “by virtue of which we consider that we can find no true or existent fact, no true assertion, without there being a sufficient reason why it is thus and not otherwise, although most of these reasons cannot be known to us” (M 31). The classical statement of the principle of sufficient reason is nihil sine ratione: there is nothing without reason or cause. Leibniz holds that every state of affairs has an explanation, even if we must admit that we often do not have sufficient information to provide an explanation. The principle of sufficient reason assumes great prominence in Leibniz’s philosophy, most notably in his accounts of substance, causality, freedom, and optimism.

Closely related to the principle of sufficient reason is the principle of the best. This principle holds that rational beings always choose, and act for, the best. In this way, reason is teleologically ordered towards goodness. On Leibniz’s thinking, if reason did not opt for what is best, it would act arbitrarily; it would not have a sufficient reason for choosing one option over another, thus violating reason’s second great principle. Goodness provides the sufficient reason for rational choice. The principle of the best manifests itself differently in the cases of God and created minds. God, whom Leibniz considers “an absolutely perfect being” (DM 1), and who thus knows what is best, always acts in the best way. Created minds, who have a finite degree of perfection and thus limited knowledge of what is best, always act according to what seems the best from their limited perspectives.

The predicate-in-notion principle provides Leibniz’s notion of truth: praedicatum inest subjecto. In any true, affirmative proposition the predicate is contained in the subject. In order for the proposition, “Leibniz is a mathematician,” to be true, the idea “mathematician” must somehow be included in the idea “Leibniz.” Leibniz’s interpretation of the predicate-in-notion principle, we shall see, has far-reaching consequences for his metaphysics. Somewhat relatedly, Leibniz affirms the principle of the identity of indiscernibles, which states that any two objects sharing all properties are in fact the same, identical object. Each individual object contains some individuating characteristic. Important for Leibniz, this individuating characteristic must be something intrinsic to the individual, and not simply a separation in space and time, which Leibniz considers purely extrinsic denominations. The principle of the identity of indiscernibles is tied closely to the predicate-in-notion principle insofar as the latter makes intrinsic properties the basis of all truth and the former makes such properties the basis for identity and individuation.

A final key principle worth noting is the principle of continuity. “Nothing takes place suddenly, and it is one of my great principles that nature never makes leaps,” Leibniz writes in the New Essays. “I call this the Law of continuity” (NE 56). All change is continuous; there is never a leap, but rather a series of intervening stages. This principle is especially germane to Leibniz’s development of the infinitesimal calculus, but relevant too to his metaphysics and epistemology.

3. Metaphysics

a. Substantial Forms

One of the earliest intellectual projects Leibniz set for himself was to determine the proper relationship between the Aristotelian philosophy taught at his university in Leipzig and the new, mechanical philosophy espoused by thinkers like Galileo, Descartes, and Hobbes. Leibniz embraces modern, mechanical physics as the proper method for investigating nature, yet he is distinctive among 17^th century thinkers for the depths of his efforts to retain several key metaphysical concepts of ancient and medieval philosophy. Chief among these concepts is the Aristotelian idea of substantial form. Though Leibniz does not adopt the traditional understanding of substantial form in its details, his grappling with the legitimacy of this notion sets the trajectory for much of his metaphysics.

Aristotle, with the medieval scholastics following him, argues that any individual thing consists of a substantial form, which determines the kind of thing it is, and matter, which individuates the thing and makes it numerically distinct from other like substances. So, a particular squirrel consists of the universal form “squirrel” shaping and directing particular material stuff. In the 17^th century, the idea that substantial forms should enter into physical accounts of nature becomes especially odious. Citing “squirrelness,” the moderns maintain, tells us nothing regarding the activity of a squirrel. For thinkers such as Hobbes and Descartes, substantial forms are useless fictions, at best superfluous and at worst misleading. The mathematically-based, mechanical laws governing matter in motion suffice to explain the whole of nature, with no need to take into account the kind of thing under investigation. What counts in describing the behavior of a squirrel is not its “squirrelness,” but the forces its limbs exert on one another, the pressure differentials in its circulatory system, and other quantifiable data. This approach makes it possible to have a single method for investigating all natural phenomena.

Leibniz agrees that substantial forms have no use in physics, but he insists metaphysical accounts of reality require something like substantial forms. Mechanical explanation adequately addresses the activity of the physical world, but not its underlying nature. For Leibniz, the corporeal world its very essence depends on incorporeal principles. Both Hobbes’ purely materialist metaphysics and the strict substance-dualism of Descartes fail to properly appreciate nature’s dependence on purely metaphysical entities. Ultimately, Leibniz’s defense of substantial forms provides the first step in the development of his idealist metaphysics.

Leibniz offers several defenses of substantial forms, in which he tries not to revive Aristotle’s notion of form wholesale, so much as to prove the existence of irreducible, incorporeal entities. One argument turns on the principle of sufficient reason: the fact that the corporeal world itself cannot offer any explanation for its particular features. Why does a given body occupy so much space, have a particular shape, or move in just this way? By limiting oneself to mechanical explanation, one can either say that body A’s features were caused by body B, or one can say that body A has had its particular constitution from eternity. The former approach leads to an infinite regress in explanation, which is to say it never arrives at an explanation at all. There is always yet another body requiring explanation. The latter approach, for Leibniz, likewise offers no real explanation. Citing eternity as a reason, he feels, amounts to answering the question “Why is A, x?” with “Simply because A is x and always has been x,” dodging the question. Since the corporeal world does not contain sufficient explanation for its own features, Leibniz concludes that the cause of such features lies in incorporeal principles.

In a second defense of incorporeal substantial principles, Leibniz denies the Cartesian distinction between the primary qualities of bodies and secondary qualities such as color and temperature (DM 12). Descartes, anticipating Locke, argues that the secondary qualities of bodies are relative to the perceiving subject. For instance, as we observe in cases of color-blindness, one person perceives an object as red and another person the same object as green. Color, the argument goes, is thus not a property of the body itself, but depends on the interaction between object and perceiver. Descartes holds, however, that size, shape, and motion are not relative properties, but constitute the essence of body itself. Leibniz, believing that space and time are relative, counters that these primary properties which depend on space and time, and also include something relative to perception. No perceived material quality, therefore, accounts for what a body essentially is. It follows that incorporeal principles must be the real metaphysical building blocks of reality.

A third argument for substantial forms comes in Leibniz’s treatment of force. Descartes had confused force with what we would call momentum. He measured force by multiplying mass by velocity, not by acceleration, or the square of velocity. For Leibniz, this error on the part of Descartes points to an important fact about reality. Motion, measured by mv, is relative. When several objects change positions, one cannot with certainty attribute motion to one object or another. Force, however, has more reality. We have sufficient reason to attribute it to one body over others. In other words, we have more certainty which body in a system is the proximate cause of changes in other bodies. Force, therefore, has more reality than motion, and yet force is not corporeal in the way both mass and velocity are since force is not extended. Though Descartes’ confusion seems simply an error in calculation, in it Leibniz sees additional indication that the realities grounding corporeal objects are not themselves corporeal.

b. Substance as Complete Concept

Though his defense of incorporeal substances allows Leibniz to partially reconcile pre-modern and modern thought, Leibniz still needs to articulate his own account of the nature of these substances. In §8 of the Discourse on Metaphysics, Leibniz takes up the task of defining individual substance. He begins with Aristotle’s definition, which states that when many things are said of a subject, yet it is said of nothing else, this subject is rightly called an individual substance. So, for instance, we say of Alexander the Great that he is Macedonian and ambitious, but we do not say of anything else that it is Alexander the Great. Thus, Alexander is an individual substance.

Leibniz deems this Aristotelian definition of substance merely logical. It tells us something about the structure of thought and language, but does not provide a metaphysical account of substance. To move to a proper metaphysical understanding, Leibniz believes we must look more closely at the nature of predication. “All true predication,” he writes, “has some basis in the nature of things.” Here, Leibniz shows his belief that there is isomorphism between metaphysics and logic. All true propositions have an ontological basis. All we can truly say of Alexander the Great is included in Alexander’s nature.

The idea that each substance includes all the predicates which belong to it is, Leibniz takes it, simply a metaphysical restatement of the predicate-in-notion principle. On the basis of this principle, Leibniz arrives at his notion of substance as a complete concept:

The nature of an individual substance or of a complete being is to have a notion so complete that it is sufficient to contain and to allow us to deduce from it all the predicates of the subject to which the notion is attributed. (DM 8)

Leibniz’s thought is essentially this: if one had a sufficiently powerful intellect, one could deduce from the idea of any individual substance all that could ever be said of it, in just the same way that if one has a clear and distinct idea of a circle, one can deduce all the properties of a circle. From the very concept of Alexander the Great, the infinite intellect of God can deduce all Alexander’s qualities, including that he is the vanquisher of Darius. To be a substance, then, is to have such a corresponding complete concept. Every substance, as it were, includes its biography.

Beginning in the 1690s, “monad” becomes Leibniz’s preferred term for a complete, incorporeal, individual substance. The term monad derives from the Greek mónos, meaning alone or solitary. Leibniz introduces the term to underscore the fact that individual substances are not only complete, but also simple. As Leibniz’s defense of substantial forms showed, the material realm needs grounding in something incorporeal. Matter, however, can be infinitely divided. Leibniz therefore reasons that there must be infinite simple monads populating the world at even the most infinitesimal levels. Leibniz likens the fullness and complexity of the monadic universe to “nested” ponds and gardens.

Each portion of matter can be conceived as a garden full of plants, and as a pond full of fish. But each branch of a plant, each limb of an animal, each drop of its humors, is still another such garden or pond. (M 67)

Monads are thus “spiritual atoms,” the incorporeal building blocks of all reality. They are the complete entities which merit the designation “substance.”

It is in the nature of each monad to have its own internal principle of activity. As Leibniz writes, “activity is of the essence of substance in general” (NE 65). Beginning in the 1690s, Leibniz refers to the internal activity of substances as their primitive active forces. Defining substance in terms of activity is important to Leibniz for several reasons. For one, this position is of a piece with his contention that the activity of corporeal entities is grounded in that of incorporeal entities. In order to play this role, incorporeal monads must themselves be active. More importantly, Leibniz broaches the discussion of substance in the Discourse on Metaphysics with the goal of differentiating the actions of God from those of creatures. In arguing that each substance has its own primitive active force, Leibniz distances himself both from Spinoza’s monism and Malebranche’s occasionalism, the former holding that individual things are not themselves substances but rather modes of a single divine substance, and the latter invoking God’s power to explain the ordinary doings of creatures. To Leibniz, each of these positions insufficiently appreciates that each substance is complete and active in itself. For, were created substances to lack activity, there would be no distinction between actual, created substances and the possible yet uncreated substances in God’s mind, a modal distinction central to Leibniz’s theodicy.

c. Causality and Pre-Established Harmony

If each substance is complete in itself and requires no other substance to be understood, it follows that every finite substance is causally independent of all save God. Each created substance is, as Leibniz says, “like a world apart” (DM 14). But how can this be? How can Alexander defeat Darius without being related to, and thus in a sense dependent on, Darius? More broadly, how can Leibniz square his “world apart” language with our experience of living in a world with a plethora of cause and effect relationships between substances?

Leibniz responds to these questions by offering a unique theory of causal interaction, which he calls at different points either the theory of pre-established harmony or the hypothesis of concomitance. The theory holds that although no two substances directly influence each other, they can express each other, that is, the activity of one can be reflected in the concept of the other. Alexander, we typically say, caused Darius’ death. Leibniz does not object to this kind of causal attribution, but insists that at the metaphysical level, what we call causality amounts to no more than this: it is in the nature of Alexander to be he who defeats Darius and it is likewise in the nature of Darius to be him defeated by Alexander. These two independent substances, as Leibniz puts it, “mirror” each other, so that at the exact moment it can be predicated of Alexander that he is the vanquisher of Darius, it can likewise be predicated of Darius that he is the victim of Alexander.

Hence, although each substance is “like a world apart,” substances form a common world by mirroring, or expressing, one another. God ordains at the moment of creation—in Leibniz’s terms he “preestablishes”—that the perceptions of all creatures in the world harmonize with one another, that there is strict alignment so that at the moment I perceive myself as tapping my friend on the shoulder, she perceives herself as being tapped. Leibniz is fond of likening the relationship between substances to that between two perfectly synchronized clocks which remain aligned despite never touching each other. Causal interaction is no more than what we find in these clocks, the harmonized activity of independent entities. Leibniz famously describes independent monads as “windowless,” neither letting in any outside influence nor issuing any influence (M 7). This is the Leibnizian universe: windowless monads in pre-established harmony.

The theory of pre-established harmony includes the rather strong claim that each substance is harmonized with all other substances in the world. This must be the case if the substances are to form a common world with a common history, since mutual expression is the only possible relation between independent substances. Does this mean that my concept expresses the nature of even a fish living thousands of years ago? In a word, yes. Though Alexander and Darius express each other much more distinctly than I express the ancient fish, my concept must bear traces of the existence of that fish since we are members of a common world. This might seem fantastical, even absurd, but if one considers how much one’s own experience reflects the activities and efforts of one’s predecessors, and how much their activities were constrained by their natural environment, then perhaps one can begin to appreciate Leibniz’s insight that every single substance bears traces of, or faintly expresses, the whole universe, past, present, and future.

Leibniz’s explanation of causality via pre-established harmony and mutual expression has led some commentators to accuse Leibniz of what they call the “mirroring problem.” They object that if substance A expresses the essence of all others, yet these in turn express substance A, then the world is like a hall of mirrors which reflect one another but no concrete images. In this scenario, the concept of any given substance is not complete, as Leibniz would hold, but empty. Although this line of objection points to some of the complexities and potential difficulties in the theory of pre-established harmony, it merits mention that Leibniz sees each substance as fundamentally mirroring God. “It can even be said that every substance bears in some way the character of God’s infinite wisdom and omnipotence and imitates him as much as it is capable” (DM 9). Stating that each substance reflects God’s essence, while also mirroring all other substances, does not directly respond to the mirroring problem. Noting that each substance reflects God’s essence by virtue of its own internal individuating activity perhaps provides a more satisfying response, and it is likely that Leibniz’s solution to the mirroring problem lies in this direction.

d. Idealism

Leibniz’s defense of incorporeal monads as the foundation of the physical world, his notion of substance as a complete concept, and his account of causality via pre-established harmony all contribute to Leibniz’s brand of idealism. By idealism, we mean the thesis that nothing exists in the world but minds and their ideas. As Leibniz summarizes his idealism: “There is nothing in the world but simple substances and in them perception and appetite” (AG 181).

By perception, Leibniz means the “passing state which involves and represents a multitude in the unity or in the simple substance” (M 14). Since each substance is metaphysically complete in itself and “like a world apart,” all changes in its state arise spontaneously, that is, without the intervention of other substances. Yet since each substance mirrors all others, it must contain a multiplicity of representations within itself. The sequence of spontaneous representations is what Leibniz calls perception. Importantly, Leibniz posits that all beings in the world perceive. This is yet another consequence of the fact that mutual representation is the only relation between monads in pre-established harmony. What distinguishes rational, conscious minds from all other substances is not perception, but apperception, or the ability to reflect on their mental processes.

Of appetite, Leibniz writes: “The action of the internal principle which brings about the change or passage from one perception to another can be called appetition; it is true that the appetite cannot always completely reach the whole perception toward which it tends, but it always obtains something of it. And reaches new perceptions” (M 15). The best analogy here is perhaps a mathematical function, where appetite is the analogue to the function equation, or the law of the series, and where each perception represents a discrete value. Leibniz’s point is that each substance has an orientation which defines it and which governs the transition between perceptions. This does not mean that each individual can fully choose or determine the sequence of its perceptions, since it is constrained by the need to faithfully represent the activity of other substances. Appetite does indicate, however, that there is a striving or tendency unique to each substance which shapes the manner in which it reflects the world. Hence Leibniz describes substances as so many distinct “viewpoints” on the universe (DM 14; M 57).

In composite substances, such as living animals whose various parts contribute to the well-being of the entire organism, simple monads unite under the direction of a dominant monad (M 70). Each monad retains its substantial independence, but living organisms display an especially high level of intermonadic harmony. Though Leibniz does not define in detail the operations of dominant monads, these monads must at least subsume others under their own internal principles or appetites. The activity of subordinate monads thereby serves the goals of the dominant monad. Conversely, subordinate monads must have particularly strong bearing on the perceptions of dominant monads, being, as it were, extensions of it. “There is nothing in the world but simple substances, and in them perception and appetite” may sound like a simple statement, but its simplicity should not mask the manifold degrees of coordination between the perceptions and appetites of monads.

e. The Nature of Body

It follows from Leibniz’s idealism that bodies are phenomenal. In other words, the physical world is the perception of perceiving monads. Leibniz is at pains, however, to insist that his system makes bodies “well-founded phenomena” (phenomena bene fundata). By this Leibniz means that bodies are not arbitrary perceptions lacking veracity. The pre-established harmony among all substances establishes a common realm of truth. Our perceptions thus provide us with knowledge of reality and serves as the starting point for empirical science.

Although “well-founded phenomena” might seem an empty expression within an idealist framework, it gains meaning from Leibniz’s commitment to the principle of sufficient reason, that is, the principle that nothing happens without reason or cause. For Leibniz, God’s rational ordering of creation certifies the reliability of sense perception, since God—the most rational of all minds—cannot do anything without having a reason for doing so. It would be arbitrary of God to give me this particular set of perceptions instead of some other set if it were not the case that my perceptions have some basis in other existing substances (NE 56). The thoroughgoing rational design of the world ensures that my perceptions indeed reflect the true order of things.

Defining bodies as “well-founded phenomena” leaves open the question of the relation of an individual’s mind to his own body. After all, my experience of my body seems qualitatively different than my perception of other things in the world. My arm, for example, moves upwards when I wish to remove my hat. Other bodies do not respond to my will in a like manner. Leibniz again invokes his theory of pre-established harmony to explain this apparent interaction between one’s mental and bodily states.

When I wish to raise my arm, it is precisely at the moment when everything is arranged in the body so as to carry this out, in such a manner that the body moves by virtue of its own laws; although it happens through the admirable but unfailing harmony between things that these things conspire towards that end precisely at the moment when the will is inclined to it, since God took it into consideration in advance, when he made his decision about the succession of all things in the universe. (LA 92)

Leibniz explains that God has arranged the world such that one’s mind and body do not directly influence each other, but nevertheless correspond perfectly at all moments. Leibniz is at pains to emphasize that the mind does not directly move the body because he wants to preserve the integrity of physics. Modern physics, relying on the principles of inertia and the conservation of force, requires that the motion of bodies be explained by other bodies. If minds directly influenced bodies, force could be added to the world at any time, and neither the principle of inertia nor the principle of conservation would hold. What causes the motion of my arm are the electrical impulses and synapses of my nervous system. The parallels between our desires and our bodily movements are instances not of interaction, but of harmony.

It is important to note that Leibniz sees the pre-established harmony between mind and body as following from his general theory of substance. Since minds are substantial and bodies phenomenal, my body is in one sense just a particularly distinct perception of my mind. In this sense, one’s perception of one’s body is not qualitatively different from one’s experience of other phenomena. Taking up Leibniz’s description of monads as various “viewpoints” on the universe, perhaps we can liken the body to one’s viewfinder, one’s lens on the universe, so long as we do not take the metaphor too literally by treating the body as an independent substance.

Though Leibniz adopts the language of “well-founded phenomena” to characterize bodies, scholars have debated the extent to which Leibniz’s idealism entails phenomenalism. The debate, put one way, is whether Leibniz makes bodies so “well-founded” that they have more reality than the term phenomena suggests. There is some consensus around the idea that Leibniz does not fully reduce bodies to perceptions, à la Berkeley, since bodies are aggregates of substantially real monads. Less certain is whether the substantial reality of monads makes labeling Leibniz a phenomenalist less apt. Given Leibniz’s insistence that “there is nothing in the world but [incorporeal] simple substances and in them perception and appetite” (AG 181) and his own use of the term phenomena, it seems most likely that Leibniz did not wish to accord bodies of aggregated monads the same metaphysical status as the monads comprising them. In short, monads are substantial, bodies are phenomenal, and Leibnizian idealism entails phenomenalism.

f. Efficient and Final Causality

Leibniz’s retrieval of the notion of substantial form blossomed into his idealist, monadic metaphysics and theory of pre-established harmony. Pre-established harmony mandates that the activity of bodies be explained by other bodies, not by minds. In explaining the activities of bodies, Leibniz makes a second major effort at reconciling ancient and modern thought. He mounts a defense of the utility of final causes in physics.

Aristotle distinguished between four causes, or four ways of accounting for the being of a thing. Philosophers of the 17^th century found particularly objectionable the idea of final cause. The final cause of something indicates its purpose or goal. For instance, one might claim that the final cause of a tree is to grow upwards and reproduce. Thinkers such as Descartes, Hobbes, and Spinoza rejected the utility of final causes in explanations of the physical world, much as they rejected the utility of formal causes, or substantial forms. They restricted physics to the study of efficient causes, mechanical accounts of bodies in motion. We explain the growth of tree by looking to nutrient transfer from roots to branches, the exchange of compounds in respiration, the means of reproduction. To the moderns, any mention of tree’s purpose belongs to poetry, not physics.

Leibniz is as committed to mechanical explanation as his contemporaries, yet he bucks the 17^th century trend of discrediting final causes outright. He reconciles the two approaches by offering a doctrine of double explanation. For Leibniz, events in nature are subject to explanation by either efficient or final causes. Leibniz does not adhere strictly to the Aristotelian notion of final cause any more than he adheres to the Aristotelian notion of substantial form. What Leibniz realizes, however, is that consideration of the end state of a physical process can often have as much predictive power as consideration of the motive forces involved. In §22 of the Discourse on Metaphysics, Leibniz cites Fermat’s proof of the refraction law for light. Fermat derived the law by noting that light takes the easiest path, or the path of least resistance. In this sense, Fermat took note of the end or goal light rays achieve. By contrast, Descartes proved the same law solely by examining efficient causes, likening the refraction of light to bouncing tennis balls, and considering factors such as speed and mass. The refraction of light, Leibniz observes, can be explained and predicted under two separate causal paradigms.

Leibniz’s development of the calculus aids him greatly in his defense of final causes. Using what we would today call the variational calculus, Leibniz can show that change in nature happens at optimal points where the derivative vanishes. Systems thus tend towards certain end states and analyzing these states can furnish us with significant predictive power. Calculus permits Leibniz to tie discussions of final cause to mathematics, not poetics.

Although Leibniz finds both efficient and final causal explanations acceptable, he insists that they be kept separate. We ought not to invoke discussions of purpose simply when we lack a sufficient mechanical explanation. Final causes do not fill the gaps in our understanding of efficient causes; they provide another method of investigation entirely. Leibniz favors explanations by efficient causes, to be sure, as they open up great possibilities for engineering. Still, he considers either method a legitimate account of the world. Efficient causes, Leibniz likes to say, show us God’s power; final causes, by bringing to light the directedness and efficiency of nature, reveal God’s wisdom.

4. Theodicy

a. Leibniz’s Project

Leibniz ranks peace of mind as “the greatest cause of [his] philosophizing” (L 148). Central to Leibniz’s efforts to secure peace of mind is the thesis that we live in the best of all possible worlds, a position now commonly called Leibnizian optimism. Leibniz reasons that if we can assure ourselves that God acts in the best of all possible ways, then we can trust God’s justice and have true peace of mind. Of course, it is by no means self-evident that our world, which includes suffering and evil, is compatible with divine justice, nor is it self-evident what criteria could certify the world as “the best of all possible.” Leibniz thus devotes much argument to defending divine justice and coins the term “theodicy”—from the Greek words for God (theós) and justice (díkē)—to describe this project.

b. God

The thesis that God acts in the best of all possible ways follows from the notion of God as “an absolutely perfect being” (DM 1). Leibniz accepts Descartes’ ontological proof for the existence of God, which proves the existence of God by way of our idea of perfection, with one caveat. To Leibniz, Descartes leaves his proof open to the objection that God does not exist because God cannot exist. “An absolutely perfect being,” this objection posits, is a logical impossibility. So, Leibniz sets out to demonstrate that a single being can possess all perfections in a logically consistent manner. He bolsters the ontological proof by grounding the demonstration for God’s actuality in a demonstration of God’s possibility.

Leibniz clarifies what he means by “perfection” by stipulating that those properties incapable of a highest degree do not qualify as perfections. The “greatest of all numbers” is a contradiction, as is the “greatest of all figures,” since number and magnitude are infinitely continuous quantities. However, there is nothing inherently contradictory in “the highest degree of knowledge” or “the highest degree of power,” so omniscience and omnipotence are rightly considered divine perfections (DM 1). We can say a being possesses limitless knowledge and power without predicating meaningless, impossible attributes of God. Importantly for the purposes of an ontological proof, existence qualifies as perfection under Leibniz’s definition.

Leibniz argues for the compatibility of all perfections by further stipulating that by “perfection” he means a simple, positive quality (L 167). Once we recognize that perfections are simple qualities, Leibniz believes we easily arrive at the conclusion that there is nothing inherently contradictory in the idea of a perfect being. For, were two perfections incompatible, this fact would be evident either immediately or through an analysis of the perfections in question. In the case of perfections like knowledge and power, no immediate incompatibility presents itself. Yet, because these qualities are simple, they cannot be broken down into components which might be shown incompatible. Since the incompatibility of perfections can be shown neither in itself, nor through demonstration, Leibniz concludes that God is a logically possible being. And—following the logic of the ontological proof—if possible, God is necessary.

Leibniz does not disallow other, a posteriori proofs for God’s existence. To the contrary, he employs several such proofs in his writings. Since it turns so much on the idea of perfection, however, his defense of the ontological proof holds a special place in his theodicy and thus in his philosophy as a whole.

c. Possible Worlds and Optimism

As an absolutely perfect being, God acts in the most perfect fashion. To understand what this means for an account of creation and a defense of God’s justice, Leibniz turns to the idea of possible worlds. A possible world is any set of possible substances whose attributes are mutually consistent, or compatible, with one another. Monads whose mutual existence would not entail contradictions are said to be compossible and thus potential members of a common world. God, in his omniscience, surveys an infinite number of compossible sets of substances and chooses to create the optimal, or best possible, world

What characterizes the best possible world? By what criteria does God make his selection? In the Discourse on Metaphysics, Leibniz writes that God selects that world which most effectively balances simplicity of means with richness of effects (DM 5). He likens God to a skilled architect who best employs the space and resources available to him, or a skilled geometer who finds the most elegant solution to a problem. Simplicity of means requires that there be order, efficiency, continuity, and intelligibility in the world. Richness of effects requires the maximization of both metaphysical and moral goodness. Metaphysical goodness denotes the amount of essence or perfection in the world, in short, the extent to which various creatures in the world imitate God’s inexhaustible essence. Maximizing metaphysical goodness therefore requires, at the very least, the creation of a great variety of creatures. Moral goodness refers to the happiness of rational beings, particularly the perfection and advancement of their rational faculties.

Much scholarship is devoted to determining precisely how Leibniz sees richness and simplicity coinciding in the best possible world. The task of interpretation gains complexity from the fact that Leibniz also speaks of God optimizing beauty and harmony, and even at times suggests that the best possible world progresses continually in perfection over time. Despite the difficulties in interpretation, it is clear that at the very least rational beings must inhabit an intelligible world. The perfections of rational beings interfere with one another least and thus are maximally compossible. Rarely does the knowledge and virtue of one person prevent or disallow the knowledge and virtue of another. By contrast, the beauty of a mountain range does preclude the beauty of plains at a given space and time. Because rational beings are capable of knowing God and entering into relationship with him, they are most responsible for maximizing metaphysical and moral goodness in the world. The intelligible order of creation aids them in this by making knowledge of various phenomena accessible through simple hypotheses.

Crucially, the existence of suffering does not count as proof against our world as being the best possible. By Leibniz’s lights, the goodness of the world as a whole does not require that each aspect of the world be choice worthy in itself. Pain and suffering find their place in the best possible world as “necessary evils” in maximizing its overall goodness. Here, the question of God’s justice arises and the true importance of possible worlds for Leibniz’s theodicy comes to light. How can God will to create pain and suffering? Does creating these not compromise divine justice? Leibniz responds that the divine will desires only what is good. The divine intellect takes, as it were, this desire for the good and determines how best to actualize it. The construction of the best possible world is the work of the divine intellect, and no more a matter of God’s will than the solution to an algebra equation depends on my will. God, Leibniz asserts, antecedently wills the good and consequently wills the best. God never wills evils in themselves, and never compromises his perfection, goodness, or justice. He accepts evil and suffering only insofar as they contribute to the overall goodness of the best possible world.

The distinction between what follows from the divine will and what follows from the divine intellect ultimately provides Leibniz with a means of upholding God’s perfection, despite the imperfections of creation. Were the conditions of the optimal world determined not by the divine intellect, but rather by arbitrary fiat, God would be no more than a despot and we would have no objective standard by which to judge his actions best. Were pain and suffering objects of the divine will per se, God would be cruel and unworthy of love. In other words, Leibniz believes he safeguards divine perfection by explaining that God is neither injudicious in thought nor vicious in will in creating the world as it is. Thus, assuring ourselves of God’s goodness and perfection is vital because “one cannot love God without knowing his perfections” (T 54) and loving God provides more happiness and peace of mind than any other activity. “To love is to find pleasure in the happiness of another. We love God himself above all things because the pleasure which we experience in contemplating the most beautiful being of all is greater than any conceivable joy” (L 134).

Leibniz insists that his optimism provides grounds for true joy and peace of mind, not simply the kind of disaffected, “grin and bear it” acquiescence commonly associated with the Stoics and—as Leibniz sees it—championed by Spinoza and Descartes. God does not what he must, but what is best. Whether or not Leibniz offers any greater consolation than the Stoics is an open question. Yet Leibniz believes that even if one cannot see the purpose of suffering, one can gain some measure of joy by contemplating, and advancing in knowledge of, God’s perfection.

Furthermore, because the theory of pre-established harmony among substances requires that all monads be created or destroyed collectively, Leibniz defends the immortality of monads. What we consider “life” is an active state of perception and appetite; what we consider “death” is simply dormancy. Leibniz, not unlike other Christian thinkers before him, maintains the hope that God will compensate for evils suffered by individuals over the full course of their existence, even if the purpose of those evils is not evident during their natural lifespans.

d. Freedom and Necessity

Leibniz’s theodicy raises two weighty sets of questions regarding freedom. The first concerns God’s freedom in creating. If the divine intellect objectively determines the design of the best possible world, should we not conclude that God is determined to create just this world? Is the notion of the divine will not meaningless, compromising the theological concept of grace? The second set of questions concerns human freedom. Since each individual substance contains all that can ever be predicated of it, and since God surveys the activity and interrelations of all monads in selecting the best possible world, it would seem that the entire course of history is set before the creation of the world. Does this mean that the idea of free will—and along with it theological concepts such as sin and redemption—is meaningless?

Leibniz takes these questions seriously throughout his career. His reflections trace at least to his Confession of a Philosopher of 1672-3. Section 13 of 1686’s Discourse on Metaphysics, which explores freedom and necessity, spurs his lengthy correspondence with Antoine Arnauld. And in the Theodicy of 1710, Leibniz calls the “labyrinth of freedom and necessity” one of the most perplexing questions facing humankind.

Though far from the first thinker to confront this “labyrinth,” Leibniz’s original contribution lies in his distinction between two kinds of necessity. Truths whose contraries imply a contradiction Leibniz calls “necessary per se.” Among these truths governed by the principle of non-contradiction, Leibniz includes the laws of arithmetic, geometry, and logic. Because these truths cannot be otherwise, not even to the divine intellect, Leibniz posits that they hold in all possible worlds. He thus refers to propositions necessary per se as “eternal verities.”

Truths which are certain, but whose contrary does not imply contradiction, Leibniz terms “necessary ex hypothesi.” The sequence of events in the world is necessary in this way. It is logically possible to conceive of the world being otherwise than it is. We create fictionalized accounts of reality in novels and dramas all the time; these accounts are entirely consistent in themselves. Because events in the world can be imagined otherwise, Leibniz believes they are in themselves contingent (contingent per se). Nevertheless, events in the world necessarily happen as they do on the presumption of (ex hypothesi) God’s selection of the best possible world. While the created world could be otherwise than it is, the optimal world could not be. Truths necessary ex hypothesi are governed by the principle of sufficient reason: God has a reason, a cause for creating the world in this way, namely, his desire for the best.

Leibniz locates a second method of distinguishing truths necessary per se from truths contingent per se in their respective manners of demonstration. The truth of a claim necessary per se, Leibniz writes, can be demonstrated a priori in a finite analysis, a proof with a finite number of steps. Think of Euclid’s demonstrations of the principles of geometry. Proving the truth of a contingent proposition, by contrast, requires an infinite analysis. To explain a priori why a given proposition about the world is true, one would have to take into account its harmony with all the other substances in the world, as well as account for why this set of substances was chosen out of the infinite number of possible worlds. Explanation would literally proceed ad infinitum. This is not to say that contingent truths are unknowable. God’s infinite intellect can presumably handle an infinite analysis and we know contingent truths a posteriori through experience. Infinitude of an analysis is a formal property of certain demonstrations, one Leibniz thinks suffices to distinguish necessary ex hypothesi from necessary per se truths.

With the distinction between the two kinds of necessity, Leibniz attempts to maintain meaningful notions of both divine and human freedom. Since God has infinitely many options among possible worlds, he cannot be said to be required in creating. One might object that God’s benevolent nature constrains and determines his action by forcing God to select the best world his intellect can design. Leibniz, however, counters that acting in accord with one’s nature and for the sake of the best is true freedom. One is only determined when constrained by outside forces. That God’s own nature leads him to create the best from among possible worlds makes him all the more free and worthy of praise.

Whether Leibniz is licensed to speak of human freedom is a thornier issue. Kant, in his Critique of Practical Reason, famously scoffs that Leibniz grants human beings nothing more than “the freedom of a turnspit” which, “once it is wound up, also accomplishes its movements of itself” (I.3; 5:97). Kant reasons that Leibniz’s monads, like any good machine, simply execute what they are programmed to do. To an extent, Kant is right. Leibniz does not entertain a notion of “free will,” if by this one means arbitrary and completely undetermined choice. The principle of sufficient reason banishes arbitrary choice. Human beings act in accord with their own natures, choosing what they deem best. My individual essence provides the reason for what I do

Yet while rejecting a voluntarist conception of free will, Leibniz nevertheless speaks of human freedom. We might reconstruct Leibniz’s reasoning in three steps. First, with the modal distinction between the two kinds of necessity, Leibniz insists that human choices are not necessary in the strong sense. Each truth about monads and their history is logically contingent. Leibniz, therefore, is not a logical determinist. He is however, an ontological determinist, insofar as all events are necessary given the composition of the world. Nevertheless—and this is the second step—the fact that each substance is causally independent of all other created substances makes each monad spontaneous. Spontaneity, to reiterate, refers to the fact that each state of a created substance follows from its preceding state without the direct influence of other substances; in this sense, each substance is “free.” Still, spontaneity is not what most people mean by human freedom. Human freedom—step three—comes with the fact that rational beings can gain knowledge of the causal principles governing the sequence of events in the world. Acting with knowledge does not make one less determined, but does make one less passive. One feels less at the mercy of inalterable forces when one understands these forces and can appreciate the principles of God’s design. The idea that increased activity and knowledge make an individual free owes much more to the conception of freedom developed by the Stoics and revived in the 17^th century by Spinoza than it owes to voluntarist and Protestant conceptions of free will. As Leibniz sees it, his is the only conception of freedom compatible with divine perfection and worldly optimism.

5. Epistemology

a. Ideas and Knowledge

Leibniz’s epistemology begins with the distinction between clear and obscure ideas. An idea is clear when it allows one to recognize the thing represented, obscure when it does not. For example, one may have seen a gerbil and thus have an idea of what a gerbil is. However, if the next time she encounters a small rodent she cannot tell whether it is a gerbil or a hamster, then she possesses only an obscure idea of “gerbil.” By contrast, when one’s idea suffices to reliably distinguish one kind of object from others, then the idea is clear.

Leibniz divides clear ideas into two classes: confused and distinct. A clear idea is also distinct when one can catalogue all the marks, or criteria, distinguishing that idea from others. The animal physiologist can differentiate and enumerate those characteristics common to all rodents and those unique to gerbils. A child with a pet gerbil might not be able to do so and thus would have a clear but confused idea. Leibniz believes our sensory ideas, such as those of color, are clear and confused. Though we reliably distinguish blue from red, we cannot necessarily spell out the marks or causes which make one object blue and another red. We perceive colors without explaining them.

Leibniz proceeds to further classify clear and distinct ideas as either adequate or inadequate. If possessing an adequate idea, one has clear and distinct knowledge not only of the idea in question, but also of all its component parts. One has clear and distinct knowledge “all the way down” to the primitive concepts which compose the idea. Leibniz admits that he is unsure if any human being possesses an adequate idea, but believes our arithmetical knowledge most nearly approaches adequacy. In all other cases, where one cannot carry out comprehensive analyses down to primitive concepts, one has clear, distinct, yet inadequate ideas.

At its highest reaches, knowledge is not only adequate, but also intuitive. Intuitive knowledge is both adequate and non-discursive. That is, one clearly and distinctly knows all the ingredients of an idea and grasps these simultaneously. As is the case with all adequate knowledge, intuitive knowledge seems more suited to divine knowers than to human knowers, as the latter cannot think about all the components of a complex concept at once.

One consequence of Leibniz’s taxonomy of knowledge is that it provides Leibniz with a means of explaining sense perception. Given Leibniz’s idealism, all that exists in the world are monads and their mental states. Bodies are phenomenal and therefore not sources of knowledge. What, then, is sense perception? Is there any real difference between sensation and intellection if all ideas follow spontaneously from a monad’s own concept, with no interaction between monads? Leibniz answers such questions by noting that what we commonly experience as sense perceptions are simply confused ideas. Even if they are clear, sense perceptions are necessarily confused. Though these perceptions arise spontaneously in the perceiving subject, they express the harmony between a given monad and all others; it is therefore impossible to enumerate all the contributing factors to any given sense perception, most of which fall below the threshold of consciousness (DM 33). With the category of clear and confused ideas, Leibniz can meaningfully retain the distinction between sensation and intellection without compromising the basic tenets of his idealism.

Leibniz’s approach to ideas and knowledge separates him in some key respects from his fellow 17^th century rationalists. The division between distinctness and adequacy leads Leibniz to differentiate between nominal and real definitions. Nominal definitions include distinct knowledge; they sufficiently identify the defining marks of a concept. Yet they do not ensure that the concept is possible. It could be that a concept is internally inconsistent, a fact which would be revealed if one had adequate knowledge of all its parts. Real definitions account for the possibility of a thing, either by citing experience or through a priori demonstration. In his discussion of definition, Leibniz seeks to modify Hobbes’ strong nominalism in which all truth is dependent on the relationship between names and definitions. There is a higher level of knowledge than that contained in nominal definitions, one which accounts for possible existence in reality.

Hobbes is not Leibniz’s only rationalist target. Leibniz believes he improves upon Descartes’ maxim that all clearly and distinctly perceived ideas are true by delineating better criteria for clarity and distinctness. To Leibniz, Descartes construes clarity and distinctness as something like immediately perceived qualities, ripe for misevaluation.

b. Innate Ideas

In the New Essays on Human Understanding, Leibniz takes aim at Locke’s depiction of the mind as a tabula rasa, or blank tablet, needing external impressions to furnish it with the contents of its reasoning. In opposition to this conception of the mind and cognition, Leibniz affirms the existence of innate ideas. In one sense, Leibniz’s theory of substance obviously commits him to some conception of innate ideas. If monads have no “windows” through which they interact with other substances, then of course all their ideas must have an internal, innate origin.

But Leibniz does not rest his defense of innate ideas on his theory of substance. Rather, he advances fairly traditional epistemological arguments regarding the nature of deductive, a priori truths. Empirical knowledge can show that something is the case but cannot show that something is necessarily the case. The human mind, however, has knowledge of necessary truths, such as the laws of arithmetic and geometry. These necessary truths, which Leibniz calls “truths of reason,” are ideas whose opposite is impossible. They are the eternal truths which obtain in all possible worlds. Because truths of reason are known solely through the principle of non-contradiction and require no empirical data, Leibniz concludes that they are innate to the mind. Leibniz contrasts innate ideas with “truths of fact,” contingent truths whose opposite is possible and knowledge of which requires experience.

The theory of innate ideas does not imply that all minds have equal awareness of the truths of reason. Ideas are innate in us not as actualities, but “as inclinations, dispositions, tendencies, or natural potentialities” (NE 52). Accessing truths of reason requires effort. Yet the presence of innate ideas does incline us towards their discovery. In one particularly apt metaphor, Leibniz claims that rational minds are not like blank tablets, but like veined pieces of marble, disposed to be cut and polished in determinate ways.

c. Petites Perceptions

One of the more original elements of Leibniz’s epistemology is his theory of petites perceptions.

There are hundreds of indications leading us to conclude that at every moment there is in us an infinity of perceptions, unaccompanied by awareness or reflection; that is, of alterations in the soul itself, of which we are unaware because these impressions are either too minute and too numerous, or else too unvarying, so that they are not sufficiently distinctive on their own. But when they are combined with others they do nevertheless have their effect and make themselves felt, at least confusedly, within the whole. (NE 53)

Leibniz posits that at any given time, the mind has not only the thoughts of which it is aware, but also innumerable small, insensible perceptions, which he calls petites perceptions.

Leibniz wagers that there are “hundreds of indications” pointing to existence of petites perceptions. Regardless of whether this is hyperbole, there are at least a few good reasons Leibniz includes these perceptions in his theory. For one, petites perceptions follow from the theory of pre-established harmony, both the harmony between all substances and the harmony between mind and body. Each monad mirrors the activity of all others at all moments. This mirroring takes place via mutual representation. Since no mind, at any given moment, has conscious awareness of all other substances, mutual representation must be taking place at insensible levels via petites perceptions. Moreover, the pre-established harmony between mind and body requires that mental activity express and run parallel to bodily activity. However, one is often insensitive to one’s bodily processes. In order to maintain the perfect parallelism between body and mind, therefore, we must conclude that the mind has petites perceptions of the body’s activity.

Even more fundamentally, the existence of petites perceptions follows from Leibniz’s understanding of substance. It is of a piece with the thesis that “there is nothing in the world but simple substances and in them perception and appetite.” Activity, more specifically perception, is the mark of any substance. That the mind has petites perceptions explains how it remains active and substantial even in dreamless sleep or after death.

Petites perceptions also help to explain the workings of appetite. Appetite determines the transition from one perception to the next, a transition which oftentimes seems sudden and episodic. For instance, one might jump immediately from thinking of one’s mother to thinking of Beethoven’s fifth symphony. On its face, this transition violates the principle of continuity, which states that no discontinuous change occurs. Nature—including rational nature—makes no leaps, has no gaps. The theory of petites perceptions accounts for apparent leaps in perception. What appears a discontinuous change in thought is actually determined by the continuous workings and interactions of infinitely many insensible perceptions.

Finally, petites perceptions help to explain what is confused in a confused idea, particularly in sense perceptions. The difficulty in explaining all the marks of a sensation comes from the many petites perceptions which contribute to it. “These minute perceptions…constitute that je ne sais quoi, those flavors, those images of sensible qualities, vivid in the aggregate but confused as to the parts; those impressions which are made on us by the bodies around us and which involve the infinite; that connection each of us has with the rest of the universe” (NE 54-5).

d. Reflection, Memory, Selfhood

All substances are incorporeal and perceptive. For this reason, Leibniz understands all substances on analogy to human minds or souls. Leibniz reserves the proper use of the term “soul,” however, for higher order substances with particular cognitive capacities. Souls not only perceive, but also apperceive. That is, they not only perceive objects, but also think about and reflect on themselves. They have the added capacity to remember past perceptions. These abilities to reflect and remember provide souls with a sense of self, an understanding of the “I.” As a result, souls have moral identities. Moral identity goes beyond the substantial identity over time that all monads have; moral identity requires that one can remember his past actions, recognize himself as the selfsame individual over time, and therefore assume responsibility for his character.

Reflection and memory make souls not just moral beings, but intellectual beings as well. Leibniz observes that self-reflection serves as the starting point for all metaphysical and philosophical thinking. Each soul is, as it were, its own principal innate idea. Studying one’s own nature leads one to form and investigate fundamental metaphysical ideas. “In thinking of ourselves, we think of being, of substance, of the simple and the composite, of the immaterial, and of God himself, by conceiving that that which is limited in us is limitless in him. And these reflective acts furnish the principle objects of our reasonings” (M 30).

Because of their moral and intellectual capacities, Leibniz likens souls to “little divinities” (M 30). Leibniz expresses the near divinity of rationality rather poignantly in the Theodicy:

This portion of reason which we possess is a gift of God and consists in the natural light that has remained with us in the midst of corruption; thus it is in accordance with the whole, and it differs from that which is in God only as a drop of water differs from the ocean, or rather as the finite from the infinite. (T 169)

Though every substance reflects God and his plan for the cosmos, rational souls are mirrors of God in a heightened way, being able to understand the nature of things, reflect on God’s works, and ultimately enter into relationship with him (M 83-84).

6. Ethics

Of the traditional major content areas of philosophy, ethics is perhaps the only one to which Leibniz is generally not considered to have made significant contribution. Certainly he does not share the reputation as an ethicist enjoyed by early modern thinkers Spinoza, Hume, and Kant, nor does he share the influence in political philosophy had by Locke and Hobbes. Leibniz himself, however, took great interest in the ethical dimensions of his thought. He engaged in central debates of the day regarding the foundations of justice and the possibility of altruistic love. Furthermore, all his thinking has a clear ethical bent, with the peace of mind sought by his optimism a prime example of this. While Leibniz’s ethical contributions do not match his metaphysics in scope or originality, when it comes to a thinker as singular as Leibniz, this fact alone should not discourage inquiry into his ethics.

a. Intellect and Will

Leibniz’s approach to ethics is, broadly speaking, intellectualist in nature. That is, Leibniz sees moral goodness as increasing in line with knowledge. He defines will as “the inclination to do something in proportion to the good it contains” (T 139). Hence, the more knowledge one has of the goodness of a particular object or act, the better one’s will is directed. Loving and desiring the right kinds of things follows from proper understanding. Perfecting the intellect, in short, accomplishes the perfection of the will.

Perfecting the intellect also brings about happiness. “It is obvious,” Leibniz writes, “that the happiness of mankind consists in two things—to have the power, as far as permitted, to do what it wills and to know what, from the nature of things, ought to be willed. Of these, mankind has almost achieved the former; as to the latter, it has failed in that it is particularly impotent with respect to itself” (L130). Despite Leibniz’s dour diagnosis of humanity’s understanding of perfection, his prognosis is encouraging. He does not see happiness as particularly difficult to achieve. One need only pursue and acquire knowledge of the nature of things.

The close alliance Leibniz sees between intellect and will has the further consequence of ruling out indifference of equipoise, a topic of much debate in the 17^th century At issue in discussions of this “indifference” is the question of whether one’s will can be in complete suspension when faced with two or more options, without inclination one way or another. The purported phenomenon of indifference of equipoise was taken at the time as evidence of the will’s independence from the intellect and even of its capacity for free, uncaused choice.

Leibniz rejects indifference of equipoise on grounds of the principle of sufficient reason. Uncaused events are incomprehensible; all events, including acts of the will, have some explanation. Here the deeper significance of Leibniz’s account of the will comes to light: one’s knowledge of the goodness of things provides the reason the will chooses as it does. Still, one might ask, could not the will be in equilibrium when faced with two objects of equal goodness? No. Per the principle of the identity of indiscernibles, each substance in the world has a unique complete concept which mirrors God and creation in a unique way; no two substances, no two states of affairs, are equivalent in goodness. One’s intellect and will therefore cannot respond identically to two different options. Though we may sometimes feel completely indifferent and unable to articulate the reasons for a choice, Leibniz insists that it would be a mistake to think of the choice as uncaused or of the will as uninclined. Infinitely many petites perceptions are at work in one’s mind at all times; much like machines, our movements are the result of all the tendencies and inclinations within us, even those of which we are unaware. Thus, we should not champion arbitrary choice by citing indifference of equipoise, but rather become freer, more self-aware moral beings through progress in knowledge.

b. Justice and Charity

Leibniz sees the study of justice as an a priori science of the good. There is, that is, an objective, rational basis for justice. Though Leibniz wrote much regarding the positive laws of states, he does not see positive law as the foundation of justice. He rejects the position that justice has no firmer foundation than the fiat of those in power, a position Leibniz often mentions in conjunction with Thrasymachus from Plato’s Republic but more pointedly associates with Samuel von Pufendorf and Thomas Hobbes. Taken to its logical conclusion, this position results in divine command theory: certain principles are just simply because God, the most powerful of all legislators, has posited they be so. For Leibniz, this line of thinking violates God’s perfection. God acts in the most perfect way and thus acts with good reason, not by arbitrary fiat. He is perfect not only in power, but also in wisdom. God’s perfect will follows upon his perfect intellect no less than the will of any rational being follows upon her intellect. The a priori, eternal standard of justice to which God himself adheres provides the basis for a theory of natural law.

Leibniz defines justice as the charity of the wise person. Though this may seem unique, or even odd, to those accustomed to seeing justice and charity contrasted, what is truly original in Leibniz’s rooting justice in charity is his very definition of charity, or love. In the 17^th C., there were a series of debates regarding the possibility of disinterested love. Each creature, it would seem, acts to preserve and advance its own being. Hobbes and Spinoza employed the term conatus to refer to the striving each being has to persist in its own being and made it the foundation of their respective psychologies. On this view, one loves what one finds pleasing, that is, what one finds conducive to his own persistence. Love is reduced to a kind of egoism which, even where benevolent, nevertheless lacks an altruistic component.

Leibniz attempts to obviate the tension between egoism and altruism by defining love as taking pleasure in the happiness, or perfection, of another. With this definition, Leibniz does not deny the fundamental drive all creatures have for pleasure and self-interest, but ties it to altruistic concern for the well-being of others. The coincidence of altruism and self-interest defines love and captures the essence of justice. Justice is the charity of the wise person and the wise person, Leibniz goes on to say, loves all. Leibniz’s basic contention is that to be just is to show the love attended by insight that God shows. Ethics involves seeking the good of all in a prudent way, such that the good of each individual is pursued only insofar as it is compatible with the whole. One cannot love all when obtaining the happiness of one person at the expense of another’s, nor would this be desirable, since Leibniz believes we find more pleasure in harmony than discord. The kind of universal love demanded by Leibniz’s definition of justice is nurtured by reflection on the universal harmony between all things. Leibniz believes that appreciating the harmonious order of the cosmos can lead individuals to find pleasure in increasing the perfection and happiness of all who share in that order.

Leibniz’s definition of love also entails that loving God is the highest end of rational beings. If love is finding pleasure in the perfection of another, then loving an infinitely perfect being affords the greatest possible pleasure and happiness.

To love is to find pleasure in the happiness of another. We love God himself above all things because the pleasure which we experience in contemplating the most beautiful being of all is greater than any conceivable joy. (L 134)

Since the harmony of the world mirrors God’s perfection, Leibniz’s conception of justice does not place love of God at odds with love of others. We should take pleasure in perfection wherever we discern it. Justice as the charity of the wise person means that love of God and love of neighbor are one. By identifying justice with love of God and harmony between all, Leibniz brings to fruition the ethical implications of his metaphysical inquiries into God’s perfection and pre-established harmony. Ethics and metaphysics are, for Leibniz, never far apart.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources: Leibniz Texts and Translations

The standard critical edition of Leibniz’s writings is G.W. Leibniz: Sämtliche Schriften und Briefe, edited by the Deutsche Akademie der Wissenschaften (Berlin: Academy Verlag, 1923- ). The Akademie edition is still in production. Other useful editions of Leibniz’s writings in their original languages are those of C. I. Gerhardt (Die Philosophischen Schriften von Leibniz. 7 vols. 1875-1890) and Ludovici Dutens (Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz: Opera Omnia. Hildesheim: Georg Olms Verlag, 1989).

References in this article to Leibniz’s works use the following abbreviations and translations:

AG G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Essays. Edited and translated by Roger Ariew and Daniel Garber. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1989.

DM Discourse on Metaphysics, as translated by Ariew and Garber in G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Essays. Passages from the Discourse are cited by section number.

G Die Philosophischen Schriften von Leibniz. Edited by C.I. Gerhardt. Berlin. 7 vols. 1875-1890.

L G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Papers and Letters. Edited and translated by Leroy E. Loemker. 2nd ed. Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1989.

LA The Leibniz-Arnauld Correspondence. Edited by H.T. Mason. Manchester: Manchester University Press, 1967.

M Monadology, as translated by Ariew and Garber in G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Essays. Passages from the Monadology are cited by section number.

NE New Essays on Human Understanding. Edited by Peter Remnant and Jonathan Bennett. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.

T Theodicy: Essays on the Goodness of God, the Freedom of Man, and the Problem of Evil. Translated by E.M. Huggard. BiblioBazaar, 2007.

Other helpful collections of Leibniz’s writings in English include:

The Leibniz-Clarke Correspondence. Edited by H.G. Alexander. New York: Philosophical Library, 1956.
The Labyrinth of the Continuum: Writings on the Continuum Problem, 1672-1686. Edited by Richard W. T. Arthur. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2002.
The Leibniz-Des Bosses Correspondence. Edited by Brandon C. Look and Donald Rutherford. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2007.
Leibniz: Logical Papers. Edited by G.H.R. Parkinson. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1966.
De Summa Rerum: Metaphysical Papers, 1675-1676. Edited by G.H.R. Parkinson. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1992.
Leibniz: Political Writings. Edited by Patrick Riley. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1988.
Confessio Philosophi: Papers Concerning the Problem of Evil, 1671-1678. Edited by Robert C. Sleigh, Jr. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2005.
Leibniz and the Two Sophies: The Philosophical Correspondence. Edited by Lloyd Strickland. Toronto: Iter, Inc., 2011.
Leibniz’s ‘New System’ and Associated Contemporary Texts. Edited by R.S. Woolhouse and Richard Francks. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1997.

b. Secondary Sources

i. Introductory Texts

Antognazza, Maria Rosa. Leibniz: An Intellectual Biography. New York: Cambridge University Press, 2009.
Arthur, Richard T.W. Leibniz. Cambridge: Polity Press, 2014.
Jolley, Nicholas. Leibniz. New York: Routledge, 2005.
Perkins, Franklin. Leibniz: A Guide for the Perplexed. New York: Continuum, 2007.
Savile, Anthony. Routledge Guidebook to Leibniz and the Monadology.New York: Routledge, 2000.

ii. More Advanced Studies

Adams, Robert Merrihew. Leibniz: Determinist, Theist, Idealist. New York: Oxford University Press, 1994.
Garber, Daniel. Leibniz: Body, Substance, Monad. New York: Oxford University Press, 2009.
Ishiguro, Hidé. Leibniz’s Philosophy of Logic and Language. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1975.
Mercer, Christia. Leibniz’s Metaphysics: Its Origins and Development. New York: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
Parkinson, G.H.R. Logic and Reality in Leibniz’s Metaphysics. Cambridge: Oxford University Press, 1965.
Rescher. Nicholas. Leibniz’s Metaphysics of Nature. Dordrecht: Reidel, 1981.
Riley, Patrick. Leibniz’s Universal Jurisprudence: Justice as the Charity of the Wise. Harvard University Press, 1996.
Rutherford, Donald. Leibniz and the Rational Order of Nature. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
Sleigh, Robert C. Leibniz and Arnauld: A Commentary on their Correspondence. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1990.
Smith, Justin E.H. Divine Machines: Leibniz and the Sciences of Life. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2011.
Strickland, Lloyd. Leibniz Reinterpreted. London: Continuum, 2006.
Wilson, Catherine. Leibniz’s Metaphysics: A Historical and Comparative Study. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1989.

iii. Collected Essays

Brown, Stuart, ed. The Young Leibniz and his Philosophy (1646-76). Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1999.
Jorgensen and Newlands, eds. New Essays on Leibniz’s Theodicy. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2014.
Jolley, Nicholas, ed. The Cambridge Companion to Leibniz. edited by Nicholas Jolley. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
Rutherford and Cover, eds. Leibniz: Nature and Freedom. New York: Oxford University Press, 2005.

Author Information

Edward W. Glowienka
Email: eglowienka@carroll.edu
Carroll College
U. S. A.

Resource Bounded Agents

Resource bounded agents are persons who have information processing limitations. All persons and other cognitive agents who have bodies are such that their sensory transducers (such as their eyes and ears) have limited resolution and discriminatory ability; their information processing speed and power is bounded by some threshold; and their memory and recall is imperfect in some way. While these general facts are not controversial, it is controversial whether and to what degree these facts should shape philosophical theorizing.

Arguably, resource bounded agents pose the most serious philosophical challenges to normative theories in a number of domains, and especially to theories of rationality and moral action. If a normative theory endorses a standard for how an agent ought act or think, or if a normative theory aims to provide recommendations for various kinds of conduct, such a theory will have commitments regarding the descriptive facts about the agent’s cognitive limitations. There are two major responses. These theories may either (1) argue to dismiss these descriptive facts as irrelevant to the normative enterprise (see section 2) or, instead, (2) attempt to accommodate these facts in some way (see section 3). Historically, normative theories that have attempted to accommodate facts about cognitive limitations have done so by either (i) augmenting the proposed normative standard, or (ii) using facts about cognitive limitations to show that agents cannot meet the proposed normative standard.

After a brief discussion of some empirical work addressing human cognitive limitations, this article will discuss idealization in philosophy and the status of the normative bridge principle “ought implies can,” which suggests that “oughts” are constrained by descriptive limitations of the agent. Next, the article explores several theories of rationality that have attempted to accommodate facts about cognitive limitations.

As an introductory and motivating example, consider the claim that human agents ought not to believe inconsistent propositions. Initially, such a claim seems perfectly reasonable. Perhaps this is because a collection of inconsistent propositions is guaranteed to include at least one false proposition. But Christopher Cherniak (1986) has pointed out that when one has as few as 140 (logically independent) beliefs, there are approximately 1.4 tredecillion (a number with 43 digits) pairs of beliefs to check for potential inconsistency. No human could ever check that many items for consistency. In fact, an ultra-fast supercomputer would take 20 billion years to complete such a task. Hence, for some epistemologists, the empirical fact of the impossibility of a complete consistency-check of a human’s belief corpus has provided reason for thinking that complete consistency of belief is not an appropriate normative standard. Whether such a response is ultimately correct, however, concerns the status of resource bounded agents in normative theorizing.

Cognitive Limitations and Resource Bounds
Idealization
Accommodating Cognitive Limitations
1. Changing the Normative Standard
2. Failing to Meet the Standard
  1. Kahneman and Tversky’s “Heuristics and Biases” Program
References and Further Reading
1. References
2. Further Reading

1. Cognitive Limitations and Resource Bounds

Every known cognitive agent has resource and cognitive limitations. Christopher Cherniak refers to this necessary condition as the “finitary predicament”: because agents are embodied, localized, and operate in physical environments, they necessarily face informational limitations. While philosophers have acknowledged this general fact, the precise details of these resource and cognitive limitations are not widely discussed, and the precise details could matter to normative theorizing. Revisiting the example from above, it is obvious that humans cannot check 1.4 tredecillion pairs of beliefs for consistency. But it is not obvious how many beliefs a human agent can check. If it could be experimentally demonstrated that humans could not occurrently check twelve beliefs for consistency, even this minimal consistency check might not be rationally required. Hence, the precise details of cognitive limitations need to be addressed.

Before turning to the details of cognitive limitations, it is important to note that there are two senses of the term ‘limitation’. To see the distinction, consider a simple example. Very young children are limited in their running abilities. This limitation can be described in two ways: (i) young children cannot run a mile in under four minutes, and (ii) young children are not excellent runners. The important difference in these (true) descriptions is that way (i) uses non-normative language and way (ii) uses normative language. This distinction is crucial when the main objective is an evaluation of the normative standard itself. For instance, challenging whether (i) is true involves non-normative considerations while challenging whether (ii) is true fundamentally involves normative considerations. As such, the kinds of cognitive limitation under discussion in this article will primarily concern non-normative limitations.

In what follows, this article will survey some findings from cognitive psychology to illustrate various attempts to measure human cognitive limitations. These findings are not exhaustive and should be thought of as representative examples.

a. Limitations of Memory

Memory is the general process of retaining, accessing, and using stored information. Short-term memory is the process of storing small amounts of information for short periods of time. In 1956 George Miller published a paper that helped measure the limitations of human short-term memory. This paper was an early example of the field that would later be known as cognitive psychology. In “The Magical Number Seven, Plus or Minus Two”, Miller argued that short-term memory is limited to approximately seven items (plus or minus two). That is, Miller argued that for typical adult humans, short-term memory is bounded by about nine items. Later work such as Cowan (2001) has suggested that the capacity of short-term memory might be smaller than previously thought, perhaps as small as four items.

In some ways, Miller’s result should be puzzling. Humans are often able to recite long sentences immediately after reading them, so how would this ability square with Miller’s experimental results? Miller also introduced the idea of “chunking” in his famous 1956 paper. To “chunk” items is to group them together as a unit (often by a measure of similarity or meaningfulness). This is an information compression strategy. For example, suppose the task is to remember the following eight words: catching, dog, apples, city, red, frisbees, park, yellow. Likely, this would be somewhat difficult. Instead, suppose the task was to remember the four phrases: yellow dog, red apples, catching frisbees, city park. This should be less difficult, even though the task still involves eight words. The explanation is that the eight items have been “chunked” down to four informational items (to be “uncompressed” later when needed). Yet, the existence of chunking strategies does not mean that short-term memory is unbounded. Typical humans cannot remember more than seven (plus or minus two) chunks, nor is it the case that just any string of information can be chunked. For many subjects, it would be exceedingly difficult to chunk the following eight strings of letters: rucw, mxzq, exef, cfiw, uhss, xohj, mnwf, ofhn.

Long-term memory is the process of storing information for long periods of time. Long-term memory also features kinds of limitation. It may be tempting to think that stored memories are like photographs or video, which may be retrieved and then reviewed as an unaltered representation of an event. But this is not how human memory works. Psychologists have known for a long time that many aspects of memory are “constructive”. That is, factors such as expectation, experience, and background knowledge can alter memories. Humans are prone to omit details of events and even add details that never occurred. Consider the classic example of Bartlett’s “War of the Ghosts” experiment. In 1932 Fredrick Bartlett read British subjects a story from aboriginal Canadian folklore. He then asked the subjects to recall the story as accurately as they were able. This established a baseline of subject performance. Next, Bartlett used the experimental technique of “repeated reproduction” and had subjects retell the story after longer and longer periods of time. Bartlett found that as more time passed, subjects’ retelling of the story became shorter and more and more details were omitted. As well, many subjects added details to the story that reflected their own culture, rather than the cultural setting of the story. As one example, instead of recalling the canoes that were mentioned in the story, many subjects retold the story as concerning boats, which would be more familiar to a British participant.

It has also been demonstrated that for some kinds of information, retrieving an item from memory can reduce the likelihood of successfully retrieving a competing or related item. As a simple example, trying to remember where one last put one’s keys would be much more difficult if competing memories such as where one put the keys two days ago or three days ago were just as likely to be recalled. Instead, it appears as though there is an inhibitory mechanism that suppresses the recall of competing memories (in this case, the older “key location” memory). While potentially beneficial in some respects, this “retrieval-induced forgetting” effect might be harmful in some academic settings. Macrae and MacLeod (1999) gave subjects 20 “facts” about a fictional island. Next, subjects were evenly divided into two groups: group one practiced memorizing only a select 10 of the 20 facts and group two did not practice memorizing any of the 20 facts. Unsurprisingly, group one had better recall than group two on the select 10 facts. But, interestingly, group two had better recall than group one on the other 10 facts. That is, by attempting to memorize some subset of the 20 facts, group one had impoverished recall in the unpracticed subset of facts. This result might have implications for students that attempt to cram for an exam: in cramming for an exam, students may reduce their performance on unstudied material.

In addition to the above limitations, humans also suffer from age related performance decreases in memory. Humans also typically have difficulty in remembering the source of their information (that is, how they initially learned the information). Further, misinformation and suggestion can alter subjects’ memories and even create “false memories”. Eyewitness reports of a crime scene may omit relevant information when a gun is present (known as “weapon focus”), due to the narrow attentional focus on the gun. As well, subtle feedback to an eyewitness report (for example, a police officer says “thanks for helping identify the perpetrator”) can strengthen the eyewitness’ feeling of confidence, but not their reliability.

b. Limitations of Visual Perception

Humans are able to visually detect wavelengths between roughly 400 and 700 nanometers, corresponding to colors from violet to red. Hence, unaided human vision cannot detect much of the information in the electromagnetic spectrum, including infrared and ultraviolet radiation. Under ideal conditions, humans can discriminate between wavelengths in the visible spectrum that differ by only a few nanometers.

It is a mistake to think that, for humans, the entire visual field is uniformly detailed. This is surprising, because it seems (phenomenologically, at least) that most of the visual field is detail rich. Recall the experience of studying the brushstrokes of an artwork at approximately five feet of distance. The uncritical experience suggests that vision always provides highly detailed information—perhaps this is because everywhere one looks there appears to be detail. Yet, there is a sense in which this is an illusion. In the human eye, the fovea is responsible for providing highly detailed information, but the fovea is only a small part of the retina. Eye movements, called saccades, change the location of foveal vision to areas of interest, so details can be extracted where they are wanted. Much of the visual field in humans does not provide detail rich information, and might be described in lay terms as being similar to “peripheral vision”. This non-foveal part of the visual field has limited acuity and results in impoverished perceptual discriminatory ability.

Just as it is incorrect to think that memory works like a photograph, human color vision does not simply provide the color of an object in the way a “color picker” does in a image editing computer program. The color an object appears is often highly sensitive to the amount of light in the environment. Color judgments in humans can be highly unreliable in low light environments, such as when distinguishing green from purple. Human vision is also subject to color constancy in some circumstances. Color constancy occurs when objects appear to stay the same color despite changing conditions of illumination (which change the wavelengths of light that are reflected) or because of their proximity to other objects. For instance, the green leaves of a tree may appear to stay the same color as the sun is setting. Color constancy may be helpful for the tracking or re-identification of an object through changing conditions of illumination, but it may also increase the unreliability of color judgments.

c. Limitations of Attentional Resources

Attention is the capacity to focus on a specific object, stimulus, or location. Many occurrent cognitive processes require attentional resources. Lavie (1995, 2005) has proposed a model that helps explain the relationship between the difficulty of various tasks and the ability to successfully deploy attentional resources. Lavie’s idea is that total cognitive resources are finite, and difficult cognitive tasks take up more of these resources. A direct implication is that comparatively easier tasks allow for available cognitive resources to process “task-irrelevant” information. Processing task-irrelevant information can be distracting and even reduce task performance. For an example of this phenomenon, consider the difference between taking an important final exam and casually reading at a coffee shop. Applying Lavie’s model, taking an important final exam will often use all of one’s cognitive resources, and hence, no task-irrelevant information (such as the shuffling of papers in the room or the occasional cough) will be processed. In this particular instance, the task-irrelevant stimuli cannot be distracting. In contrast, causally reading at a coffee shop typically is not a “high-load” task and does not require most of a subject’s cognitive resources. While reading casually one can still overhear a neighboring conversation or the sound of the espresso machine, sometimes hindering the ability to concentrate on one’s book.

As an example of competition from task-irrelevant stimuli, consider the well-known Stroop effect. First conducted by J.R. Stroop in 1935, the task is to name as quickly as possible the color of ink used to print a series of words. For words such as ‘dog’, ‘chair’ and ‘house’, each printed in a different color, the task is relatively easy. But Stroop had subjects read words such as ‘green’, ‘blue’, and ‘red’ printed in non-representative colors (so ‘red’ might be printed in blue ink). This version of the task is much more challenging, often taking twice as much time as the version without color words. One explanation of this result is that the task-irrelevant information of the color word is difficult to ignore, perhaps because linguistic processing of words is often automatic.

Attentional resources are also deployed in tracking objects in the environment. Object-based attention concerns representing and tracking objects. Xu et al. (2009) report that due to limits on processing resources, the visual system is able to individuate and track about four objects. Sears and Pylyshyn (2000) also cite limits on the capacity to process visual information and have shown that subjects are able to track about five identical objects in a field of ten objects.

2. Idealization

This section will discuss one dismissive response to problems posed by resource bounded agents. The basic idea behind this response is that descriptive facts about cognitive limitations are irrelevant to the normative enterprise.

a. Idealization Strategies

In drafting various normative theories (concerning, for example, rational belief or moral action), some philosophers have claimed to be characterizing “ideal” agents, rather than “real” or “non-ideal” agents like humans (where real or non-ideal agents are those agents that have cognitive limitations). This strategy can be defended on a number of lines, but one defense appeals to theory construction in the physical sciences. In drafting physical theories it is often helpful to first begin with theoretically simple constraints and add in complicating factors later. For instance, many introductory models about forces omit mention of complicating factors such as friction, air resistance, and gravity. Likewise, a philosopher might claim that the proper initial subject of normative theorizing is the ideal agent. As such, descriptive details of the cognitive limitations of non-ideal agents are simply not relevant to initial theorizing about normative standards, because ideal agents do not have cognitive limitations. Yet, the thought is, theories of ideal agents might still be useful for evaluating non-ideal agents. Continuing with the analogy with scientific models, the proposed strategy would be to first determine the normative standard for ideal agents, and then evaluate non-ideal human agents as attempting to approximate this standard.

As one example of this strategy, return to the issue of believing inconsistent propositions. Because ideal agents do not have memory or computational limitations, these agents are able to check any number of beliefs for inconsistency. It then seems that these agents ought not to believe inconsistent propositions. Perhaps the reason for this is that one ought not to believe false propositions, and a set of inconsistent propositions is guaranteed to have at least one false member. This result might serve as one dimension of the normative standard. Now, turning attention to resource bounded agents such as humans, it might be thought that these agents ought to try to approximate this standard, however imperfectly. That is, the best reasoners imaginable will not believe inconsistent propositions, so humans ought to try to approximate the attitudes or behaviors of these reasoners. On this view, better human reasoners believe fewer inconsistent propositions.

A second defense of the idealization strategy appeals directly to the kinds of concepts addressed by normative theories. Many normative concepts appear to admit of degrees. It might be thought that there can be better and worse moral decisions and better and worse epistemic attitudes (given a collection of evidence). If this is correct then, plausibly, ideal agents might be thought to be the best kind of agent and correspondingly the proper subject for normative theorizing. Consider the following example. Suppose a person witnesses an unsupervised child fall off a pier into a lake. In a real case, the human observer might feel paralyzing stress or anxiety about the proper response and thus momentarily postpone helping the child. Such a response may seem less than optimal—it would be better if the agent responded immediately. Considering these optimal responses might necessarily involve imagining ideal agents, because (plausibly) every real agent will have some amount of stress or anxiety. Because ideal agents do not have psychological limitations, an ideal agent would not become paralyzed by stress or anxiety and would respond immediately to the crisis. In this regard, after abstracting away from complicating factors arising from human psychology, ideal agents might help reveal better moral responses.

As briefly mentioned above, idealization strategies often offer a bridge principle, linking the proposed normative standard to real human action and judgment. Of course, human agents are not ideal agents, so how do ideal normative standards apply to real human agents? One common answer is that human agents ought to try to approximate the ideal standards, and better agents more closely approximate these standards. For instance, it is clear that no human agent could achieve a pairwise check of all of their beliefs for logical consistency. But it still might be the case that better agents check more of their beliefs for consistency. Plausibly, young children check few of their beliefs for consistency whereas reflective adults are careful to survey more of the claims they endorse for consistency and coherence. On this measure it is not obviously unreasonable to judge the reflective adult as more rational than the young child.

b. Problems with the Idealization Strategy

One potential problem with the idealization strategy is the threat of incoherence. If every cognitive agent is physically embodied, then every cognitive agent will face some kinds of resource limitation. Hence, it is unclear that ideal agents are either physically possible or even conceivable. What kind of agents are ideal cognizers anyway? Do ideal cognizers even reason or make inferences, given the immediate availability of their information? Should we really think of them as reasoners or agents at all? Ideal cognizers are certainly unlike any cognitive agent with which we’ve ever had any experience. As such, the thought is that little weight should be placed on claims such as “ideal agents are able to check any number of beliefs for inconsistency”, because it is not clear such agents are understandable.

An idealization theorist might respond by leaning on the analogy with model construction in the physical sciences. Introductory models of forces that omit friction, say, may describe or represent physically impossible scenarios but these models nonetheless help reveal actual structural relationships between force, mass, and acceleration (for instance). Perhaps, so too for normative theorizing about ideal agents.

A second potential problem with the idealization strategy concerns possible disanalogies between theorizing in philosophy and the physical sciences. Introductory models of forces in the physical sciences do not yield ultimate conclusions. That is, the general relationship between force and mass that is established in idealized models is later refined and improved upon with the addition of realistic assumptions. These updated models are thought to be superior, at least with respect to accuracy. In contrast, however, many philosophers who claim to be theorizing about ideal agents take their results to be either final or ultimate. As previously mentioned, some epistemologists take belief consistency to be a normative ideal, and adding realistic assumptions to the model does not produce normatively better results. If such a stance is taken, then this weakens the analogy with theory construction in the physical sciences.

A third potential problem with the idealization strategy is that it is not clear that there are unique ideal agents or even unique idealized normative standards. Why should we think that there is one unique ideally rational agent or one unique ideally moral agent, rather than a continuum of better agents (perhaps just as there is no possible fastest ideal marathon runner)? The worry is clear in this respect: if there are only better and better agents (with no terminally best agent) then the study of any particular idealized agent cannot yield ultimate normative standards. It is also not clear that there are always unique idealized normative standards. For instance, it is often assumed that there are optimal decisions or optimal plans for ideal agents to choose. Yet, John Pollock (2006) has argued that there is “no way to define optimality so that it is reasonable to expect there to be optimal plans”. The consequence of this result, if it can be maintained, is that there is no unique optimal plan or set of plans that an ideal agent could choose. Hence, an idealization strategy, one that abstracts away from time and resource constraints on the agent, could not represent ideal plans. It is more controversial as to whether there are optimal belief states that ideal reasoners would converge to, given unbounded time and unbounded cognitive resources.

c. Ought Implies Can

A fourth potential problem with the idealization strategy concerns the well-known and controversial “ought implies can” principle. If true, this principle states that the abilities of the agent constrain normative demands or requirements on the agent. Consider an example from the moral domain. Suppose that, after an accident, a ten ton truck has pinned Abe to the ground and is causing him great harm. Ought a fellow onlooker, Beth, lift the truck and free Abe? Many would claim that because Beth is unable to lift the truck, she has no duty or obligation to lift the truck. In other words, it might seem reasonable to think that Beth must be able to lift the truck for it to be true that she ought to lift the truck. There may well be other things that Beth ought to do in this situation (perhaps make a phone call or comfort Abe), but the idea is that these are all things that Beth could possibly do.

If “ought implies can” principles are true in various normative domains such as ethics or epistemology, then the corresponding idealization strategy would face the following problem. Idealization strategies, by definition, abstract away from the actual abilities of agents (including facts about memory, reasoning, perception, and so forth). Hence, these strategies will not produce normative conclusions that are sensitive to the actual abilities of agents, as “ought implies can” principles require. Hence, idealization strategies are defective.

Said differently, “ought implies can” principles suggest that descriptive facts matter to normative theorizing. As Paul Thagard (1982) has said, epistemic principles “should not demand of a reasoner inferential performance which exceeds the general psychological abilities of human beings”. Of course, idealization strategies necessarily disagree with this claim. If “ought implies can” principles are true then we have reason to reject idealization strategies.

Are “ought implies can” principles true? Intuitively, the Abe and Beth case above seems plausible and reasonable. This provides prima facie evidence that there is something correct about a corresponding moral “ought implies can” principle in the moral domain. However, in epistemology, there are reasons to think that “epistemic oughts” do not always imply “epistemic cans”.

In defending evidentialism, Richard Feldman and Earl Conee (1985) have argued that cognitive limits do not always constrain theories of epistemic justification. As they say, “some standards are met only by going beyond normal human limits”. Feldman and Conee give three examples. The first concerns a human agent whose doxastic attitude a best fits her evidence e, but forming a is beyond the agent’s “normal cognitive limits”. To fill in the details, suppose that the doxastic attitude that best fits Belinda’s evidence is believing that her son is guilty of the crime, but also suppose that Belinda is psychologically unable to appropriately assess her evidence (given its disturbing content). Feldman and Conee think that the intuitive response to such a case would be to think that (believing in guilt) “would still be the attitude justified by the person’s evidence”, even though in this case Belinda faces the impossible task of assessing her evidence. Indeed, it seems that this is a standard response one might have toward family members of guilty defendants: given the evidence, they ought to believe that their loved one is guilty, despite its impossibility. If such a response is correct, then “ought implies can” principles are not always true in epistemic domains.

The second and third examples Feldman and Conee give are the following:

Standards that some teachers set for an “A” in a course are unattainable for most students. There are standards of artistic excellence that no one can meet, or at least standards that normal people cannot meet in any available circumstance.

These latter examples are surely weaker than the first. It would be completely unreasonable for a teacher to adopt a standard for an “A” that was impossible for any student to satisfy (“to get an “A” a student must show that 0 = 1″). However, part of the difficulty here is that the relevant notion of “can” is either vague or ambiguous. Does “can” mean some students could satisfy the standard some times? Or does “can” mean that at least one student could satisfy the standard once? It would not be unreasonable for a teacher to adopt a standard for an “A” that one particular class of students could not attain. The art example is even more difficult. First, the art example is unlike the Abe pinned under the truck example. In that case it was physically impossible for Beth to lift the truck. The art example, however, contains a standard that “normal people cannot meet in any available circumstance”, with the implication that some humans can meet the standard. The difference between these examples is that one is indexed to Beth’s abilities and the other is indexed to human artistic abilities, generally. The worry is that some standards might be “community standards” and hence the relevant counterexample would be a case where no one in the community could meet the standard. Indeed, it would be an odd artistic standard such that no possible human could ever satisfy it.

Lastly, it is unclear whether Feldman and Conee’s remarks can be generalized to other normative domains. Even if Feldman and Conee are correct in thinking that various “epistemic oughts” do not imply “epistemic cans”, it is not obvious whether similar considerations hold in the domain of morality or rational action.

3. Accommodating Cognitive Limitations

The second major kind of response to resource bounded agents is to accommodate the descriptive facts of cognitive limitations into one’s normative theory. Proponents of this response claim that facts about cognitive limitations matter for normative theories. To continue with the example of believing inconsistent propositions, a theorist that adopted a version of this response might attempt to argue that resource bounded agents ought not to believe “feasibly reached” or, instead, “obvious” inconsistent propositions. This response would accommodate facts about cognitive limitations by relaxing the standard “never believe any set of inconsistent propositions”.

There are two ways in which one might attempt to accommodate cognitive limitations into one’s normative theorizing. First, similar to the above example, one might “change the normative standard” and argue that resource bounded agents show that normative standards should be relaxed in some way. Versions of this response will be discussed in section 3a. Second, one might instead argue that cognitive limitations show that the agents being investigated cannot meet the proposed normative standard, and hence, are inherently defective in some dimension. This response will be discussed in section 3b.

a. Changing the Normative Standard

In this subsection, the article discusses several prominent views that accommodate descriptive facts about cognitive limitations by augmenting or changing normative standards.

i. Simon’s “Satisficing View” of Decision Making

One way to accommodate the cognitive limitations that agents face is to relax the traditional normative standards. In the domain of rational decision making, Herbert Simon (1955, 1956) replaced the traditional “optimization” view of the rationality of action with the more relaxed “satisficing” view. To illustrate the difference between optimization procedures and satisficing procedures, consider the well-known “apartment finding problem”. Presumably, when searching for an apartment one values several attributes (perhaps cost, size, distance from work, quiet neighborhood, and so forth). How ought one choose? The optimization procedure recommends maximizing some measure. For example, one way to proceed would be to list every available apartment, assess each apartment’s total subjective value under the various attributes, determine the likelihoods of obtaining each apartment, and then calculate this “weighted average” and choose the apartment that optimizes or maximizes this measure. Simon noticed that such an optimization procedure is typically not feasible for humans: it is too computationally demanding. For one, the complete information about apartment availability or even complete information about apartment attributes is often unavailable. Secondly, the relevant probabilities are crucial to an optimization strategy, but these probabilities are too cognitively demanding for typical human agents. For example, what is the probability that apartment B will still be available if the initial offer for apartment A gets rejected? How would one calculate this probability? Instead, Simon suggests that humans ought to make decisions by “satisficing”, or deciding to act when some threshold representing a “good enough”, but not necessarily best or optimal, outcome is achieved. To satisfice in the apartment finding problem, one determines some appropriate threshold or aspiration level of acceptability (representing “good enough”), and then one searches for an apartment until this threshold is reached. A satisficer picks the first apartment that surpasses this threshold.

It is important to note that, under a common interpretation, Simon is not recommending the satisficing procedure as a next best alternative to the optimization procedure. Instead, Simon is suggesting that the satisficing procedure is the standard by which to judge rational action. Correspondingly, human agents who do not optimize in the sense described above are not normatively defective qua rational decision maker.

One claimed advantage of satisficing over optimization concerns computational costs. A satisficing strategy is thought to be less computationally intensive than an optimization strategy. Optimization strategies require the computation of “expected values” based on a network of probabilities and subjective values, and also the computational resources to store and compare these values. Satisficing strategies, by contrast, only require that an agent is able to compare a possible choice with a threshold value, and there is no need to store past assessments (other than the fact that a past choice was assessed). A second advantage of satisficing is that it seems to come close to describing how humans actually solve many decision problems and, as well, appears to be predictively successful. For better or worse, humans do seem to pick apartments, cars, perhaps even mates that are “good enough” rather than optimal (and note that someone like Simon would say this is “for the better”).

Two criticisms of satisficing concern its stability over time and the setting of satisficing thresholds or aspiration levels. A benefit of the optimization procedure is that an agent can be confident that her decision is the best in a robust sense—in comparison with any other alternative, the optimal option will be superior to this alternative. However, if one picks option a under a satisficing procedure, one cannot be confident that option a will be superior to any other future alternative option b. In fact, one cannot be confident that the next alternative option is not better than the current option. This is potentially problematic in the following sense. If one sets one’s satisficing threshold too low, one may quickly find a choice that surpasses this threshold, but is nonetheless unacceptable in a more robust sense. For example, buying the first car one sees on the sales lot is often not recommended, however easy this strategy is to follow. In this example the threshold for “good enough” is clearly too low. This leads to the second broad criticism. When factoring in the calculation needed to determine how low or high to set the satisficing threshold, it is not obvious whether satisficing procedures retain their computational advantage. As previously mentioned, a satisficing threshold that recommends buying the first car one sees on the sales lot is too low. But what threshold should count as representing a “good enough” car? In most cases this is a difficult question. Intuitively, a “good enough” car is one that has some or many desirable features. But is this a probabilistic measure—must these desirable features be known to obtain with the choice selection or are they merely judged to be probable? Further, how does one compute the relationship between some particular feature of the car and its desirability? The worry is that setting appropriate satisficing thresholds is as difficult as optimizing. Serious concern with these kinds of issues puts pressure on the claim that satisficing procedures have clear computational advantages.

ii. Pollock’s “Locally Global” View of Planning

John Pollock is also critical of optimization strategies for theories of rational decision making, for reasons concerning cognitive limitations. However, rather than focus on the rationality of individual decision problems (such as the apartment finding problem or the car buying problem mentioned above), Pollock’s view concerns rational planning. To see the difference between individual decision problems and planning problems, consider the following example. In deciding what to do with one’s afternoon, one might decide to go to the bank and go to the grocery store. By deciding, one has solved an individual decision problem. However, there are two important issues that are still unresolved for the decision: (1) how to implement the decisions “go to the bank” and “go to the grocery store” (go by car or by bus or walk?) and (2) how to structure the order of individual decisions (go to the bank first, then go to the grocery store second?). Planning generally concerns the implementation and ordering issues illustrated in both (1) and (2). When agents engage in planning they attempt to determine what things to do, how to do them, and how to order them.

Planning is often regarded as more broad than the field of “decision theory”, which typically focuses on the rationality of individual actions. Research in artificial intelligence concerning action almost exclusively focuses on planning. One reason for this focus is that many AI researches want to build agents that operate in the world, and operating in the world requires more than just deciding whether to perform some particular action. As illustrated above, there are often many ways to perform the same action (one may “go to the bank” by traveling by car or by boat or by jet pack). As well, actions are performed in temporal sequence with other actions, some of which potentially conflict (for example, if the bank closes at 4pm, then it is impossible to go to the bank after one goes to the grocery store).

Now, how ought rational agents to plan? One suggestion is that rational agents choose optimal plans, in a way similar to the optimization procedure mentioned in section 3ai above. An optimal plan is a plan that maximizes some measure (such as expected utility, for example). A simple version of a plan-based optimization procedure might include the following: (i) survey all possible plans and (ii) choose the plan that maximizes expected utility. Many of the claimed virtues for the optimization procedure of individual decisions discussed in section 3ai above also count as virtues of the plan-based optimization procedure.

John Pollock has argued that real, non-ideal agents ought not use plan-based optimization procedures. Part of his argument shares reasons given by Herbert Simon: resource bounded agents such as humans cannot survey and manage the information required to optimize. Further, Pollock responds to this situation in a similar way to Simon. Rather than claim that informational resource limitations show that humans are irrational, Pollock argues that the correct normative standard is actually less demanding and can be satisfied by human agents.

One feature of Pollock’s argument is similar to Christopher Cherniak’s (1986) observation about the inherent informational complexity of a complete consistency check on one’s belief corpus. Pollock argues that because plans are constructed by adding parts or “sub-plans”, the resulting complexity is such that it is almost always impossible to survey the set of possible plans. For example, suppose an agent considers what plan to adopt for the upcoming week. In a week, an agent might easily make over 300 individual decisions, and a plan will specify which decision to implement at each time. Further, suppose that there are only 2 alternative options for each individual decision. This entails that there are 2^300 possible plans for the week to consider, or, approximately 10^90 plans, a number greater than the estimated number of elementary particles in the universe. Obviously, human agents cannot survey or even construct or represent the set of possible plans for a week of decisions. Actually, the situation is much worse. Rational planning includes what things to do, how to do them, and how to order them, and additionally what may be called “contingency plans”. One might adopt a plan to drive to the airport on Sunday, but this plan might also include the contingency plan “if the car won’t start, call a taxi”. Optimization procedures would require selecting the maximally best contingency plans for a given plan (it would typically not be recommended to try to swim to the airport if one’s car won’t start), but additionally surveying and constructing the set of all possible contingency plans only furthers the computational complexity problem with the optimization procedure.

Instead of optimization, Pollock argues that non-ideal human agents should engage in “locally global” planning. Locally global planning involves beginning with a “good enough” master plan (an idea Pollock acknowledges is reminiscent of Simon’s satisficing view), but continually looking for and making small improvements to the master plan. As Pollock claims, “the only way resource bounded agents can efficiently construct and improve upon master plans reflecting the complexity of the real world is by constructing or modifying them incrementally”. The idea is that resource bounded agents ought to defeasibly adopt a master plan which is “good enough”, but continually seek improvements as new information is obtained or new reasoning is conducted.

iii. Cherniak’s “Minimal Rationality” and “Feasible Inferences”

Chistopher Cherniak’s (1986) Minimal Rationality is a seminal work in the study of resource bounded agents, and it discusses the general issue of the relationship between cognitive limitations and normative standards. He begins by arguing against both idealized standards of rationality (“finitary” agents such as humans could never satisfy these conditions) and a “no standards” view of rationality (unlike agents we recognize, such agents would never generate any predictions on their behavior). The third alternative, that of “minimal rationality” suggests “moderation in all things, including rationality”. Cherniak claims that many of the minimal rationality conditions can be derived from the following principle:

(MR) If A has a particular belief-desire set, A would undertake some, but not necessarily all, of those actions that are apparently appropriate.

For example, Cherniak is clear in suggesting that rational agents need not eliminate all inconsistent beliefs. This generates the following “minimal consistency condition”:

(MC) If A has a particular belief-desire set, then if any inconsistencies arose in the belief set, A would sometimes eliminate some of them.

In support of (MC), Cherniak argues that non-minimal, ideal views of rationality (ones that suggest agents ought to eliminate all inconsistencies) would actually entail that humans are irrational. As he claims, “there are often epistemically more desirable activities for [human agents] than maintaining perfect consistency”. The idea is that given the various cognitive limitations that humans face (the “finitary predicament”), it would be irrational for any human to attempt to satisfy the Sisyphean task of maintaining a consistent belief corpus.

There are two prominent objections to Cherniak’s minimal consistency condition. First, as Daniel Dennett and Donald Davidson have pointed out in various works, it is difficult to understand or ascribe any beliefs to agents that have inconsistent beliefs. For instance, suppose that Albert believes that p, and that p entails q, but also suppose that Albert believes that q is false. What is Albert’s view of the world? In one sense, it may be argued that Albert has no view of the world (and hence no beliefs) because, ultimately, Albert might be interpreted as believing both q and ¬q, and there is no possible world that could satisfy such conditions. In response, Cherniak invokes an “ought implies can” principle. He suggests that once an agent meets a threshold of minimal rationality, “the fact that a person’s actions fall short of ideal rationality need not make them in any way less intelligible to us”. As such, Cherniak’s response could be understood in a commonsense way: typical human agents have some inconsistent beliefs, but we nonetheless ascribe beliefs to them.

A second objection to Cherniak’s minimal consistency condition concerns the permissiveness of the condition. As Appiah (1990) has worried, “are we left with constraints that are sufficiently rich to characterize agency at all”? As an example, an agent that eliminates a few inconsistent beliefs only on Tuesdays would satisfy (MC). Yet there is something intuitively defective about such a reasoner. Instead, it seems that what is wanted is a set of constraints on reasoners, reasoning, and agency that are more strict and more demanding than Cherniak’s minimal rationality conditions. Perhaps anticipating objections similar to Appiah’s, Cherniak developed what he calls a theory of “feasible inferences”. A theory of feasible inferences recruits descriptive facts about cognitive limitations to provide more restrictive normative requirements. For instance, a theory of “human memory structure” describes what information is cognitively available to human agents, given various background conditions. In general terms, when information is cognitively available to an agent, more normative constraints are placed on the agent. Correspondingly, conditions such as (MC) would thereby be strengthened.

However, it is unclear whether a theory of human memory structure will provide enough detail to propose a “rich structure of constraints” on rationality or agency. For one, Cherniak’s theory of human memory structure describes typical humans. There is even a sense in which “typical human” is an idealized notion since no individual is a typical human. Given that there are individual differences in memory abilities between humans, which constraints should be adopted? If an inference to q is obvious for Alice but it would not be obvious for a typical human, is Alice required to believe q (on pain of irrationality) or is it merely permissible for her to believe q? Note that proponents of idealization strategies (as discussed in section 2) are able to provide a rich structure of constraints and do not have to worry about individual differences in cognitive performance.

iv. Gigerenzer’s “Ecological Rationality”

Gerd Gigerenzer views rationality as fundamentally involving considerations of the agent’s environment and the agent’s cognitive limitations. Similar to many of the theorists discussed above, Gigerenzer also cites Herbert Simon as an influence. Many aspects of Gigerenzer’s view may be understood as responding to the influential project of psychologist Daniel Kahneman, to which this article will turn next.

Gigerenzer (2006) is clear in his rejection of “optimization” views of rationality, which he sometimes calls “unbounded rationality”. As he claims,

. . . it is time to rethink the norms, such as the ideal of omniscience. The normative challenge is that real humans do not need. . . unlimited computational power.

In place of optimization procedures, Gigerenzer argues that resource bounded agents ought to use “heuristics” which are computationally inexpensive and are tailored to the environment and abilities of the agent (and are, hence, “fast and frugal”). Rationality, for Gigerenzer, consists in the deployment of numerous, however disparate, fast and frugal heuristics that “work” in an environment.

To understand Gigerenzer’s view, it is helpful to consider several of his proposed heuristics. For the first example, consider the question of who will win the next Wimbledon tennis championship. One way to answer this question, perhaps in line with the optimality view of rationality, would be to collect vast amounts of player performance data and make statistical predictions. Surely, such a strategy is computationally intensive. Instead, Gigerenzer suggests that in some cases it would be rational to use the following heuristic:

Recognition Heuristic: If you recognize one player but not the other, then infer that the recognized player will win the particular Wimbledon match.

First, the recognition heuristic is obviously computationally cheap—it does not require informational search or deep database calculations, or the storage of large amounts of data. Second, the recognition heuristic is incredibly fast to deploy. Third, this heuristic is not applicable in all environments. Some agents will not be able to use this heuristic because they do not recognize any tennis player, and some agents will not be able to use this heuristic because they recognize every tennis player. Fourth, it is essential to note that proper use of the recognition heuristic, in Gigerenzer’s view, results in a normatively sanctioned belief or judgment. That is, when agents use the recognition heuristic in the appropriate environment, the resulting belief is rational. For instance, if Mary only recognizes Roger Federer in the upcoming match between Federer and Rafael Nadal, then it is rational for her to believe that Federer will win.

Some may find this last result surprising or counterintuitive—after all, Mary may know very little about tennis, so how can she have a rational belief that a particular player will win? Gigerenzer would reply that such surprise or counterintuitiveness probably results from holding an optimality view of rationality. Gigerenzer’s project is an attempt to argue that rationality does not consist in gathering large amounts of information and making predictions on this basis. Rather, Gigerenzer thinks that rationality consists in using limited amounts of information in efficient or strategic ways, with the caveat that the proper notion of efficiency and strategy are not idealized notions, but concern the agent’s cognitive limitations and environment.

Now turn to the important question: does the recognition heuristic work? Gigerenzer (2007) found that in approximately 70% of Wimbledon matches, the recognition heuristic predicted the winning player. That is, for agents that are “partially ignorant” about tennis (those that know something about tennis but are not experts) the recognition heuristic gives better-than-chance predictive success.

Consider another heuristic. Humans need to track objects in the environment such as potential threats and sources of food. One way to track an object would be to calculate its trajectory using properties of force, mass, velocity and a series of differential equations. Some AI systems attempt to do just this. It is clear that humans do not explicitly solve differential equations to track objects, but it is also not obvious that humans do this even at a subconscious or automatic level. Gigerenzer (2007) proposes that humans use a “gaze heuristic” in specific situations. For example, consider the problem of tracking an oncoming plane while flying an airplane. One way to infer where an approaching plane will be is to use a series of mathematical formulae involving trajectories and time. A second way would be to use the following gaze heuristic:

Gaze Heuristic: Find a scratch or mark in your airplane windshield. If the other plane does not move relative to this mark, dive away immediately.

As with the recognition heuristic, the gaze heuristic is computationally cheap and fast. Further, this heuristic is not liable to induce calculation errors (as may be the case with the mathematical equations strategy).

Gigerenzer has also argued that a version of the gaze heuristic is used by outfielders when attempting to catch fly balls. This heuristic consists of the following instructions: fix your gaze on the ball, start running, and adjust your running speed so that the image of the ball rises at a constant rate. Interestingly, Shaffer et al. (2004) attached a small camera to dogs when they were fetching thrown frisbees, and it appears that dogs may too use the gaze heuristic. If so, a plausible explanation seems fitting with Gigerenzer’s proposal: in the face of resource limitations, many agents use inference strategies that are fast and frugal, and work in their environment.

One initial worry for Gigerenzer’s project of finding fast and frugal heuristics is that it is not clear there are enough heuristics to explain humans’ general rationality. If a non-expert correctly infers that an American will hit the most aces during Wimbledon, was this an inference based on the recognition heuristic (it is not obvious that it must be), or is there an additional heuristic that is used (perhaps a new heuristic that only concerns aces hit in a tennis match)? Gigerenzer is clear in his rejection of “abstract” or “content-blind” norms of reasoning that are general purpose reasoning strategies, but his alternative view may be forced to posit a vast number of heuristics to explain humans’ general rationality. Further, a cognitive system that is able to correctly deploy and track a vast number of heuristics does not obviously have a clear computational advantage.

A second worry concerns the “brittleness” of the proposed heuristics. For instance, referencing the above mentioned recognition heuristic, what ought one to infer in the case of a tennis match where the recognized player becomes injured on court? Of course, the recognition heuristic is not adaptable enough to handle this additional information (with the idea being that injured players, however excellent, are typically unlikely to win). So, there may be instances in which it is rational to override the use of a heuristic. But positing a cognitive system that monitors relevant additional information and judges whether and when to override the use of a specific heuristic might erase much of the alleged computational advantages that heuristics seem to provide.

b. Failing to Meet the Standard

This article will now address the remaining response by theorists to accommodate the facts of cognitive limitations into their normative theorizing. Some philosophers and psychologists have used facts about cognitive limitations to argue that humans fail to meet various normative standards. For instance, one might argue that humans’ inherent memory limitations and corresponding inability to check beliefs for logical consistency entail that humans are systematically irrational. One might argue that humans’ inherent inability to survey all relevant information in a domain entails that all humans are systematically deluded in that domain. Or, concerning morality, one might attempt to argue that cognitive limitations entail that humans must be systematically immoral, because no human could ever make the required utility calculations (of course, under the assumption of a particular consequentialist moral theory).

Though all of the example positions in the above paragraph are somewhat simplistic, they all roughly share the following features: (i) the claim of a somewhat idealized or “difficult to obtain” normative standard and (ii) the claim that facts about cognitive limitations are relevant to the normative enterprise and show that agents cannot meet this normative standard. As a quick review of material covered in previous sections, theorists such as Herbert Simon, John Pollock, Christopher Cherniak, and Gerd Gigerenzer would reject feature (i), because, in very general terms, they have argued that cognitive limitations provide reason for thinking that the relevant normative standards are not idealized and are not “difficult to obtain”. Proponents of the idealization strategy, such as many Bayesians in epistemology, would reject (ii), because they view the cognitive limitations of particular cognitive agents as irrelevant to the normative enterprise.

i. Kahneman and Tversky’s “Heuristics and Biases” Program

Daniel Kahneman and Amos Tversky are responsible for one of the most influential research programs in cognitive psychology. Their basic view is that human agents reason and make judgments by using cognitive heuristics, and that these heuristics produce errors. Hence the label “heuristics and biases”. Though Kahneman and Tversky have taken a nuanced position regarding the overall rationality of humans, others such as Piatelli-Palmarini (1994) have argued that work done in the heuristics and biases program shows that humans are systematically irrational.

Before discussing some of Kahneman and Tversky’s findings, it is important to note two things. First, though both Gigerenzer and Kahneman and Tversky use the name “heuristics”, these theorists plausibly mean to describe different mechanisms. For Gigerenzer, reasoning heuristics are content-specific and are typically tied to a particular environment. For Kahneman and Tversky, heuristics are understood more broadly as a “shortcut” procedure for reasoning or as a reasoning strategy that excludes some kinds of information. Notoriously, Gigerenzer is critical of Kahneman and Tversky’s characterization of heuristics, claiming that their notion is too vague to be useful. Second, Gigerenzer and Kahneman and Tversky evaluate heuristics differently. For Gigerenzer, heuristics are normatively good (in situations where they are “ecologically rational”), and they are an essential component of rationality. Kahneman and Tversky, however, typically view heuristics as normatively suspect since they likely lead to error.

To begin, consider Kahneman and Tversky’s heuristic of “representativeness”. As they say, “representativeness is an assessment of the degree of correspondence between a sample and a population, an instance and a category, an act and an actor or, more generally, between an outcome and a model”. By using the representativeness heuristic, for one example, a subject might infer that a typical summer day is warm and sunny because it is a common and frequent event, and hence, representative.

Kahneman and Tversky claim that the representativeness heuristic drives some proportion of human probability judgments. They also claim that the use of this heuristic for probability judgments leads to systematic error. In one experiment Tversky and Kahneman (1983) gave subjects the following description of a person and then asked them a probability question about this description. This is the well-known “Linda the bank teller” description: “Linda is 31 years old, single, outspoken and very bright. She majored in philosophy. As a student, she was deeply concerned with issues of discrimination and social justice, and also participated in anti-nuclear demonstrations”. Next, Kahneman and Tversky asked subjects which of the two statements was more probable (given the truth of above description): (T) Linda is a bank teller, or (T&F) Linda is a bank teller and is active in the feminist movement. Kahneman and Tversky report that approximately 85% of subjects judge (T&F) as more probable than (T). Before discussing the alleged incorrectness of this judgement, why might subjects make this judgment? The thought is that, given the description of Linda being an activist in social justice movements and perhaps a philosophy major, (T&F) is more representative of Linda than (T). If Kahneman and Tversky are right in thinking that representativeness drives judgment about probabilities, then their model could explain the result of the Linda case.

But ought agents to judge that (T&F) is more probable than (T), given the description of Linda? This is the important normative question. Kahneman and Tversky rely on the probability calculus as providing the normative standard. According to many versions of the probability calculus, prob(a) ≥ prob(a&b), regardless of the chosen a or b. This may be called “the conjunction rule” for probabilities. The basic idea is that a narrower or smaller class of objects is never more probable than a larger class, and that the overlap of two classes cannot be larger than one of the individual classes. For example, which class is larger, the class of all trucks (Tr) or the class of all white trucks (W&Tr)? Clearly, the answer is the class of all trucks, because every white truck is also a truck. So, which is more probable, that there is a truck parked in front of the White House right now (Tr) or that there is a white truck parked in front of the White House right now (W&Tr)? Plausibly, it is more likely that there is a truck parked in front of the White House (Tr), because any white truck is also a truck, and hence would also count toward the likelihood of there being a truck parked there.

Kahneman and Tversky appeal to the probability calculus as providing the normatively correct rule of reasoning for the Linda case. Because 85% of subjects responded that (T&F) was more probable than (T), against the conjunction rule, Kahneman and Tversky claim that most subjects made an incorrect judgment. So, on their view, this is a case where resource limitations cause human agents to use shortcut procedures such as the representativeness heuristic, and the representativeness heuristic gets the wrong answer. Hence, the representativeness heuristic is responsible for a cognitive bias.

The alleged cognitive bias in the Linda case provides just one part of Kahneman and Tversky’s overall program of heuristics and biases. They have argued that human subjects make errors with insensitivity to prior probabilities, insensitivity to sample size, misconceptions of chance, and misconceptions of regression. Importantly, these claims rely on the probability calculus as providing the correct normative standard. But should we think that the probability calculus provides the correct normative standard for rationality?

One straightforward reason to think that the probability calculus provides the correct normative standard for rational belief concerns logical consistency. Violation of the standard axioms of the probability calculus entails a set of inconsistent probabilistic statements. As such, degrees of belief that satisfy the probability calculus are often called “coherent” degrees of belief. For reasons similar to those given in the introduction to this article, it is often thought that it is not rational to believe a set of inconsistent propositions. Hence, it seems rational to obey the probability calculus.

However, there are significant worries with thinking that the probability calculus provides the correct normative standard for rationality. First, following the rules of the probability calculus is computationally demanding. Independent of Kahneman and Tversky’s experimental results, we should anticipate that few humans would be able to maintain coherent degrees of probabilistic belief, for reasons of computational complexity alone. This observation would entail that humans are not rational, yet this goes against our commonsense view that humans are often quite rational. Indeed, it might be difficult to explain how we’re able to predict human behavior without the corresponding view that humans are usually rational. Insofar as our commonsense view of human rationality is worth preserving, we have reason to think that the probability calculus does not provide a correct normative standard.

A second worry concerns tautologies. According to standard interpretations of probability, every tautology gets assigned probability 1. But if the probability calculus provides a normative standard for belief, then it is rational for us to believe every tautology (for any set of evidence e). But this seems wrong. There are many complex propositions that are difficult to parse or interpret or even understand, but are nonetheless tautologies. Until one recognizes these propositions as instances of a tautology, it does not seem rational to believe just any tautology.

A third and final worry concerns the psychological nature and phenomenology of belief. If the probability calculus provides the correct normative standard for belief then most of our contingent beliefs (for example, “the coffee cup is on the desk”) will have a precise numerical probability assignment, and this number will be less than 1. Call beliefs that are less than 1 but greater than 0.5 “likely beliefs”. Many of our familiar contingent beliefs will be likely beliefs (hence, getting some number assignment such as 0.99785), but it is unclear that our cognitive systems would be able to store or even compute vast amounts of probabilistic information. Belief seems to not work this way. There are, of course, projects in artificial intelligence that attempt to model similar probabilistic systems, but their results have not been universally convincing. Secondly, the phenomenology of belief suggests that many of our contingent beliefs are not “graded” entities that admit of some number, but are binary or “full” beliefs. When one believes that “the coffee cup is on the desk” it often feels like one “fully” believes it, rather than merely “partially” believing it (as would be required if the belief were assigned probability 0.99785). As an example, when reasoning about contingent matters of fact, we often treat our beliefs as full beliefs. Hence, the following reasoning seems both commonplace and acceptable, and does not require probabilities: “I think the coffee cup is in the office, so I should walk there to get the cup”. Hence, the phenomenology of belief gives a possible reason to doubt that the probability calculus provides the correct normative standard for belief.

4. References and Further Reading

a. References

Appiah, Anthony. (1990). “Minimal Rationality by Christopher Cherniak.” The Philosophical Review, 99 (1): 121–123.
Bartlett, Fredrick C. (1932). Remembering: A Study in Experimental and Social Psychology, Cambridge, Cambridge University Press.
Cherniak, Christopher. (1986). Minimal Rationality, Cambridge, MIT Press.
- An important work in the study of resource bounded agents. Discusses idealization in theories of rationality and conditions for agenthood.
Cowan, N. (2001). “The Magical Number 4 in Short-Term Memory: A Reconsideration of Mental Storage Capacity.” Behavioral Brain Science, 24: 87–185.
Feldman, Richard and Conee, Earl. (1985). “Evidentialism.” Philosophical Studies, 48: 15–34.
- Contains a discussion of “ought implies can” principles in epistemology.
Gigerenzer, Gerd. (2006). “Bounded and Rational.” In Stanton, Robert J. (ed.) Contemporary Debates in Cognitive Science, Oxford, Blackwell.
Gigerenzer, Gerd. (2007). Gut Feelings: The Intelligence of the Unconscious, New York, Viking.
- Summarizes and illustrates Gigerenzer’s program of “fast and frugal” heuristics, and is intended for a wide audience.
Lavie, N. (1995). “Perceptual Load as a Necessary Condition for Selective Attention.” Journal of Experimental Psychology: Human Perception and Performance, 21: 451–468.
Lavie, N. (2005). “Distracted and Confused? Selective Attention Under Load.” Trends in Cognitive Science, 5: 75–82.
Macrae, C.N. and MacLeod, M.D. (1999). “On Recollections Lost: When Practice Makes Imperfect.” Journal of Personality and Social Psychology, 77: 463–473.
Miller, George A. (1956). “The Magical Number Seven, Plus or Minus Two: Some Limits On Our Capacity For Processing Information.” The Psychological Review, 63 (2): 81–97.
- Classic paper on memory limitations and an early example of the fields of cognitive science and cognitive psychology.
Piattelli-Palmarini, Massimo. (1994). Inevitable Illusions: How Mistakes of Reason Rule Our Minds, New York, John Wiley and Sons.
- Applies elements of the “heurisitics and biases” program and argues that these results help reveal common errors in judgment.
Pollock, John. (2006). Thinking About Acting: Logical Foundations for Rational Decision Making, Cambridge, Oxford University Press.
- Applying work from epistemology and cognitive science, Pollock proposes a theory of rational decision making for resource bounded agents.
Sears, Christopher R. and Pylyshyn, Zenon. (2000). “Multiple Object Tracking and Attentional Processing.” Canadian Journal of Experimental Psychology, 54 (1): 1–14.
Shaffer, Dennis M., Krauchunas, Scott M., Eddy, Marianna, and McBeath, Michael K. (2004). “How Dogs Navigate to Catch Frisbees.” Psychological Science, 15 (7): 437–441.
Simon, Herbert A. (1955). “A Behavioral Model of Rational Choice.” The Quarterly Journal of Economics, 69 (1): 99–118.
Simon, Herbert A. (1956). “Rational Choice and the Structure of the Environment.” Psychological Review, 63 (2): 129–138.
- An early description of the satisficing procedure.
Stroop, J.R. (1935). “Studies of Interference In Serial Verbal Reactions.” Journal of Experimental Psychology, 18: 643–662.
Thagard, Paul. (1982). “From the Descriptive to the Normative in Psychology and Logic.” Philosophy of Science, 49 (1): 24–42.
Tversky, Amos and Kahneman, Daniel. (1983). “Extensional Versus Intuitive Reasoning: The Conjunction Fallacy in Probability Judgment.” Psychological Review, 90 (4): 293–315.
- Contains the well-known “Linda” example of the conjunction fallacy in probabilistic judgment.
Xu, Yaoda and Chun, Marvin. (2009). “Selecting and Perceiving Multiple Visual Objects.” Trends in Cognitive Science, 13 (4): 167–174.

b. Further Reading

Bishop, Michael A. and Trout, J.D. (2005). Epistemology and the Psychology of Human Judgment, Oxford, Oxford University Press.
- Discusses and offers critiques of various epistemic norms, often citing important work in cognitive science and cognitive psychology.
Christensen, David. (2005). Putting Logic in its Place, Cambridge, Oxford University Press.
- Provides discussion about the use of idealized models. Argues that the unattainability of idealized normative standards in epistemology does not undermine their normative force.
Gigerenzer, Gerd and Selten, Reinhard (eds.). (2001). Bounded Rationality: The Adaptive Toolbox, Cambridge, MIT Press.
- An influential collection of papers on bounded rationality.
Goldstein, E. Bruce. (2011). Cognitive Psychology: Connecting Mind, Research, and Everyday Experience. Belmont, Wadsworth.
- Introductory text in cognitive psychology. Some of the examples of cognitive limitations from section 1 were drawn from this text.
Kahneman, Daniel. (2011). Thinking Fast and Slow. New York, Farrar, Straus, and Giroux.
- Provides an overview of the “heuristics and biases” program and the two-system model of judgment.
Morton, Adam. (2012). Bounded Thinking: Intellectual Virtues for Limited Agents, Oxford, Oxford University Press.
- A virtue-theoretic account of bounded rationality and bounded thinking. Addresses how agents should manage limitations.
Rubinstein, Ariel. (1998). Modeling Bounded Rationality, Cambridge, MIT Press.
- Provides examples of formal models for resource bounded agents.
Rysiew, Patrick. (2008). “Rationality Disputes — Psychology and Epistemology.” Philosophy Compass, 3 (6): 1153–1176.
- Good discussion and overview of the “rationality wars” debate in cognitive science and epistemology.
Simon, Herbert A. (1982). Models of Bounded Rationality, Vol. 2, Behavioral Economics and Business Organization. Cambridge, MIT Press.
- Collection of some of Simon’s influential papers on bounded rationality and procedural rationality.
Weirich, Paul. (2004). Realistic Decision Theory: Rules for Nonideal Agents in Nonideal Circumstances, Oxford, Oxford University Press.
- Argues for principles of decision making that apply to realistic, non-ideal agents.

Author Information

Jacob Caton
Email: jcaton@astate.edu
Arkansas State University
U. S. A.

Gender in Chinese Philosophy

The concept of gender is foundational to the general approach of Chinese thinkers. Yin and yang, core elements of Chinese cosmogony, involve correlative aspects of “dark and light,” “female and male,” and “soft and hard.” These notions, with their deeply-rooted gender connotations, recognize the necessity of interplay between these different forces in generating and carrying forward the world. The major thinkers of China’s first philosophic flourishing—traditionally referred to as the Hundred Schools, c. 500s-200s B.C.E.—inherited and further developed this comprehensively gendered view of the world. These concepts continue to shape contemporary Chinese thought, as well. Historically, the most influential Chinese perspectives on the issue of gender come from what are commonly referred to as Confucian and Daoist traditions of thought, which take somewhat opposing positions. Many texts associated with Confucianism emphasize yang’s dominant, male-related characteristics, whereas those linked to Daoism, especially the Laozi, reverse this view, finding value in yin’s subordinate, female characteristics. However, it should be noted that Chinese thinkers, regardless of their classification as Confucian or Daoist, generally see the opposing qualities of yin and yang as integral parts of a whole that complement one another. Accordingly, the closest word to “gender” in modern Chinese is xingbie, which can be quite literally understood as a difference (bie) of individual nature or tendencies (xing). The word generally, however, refers to the physiological characteristics that then provide the basis for corresponding social identities. The genders, in terms of social roles, are not defined absolutely or theoretically, but rather through the mutually reciprocal, physical, generative relationship between male and female. They are understood correlatively, and determined by their context and dynamic tendencies as they interact with one another. Such traditions within Chinese thought may be applied as resources for contemporary feminist philosophy, albeit not without considerable caution.

Introduction
Human Tendencies (Nature) and Gender
Gender Cosmology
Gender and Social Order
Family Patterns
Chinese Cultural Resources for Feminism
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

There is a debate in contemporary Chinese academic circles about whether or not the idea of “gender” or “gender concepts” actually applies to traditional Chinese thought. Chinese scholars argue about the presence of “male” (xiong) and “female” (ci) characteristics, differences, and relations in the context of ancient Chinese philosophy. Although affirming this interpretation would provide a space for comparative studies with Western traditions, some thinkers believe that doing so distorts traditional Chinese thought.

Zhang Xianglong is a prominent representative of those who think that Chinese philosophy and culture have long been influenced by concepts of gender. For him, Chinese thinking is fundamentally gendered as it takes the interaction between male and female as the basic model for philosophical investigations. He further argues that it is one of the core aspects of mainstream thought in China. Zhang demonstrates that yin and yang strongly connote ideas of female and male, and identifies such gendered thought in works as early as the Zhouyi, or Yijing (Book of Changes), a traditional Chinese divinatory text of uncertain antiquity consisting of hexagrams and their interpretations, as well as throughout the later traditions of Confucianism, Daoism, and Chinese Buddhism. Accordingly, he argues that yin and women have “in principle never been doomed to be inferior” and “discrimination against women in ancient Chinese culture is neither deterministic nor universal” (Zhang 2002:5). Such a claim is dubious, as the dualistic dynamic of yin and yang, while positing both aspects as essential to existence and in this way ontologically equal, has been generally presented as inherently hierarchical. Chen Jiaqi opposes Zhang’s broader position, arguing that yin and yang are not necessarily related to gender. For Chen, yin and yang primarily involve social relationships, political forms, and weighing advantages and disadvantages. He holds that gender characteristics are too abstract to be practically relevant in this context, and do not apply directly to social forms (Chen 2003).

From a historical perspective, Chen’s interpretation is less convincing than Zhang’s. There are numerous Chinese texts where yin and yang are broadly associated with gender. While yang and yin are not exclusively defined as “male” and “female,” and either sex can be considered yin or yang within a given context, in terms of their most general relation to one another, yin references the female and yang the male. For example, the Daoist text known as the Taipingjing (Scripture of Great Peace) records that “the male and female are the root of yin and yang.” The Han dynasty Confucian thinker Dong Zhongshu (195-115 B.C.E.) also writes, “Yin and yang of the heavens and the earth [which together refer to the cosmos] should be male and female, and the male and female should be yin and yang. Thereby, yin and yang can be called male and female, and male and female can be called yin and yang.” These and other texts draw a strong link between yin as female and yang as male. However, it is important to also recognize that gender itself is not as malleable as yin and yang, despite this connection. While gender remains fixed, their coupling with yin and yang is not. This close and complex relationship means yin and yang themselves require examination if their role in Chinese gender theory is to be properly understood.

The original meaning of yin and yang had little to do with gender differences. Some of the earliest uses of yin and yang are found in the Shangshu (Book of Documents). Here, the word yang is employed six times, and five times it denotes the southern side of mountains, which receives the most sunlight. The term yin appears three times in the text, and refers to the shadier northern side of mountains. These examples are characteristic of how yin and yang function throughout Chinese intellectual history; they do not refer to particular objects, but act as correlative categorizations. In most instances yin and yang are used to indicate a specific relationship within a determined context. The way sunshine falls on a mountain is the context, and the difference between the northern and southern sides, where the latter receives more light and warmth, determines their association, which is understood as yin and yang. The terms are thereby an expression of the function of the sun on a particular place, but they do not speak to the actual substance of the objects (the sun or mountain) themselves. The specific traits of the objects can only be designated yin and yang in their functional correlation to one another. Within this matrix, yin things share commonalities when viewed in relation to yang things.

In this way, the early association of yin and yang with gender can be seen as speaking to the relationship between genders, and not to their essential or substantial natures. Yin and yang traits were thus seen as able to accurately describe broad differences between males and females as they interact with one another. Fixing the link between these categorizations, having men be yang in relation to women, who are yin, only works in a highly abstract or broad sense. For example, the Book of Changes states that the emperor is supposed to have six male ministers at the south palace (a yang position) and six wives or concubines at the north palace (a yin position). Like the southern and northern sides of a mountain, men and women are yang and yin in the way they serve the emperor. Social positions are linked to gender and understood through yin and yang. The Liji (Record of Rituals) states that “the male is outside, and the wife inside the home. The sun starts in the east and the moon starts in the west. This is the distinction of yin and yang, the positions of husband and wife.” However, in specific contexts, it is possible for the association to be reversed. For instance, in Dong Zhongshu’s Chunqiu Fanlu (Spring and Autumn Annals), we also find that “the sovereign is yang, the minister is yin; the father is yang, the son is yin.” Here males, such as ministers or sons, can also be considered yin. The entire pattern can be overturned, as well, such as in the relationship between an empress and her male ministers, where the woman is yang and the men are considered yin. However, such a situation was often considered something that should be approached with caution, as it violated natural patterns. For example, Wang Bi (226-249 C.E.), who did not care much for Dong Zhongshu’s cosmological interpretation, still argued that a woman who was too strong was not to be married.

In terms of actual practice, the more generalized and stable affiliation between yin as female and yang as male often won out, as exemplified by Wang’s idea. It was commonly appropriated as an ideological tool for backing the oppression of women, especially after Dong Zhongshu’s theories took hold. Dong, whose version of Confucianism won imperial backing during the Han dynasty, was also responsible for promoting the official establishment of a formal cosmology based on yin and yang, which became quite influential in the Chinese tradition. While he allows for men to be understood as yin and women as yang in certain contexts, overall he sought to limit the scope of such reversals. For Dong, males are dominant, powerful, and moral, and therefore yang. Women, on the other hand, are precisely the opposite—subservient, weak, selfish, and jealous—and best described as yin. As a result, female virtues became largely oriented toward social roles, especially women’s duties as wives (for example, the female virtues of chastity and compliancy). Against this biased intellectual background, oppressive practices were supported and initiated. For instance, the widespread acceptance of concubinage and female foot binding in Chinese social history expressed the inequality between genders.

However, this social inequality did not accurately reflect its culture’s philosophical thought. Most Chinese thinkers were very attentive to the advantageousness of the complementary nature of male and female characteristics. In fact, in many texts considered Confucian that are predominant for two millennia of Chinese thought, the political system and gender roles are integrated (Yang 2013). This integration is based on understanding yin and yang as fundamentally affixed to gender and thereby permeating all aspects of social life. Sinologists such as Joseph Needham have identified a “feminine symbol” in Chinese culture, rooted in the Daoist concentration on yin. Roger Ames and David Hall similarly argue that yin and yang indicate a “difference in emphasis rather than difference in kind” and should be viewed as a whole, and that therefore their relationship can be likened to that of male and female traits (Ames and Hall 1998: 90-96). Overall, while the complementary understanding of yin and yang did not bring about gender equality in traditional Chinese society, it remains a key factor for comprehending Chinese conceptions of gender. As Robin Wang has noted, “on the one hand, yinyang seems to be an intriguing and valuable conceptual resource in ancient Chinese thought for a balanced account of gender equality; on the other hand, no one can deny the fact that the inhumane treatment of women throughout Chinese history has often been rationalized in the name of yinyang” (Wang 2012: xi).

2. Human Tendencies (Nature) and Gender

Gender issues play an important role in the history of Chinese thought. Many thinkers theorized about the significance of gender in a variety of areas. The precondition for this discussion is an interpretation of xing, “nature” or “tendencies.” The idea of “differences of xing” constitutes the modern term for “gender,” xingbie (literally “tendency differences”) making xing central to this discussion. It should be noted that the Chinese understanding of xing, including “human xing,” is closer to “tendency” or “propensity” than traditional Western conceptions of human “nature.” This is mainly because xing is not seen as something static or unchangeable. (It is for this reason that Ames and Hall, in the quote above, highlight the difference between “emphasis” and “kind.”) The way xing is understood greatly contributes to the way arguments about gender unfold.

The term xing first became an important philosophical concept in discussions about humanity and eventually human tendency, or renxing. In terms of its composition, the character xing is made up of a vertical representation of xin, “heart-mind” (the heart was thought to be the organ responsible for both thoughts and feelings/emotions) on the left side. This complements the character sheng, to the right, which can mean “generation,” “grow,” or “give birth to.” In many cases, the way sheng is understood has a significant impact on interpreting xing and gender. As a noun, sheng can mean “natural life,” which gives rise to theories about “original nature” or “foundational tendencies” (benxing). It thereby connotes vital activities and physiological desires or needs. It is in this sense that Mengzi (372-289 B.C.E.) describes human tendencies (renxing) as desiring to eat and have sex. He also says that form and color are natural characteristics, or natural xing. The Record of Rituals similarly comments that food, drink, and relations between men and women are defining human interests. Xunzi (312-238 B.C.E.), generally regarded as the last great classical Confucian thinker, fundamentally disagreed with Mengzi’s claim that humans naturally tend toward what is good or moral. He did, however, similarly classify xing as the desire for food, warmth, and rest.

Sheng can also be a verb, which gives xing a slightly different connotation. As a verb, sheng indicates creation and growth, and thus supports the suggestion that xing should be understood as human growth through the development of one’s heart-mind, the root, or seat, of human nature or tendencies. The Mengzi expressly refers to this, stating that xing is understood through the heart-mind. This also marks the distinction between humans and animals. A human xing provides specific characteristics and enables a certain orientation for growth that is unique in that it includes a moral dimension. It is in this sense that Mengzi proposes his theory for natural human goodness, a suggestion that Xunzi later rebuts, albeit upon a similar understanding of xing. Texts classified as Daoist, such as the Laozi and Zhuangzi, similarly affirm that xing is what endows beings with their particular virtuousness (though it is not necessarily moral).

It is on the basis of human nature/tendencies that their unique capacity for moral cultivation is given. The Xing Zi Ming Chu (Recipes for Nourishing Life), a 4^th century B.C.E. text recovered from the Guodian archaeological site, comments that human beings are defined by the capacity and desire to learn. Natural human tendencies are thereby not simply inherent, they also need to be grown and refined. The Mengzi argues that learning is nothing more than developing and cultivating aspects of one’s own heart-mind. The Xunzi agrees, adding that too much change or purposeful change can bring about falsity—which often results in immoral thoughts, feelings, or actions. These texts agree in their argument that there are certain natural patterns or processes for each thing, and deviating from these is potentially dangerous. Anything “false” or out of accordance with these patterns is likely to be immoral and harmful to oneself and society, so certain restrictions are placed on human practice to promote moral growth. These discussions look at human tendencies as largely shaped in the context of society, and can be taken as a conceptual basis for understanding gender as a natural tendency that is steered through social institutions. For example, when Mengzi is asked why the ancient sage-ruler Shun lied to his parents in order to marry, Mengzi defends Shun as doing the right thing. Explaining that otherwise Shun would have remained a bachelor, Mengzi writes, “The greatest of human relations is that a man and a woman live together.” Thus Mengzi argues that Shun’s moral character was based on proper cultivation of his natural tendencies according to social mores.

One’s individual nature is largely influenced, and to some extent even generated, by one’s cultural surroundings. This also produces physiological properties that account for a wide variety of characteristics that are then reflected in aspects of gender, culture, and social status. Linked to the understanding of yin and yang as functionally codependent categorizations, differences between genders are characterized on the basis of their distinguishing features, and defined correlatively. This means that behavior and identity largely arise within the context of male-female relations. One’s natural tendencies include gender identity as either xiong xing (male tendencies) or ci xing (female tendencies), which one is supposed to cultivate accordingly. Thus there are more physiological and cultural aspects to human tendencies, as well. In these diverse ways, Chinese philosophy emphasizes the difference between males and females, believing that each has their own particular aspects to offer, which are complementary and can be unified to form a harmonious whole (though this does not necessarily imply their equality).

3. Gender Cosmology

The idea of gender as being fundamentally understood through respective dissimilarities (nan nü you bie) is based in the physiological differences between men and women, but also manifests in philosophic thought. In fact, in one of the earliest references to the distinction between men and women, the Record of Rituals asserts:

Once there is a difference between males and females, then there can be love between fathers and sons. Once there is love between fathers and sons, obligations are generated. Once obligations are generated, rituals are made. Once rituals are made, all things can be at ease.

The original difference between genders is—presumably through the generative power of their combination—the foundation for obligations (or morality) and thus ritual (or social moral patterns), which allows finally for harmony in the cosmos as a whole. Through the establishment of the concept that human tendencies are formed and act in line with nature, Chinese gender cosmology applies an analogous generative model of yin and yang to a general understanding of the world.

Another early text, the 3^rd century B.C.E. medical compendium Huangdi Neijing (Inner Scripture of the Yellow Emperor), offers one of the most comprehensive definitions of yin and yang:

Yin and yang are the dao (“way”) of the heavens and earth, they provide the model for the net (gangji) of all beings, they are the parents of all change and transformation, and the origin of life and death, and the residence for spirit and insight. To heal illness [one] must seek its root. (Zhang 2002: 41)

Here, yin and yang are taken as a pattern embedded in the existence of all beings, thus providing the foundation for a coherent worldview. This weaves together human beings, nature, and dao (way) in a manner that creates a dynamic wholeness pervaded by and mediated through the interaction of yin and yang. This Chinese cosmological view sees all things, including humans, as borne of both yin and yang and thus naturally integrated with one another. In essence, dao represents the interaction between yin and yang, and it is in this respect that the Laozi tells us that dao is both the source and the model, or pattern, for all things (Laozi 25). More directly, the Laozi comments that all things in turn carry yin and embrace yang (Laozi 42). This shows that through yin and yang and their patterns of interaction dao provides the rhythm of the cosmos. From this perspective the genders also complement and nourish one another, and are even vital to one another.

The idea that the interaction of yin and yang generates the myriad things in existence corresponds to intercourse between male and female as the only means for reproducing life. Therefore, the nature of men and women in Chinese philosophy is not only based on purely physiological characteristics and differences, but is also the embodiment of yin and yang forces in gender. The dao of men and women are linked to the dao of the universe in terms of reproducing life. This is systematically discussed in the Book of Changes, one of China’s most ancient and influential texts. There, eight trigrams are given, which represent eight natural phenomena and can further be combined to form sixty-four hexagrams. These are expressions of the function and movement of yin and yang. They are composed of two contrasting symbols: the yang-yao unbroken horizontal line, and the yin-yao broken horizontal line. Some scholars see these as referring to the male and female genitals respectively. In this sense, the first two hexagrams qian or “heaven” (which is six yang-yaos) and kun or “earth” (six yin-yaos) can be interpreted as representing pure yin and yang. They are also responsible for the formation of general gender stereotypes in Chinese thought. They provide the gateways for change, and are considered, quite literally, the father and mother of all other hexagrams (which equates to all things in the world). The broad system of the Book of Changes attempts to explain every type of change and existence, and is built upon an identification of yin and yang with the sexes as well as their interaction with one another.

According to the “Xici Zhuan” (Commentary on the Appended Phrases) section of the Book of Changes, qian is equated with the heavens, yang, power, and creativity, while kun is identified with the earth, yin, receptivity, and preservation. Their interaction generates all things and events in a way that is similar to the intercourse between males and females, bringing about new life. The Commentary on the Appended Phrases makes the link to gender issues clear by stating that both qian and kun have their own daos (ways) that are responsible for the male and female respectively. The text goes on to discuss the interaction between the two, both cosmologically in terms of the heavens and earth and biologically in terms of the sexes. The conclusion is that their combination and interrelation is responsible for all living things and their changes. The intercourse between genders is a harmonization of yin and yang that is necessary not only for an individual’s well-being, but also for the proper functioning of the cosmos. Interaction between genders is thus the primary mechanism of life, which explains all forms of generation, transformation, and existence.

4. Gender and Social Order

Theoretically, the social order of gender in Chinese thought is broadly formed on the concepts of the heavens and earth and yin and yang. When these notions are applied to the social field, they are likened to the male and female genders. In the aforementioned Commentary on the Appended Phrases, heaven and yang are considered honorable, while the earth and yin are seen as lowly in comparison. Since the former are coupled with qian, which comprises maleness, and the latter with kun, which marks femaleness, these gender roles are valued similarly. The Inner Scripture of the Yellow Emperor says that yang’s maleness is meant for the outside, and yin’s femaleness for the inside. Men, being equated here with yang, are also associated with superiority, motion, and firmness, while women are coupled with yin and so seen as inferior, still, and gentle. Gender cosmology then largely replaced more dynamic views of gender roles with sharply defined unequal relationships, and these were generally echoed throughout the culture. The social order that emerged from this thought saw men as largely in charge of external affairs and superior to women.

The specific operational mode for maintaining this social order and its gender distinctions is li, propriety or ritual. The Record of Rituals focuses much of its discourse on specific rules regarding distinct practices reserved for certain individuals through gender categorization. In this way, wedding ceremonies are the root of propriety. Marriage is especially important because it is politically valuable for establishing and sustaining social order through designated male-female relations. In the Record of Rituals, men and women are asked to observe strict separation in society and uphold the distinction between the outer and inner. (Men being responsible for the family’s “outer” dealings, including legal, economic, and political affairs, and women the “inner” ones, such as familial relations and housework.) Social roles were thereby moralized according to gender. The Record of Rituals also tells us that the rites as a couple begin with gender responsibilities. It states, for example, that when outside the home the husband is supposed to lead the way and that the wife should follow. However, within the home women were supposed to obey men as well, even boys. Before marriage, a girl was expected to listen to her father, and then after marriage to be obedient to her husband, or to their sons if he died. These general guidelines are commonly referred to in other texts as the sancong side or “three obediences and four virtues,” which dominated theories of proper social ordering for most of China’s history.

The four virtues—women’s virtue (fude), women’s speech (fuyan), women’s appearance (furong), and women’s work (fugong)—were expounded on by Ban Zhao (45-120 C.E.) in her book Nüjie (Admonitions for Women). She believed that women should be conservative, humble, and quiet in expressing ritual or filial propriety as their virtue. In the same way, a women’s speech should not be “flowery” or persuasive, but yielding and circumspect. She should also pay close attention to her appearance, be clean and proper, and act especially carefully around guests and in public. Her work consists mainly in household practicalities, such as weaving and food preparation.

The sancong (three obediences) can also be regarded as a forerunner to the san gang, or “three cardinal guides,” of the later Han dynasty (25-220 C.E.). The three cardinal guides were put forward by the aforementioned Dong Zhongshu and contributed greatly to integrating yin and yang gender cosmology into the framework of Confucian ethics. These guides are regulations about relationships—they are defined as the ruler guiding ministers, fathers guiding sons, and husbands guiding wives. Although these rules lack specific content, they do provide a general understanding for ordering society that is concentrated on proper relationships, which is the basic element for morality in many Confucian texts. Here a strong gender bias emerges. The partiality shown toward the elevated position of husbands is only further bolstered by the other two relationships being completely male-based. The only time females are mentioned they are last. Moreover, the ranking of the relationships themselves are hierarchical, relegating women to the lowest level of this order.

Dong also elaborated on distinguishing goodness from evil based on elevating things associated with yang and its general characteristics as ultimately superior to yin, and at the same time emphasized their connections to gender characteristics. This further reinforces deep gender bias. The language of Dong’s Spring and Autumn Annals praises males and presents a negative view of females and all things feminine. The text explicitly argues that even if there are ways in which the husband is inferior to the wife, the former is still yang and therefore better overall. Even more drastically, it states that evilness and all things bad belong to yin, while goodness and all things good are associated with yang, which clearly implicitly links good and evil to male and female, respectively. There are places where, due to the interrelated correlative relationship between yin and yang, the female might be yang and therefore superior in certain aspects, but since she is mostly yin, she is always worse overall. The text even goes so far as to require that relationships between men and women be adjusted to strictly conform to the three cardinal guides. Rules require that subjects obey their rulers, children their fathers, and wives their husbands. In Dong’s other writings, he goes a step further, declaring that the three cardinal guides are a mandate of the heavens. This gives cosmological support to his social arrangement, equating male superiority with the natural ordering of all things.

In the Baihutong (Philosophical Discussions in the White Tiger Hall), which is a collection of court debates from the later Han dynasty, discourse on Dong’s guidelines is taken further. During this time, Confucianism was established as the official state ideology and heavily influenced many areas of politics, including court functioning, policies, and education. This, in turn, provided the foundation for a Confucian society in which this ideology successfully penetrated the daily lives of the state’s entire populace. Dong’s interpretation of ancient texts, including his reading of gender cosmology, became especially powerful as Confucianism believes that the basis for social order and morality begins in human interaction, not individuals. In this context, people are mainly understood according to their roles in society or relationships with others, which were already established as naturally hierarchical in the Analects (the record of Confucius’s actions and words). Dong’s work added a distinct favoring of male over female that became increasingly established and widespread as Confucianism became increasingly influential. Conceived of as analogous to the relationship between rulers and ministers, teachers and students, or parents and children, the two sexes were generally assumed to be a natural ordering of the superior and inferior.

Although these sexist trends are not found in earlier texts—at least not explicitly—they became quite common after the Han dynasty. (The most controversial exception to this is in Analects 17:25, where Confucius is recorded to have equated petty people and women; however, it is unclear exactly what he meant, and whether or not he was referring to women in general or just “petty” ones.) By the Song dynasty (960-1279 C.E.), mainstream political and intellectual discourse viewed both the ability and moral character of women as significantly inferior to males. The Confucian classic known as the Shijing (Book of Poetry) includes the controversial line “Male intellect builds states, female intellect topples states” (Zhou 2002: 489), which in the Song dynasty became understood as an argument for keeping women out of politics and state affairs. On this basis, the Neo-Confucian thinker Zhu Xi (1130-1200) criticized Wu Zetian, China’s only female emperor, arguing that failure to observe Dong’s three cardinal guides was ultimately responsible for the chaos, violence, and civil wars that had followed the Tang dynasty (618-907 C.E.). Later, during the Ming dynasty (1368-1644 C.E.), the Confucian thinker Zhang Dai (1597-1679 C.E.) developed the idea that males express virtuousness through their ability to debate and contend with one another, while women find virtuousness in lacking this skill. Although he did not expound much on this idea, it was taken to mean that women were both unable and ought not contend with others, including their husband. Their obedience was a display of morality. Similarly, men were expected to dominate their wives in a somewhat disrespectful manner in order to display their own ethical cultivation. In more extreme interpretations, Zhang’s notion was read as “a woman without talent is virtuous.” This was linked to the cosmological understanding of gender roles so that failure to follow these guides meant the betrayal of natural patterns—the traditional foundation for ethical norms. During this time, imperial law stated that any man over forty without a male heir must take on a concubine to aid him in producing one.

The domination of these views in both culture and philosophy caused the Chinese tradition to attach great importance to hierarchical gender roles. Social order based itself on cosmological theories that were automatically normative and constituted guidelines for moral cultivation. Despite the Book of Changes and Laozi’s emphasis on the importance of the interaction between yin and yang as complementary and mutually constitutive, women were generally regarded as inferior.

5. Family Patterns

Ideal political and social order in the state was regarded as a replication of the family model on a larger scale. The way neighbors interacted, friends treated one another, and ministers served rulers were all based on models of familial relationships. Early Confucian texts provided the ideological foundation for this pattern by arguing that morality must be cultivated at home first before it could be adequately practiced in society. In terms of gender, the hierarchical relationships in socio-political spheres were simply extensions of the superiority of husbands in spousal relations. The Record of Rituals explains, “Just as two rulers cannot coexist in one country, a household cannot have two masters; only one can govern” (Zheng 2008: 2353). Dong Zhongshu’s three cardinal guides promoted this attitude by requiring that wives listen to their husbands in the same way that children should listen to fathers and then further placing the spousal relationship below that of father and son. Zhu Xi bolstered this order by arguing that children should respect both parents, but that the father should be absolutely superior to the mother. Zhu recognized that there were aspects of life, mostly household affairs (nei), that women were well suited for, but saw men’s duties as superior, and therefore advocated that males always dominate females.

In line with the mutual relationship of yin and yang emphasized by the Book of Changes and Daoism, marriages were largely understood as being a deferential equivalence. The wedding rites in the Record of Rituals say that marriages are important for maintaining ancestral sacrifice and family lineages. The text describes that when a groom gives a salute, the bride can sit, and that during the ceremony they should eat at the same table and drink from the same bottle to display their mutual affection, trust, and support. This also aligns the woman, who had no official rank of her own, with her husband’s rank. The Record of Rituals further records that during China’s first dynasties, enlightened monarchs respected their wives and children, and that this is in line with natural order or dao. The Xiaojing (Classic of Filial Piety) also says that rulers should never insult even their concubines, let alone their wives. Although only leaders are mentioned, according to Chinese ethical systems people are supposed to emanate their superiors, so this deference would ideally be practiced in every household. However, such roles were largely based on function. For men this meant learning, working, and carrying on the ancestral line. Women were in charge of household affairs and principally responsible for producing a male heir. If they failed in the latter, their martial function was largely unfulfilled, which reflected poorly on the husband, as well. Since the women’s function was largely mechanistic, her status was much lower and she was essentially anonymous, without independent social standing. Men could take on concubines to produce heirs or simply for pleasure, and while wives were “in charge” of concubines, they could also be (albeit rarely) replaced by them, and would have to serve the sons of concubines if they produced none of their own. Legally, men owned their wives, and there was often little practical recourse for a woman against her husband, even though the laws of certain periods allowed for it.

The Book of Poetry contains a large number of poems and songs describing marriage and love between men and women, some of which express the joys and sorrows of women. The collection includes lamentations of men going off on business or to war, and women’s complaints of being abandoned by their husbands after concubines are purchased. They are meant to remind husbands of social expectations and moral responsibilities. The Lienüzhuan (Biographies of Virtuous Women) and Xunzi both argue that the husband-wife relation is foundational for the family, and therefore for a stable society, as well. (The Zhongyong, or Doctrine of the Mean, adds that the sage’s virtue is found most simply in husband-wife relations.) Liu Xiang (77 B.C.E.-6 C.E.), the complier of the Lienüzhuan, firmly believed that morality starts in the family and reverberates out into society. He grouped virtuous women into six categories, or virtues: maternal rectitude (muyi), sage-like intelligence (xianming), humane wisdom (renzhi), purity and deference (zhenshun), chastity and dutifulness (jieyi), and skill in arguments and communication (biantong). Later editions of this text became less gender specific, but Liu emphasized women who were able to carry out certain female-related duties in role-specific conditions (including those of daughter, wife, daughter-in-law, and mother). Although Liu did not mention it, later texts argued that widows should not remarry or take on lovers. The Neo-Confucian thinker Cheng Yi (1033-1107) was one of the harshest interpreters of widow fidelity, claiming that they should rather starve to death than take on a second husband. Zhu Xi, who disagreed with Cheng on many issues, argued that this was not practical; yet it was generally regarded as virtuous, even if not widely practiced. Cheng’s proposal was also important because he did not restrict such devotion to women, which created a rare sense of equality (of which Zhu also disapproved).

Analogous to yin and yang, the relationship of the wife and “inner” with the husband and “outer” is conceived of as complementary, not dualistic. According to the functional distinction of “inner” and “outer,” women were responsible for everything in the house, while men dominated external affairs. The most basic form of this division was given as “Men plow and women weave” (nan geng nü zhi). However, this distinction is not equivalent to the Western concepts of private and public. In fact, during the Wei-Jin period of national disunity (265-420 C.E.), it was common for women in northern Chinese states to handle family legal matters at court, go out to present gifts, and handle certain business matters. The woman’s role was not always marginalized, but it was focused on specific tasks. Chinese families often believed that educating their daughters well (though not necessarily in literary learning) was the precondition for improving the family and encouraging orderliness. Women were also often the primary caretakers and to some extent educators of all children, male or female—an invaluable role for the entire household. A couple’s shared goals, like obtaining wealth or educating children, were designated into separate spheres that either the wife or husband would control. The third-century B.C.E. philosophical miscellany known as Lüshi Chunqiu (Mr. Lü’s Spring and Autumn Annals) declares that husbands should have clothes to wear without weaving and wives have food to eat without farming because of their division of labor, which allows for a more efficacious family and society. Individual differences should be acknowledged so that the couple can support and assist one another.

6. Chinese Cultural Resources for Feminism

Taking yin and yang as an analogy for female and male, classical Chinese thought presents a complex picture of their interaction. Firstly, with thinkers such as Dong Zhongshu, the split between the two genders can be seen as relatively fixed. On this basis regulations on gender roles are equally stabilized, so that they are considered complementary, but not equal. The second major trend, seen most explicitly in the Laozi, values the inseparability of yin and yang, which is equated with the female and male. This interpretation explores the productive and efficacious nature of yin, or feminine powers. While not necessarily feminist, this latter view provides a robust resource for exploring feminism in Chinese thought. These two orientations were developed along the lines of their respective representatives in Chinese traditions.

Like the relationship between yin and yang, a complementary relationship can be seen between these two views on gender. Thinkers such as Confucius, Mengzi, Xunzi, Dong Zhongshu, and Zhu Xi are often taken to represent Confucianism, which belongs to the first viewpoint. The Laozi and Zhuangzi have then been seen as opposed to these thinkers, and are representative of Daoism. However, the actual relationship between these two “schools” is much more integrated. For example, Wang Bi wrote what is generally regarded as the standard commentary on the Laozi, and yet he considered Confucius to be a higher sage than Laozi. Similarly, actual Chinese social practices cannot be traced back to either Daoism or Confucianism exclusively, though one or the other may be more emphasized in particular cases. Taken as separate, they each highlight different aspects that, when integrated with one another, represent a whole. Although they are sometimes read as opposing views, both are equally indispensable for comprehending Chinese culture and history.

Despite the possibility of reading feminism into many Chinese texts, there can be no doubt that the Chinese tradition, as practiced, was largely sexist. For the most part, the inferior position of women was based on readings (whether or not they were misinterpretations) of texts generally classified as Confucian, such as the Record of Rituals, Book of Poetry, or Analects. On the other hand, other texts regarded as Confucian—such as the Book of Changes or Classic of Filial Piety—harbor rich resources for feminism in China. So while sexist practices are and were frequently defended on the basis of Confucian texts, this is limited to particular passages, and does not speak to the complexity of either Confucianism or Chinese traditions in general.

As a response to dominant practices, the Laozi—regardless of whether it was formed earlier or later than other major texts, such as the Analects—favors notions that counter (but do not necessarily oppose) early social values. While the Record of Rituals and Book of Poetry contain or promote hierarchical interpretations of gender issues, the Laozi clearly promotes nominally feminine characteristics and values. (This puts the Laozi in conflict with some branches of feminism that seek to destroy notions of “female” or gender-oriented traits and tendencies.) While this does not necessarily equate the Laozi with what is now called “feminism,” it does provide Chinese culture with a potential resource for reviving or creating conceptions of femininity in a more positive light.

The major philosophical concept in the Laozi is dao (way). The first chapter of the text claims that the unchanging dao cannot be spoken of, but it does offer clues in the form of a variety of images that appear throughout its eighty-one chapters. Several of the descriptions associate dao with the feminine, maternal, or female “gate.” In this context, dao is given three important connotations. It is responsible for the origin of all things, it is all things, and it provides the patterns that they should follow. The comparison to a woman’s body and its function of generation (sheng) identify dao as feminine, and therefore speak to the power of the female. The Laozi can therefore be read as advocating that female powers and positions are superior to their male counterparts. In modern scholarship, this is frequently noted, and several scholars have attempted to use the Laozi to support Chinese and comparative feminist studies. Images in the text strongly support these investigations.

For example, the text speaks of the gushen, the “spirit of the valley,” which is said to “never die” and is called xuanpin, or “mysterious femininity” (ch. 6). The character for “spirit,” gu, originally meant “generation.” It is identified with sheng (part of the character for gender and tendencies), and its shape is sometimes taken to represent the female genitals. In other places, dao is referred to as the mother and said to have given birth to all things (ch. 52). Contemporary scholars also point out that there are no “male” images or traditionally male traits linked to dao in the Laozi. Dao’s characteristics, such as being “low,” “soft,” and “weak,” are all associated with yin and femininity, thereby forging a strong link between dao and the female.

Yin tendencies are not, however, exclusively valued. The Laozi offers a more balanced view, which is why it can be used as a resource of feminism, but is not necessarily feminist itself. For example, it says that all things come from dao and that they carry the yin and embrace the yang, and that their blending is what produces harmony in the world (ch. 42). Yin is arguably more basic, but is prized for its ability to overcome yang, just as the soft can overcome the hard and stillness can defeat movement. These notions are applied to many aspects of life, including sexual, political, and military examples. These examples revere female traits, arguing that yin should be acknowledged for its numerous strengths, but do not reject the importance of yang.

Taken as a political text, the Laozi argues that the ruler should take on more female than male traits in order to properly govern the world. This is supposed to allow him to remain “still” while others are in motion, ideally self-ordering. Although this confirms the usefulness of female virtue, it is not an argument for it being superior, or even equal to male counterparts. Rather, it demonstrates how female characteristics can be used to promote efficacy.

Given that sexist practices have largely be defended by reference to texts and scholars that self-identify with the Confucian tradition, it is easy to see why contemporary scholars have looked to the Laozi as one of the major sources for constructing Chinese feminism. It is certainly the first major Chinese philosophical text that explicitly promotes a variety of female traits and values, which allows room for feminist consciousness and discourse.

7. References and Further Reading

Ames, Roger T., and David L. Hall. Thinking from the Han: Self, Truth, and Transcendence in Chinese and Western Culture. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press, 1998.
- (This book includes a chapter on gender roles that outlines how the Confucian tradition can be used to establish a foundation for Chinese gender equality.)
Ames, Roger T., and Henry Rosemont Jr., trans. The Analects of Confucius: A Philosophical Translation. New York, NY: Ballantine Books, 1998.
- (An excellent translation of the Confucian Analects.)
Bossler, Beverly. Courtesans, Concubines and the Cult of Female Fidelity: Gender and Social Change in China, 1000–1400. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 2012.
- (A superb study of how female roles and virtues shaped Chinese family life, politics,and academics.)
Chen, Jiaqi. “Critique of Zhang Xianglong.” Zhejiang Academic Journal 4 (2003): 127–130.
- (This article points out inequalities of gender rules in Chinese philosophy and social systems.)
Moeller, Hans-Georg, trans. Daodejing: A Complete Translation and Commentary. Chicago, IL: Open Court, 2007.
- (Moeller’s commentary is sensitive to feminist interpretations of the Daodejing or Laozi.)
Rosenlee, Li-Hsiang. Confucianism and Women. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press, 2006.
- (A book-length study of gender roles in the Confucian tradition.)
Van Norden, Bryan, trans. Mengzi, with Selections from Traditional Commentaries. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing, 2008.
- (A masterful translation of the Mengzi with commentaries from traditional Chinese scholars.)
Wang, Robin R. Yinyang: The Way of Heaven and Earth in Chinese Thought and Culture. NY: Cambridge University Press, 2012.
- (The best study of Chinese yinyang theory in English. The text also includes discussions of gender issues.)
Wang, Robin R. Images of Women in Chinese Thought and Culture: Writings from the Pre-Qin Period through the Song Dynasty. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing, 2003.
- (An excellent resource for gender issues in Chinese thought.)

Author Information

Lijuan Shen
Email: aashen@126.com
Xi’an University of Architecture and Technology
China

and

Paul D’Ambrosio
Email: pauljdambrosio@hotmail.com
East China Normal University
China

Theological Determinism

Theological determinism is the view that God determines every event that occurs in the history of the world. While there is much debate about which prominent historical figures were theological determinists, St. Augustine, Thomas Aquinas, John Calvin, and Gottfried Leibniz all seemed to espouse the view at least at certain points in their illustrious careers. Contemporary theological determinists also appeal to various biblical texts (for example Ephesians 1:11) and confessional creeds (for example the Westminster Confession of Faith) to support their view. While such arguments from authority carry significant weight within the traditions in which they are offered, another form of argument for theological determinism which has broader appeal draws on perfect being theology, or a kind of systematic thinking through the implications of the claim that God is—in the words of St. Anselm—quo maius cogitari non potest: that than which none greater can be conceived. The article below considers three such perfect being arguments for theological determinism, having to do with God’s knowledge of the future, providential governance of creation, and absolute independence. Implications of theological determinism for human freedom and divine responsibility are then discussed.

Reflection on theological determinism is both theoretically interesting and also practically important, especially for the lives of religious believers. On the one hand, for anyone who enjoys a good philosophical puzzle, thinking through the implications of this view offers the opportunity to consider whether various sets of propositions to which people sometimes ascribe—e.g. that God has exhaustive foreknowledge but that some events are not determined, or that God determines all events but that humans are culpable for their own sin—are in fact jointly consistent, and so what sort of systematic metaphysics is possible. On the other hand, whether all events in the world—and, in particular, personally significant events, such as the birth or death of a child, or the gain or loss of employment—are understood to be determined by God or not makes a significant difference to the attitudes that religious believers adopt and the decisions they make in response to such events in their own lives.

Defining Theological Determinism
Arguments for Theological Determinism
Theological Determinism and Human Freedom
Theological Determinism and Divine Responsibility for Evil
References and Further Reading

1. Defining Theological Determinism

As stated above, theological determinism is the view that God determines every event that occurs in the history of the world. What it means for God to determine an event may need some spelling out. Theological determinism is often associated with Calvinist or Reformed theology, and many proponents of Calvinism put their view in terms of the specificity of God’s decree, the efficaciousness of God’s will, or the extent of God’s providential control. John Feinberg, for example, describes his theological determinist position as that view that “God’s decree covers and controls all things” (2001, p. 504), while Paul Helm, another staunch theological determinist of the Calvinist variety, simply says that God’s providence is “extended to all that He has created” (1993, p. 39). The problem with such characterizations is that they are subject to multiple interpretations, some of whom would be affirmed by theological indeterminists. For instance, a theological indeterminist might say that God’s providence extends to all events, or that even undetermined events are controlled or decreed by God in the sense that God foresees them and allows them to occur and realizes His purposes through them.

Thus one might think it better to define theological determinism in terms of divine causation, as Derk Pereboom does when he characterizes his view as “the position that God is the sufficient active cause of everything in creation, whether directly or by way of secondary causes” (2011, p. 262). The problem here is that some thinkers who seem committed to theological determinism deny that God should be considered a cause at all, at least in any univocal sense as creatures are. Herbert McCabe, for instance, maintains that when we act freely, we are not caused to act by anyone or anything other than ourselves (1987, p. 12). This is not because McCabe thinks that our free actions are undetermined by God, but because he thinks that God is not an “existent among others,” as created causes are (1987, p. 14). Thinkers like McCabe sometimes appeal to Thomas Aquinas’ doctrine of analogy in explaining their view. According to this doctrine, as Austin Farrer explains it, God’s providential activity cannot be conceived in causal terms without “degrade[ing] it to the creaturely level and plac[ing] it in the field of interacting causalities”—the results of which can only be “monstrosity and confusion” (1967, p. 62). If the views of such Thomists are to count as versions of theological determinism, then we need a way of spelling out the view in non-causal terms.

Perhaps, then, theological determinism will have to be defined in terms of God’s decree or will or control after all; but if so, these concepts will have to be defined so as to rule out indeterministic interpretations. We might, for instance, take Feinberg’s definition of an “unconditional” decree as one “based on nothing outside of God that move[s] him to choose one thing or another” (2001, p. 527) and then characterize theological determinism as the view that God unconditionally decrees every event that occurs in the history of the world. Such a view would exclude the possibility that God merely permits some events which He foresees will happen in some circumstances but which He does not Himself determine.

2. Arguments for Theological Determinism

a. Divine Foreknowledge

One of the divine attributes that has been appealed to in arguments for theological determinism is God’s knowledge of future events, or (simple) foreknowledge. Numerous biblical passages support the idea that God knows all that the future holds, including the free choices of human beings. For instance, the New Testament records Jesus’ prophesies that Judas will betray him and that Peter will deny him three times; and in the Hebrew Bible, the psalmist declares to God, “In your book were written all the days that were formed for me, when none of them as yet existed” (Psalm 29). Furthermore, if we assume that there are truths about the future to be known (a question discussed below), then exhaustive divine foreknowledge—that is, God’s foreknowledge of every future event—may be thought to follow from considerations of perfect being theology, since to not know some truth would seem to be an imperfection.

But if God knows the future exhaustively, theological determinists argue, then all future events must be determined, directly or indirectly, by God. The reasoning they offer in support of this argument can be considered in two steps. First is the claim that for a future event e to be known at some time t (say, “in the beginning”), e must be determined at or prior to t. Otherwise, there would be no truth about e to be known at t. The second claim is that if all future events are determined from the beginning of time, they must ultimately be so by God, since nothing else existed in the beginning to determine them. This is not to say that God’s knowledge is causal, in the sense that simply by knowing something, God is the cause of that thing. Rather, proponents of this line of reasoning contend that God cannot know a proposition unless it is true; and the proposition that some event will occur cannot be true at some time, unless that event is determined by that time; but then if God knows that some event will occur when nothing but God exists, it must be God Himself who ultimately determines the event’s occurrence.

Various responses to this sort of argument, for the incompatibility of divine foreknowledge and undetermined events, have been offered in the history of theology. One popular reply first made by Boethius is to deny that God knows anything at some time, since God exists outside of time altogether and knows all things from an eternal perspective. Another response, inspired by William of Ockham, is to grant the possibility of temporal divine knowledge but deny that what God foreknows must be determined by God. Alvin Plantinga (1986), for instance, has argued that creatures can have a sort of counterfactual power over God’s past knowledge, such that they make it the case that God knows what they themselves determine.

One final, more radical response to this argument is to deny that God has exhaustive foreknowledge. Defenders of open theism, who take this route, maintain that God leaves some future events undetermined, and so does not know exactly what the future holds. This is not to say that God is not omniscient. Rather, according to some open theists, propositions about undetermined events are simply not true (or false) before those events occur; or, according to others, there are true propositions about undetermined events, but they are in principle unknowable. Either way, open theists maintain that it is not a real limitation on God not to know what it is impossible to know, and so the denial of exhaustive foreknowledge is compatible with the affirmation that God is a supremely perfect being.

None of these responses to the argument for theological determinism just described are without their critics, however. In reply to the Boethian proposal, questions have been raised about the coherence of the claim that God—a personal being who acts—exists altogether outside of time. Furthermore, the appeal to divine eternality may not even solve the problem, since a parallel argument for theological determinism can be constructed on the assumption that God knows timelessly all that the future—considered from our perspective—holds. Likewise, in reply to the Ockhamist solution, some have questioned whether there is any real distinction between counterfactual power over God’s knowledge of the past and the power to bring about the past, the latter of which seems problematic if not impossible. Finally, many philosophers reject the open theist claim that there are propositions about the future that are neither true nor false, since such a claim requires the denial of the widely accepted principle of bivalence. And the alternative open theist view, that there are true propositions about the future that are unknowable by God, seems to call into question divine omniscience. Furthermore, many theists reject open theism as unorthodox and incompatible with divine sovereignty and providential care of creation—an issue to be discussed below.

b. Divine Providence

In addition to attributing to God exhaustive foreknowledge—or knowledge of all that will happen in the future—many theists are also committed to the claim (explicitly or implicitly, in virtue of other things they believe) that God has exhaustive knowledge of counterfactual conditionals, or facts about what would happen if circumstances were different than they in fact are. One famous biblical example of such knowledge is found in the Hebrew Bible, when David consults God about a rumor he has heard:

David said, “O Lord, the God of Israel, your servant has heard that Saul seeks to come to Keilah, to destroy the city on my account. And now, will Saul come down as your servant has heard?…” The Lord said, “He will come down.” Then David said, “Will the men of Keilah surrender me and my men into the hand of Saul?” The Lord said, “They will surrender you.” (1 Samuel 23: 10-12, N.R.S.V.)

Upon hearing this news, David and his men decide to leave Keilah, and thus Saul, learning that David has left, never ends up going there himself, and the men of Keilah never have the chance to surrender David to him. Thus the truths that the Lord revealed to David are of the counterfactual sort: if David had remained in Keilah, Saul would have sought him there; and if Saul had sought him there, the men of Keilah would have surrendered David to Saul.

Some philosophers have argued that exhaustive divine knowledge of such counterfactual conditionals is essential to God’s perfection—in particular, to God’s sovereignty and providential care for creation—and that such knowledge entails theological determinism. The argument has centered on what are called “counterfactuals of freedom,” or those counterfactual conditionals about what a possible created person (who may or may not ever exist) would freely do in a possible circumstance (which may or may not ever occur). The free actions in question are supposed to be libertarian, or those that are not determined, either by a prior state of the world or by God. Luis de Molina considered knowledge of such counterfactuals to be part of God’s scientia media, or middle knowledge, standing in between God’s “natural knowledge,” or knowledge of God’s own nature and the necessary truths that follow from it, and “free knowledge,” or knowledge of God’s will and the contingent truths that follow from it. Molina claimed that, like the propositions included in God’s natural knowledge, counterfactuals of freedom are pre-volitional, or (logically) prior to, and thus independent of, God’s will; though like the propositions included in God’s free knowledge, they are contingent truths.

One way to reconstruct the line of reasoning from divine knowledge of counterfactual conditionals to theological determinism is thus as follows:

If there are any events in the history of the world that are not determined by God, then—contra Molina—God cannot have exhaustive knowledge of counterfactual conditionals.
If God lacks exhaustive knowledge of counterfactual conditionals, then God take risks with creation.
A God who takes risks with creation is not perfect.
Therefore, since God is perfect, God must determine every event in the history of the world.

Robert Adams has argued in favor of the first premise, focusing in particular on the possibility of God’s knowledge of counterfactuals of freedom. Adams contends that for God to know a proposition, it must have a truth-value; but counterfactuals of freedom lack truth-values, since there is nothing that could ground their truth. While the consequent of a conditional may follow from the antecedent by logical or causal necessity, neither sort of necessity can ground the truth of a conditional about how a person would act if placed in a particular circumstance, if that action is undetermined. And features of a person that do not necessitate her action—such as her particular beliefs and desires—cannot ground the truth of counterfactual conditionals about her action, precisely because such features are non-necessitating. Adams suggests that divine foreknowledge may not face the same grounding problem as middle knowledge, since categorical predictions about undetermined events “can be true by corresponding to the actual occurrence of the event that they predict” (1987, p. 80). But in the case of counterfactual conditionals, there may never be actual events to which the propositions correspond.

Supposing Adams is right that middle knowledge is impossible, what would divine providence look like without it, on the assumption that God does not determine some events in the world? One might think that all God really needs to providentially govern the world is foreknowledge. Yet William Hasker has argued “foreknowledge without middle knowledge—simple foreknowledge—does not offer the benefits for the doctrine of providence that its adherents have sought to derive from it” (1989, p. 19). His reasoning, in brief, is that foreknowledge is about what will actually happen in the world God has created, and so will be useless to God in deciding what to create to begin with or how to arrange events throughout history for the benefit of creatures. Consider, for example, the biblical case discussed above, in which David consults God to determine the best strategy for avoiding capture by Saul. If God had only simple foreknowledge and not middle knowledge, then God could only tell David what he would in fact do, and what Saul’s response would in fact be, and not what better or worse outcomes might result from alternative courses of action. Likewise—and perhaps more worrisome—before creating the world, God could not know without middle knowledge whether, if He gave creatures the libertarian freedom to decide whether to enter a loving relationship with Him and their fellow creatures, any of them would indeed choose to do so. Thus, creating a world with such indeterministic events is risky business for God. In contrast, the view in which God determines all events of the world can be considered a risk-free view of providence.

While Hasker goes on to defend the risky view of providence, others have criticized it as inconsistent with divine perfection. Edwin Curley (2003) has argued that it involves a kind of recklessness inconsistent with the providential wisdom and concern for creatures that is supposed to be characteristic of a perfect Creator. Focusing in particular on indeterminism at the level of human action, Curley points out that a God who gave creatures libertarian freedom without knowing how they would use it would run the risk of their destroying themselves and thwarting God’s purposes for creation. Thomas Flint similarly argues for the superiority of the risk-free view of providence by means of a parental analogy. Imagine, he says, that a parent has two options for her child: under Option One, the child may struggle and seem to be in danger, but the parent will “know with certainty that she will freely develop into a good and happy human being who leads a full and satisfying life”; under Option Two, in contrast, the parent will have no idea how things will turn out for the child, and can only hope for the best. Flint says he would, without hesitation, choose Option One, and that the claim that Option Two is preferable is “just short of absurd” (1998, p. 106). Likewise, he suggests, the claim that a risk-taking God is superior to, or even on par with, a risk-avoiding one is incredible.

If the above line of reasoning is correct, then it follows that a supremely perfect God would not create a world in which events were left undetermined. However, the argument has been questioned on a number of points. With respect to Adams’ argument against the possibility of middle knowledge, at least two assumptions are open to doubt. First, it is unclear whether, for a proposition to have truth-value, there must be something that grounds its truth. Francisco Suárez, an early follower of Molina, seemed to question this claim. Richard Gaskin has as well, maintaining that there is nothing that grounds the truth of any proposition, and that to suppose otherwise “is to slide into a substantial and implausible correspondence theory of truth” (1993, pp. 424-425).

Others, granting that true propositions may need grounding, have proposed possible grounds for counterfactuals of freedom. Alvin Plantinga, for instance, has suggested a parallel between counterfactuals of freedom and propositions about past events. He writes: “Suppose… that yesterday I freely performed some action A. What was or is it that grounded or founded my doing so?… Perhaps you will say that what grounds [the truth of the proposition that I did A] is just that in fact I did A” (1985, p. 378). Plantinga responds that the same kind of answer is available in the case of counterfactuals of freedom; for what grounds such truths is the fact that certain people (actual or possible) are such that if they were put in certain circumstances, they would do certain things.

Other theists who accept that God lacks exhaustive knowledge of counterfactual conditionals question whether this entails that God lacks the sort of providential control over creation essential to His perfection. David Hunt has argued, contra Hasker, that simple foreknowledge can in fact give God a “providential advantage,” allowing Him to “secure results” that He would not be able to secure without such knowledge (2009). If with simple foreknowledge God can thus ensure His central purposes for creation, perhaps the charge that theological indeterminism entails risk-taking with respect to less significant outcomes will not have so much sting.

Alternatively, one may argue with open theists that the risky view of providence involves divine virtues such as experimentation, collaboration, responsiveness, and vulnerability, and that it is the only way to secure the great metaphysical and moral value of creatures with libertarian freedom. One way to put this latter point is in terms of Flint’s parental analogy. After noting that he would of course choose (risk-free) Option One if he could, Flint says, “the fact that we don’t have a choice here, that we as parents are stuck with [risky] Option Two, is one of the things that is especially frustrating (and even terrifying) about being a parent” (1998a, p. 106). An open theist convinced of the impossibility of middle knowledge might respond that this must similarly be what is especially frustrating (and even terrifying!) about being God—that Option One is not available, so that if God wants to create persons with libertarian freedom, He must opt for Option Two. But just as a parent still chooses to give birth to a child, so God still chooses to bring into being such creatures, because of their great value.

c. Divine Aseity

A third argument for theological determinism focuses on the divine attribute of aseity. The word aseity which comes from the Latin phrase a se—“from itself”—refers to God’s absolute independence from anything distinct from Himself. While some have taken divine aseity to be the most fundamental feature of our conception of God, others have suggested that it follows from God’s perfection, since to be dependent on another would seem to be an imperfection (Brower 2011). Closely related to the concept of divine aseity is the medieval conception of God as pure act (actus purus). What medieval thinkers meant by saying that God is pure act is that He is always complete in Himself—always “all that He can be.” In contrast, in created beings there is potentiality and passivity, meaning that they are not all that they can be, but can be changed and acted on by others.

On the basis of considerations of God’s aseity and pure actuality, Reginald Garrigou-Lagrange has offered an argument for theological determinism. For, he says, those who maintain that there are some events that God does not determine—for instance, human choices—must posit “a passivity in the pure Act. If the divine causality is not predetermining with regard to our choice… the divine knowledge is fatally determined by it. To wish to limit the universal causality and absolute independence of God, necessarily brings one to place a passivity in Him” (1936, p. 538). To illustrate his point, Garrigou-Lagrange asks us to imagine that when God gives two men grace to fight temptation, one cooperates with this grace while the other does not, but that the difference between their responses is not determined by God. Supposing that God can foreknow the two men’s responses to His grace, theological indeterminists must admit that “the foreknowledge is passive,” just as a person’s knowledge is passive when she is a mere spectator to some event (1936, pp. 538-539). What Garrigou-Lagrange seems to mean by this suggestive phrasing is that God’s intellect would be passive, in the sense that in coming to know what the two men will do, God’s intellect would be acted upon by something outside of it. Garrigou-Lagrange concludes:

God is either determining or determined, there is no other alternative. His knowledge of free conditional futures is measured by things, or else it measures them by reason of the accompanying decree of the divine will. Our salutary choices, as such, in the intimacy of their free determination, depend upon God, or it is He, the sovereignly independent pure Act, who depends upon us. (1936, p. 546)

In response to this argument for theological determinism, Eleonore Stump contends that the dilemma presented by Garrigou-Lagrange—that God either determines or is determined—is a false one, if determination is taken to be equivalent to causation. She offers examples of both divine and human knowledge in which the knower neither determines what she knows, nor is determined by it. On the human side, a person might know that an animal is a substance, but the human obviously does not determine this truth. And (on Thomas Aquinas’ view of human cognition—which Garrigou-Lagrange would presumably accept) neither is the human rendered passive, or determined in her knowledge of this truth, since the human intellect’s operations are active in the process of deriving it, and nothing acts on the intellect “with causal efficacy” in this process. Likewise, on the divine side, God presumably knows of His own existence without determining that He exists; but neither, presumably, is God determined in His knowledge of this truth (2003, pp. 120-121).

One thing to note about the examples offered by Stump—of a human knowing that an animal is a substance, or of God knowing that He exists—is that the truths known are in both cases necessary. One question that a theological determinist might raise is whether, when it comes to knowledge of contingent events, the indeterminist can likewise maintain that the knower neither determines nor is determined by what she knows. While our coming to know necessary truths on the basis of, say, complex mathematical reasoning would seem to be quite an active process, our coming to know contingent truths on the basis of some very clear and distinct perception—say, that we have hands—would seem to be more passive. If this is right, then the theological determinist might maintain that if God’s knowledge of undetermined future events is quasi-perceptual, then God might indeed be rendered passive by such knowledge. Furthermore, even if the theological indeterminist can defend a conception of divine foreknowledge on which God is not determined by some of what He knows, in the sense that He is not caused to know some truths, it is very hard to see how He would not in some sense be dependent on something outside of Himself for that knowledge. The question for theological indeterminists is whether this sense of dependency is compatible with a conception of God as supremely perfect.

3. Theological Determinism and Human Freedom

So far we have considered arguments that theological determinists have put forward in support of their view of divine providence, as well as some objections raised to these arguments. Critics of theological determinism not only object to the positive reasons offered in favor of the view, but also to certain negative implications. One major issue theological determinists must grapple with is how there can be any creaturely freedom in a world in which all events are determined by God. The claim that at least some creatures are both free and responsible for their actions is a central part of traditional Western theisms—Judaism, Christianity, and Islam—and most contemporary theological determinists affirm this claim, though as we will see, some within these traditions dissent from it. Below, several theological deterministic conceptions of human freedom are discussed.

a. Standard Compatibilism

Perhaps the most common conception of free will espoused by theological determinists is the standard compatibilist one: that determinism of any sort—whether theological (that is, determination by God) or natural (that is, determination by antecedent events in accordance with the laws of nature)–does not automatically rule out free will. Theological determinists espousing this view often appeal to secular theories of freedom and arguments for the compatibility of such freedom with natural determinism to support their claim that theological determinism is also compatible with free will. For instance, according to the classic compatibilist position defended by Thomas Hobbes, a person is free to the extent that she finds no impediment to doing what she wants or wills to do.

Contemporary compatibilists, recognizing the limitations of this position—for example that it allows for actions resulting from brainwashing to be free—have offered various refinements, such as that, in addition to being able to do what one wants or wills to do, one must act with sensitivity to certain rational considerations (the reasons-responsive view), or one must have the will one wants to have (the hierarchical model). One proponent of the latter view is Lynn Rudder Baker. According to Baker, “Person S has compatibilist free will for a choice or action if:

1. S wills X,
2. S wants to will X,
3. S wills X because she wants to will X, and
4. S would still have willed X even if she (herself) had known the provenance of her wanting to will X.” (2003, p. 467)

Baker notes that her account is compatibilist in the sense that “a person S’s having free will with respect to an action (or choice) A is compatible with A’s being caused ultimately by factors outside of S’s control.” She makes no distinction, with respect to the question of an agent’s freedom, whether the agent’s action is caused “by God or by natural events” (2003, pp. 460-461). More generally, theological determinists point out that on all such contemporary compatibilist accounts of free will, divine determination does not automatically rule out human freedom, since none of these accounts specifies what must be true of the first causes of human volition and action. This lack of specificity, however, is precisely the problem that incompatibilists—those who hold that determinism of any sort is incompatible with free will—find with the compatibilist position. They reason that if either God or events of the distant past are the ultimate causes of our actions, then our actions are not under our control. The debate between compatibilists and incompatibilists has a long history, and is ongoing. See “Free Will” for a more in-depth summary.

b. Theological-but-not-Natural Compatibilism

While many theological determinists take the standard compatibilist line, some differentiate between natural and theological determinism, and maintain that only the latter is compatible with free will. Defenders of this position, who might be called “theological-but-not-natural-compatibilists,” appeal to a number of differences between theological and natural determinism to support their view. Hugh McCann, for instance, argues that in contrast to the way in which events that we bring about come to pass, “the manner in which our actions come to pass is not one in which God acts upon us or does anything to us” (2005, p. 145). McCann maintains that God’s causing our actions is like an author’s creating the characters of a novel. He writes: “The author of a novel never makes her creatures do something; she only makes them doing it. It is the same between us and God” (2005, p. 146).

McCann should not be interpreted as denying theological determinism here—that is, as saying that God does not determine what creatures do, but only what they are. Rather, he means that, unlike creatures who can only make other creatures do things, God has the unique ability to make creatures themselves; and rather than first bringing creatures into being, and then making them do certain things, God by one and the same act makes creatures doing the things they do. McCann contends that because of such differences between divine and creaturely causation, theological determinism “does not endanger our freedom” as natural determinism does (2005, p. 146).

However, theological compatibilism, like its natural counterpart, has been criticized by standard incompatibilists. One of the most influential arguments for the incompatibility of causal determinism and human freedom—the Consequence argument—relies on the premise that, in a deterministic world, the ultimate causes of our actions are events of the distant past. The reason why this is considered a problem, though, is simply that such causes lie outside of our control. So if the Consequence argument establishes the incompatibility of free will and natural determinism, a parallel argument appealing to the fact that God’s will, taken as a determining cause, likewise lies outside of our control should establish the incompatibility of free will and theological determinism. To put the point differently, it seems that those who hold that God’s determination of our actions is both causal, and compatible with human freedom, ought to be standard compatibilists about determinism and free will, rather than theological-but-not-natural compatibilists, since the differentiating features of natural determining causes pose no additional threat to free will, once one accepts that God’s determining causation is compatible with human freedom.

c. Libertarianism

While the theological determinists described above, who maintain that theological determinism is compatible with human freedom while natural determinism is not, suggest various differences between divine and natural determination, they still recognize God’s determination as a species of causation. As mentioned already, however, some who seem to espouse theological determinism deny that God should be considered a cause at all, at least in any univocal sense as creatures are. Writing in this tradition, Michael Hoonhout applauds Aquinas for intentionally discussing the doctrine of divine providence twice in his Summa Theologiae—first in the context of “the essence of God” and then in the context of “the nature of creation”—in recognition of “two radically different orders of intelligibility.” He maintains that “double affirmations which seemingly contradict each other are to be expected” if we respect the integrity of each order (2002, pp. 4-6).

The seemingly contradictory “double affirmations” to which Hoonhout refers are that God determines everything that occurs in the world, and that humans have a non-deterministic form of freedom. Thus one finds some theologians who seem clearly committed to theological determinism when considering the order of the Creator, speaking of the possibility of libertarian human freedom in the context of the order of creation. Kathyrn Tanner, for instance, maintains a view of divine causation as absolute in terms of both its range (“all inclusive or universally extensive”) and its efficacy (“cannot be hindered, diverted, or otherwise redirected by creatures”). Tanner claims that since “God does not bring about the human agent’s choice by intervening in the created order as some sort of supernatural cause,” one can “still affirm a very strong libertarian version of the human being’s freedom” (1994, pp. 113, 125, 126).

The trouble with such a view, however, is that it seems to face a dilemma. On the one hand, if the way in which God determines events in the world is really nothing like the way creaturely causes do, such that even fundamental concepts like conditional necessity do not apply to the relationship between God’s causal activity and its effects, then, as Thomas Tracy points out (1994), analogy collapses into equivocation, and we are left without any idea of what theological determinism is supposed to mean. On the other hand, if such fundamental concepts do apply to divine causation in something like the way they apply to creaturely causation, then arguments against the compatibility of theological determinism and human freedom must be considered and responded to, rather than simply dismissed as involving a confusion of categories.

d. Hard Determinism

One final position that theological determinists may adopt on the issue of human freedom is the standard incompatibilist one, admitting that determinism of any sort is incompatible with free will and thus that there can be no creaturely freedom. This view, called hard theological determinism, has historically won few adherents, in part because of the centrality of the belief in human freedom to so much civic and religious life. On the civic side, the assumption of free will has been thought to underwrite reactive attitudes such as resentment, indignation, gratitude, and love, and the moral and legal practices of praise and blame, reward and punishment. On the religious side, human freedom has seemed crucial to the logic of divine commandment and judgment, and to such reactive attitudes and practices as guilt, repentance, and forgiveness.

However, some hard theological determinists have challenged such assumptions about the centrality of free will. Derk Pereboom, for instance, has argued that, while theological determinism is not compatible with the basic sense of desert (that is, deserving praise or blame simply because of the moral status of what one has done) it is compatible with judgments of value (for example, that behavior is good or bad), as well as the reactive attitudes and practices which are most central to traditional theism, and which might seem to presuppose basic desert. For instance, a person without free will might still recognize that she has failed to act according to the principles she believes she should live by, and so experience guilt; or, she might resolve to no longer hold another’s past behavior as a reason to remain at odds with him, and so forgive. Pereboom suggests that God’s commanding and judging, rewarding and punishing may serve the moral formation of creatures even without free will, and so may be justified without it. However, some critics have questioned whether such religiously significant attitudes and practices as repentance and the resolution to amend one’s life can really be secured without a sense of either basic desert or the sort of agential control which hard theological determinists deny. Furthermore, even if hard theological determinism is compatible with such attitudes and practices central to theistic traditions, it is another question whether the denial of free will and moral responsibility in the basic-desert sense is itself compatible with the teachings of these religions. One question that remains for hard Christian determinists, for example, is how to make sense of the many New Testament passages that discuss the freedom found in Christ (cf. Galatians 5:1, 2 Corinthians 3:17).

4. Theological Determinism and Divine Responsibility for Evil

Besides explaining how, on their view, humans can be free and responsible for their own actions (or how the denial of human freedom is compatible with traditional theism), theological determinists must also face questions about God’s moral responsibility for the evil in the world that, on their view, He determines. As with the former issue, their responses to the latter are many and varied. Below a number of distinct responses are discussed.

a. Theodicies and Defenses

Some theists attempt to offer a theodicy, or plausible explanation of why God has created a world in which evil exists. Others, uncertain of what God’s actual reasons are, propose instead a defense, or possible explanation. One historic and popular explanation of why evil exists in a world created by God is the free will defense, first proposed by St. Augustine and developed by Alvin Plantinga (1974). According to this defense, the evil we witness in God’s creation is not in fact God’s doing at all, but the result of humans’ misuse of their own freedom: God created humans to live in harmony with Himself and each other, but they freely chose to rebel against God and to sin against one another. Some proponents of this defense extend it to explain natural as well as moral evil, suggesting that all suffering in the world is ultimately due to sinful choices of fallen creatures, some of which lie behind the destructive natural forces of the world. However, the free will defense seems to assume that it was impossible for God both to create free persons and to determine all of their actions, such that they never do evil. In other words, it seems to assume an indeterministic conception of human freedom incompatible with theological determinism. Thus, the traditional free will defense would not seem to be an option for theological determinists.

Some compatibilists have argued, however, that the free will defense need not presuppose an indeterministic conception of human freedom. Jason Turner, for instance, suggests that if “free actions can be determined but must not be dependent on another’s will”—a view he calls “independent compatibilism”—then the free will defense may still be open to theological determinists (2003, p. 131). On independent compatibilism, whether God could create a world with free persons who were determined in their actions and never committed moral evil depends on whether God would create such a world because the persons never committed evil, or for some other reason. Supposing that the reason God would create a world in which persons who were determined in their actions never committed moral evil was indeed because they never committed evil, their actions would be dependent on God’s will, and so would not be free.

While there thus may be some versions of the free will defense open to the theological determinist, such versions require metaphysical assumptions that may seem implausible—for instance, that events in the causal history of an agent’s action occurring before she was even born may determine whether her (determined) actions are free or not, and that whether an event depends on God’s will in a freedom-undermining way depends on what God’s reasons were for causing it. Still, theological determinists may argue that even the traditional indeterministic version of the free will defense is implausible, and that more plausible explanations of evil are available. John Hick, for instance, contends that, given a modern understanding of evolutionary theory, the claim that humans were created perfect and fell from grace is an incredible one. Inspired by the writings of St. Irenaeus, Hick proposes instead the soul-making theodicy, according to which God created imperfect creatures in a world in which they are prone to suffering and sin. He argues that it is not the freedom of creatures, per se, which is so valuable as to outweigh these evils, but rather their development, morally and spiritually, through struggle, suffering, trial and temptation, and the virtuous characters which result from “the investment of costly personal effort” (2010, p. 256). While Hick is himself committed to theological indeterminism, his basic theodicy is compatible with theological determinism as well.

Two other theodicies that theological determinists have adopted likewise focus on the value of development or process. Eleonore Stump has suggested that a world of sin and suffering is “most conducive” to bringing about both humans’ willingness to receive the gift of salvation from God and also their subsequent sanctification (1985, p. 409). While Stump holds that human freedom is incompatible with theological (and natural) determinism, and that receiving the gift of salvation and undergoing the process of sanctification both require free will, Derk Pereboom contends that “no feature of [her] account demands libertarian freedom, nor even a notion of free will of the sort required for moral responsibility… It is sufficient that this change [the turning to God on the occasion of suffering] is seriously valuable, and that it results in more intimate relationship with God” (2015). Marilyn McCord Adams, likewise, has proposed that participating in evil might facilitate creatures’ identification with Christ and union with God (1999). Such work on theodicy has drawn on specifically Christian conceptions of God and the human good, and advanced them in innovative ways. Yet, these proposals raise many questions about the value of process—developing moral character, becoming sanctified, or coming to identify with God—as well as the comparative value of such processes with the disvalue of the sin and suffering that make them possible.

b. Causing vs. Permitting Evil

Even supposing the disvalue of all sin and suffering in the world is outweighed by the value of the moral development of creatures, another concern critics have raised is whether it is morally permissible for God to cause humans to sin in order to realize some good. Peter Byrne, in response to Paul Helm’s deterministic theodicy, asks:

How does it square with the Pauline injunction that one should not do evil that good may come of it? The place of that injunction in traditional moral theology is to set limits to how far we can pursue good by way of doing evil as its precondition. There are some acts that are so heinous that one may not do them for the sake of the bringing about a greater good…. One may not murder that good may come of it. But Helm’s God has precisely planned, purposed, and necessitated acts of murder and instances of other kinds of horrendous wickedness so that good may come of them. (2008, p. 200)

In response, some theological determinists have argued that the difference between God’s causing humans to commit sin for the purpose of realizing some good (the theological determinist’s view), and knowing that humans would sin if they were created in particular circumstances and choosing to create them in those circumstances anyway, for the purpose of realizing some good (the Molinist view), is morally insignificant. Indeed, theological determinists contend, even the open theist’s view, according to which God allows horrendous evil that He could prevent—presumably for the purpose of realizing some good—raises similar questions about God’s moral responsibility for evil. So, they maintain, this concern about divine responsibility should not be a reason to reject theological determinism in favor of such competing views of divine providence.

c. God not a Moral Agent

While some theological determinists offer theodicies or defenses in attempt to demonstrate that there is some actual or possible reason for evil which morally justifies God in creating it, others eschew such explanations altogether. Some argue that they are unnecessary, on the grounds God cannot, in principle, be morally responsible for anything, since He is above or beyond morality altogether. One line of argument for this conclusion is based on the idea that morality depends on God’s will and command, and that God is not Himself subject to the commandments that He establishes. Morality, on this view, only applies to creatures, over which God has ultimate moral authority. One problem facing such a divine command theory of morality is the familiar Euthyphro problem—that if God’s commandments determine the content of morality, then morality is arbitrary, such that what is right might have been wrong and vice versa if God had willed that it be so. Another implication of this argument that many theists find difficult to accept is that, if God cannot in principle be morally blameworthy since He is above morality, then He cannot be morally praiseworthy either.

d. Sin not Blameworthy

An alternative response to the question of how God could not be blameworthy for causing humans to sin is the hard theological determinist one. As discussed above, hard theological determinists maintain that, since God causes all events in creation, humans are not free or morally responsible in the basic desert sense. As Derk Pereboom notes, it follows on this view that since humans are not blameworthy for their actions, God is not the cause of blameworthy actions. Thus, God’s causing human sin is more similar to His causing natural evils, such as animal predation and its associated sufferings, than it is to His causing moral evils, traditionally understood. Since most theists agree that God has control over all such natural forces, the problem of natural evil poses no more difficulty for the theological determinist than for the theological indeterminist. However, this hard deterministic response to the problem of moral evil is compatible with the offering of a theodicy or defense particular to human sin, as well as with the appeal to skeptical theism discussed below.

e. Skeptical Theism

One final response to the problem of evil that theological determinists make is to admit that they are unable to think of reasons that would justify God in creating a world with the sort and extent of evil that we see, but nevertheless to maintain that such an inability should not be taken as good evidence that there is no divine justification for evil. This is the response offered by skeptical theists, so named because of their skepticism about their own ability to discern God’s reasons for creating and governing the world as He does. Several lines of reasoning have been offered for this position, ranging from arguments from analogy, likening the cognitive distance between us and God to that between a very young child and her parents, to arguments focusing on the massive complexity of the causal networks in the world, and our inability to comprehend how actual and possible goods and evils are connected. The view has also been subject to various objections, regarding purported negative implications of the view for theological knowledge and trust in God, and moral deliberation and action. The debate regarding these issues is ongoing, and the interested reader should see Skeptical Theism for more information.

While skeptical theism is a response to the problem of evil available to theological determinists and indeterminists alike, theological determinists who embrace the view must grapple with further issues. Like those offering a theodicy or defense, theological determinists who maintain their justified ignorance of God’s reasons must still come to terms with the fact that, on their view, evil is not merely permitted but determined by God. This would seem to lead to a sort of double-mindedness specifically about the value of moral evil in the world. It is, after all, central to religious practice to strive to see the events in one’s life from God’s perspective, and to value them as God would, in His wisdom and benevolence. Thus, if some horrendous evil—say, severe child abuse—is divinely determined, then one ought to strive to accept, and even embrace it as instrumental to God’s purposes and so for the greater good. Such an attempt, however, would seem to be in serious tension with a teaching central to the traditional theism, that moral evil is opposed by God, and should be opposed by humans as well.

5. References and Further Reading

Adams, Marilyn McCord (1999). Horrendous Evils and the Goodness of God. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
- Contains proposal that experience of evil might facilitate humans’ identification with Christ and union with God.
Adams, Robert (1987). “Middle Knowledge and the Problem of Evil.” The Virtue of Faith and Other Essays in Philosophical Theology. New York: Oxford University Press.
- Raises grounding objection against the possibility of middle knowledge.
Baker, Lynn Rudder (2003). “Why Christians Should Not Be Libertarians: An Augustinian Challenge.” Faith and Philosophy, Vol. 20 No. 4, pp. 460-478.
- Argues for compatibilism on the basis of tradition, and offers standard compatibilist account of free will.
Basinger, David and Randall Basinger (1986). Predestination and Free Will: Four Views of Divine Sovereignty and Human Freedom. Downers Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press.
- Contains discussion of how embracing theological determinism might shape one’s personal deliberations and decision-making.
Boethius (1969). The Consolation of Philosophy. Trans. V. E. Watts. New York: Penguin Books.
- Contains proposal of divine timelessness as resolution to the problem of divine foreknowledge and human freedom.
Brower, Jeffrey (2011). “Simplicity and Aseity.” The Oxford Handbook of Philosophical Theology. Ed. Flint, Thomas and Michael Rea. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Defines aseity and summarizes argument for theological determinism on the basis of aseity.
Byrne, Peter (2008). “Helm’s God and the Authorship of Sin.” Reason, Faith and History: Philosophical Essays for Paul Helm. Ed. M. W. F. Stone. Burlington, VT: Ashgate.
- Raises concern that Helm’s theological determinism commits him to the claim that God “plans, purposes, and values moral evil.”
Curley, Edwin (2003). “The Incoherence of Christian Theism.” The Harvard Review of Philosophy, Vol. 11, pp. 74-100.
- Contains argument that the risky view of providence is incompatible with divine wisdom and care for creation.
Farrer, Austin (1967). Faith and Speculation. London: A. and C. Black.
- Explicates the doctrine of analogy and its implications for the “paradox” of divine agency and human freedom.
Feinberg, John S. (2001). No One Like Him. Wheaton, IL: Crossway Books.
- Defends theological determinism on biblical, theological, and philosophical grounds, and responds to a number of objections to the view.
Flint, Thomas (1998). Divine Providence: The Molinist Account. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
- Contains argument for superiority of the risk-free over the risky view of providence.
Gaskin, Richard (1993). “Conditionals of Freedom and Middle Knowledge.” The Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 43, No. 173, pp. 412-430.
- Argues against claim that counterfactuals of freedom need grounds.
Garrigou-Lagrange, R. (1936). God, His Existence and His Nature: A Thomistic Solution of Certain Agnostic Antinomies, Vol. 2. Trans. Rose, Dom Bebe. London: B. Herder Book Co.
- Contains argument for theological determinism on the basis of God’s aseity.
Hasker, William (1985). “Foreknowledge and Necessity,” Faith and Philosophy, Vol. 2 No. 2, pp. 121-156.
- Criticizes Plantinga’s distinction between counterfactual power over the past and the power to bring about the past.
Hasker, William (1989). God, Time and Knowledge. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
- Contains argument that simple foreknowledge is providentially useless to God.
Helm, Paul (1993). The Providence of God. Downers Grove, IL: InterVarsity Press.
- Contains arguments for the “risk-free” view of providence on the basis of divine knowledge and goodness.
Hick, John (2010). Evil and the God of Love. New York: Harper and Row.
- Contains explication and defense of the soul-making theodicy.
Hoonhout, Michael (2002). “Grounding Providence in the Theology of the Creator: The Exemplarity of Thomas Aquinas.” The Heythrop Journal, Vol. 43, No. 1, pp. 1-19.
- Defends Aquinas’ seemingly contradictory “double affirmations” of divine causation and human freedom.
Hunt, David (2009). “The Providential Advantage of Divine Foreknowledge.” Arguing about Religion. Ed. Timpe, Kevin. New York: Routledge, pp. 374-385.
- Argues that simple foreknowledge enables God to secure results that He would not be able to secure without it.
McCann, Hugh (2005). “The Author of Sin?” Faith and Philosophy Vol. 22. No. 2, pp. 144-159.
- Argues that theological determinism does not endanger human freedom, as natural determinism does, and that God cannot do moral wrong, since morality is grounded in divine commands.
Pereboom, Derk (2011). “Theological Determinism and Divine Providence.” Molinism: The Contemporary Debate. Ed. Ken Perszyk. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 262-280.
- Defends compatibility of hard theological determinism and traditional theism.
Pereboom, Derk (2015). “Libertarianism and Theological Determinism.” Free Will and Theism: Connections, Contingencies, and Concerns. Ed. Timpe, Kevin and Dan Speak. Under contract with Oxford University Press.
- Offers response to the problem of evil compatible with hard theological determinism.
Plantinga, Alvin (1974). God, Freedom, and Evil. Grand Rapids, MI: Eerdmans.
- Develops a free will defense.
Plantinga, Alvin (1985). “Reply to Robert M. Adams.” Alvin Plantinga (Profiles. Vol. 5). Ed. Tomberlin, James and Peter van Inwagen. Dordrecht: D. Reidel, pp. 371-382.
- Contains proposal of possible grounds for counterfactuals of freedom.
Plantinga, Alvin (1986). “On Ockham’s Way Out.” Faith and Philosophy, Vol. 3 No. 3, pp. 235–269.
- Defends claim that humans have counterfactual power over God’s past knowledge.
Rogers, Katherin (2000). Perfect Being Theology. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press.
- Considers implications of the description of God as “that than which none greater can be conceived.”
Stump, Eleonore (1985). “The Problem of Evil.” Faith and Philosophy Vol. 2 No. 4, pp. 392-423.
- Contains proposal that sin and suffering facilitate human acceptance of saving grace and process of sanctification.
Stump, Eleonore (2003). Aquinas. New York: Routledge.
- Contains response to argument for theological determinism on the basis of divine aseity.
Tanner, Kathryn (1994). “Human Freedom, Human Sin, and God the Creator.” The God Who Acts: Philosophical and Theological Explorations. Ed. Thomas Tracy. University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press, pp. 111-135.
- Argues for the compatibility of universal divine causation and libertarian human freedom.
Tracy, Thomas (1994). “Divine Action, Created Causes, and Human Freedom.” The God Who Acts: Philosophical and Theological Explorations. Ed. Thomas Tracy. University Park: Pennsylvania State University Press, pp. 77-102.
- Contains critique of attempt to hold together theological determinism and libertarian human freedom.
Turner, Jason (2013). “Compatibilism and the Free Will Defense.” Faith and Philosophy. Vol. 30, No. 2, pp. 125-137.
- Offers version of free will defense compatible with theological determinism.
Vicens, Leigh (2012). “Divine Determinism, Human Freedom, and the Consequence Argument.” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 71:2, pp. 145-155.
- Argues that if natural determinism is incompatible with human freedom, so is theological determinism.
Zagzebski, Linda (2011). “Eternity and Fatalism.” God, Eternity, and Time. Ed. Christian Tapp. Aldershot: Ashgate Press.
- Argues that appeals to divine timelessness do not solve the problem of how divine foreknowledge is compatible with our ability to do otherwise. A parallel point can be made about the problem of how divine foreknowledge is compatible with indeterminism.

Author Information

Leigh Vicens
Email: lvicens@augie.edu
Augustana College
U. S. A.

Locke: Ethics

The major writings of John Locke (1632–1704) are among the most important texts for understanding some of the central currents in epistemology, metaphysics, politics, religion, and pedagogy in the late 17^th and early 18^th century in Western Europe. His magnum opus, An Essay Concerning Human Understanding (1689) is the undeniable starting point for the study of empiricism in the early modern period. Locke’s best-known political text, Two Treatises of Government (1693) criticizes the political system according to which kings rule by divine right (First Treatise) and lays the foundation for modern liberalism (Second Treatise). His Letter Concerning Toleration (1689) argues that much civil unrest is borne of the state trying to prevent the practice of different religions. In this text, Locke suggests that the proper domain of government does not include deciding which religious path the people ought to take for salvation—in short, it is an argument for the separation of church and state. Some Thoughts Concerning Education (1693) is a very influential text in early modern Europe that outlines the best way to rear children. It suggests that the virtue of a person is directly related to the habits of body and the habits of mind instilled in them by their educators.

Although these texts enjoy a status of “must-reads,” Locke’s views on ethics or moral philosophy have nowhere near the same high status. The reason for this is, in large part, that Locke never wrote a text devoted to the topic. This omission is surprising given that several of his friends entreated him to set down his thoughts about ethics. They saw that the scattered remarks that Locke makes about morality here and there throughout his works were, at times, quite provocative and in need of further development and defense. But, for reasons unknown to us, Locke never indulged his friends with a more systematic moral philosophy. It is thus up to his readers to stitch together his fragmented remarks about happiness, moral laws, freedom, and virtue in order to see what kind of moral philosophy is woven through the texts and to determine whether it is a coherent position.

Introduction
The Good
1. Pleasure and Pain
2. Happiness
The Law of Nature
Power, Freedom, and Suspending Desire
Living the Moral Life
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

While Locke did not write a treatise devoted to a discussion of ethics, there are strands of discussion of morality that weave through many, if not most, of his works. One such strand is evident near the end of his An Essay Concerning Human Understanding (hereafter: Essay) where he states that one of the most important aspects of improving our knowledge is to recognize the kinds of things that we can truly know. With this recognition, he says, we are able to finely-tune the focus of our enquiries for optimal results. And, he concludes, given the natural capacities of human beings, “Morality is the proper Science, and Business of Mankind in general” because human beings are both “concerned” and “fitted to search out their Summum Bonum [highest good]” (Essay, Book IV, chapter xii, section 11; hereafter: Essay, IV.xii.11). This claim indicates that Locke takes the investigation of morality to be of utmost importance and gives us good reason to think that Locke’s analysis of the workings of human understanding in general is intimately connected to discovering how the science proper to humankind is to be practiced. The content of the knowledge of ethics includes information about what we, as rational and voluntary agents, ought to do in order to obtain an end, in particular, the end of happiness. It is the science, Locke says, of using the powers that we have as human beings in order to act in such a way that we obtain things that are good and useful for us. As he says: ethics is “the seeking out those Rules, and Measures of humane Actions, which lead to Happiness, and the Means to practice them” (Essay, IV.xxi.3). So, there are several elements in the landscape of Locke’s ethics: happiness or the highest good as the end of human action; the rules that govern human action; the powers that command human action; and the ways and means by which the rules are practiced. While Locke lays out this conception of ethics in the Essay, not all aspects of his definition are explored in detail in that text. So, in order to get the full picture of how he understands each element of his description of ethics, we must often look to several different texts where they receive a fuller treatment. This means that Locke himself does not explain how these elements fit together leaving his overarching theory somewhat of a puzzle for future commentators to contemplate. But, by mining different texts in this way, we can piece together the details of an ethical theory that, while not always obviously coherent, presents a depth and complexity that, at minimum, confirms that this is a puzzle worth trying to solve.

2. The Good

a. Pleasure and Pain

The thread of moral discussion that weaves most consistently throughout the Essay is the subject of happiness. True happiness, on Locke’s account, is associated with the good, which in turn is associated with pleasure. Pleasure, in its turn, is taken by Locke to be the sole motive for human action. This means that the moral theory that is most directly endorsed in the Essay is hedonism.

On Locke’s view, ideas come to us by two means: sensation and reflection. This view is the cornerstone of his empiricism. According to this theory, there is no such thing as innate ideas or ideas that are inborn in the human mind. All ideas come to us by experience. Locke describes sensation as the “great source” of all our ideas and as wholly dependent on the contact between our sensory organs and the external world. The other source of ideas, reflection or “internal sense,” is dependent on the mind’s reflecting on its own operations, in particular the “satisfaction or uneasiness arising from any thought” (Essay, II.i.4). What’s more, Locke states that pleasure and pain are joined to almost all of our ideas both of sensation and of reflection (Essay, II.vii.2). This means that our mental content is organized, at least in one way, by ideas that are associated with pleasure and ideas that are associated with pain. That our ideas are associated with pains and pleasures seems compatible with our phenomenal experience: the contact between the sense organ of touch and a hot stove will result in an idea of the hot stove annexed by the idea of pain, or the act of remembering a romantic first kiss brings with it the idea of pleasure. And, Locke adds, it makes sense to join our ideas to the ideas of pleasure and pain because if our ideas were not joined with either pleasure of pain, we would have no reason to prefer the doing of one action over another, or the consideration of one idea over another. If this were our situation, we would have no reason to act—either physically or mentally (Essay, II.viii.3). That pleasure and pain are given this motivational role in action entails that Locke endorses hedonism: the pursuit of pleasure and the avoidance of pain are the sole motives for action.

Locke notes that among all the ideas that we receive by sensation and reflection, pleasure and pain are very important. And, he notes that the things that we describe as evil are no more than the things that are annexed to the idea of pain, and the things that we describe as good are no more than the things that are annexed to the idea of pleasure. In other words, the presence of good or evil is nothing other than the way a particular idea relates to us—either pleasurably or painfully. This means that on Locke’s view, good is just the category of things that tend to cause or increase pleasure or decrease pain in us, and evil is just the category of things that tend to cause or increase pain or decrease pleasure in us (Essay, II.xx.2). Now, we might think that, morally speaking, this way of defining good and evil gets Locke into trouble. Consider the following scenario. Smith enjoys breaking her promises. In other words, failing to honor her word brings her pleasure. According to the view just described, it seems that breaking promises, at least for Smith, is a good. For, if good and evil are defined as nothing more than pleasure and pain, it seems that if something gives Smith pleasure, it is impossible to deny that it is a good. This would be an unwelcome effect of Locke’s view, for it would indicate that his system leads directly to a kind of moral relativism. If promise breaking is pleasurable for Smith and promise keeping is pleasurable for her friend Jones and pleasure is the sign of the good, then it seems that the good is relative and there is no sense in which we can say that Jones is right about what is good and Smith is wrong. Locke blocks this kind of consequence for his view by introducing a distinction between “happiness” and “true happiness.” This indicates that while all things that bring us pleasure are linked to happiness, there is also a category of pleasure-bringing things that are linked to true happiness. It is the pursuit of the members of this special category of pleasurable things that is, for Locke, emblematic of the correct use of our intellectual powers.

b. Happiness

Locke is very clear—we all constantly desire happiness. All of our actions, on his view, are oriented towards securing happiness. Uneasiness, Locke’s technical term for being in a state of pain and desirous of some absent good, is the motive that moves us to act in the way that is expected to relieve the pain of desire and secure the state of happiness (Essay, II.xxi.36). But, while Locke equates pleasure with good, he is careful to distinguish the happiness that is acquired as a result of the satisfaction of any particular desire and the true happiness that is the result of the satisfaction of a particular kind of desire. Drawing this distinction allows Locke to hold that the pursuit of a certain sets of pleasures or goods is more worthy than the pursuit of others.

The pursuit of true happiness, according to Locke, is equated with “the highest perfection of intellectual nature” (Essay, II.xxi.51). And, indeed, Locke takes our pursuit of this true happiness to be the thing to which the vast majority of our efforts should be oriented. To do this, he says that we need to try to match our desires to “the true instrinsick good” that is really within things. Notice here that Locke is implying that there is distinction to be drawn between the “true intrinsic good” of a thing and, it seems, the good that we unreflectively take to be within a certain thing. The idea here is that attentively considering a particular thing will allow us to see its true value as opposed to the superficial value we assign to a thing based on our immediate reaction to it. We can think, for example, of a bitter tasting medicine. A face-value assessment of the medicine will lead us to evaluate that the thing is to be avoided. However, more information and contemplation of it will lead us to see that the true worth of the medicine is, in fact, high and so it should be evaluated as a good to be pursued. And, Locke states, if we contemplate a thing long enough, and see clearly the measure of its true worth; we can change our desire and uneasiness for it in proportion to that worth (Essay, II.xxi.53). But how are we to understand Locke’s suggestion that there is a true, intrinsic good in things? So far, all he has said about the good is that it is tracked by pleasure. We begin to get an answer to this question when Locke acknowledges the obvious fact that different people derive pleasure and pain from different things. While he reiterates that happiness is no more than the possession of those things that give the most pleasure and the absence of those things that cause the most pain, and that the objects in these two categories can vary widely among people, he adds the following provocative statement:

If therefore Men in this Life only have hope; if in this Life they can only enjoy, ’tis not strange, nor unreasonable, that they should seek their Happiness by avoiding all things, that disease them here, and by pursuing all that delight them; wherein it will be no wonder to find variety and difference. For if there be no Prospect beyond the Grave, the inference is certainly right, Let us eat and drink, let us enjoy what we delight in, for tomorrow we shall die [Isa, 22:13; I Cor. 15:32]. (Essay, II.xxi.55)

Here, Locke suggests that pursuing and avoiding the particular things that give us pleasure or pain would be a perfectly acceptable way to live were there “no prospect beyond the grave.” It seems that what Locke means is that if there were no judgment day, which is to say that if our actions were not ultimately judged by God, there would be no reason to do otherwise than to blindly follow our pleasures and flee our pains. Now, given this suggestion, the question, then, is how to distinguish between the things that are pleasurable but that will not help our case on judgment day, and those that will. Locke provides a clue for how to do such a thing when he says that the will is typically determined by those things that are judged to be good by the understanding. However, in many cases we use “wrong measures of good and evil” and end by judging unworthy things to be good. He who makes such a mistake errs because “[t]he eternal Law and Nature of things must not be alter’d to comply with his ill order’d choice” (Essay, II.xxi.56). In other words, there is an ordered way to choose which things to pursue—the things that are in accordance with the eternal law and nature of things—and an ill-ordered way, in accordance with our own palates. This indicates that Locke takes there to be a fixed law that determines which things are worthy of our pursuit, and which are not. This means that Locke takes there to be an important distinction between the good, understood as all objects that are connected to pleasure and the moral good, understood as objects connected to pleasure which are also in conformity with a law. Though the distinctions between good and moral good, and between evil and moral evil are not discussed in any great detail by Locke, he does states that moral good and evil is nothing other than the “Conformity or Disagreement of our voluntary Actions to some Law.” Locke states punishments and rewards are bestowed on us for our following or failure to follow this law by “the Will and Power of the Law-maker” (Essay, II.xxviii.5). So, Locke affirms that moral good and evil are closely tied to the observance or violation of some law, and that the lawmaker has the power to reward or punish those who adhere to or stray from the law.

3. The Law of Nature

a. Existence

In the Essay, the concepts of laws and lawmakers do not receive much treatment beyond Locke’s affirmation that God has decreed laws and that there are rewards and punishments associated with the respect or violation of these laws (Essay, I.iii.6; I.iii.12; II.xxi.70; II.xxviii.6). The two most important questions concerning the role of laws in a system of ethics remain unanswered in the Essay: (1) how do we determine the content of the law? This is the epistemological question. And (2) what kind of authority does the law have to obligate? This is the moral question. Locke spends much time considering these questions in a series of nine essays written some thirty years before the Essay, which are known under the collected title Essays on the Law of Nature (hereafter: Law).

The first essay in the series treats the question of whether there is a “rule of morals, or law of nature given to us.” The answer is unequivocally “yes” (Law, Essay I, page 109; hereafter: Law, I: 109). The reason for this positive answer, in short, is because God exists. Locke appeals to a kind of teleological argument to support the claim of God’s existence, saying that given the organization of the universe, including the organized way in which animal and vegetable bodies propagate, there must be a governing principle that is responsible for the patterns we see on earth. And, if we extend this principle to the existence of human life, Locke claims that it is reasonable to believe that there is a pattern or a law that governs behavior. This law is to be understood as moral good or virtue and, Locke states, it is the decree of God’s will and is discernable by “the light of nature.” Because the law tells us what is and is not in conformity with “rational nature,” it has the status of commanding or prohibiting certain behaviors (Law, I: 111; see also Essay, IV.xix.16). Because all human beings possess, by nature, the faculty of reason, all human beings, at least in principle, can discover the natural law.

Locke offers five reasons for thinking that such a natural law exists. He begins by noting that it is evident that there is some disagreement among people about the content of the law. However, far from thinking that such disagreement casts doubt on the existence of the law, he takes the presence of disagreement about the law as evidence that such a true and objective law exists. Disagreements about the content of the law confirm that everyone is in agreement about the fundamental character of the law—that there are things that are by their nature good or evil—but just disagree about how to interpret the law (Law, I: 115). The existence of the law is further reinforced by the fact that we often pass judgment on our own actions, by way of our conscience, leading to feelings of guilt or pride. Because it is not possible, according to Locke, to pronounce a judgment without the existence of a law, the act of conscience demonstrates that such a natural law exists. Third, again appealing to a kind of teleological argument, Locke states that we see that laws govern all manner of natural operations and that it makes sense that human beings would also be governed by laws that are in accordance with their nature (Law, I: 117). Fourth, Locke states that without the natural law, society would not be able to run the way that it does. He suggests that the force of civil law is grounded on the natural law. In other words, without the natural law, positive law would have no moral authority. Elsewhere, Locke underlines this point by saying that given that the law of nature is the eternal rule for all men, the rules made by legislators must conform to this law (The Two Treatises of Government, Treatise II, section 135, hereafter: Government, II.35). Finally, on Locke’s view, there would be no virtue or vice, no reward or punishment, no guilt, if there were no natural law (Law, I: 119). Without the natural law, there would be no bounds on human action. This means that we would be motivated only to do what seems pleasurable and there would be no sense in which anyone could be considered virtuous or vicious. The existence of the natural law, then, allows us to be sensitive to the fact that there are certain pleasures that are more in line with what is objectively right. Indeed, Locke also gestures towards, but does not elaborate on, this kind of thought in the Essay. He suggests that the studious man, who takes all his pleasures from reading and learning will eventually be unable to ignore his desires for food and drink. Likewise, the “Epicure,” whose only interest is in the sensory pleasures of food and drink, will eventually turn his attention to study when shame or the desire to “recommend himself to his Mistress” will raise his uneasiness for knowledge (Essay, II.xxi.43).

So, Locke has given us five reasons to accept the existence of the law of nature that grounds virtuous and vicious behavior. We turn now to how he thinks we come to know the content of the law.

b. Content

Locke suggests that there are two ways to determine the content of the law of nature: by the light of nature and by sense experience.

Locke is careful to note that by “light of nature” he does not mean something like an “inward light” that is “implanted in man” and like a compass constantly leads human beings towards virtue. Rather, this light is to be understood as a kind of metaphor that indicates that truth can be attained by each of us individually by nothing more than the exercise of reason and the intellectual faculties (Law, II: 123). Locke uses a comparison to precious metal mining to make this point clear. He acknowledges that some might say that his explanation of the discovery of the content of the law by the light of nature entails that everyone should always be in possession of the knowledge of this content. But, he notes, this is to take the light of nature as something that is stamped on the hearts on human beings, which is a mistake (see Law, III, 137-145). While the depths of the earth might contain veins of gold and silver, Locke says, this does not mean that everyone living on the stretch of land above those veins is rich (Law, II: 135). Work must be done to dig out the precious metals in order to benefit from their value. Similarly, proper use must be made of the faculties we have in order to benefit from the certainty provided by the light of nature. Locke notes that we can come to know the law of nature, in a way, by tradition, which is to say by the testimony and instruction of other people. But it is a mistake to follow the law for any reason other than that we recognize its universal binding force. This can only be done by our own intellectual investigation (Law, II: 129).

But what, exactly, is the light of nature? Locke acknowledges that it is difficult to answer this question—it is not something stamped on the heart or mind, nor is it something that is exclusively learned by tradition or testimony. The only option left for describing it, then, is that it is something acquired or experienced by sense experience or by reason. And, indeed, Locke suggests that when these two faculties, reason and sensation, work together, nothing can remain obscure to the mind. Sensation provides the mind with ideas and reason guides the faculty of sensation and arranges “together the images of things derived from sense-perception, thence forming others [ideas] and composing new ones” (Law, IV: 147). Locke emphasizes that reason ought to be taken to mean “the discursive faculty of the mind, which advances from things known to thinks unknown,” using as its foundation the data provided by sense experience (Law, IV: 149).

When directly addressing the question of how the combination of reason and sense experience allow us to know the content of the law of nature, Locke states that two important truths must be acknowledged because they are “presupposed in the knowledge of any and every law” (Law, IV: 151). First, we must understand that there is a lawmaker who decreed the law, and that the lawmaker is rightly obeyed as a superior power (a discussion of this point is also found in Government, I.81). Second, we must understand that the lawmaker wishes those to whom the law is decreed to follow the law. Let us take each of these in turn.

Sense experience allows us to know that a lawmaker exists. To demonstrate this, Locke appeals, once again, to a kind of teleological argument: by our senses we come to know the objects external world and, importantly, the regularities with which they move and change. We also see that we human beings are part of the movements and changes of the external world. Reason, then, contemplates these regularities and orders of change and motion and naturally comes to inquire about their origin. The conclusion of such an inquiry, states Locke, is that a powerful and wise creator exists. This conclusion follows from two observations: (1) that beasts and inanimate things cannot be the cause of the existence of human beings because they are clearly less perfect than human beings, and something less perfect cannot bring more perfect things into existence, and 2) that we ourselves cannot be the cause of our own existence because if we possessed the power to create ourselves, we would also have the power to give ourselves eternal life. Because it is obviously the case that we do not have eternal life, Locke concludes that we cannot be the origin of our own existence. So, Locke says, there must be a powerful agent, God, who is the origin of our existence (Law, IV: 153). The senses provide the data from the external world, and reason contemplates the data and concludes that a creator of the observed objects and phenomena must exist. Once the existence of a creator is determined, Locke thinks that we can also see that the creator has “a just and inevitable command over us and at His pleasure can raise us up or throw us down, and make us by the same commanding power happy or miserable” (Law, IV: 155). This commanding power, on Locke’s view, indicates that we are necessarily subject to the decrees of God’s will. (A similar line of discussion is found in Locke’s The Reasonableness of Christianity, 144–46.)

As for the second truth, that the lawmaker, God, wishes us to follow the laws decreed, Locke states that once we see that there is a creator of all things and that an order obtains among them, we see that the creator is both powerful and wise. It follows from these evident attributes that God would not create something without a purpose. Moreover, we notice that our minds and bodies seem well equipped for action, which suggests, “God intends man to do something.” And, the “something” that we are made to do, according to Locke, is the same purpose shared by all created things—the glorification of God (Law, IV: 157). In the case of rational beings, Locke states that given our nature, our function is to use sense experience and reason in order to discover, contemplate, and praise God’s creation; to create a society with other people and to work to maintain and preserve both oneself and the community. And this, in fact, is the content of the law of nature—to preserve one’s own being and to work to maintain and preserve the beings of the other people in our community. This injunction to preserve oneself and to preserve one’s neighbors is also endorsed and stressed throughout Locke’s discussions of political power and freedom (see Government, I.86, 88, 120; II.6, 25, 128).

c. Authority

Once we have knowledge of the content of the law of nature, we must determine from where it derives its authority. In other words, we must ask why we are bound to follow the law once we are aware of its content. Locke begins this discussion by reiterating that the law of nature “is the care and preservation of oneself.” Given this law, he states that virtue should not be understood as a duty but rather the “convenience” of human beings. In this sense, the good is nothing more than what is useful. Further, he adds, the observance of this law is not so much an obligation but rather “a privilege and an advantage, to which we are led by expediency” (Law, VI: 181). This indicates that Locke thinks that actions that are in conformity with the law are useful and practical. In other words, it is in our best interest to follow the law. While this characterization of why we in fact follow the law is compelling, there is nevertheless still an inquiry to be made into why we ought to follow the law.

Locke begins his treatment of this question by stating that no one can oblige us to do anything unless the one who obliges has some superior right and power over us. The obligation that is generated between such a superior power and those who are subject to it results in two kinds of duties: (1) the duty to pay obedience to the command of the superior power. Because our faculties are suited to discover the existence of the divine lawmaker, Locke takes it to be impossible to avoid this discovery, barring some damage or impediment to our faculties. This duty is ultimately grounded in God’s will as the force by which we were created (Law, VI: 183). (2) The duty to suffer punishment as a result of the failure to honor the first duty—obedience. Now, it might seem odd that it would be necessary to postulate that punishment results from the failure to respect a law the content of which is only that we must take care of ourselves. In other words, how could anyone express so little interest in taking care of himself or herself that the fear of punishment is needed to motivate the actions necessary for such care? It is worth quoting Locke’s answer in full:

[A] liability to punishment, which arises from a failure to pay dutiful obedience, so that those who refuse to be led by reason and to own that in the matter of morals and right conduct they are subject to a superior authority may recognize that they are constrained by force and punishment to be submissive to that authority and feel the strength of Him whose will they refuse to follow. And so the force of this obligation seems to be grounded in the authority of a lawmaker, so that power compels those who cannot be moved by warnings. (Law, VI: 183)

So, even though the existence, content, and authority of the law of nature are known in virtue of the faculties possessed by all rational creatures—sense experience and reason—Locke recognizes that there are people who “refuse to be led by reason.” Because these people do not see the binding force of the law by their faculties alone, they need some other impetus to motivate their behavior. But, Locke thinks very ill of those who are in need of this other impetus. He says the these features of the law of nature can be discovered by anyone who is diligent about directing their mind to them, and can be concealed from no one “unless he loves blindness and darkness and casts off nature in order that he may avoid his duty” (Law, VI: 189, see also Government, II.6).

d. Reconciling the Law with Happiness

The main lines of Locke’s natural law theory are as follows: there is a moral law that is (1) discoverable by the combined work of reason and sense experience, and (2) binding on human beings in virtue of being decreed by God. Now, in §1 above, we saw that Locke thinks that all human beings are naturally oriented to the pursuit of happiness. This is because we are motivated to pursue things if they promise pleasure and to avoid things if they promise pain. It has seemed to many commentators that these two discussions of moral principles are in tension with each other. On the view described in Law, Locke straightforwardly appeals to reason and our ability to understand the nature of God’s attributes to ground our obligation to follow the law of nature. In other words, what is lawful ought to be followed because God wills it and what is unlawful ought to be rejected because it is not willed by God. Because we can straightforwardly see that God is the law-giver and that we are by nature subordinate to Him, we ought to follow the law. By contrast, in the discussion of happiness and pleasure in the Essay, Locke explains that good and evil reduce to what is pleasurable and what is painful. While he does also indicate that the special categories of good and evil—moral good and moral evil—are no more than the conformity or disagreement between our actions and a law, he immediately adds that such conformity or disagreement is followed by rewards or punishments that flow from the lawmaker’s will. From this discussion, then, it is difficult to see whether Locke holds that it is the reward and punishment that binds human beings to act in accordance with the law, or if it is the fact that the law is willed by God.

One way to approach this problem is to suggest that Locke changed his mind. Because of the thirty-year gap between Law and the Essay, we might be tempted to think that the more rationalist picture, where the law and its authority are based on reason, was the young Locke’s view when he wrote Law. This view, the story would go, was replaced by Locke’s more considered and mature view, hedonism. But this approach must be resisted because both theories are present in early and late works. The role of pleasure and pain with respect to morality is present not only in the Essay, but is invoked in Law (passage quoted at the end of §2c), and many other various minor essays written in the years between Law and Essay (for example, ‘Morality’ (c.1677–78) in Political Essays, 267–69). Likewise, the role of the authority of God’s will is retained after Law, again evident in various minor essays (for example, ‘Virtue B’ (1681) in Political Essays, 287-88), Government II.6), Locke’s correspondence (for example, to James Tyrrell, 4 August 1690, Correspondence, Vol.4, letter n.1309) and even in the Essay itself (II.xxviii.8). An answer to how we might reconcile these two positions is suggested when we consider the texts where appeals to both theories are found side-by-side in certain passages.

In his essay Of Ethick in General (c. 1686–88) Locke affirms the hedonist view that happiness and misery consist only in pleasure and pain, and that we all naturally seek happiness. But in the very next paragraph, he states that there is an important difference between moral and natural good and evil—the pleasure and pain that are consequences of virtuous and vicious behavior are grounded in the divine will. Locke notes that drinking to excess leads to pain in the form of headache or nausea. This is an example of a natural evil. By contrast, transgressing a law would not have any painful consequences if the law were not decreed by a superior lawmaker. He adds that it is impossible to motivate the actions of rational agents without the promise of pain or pleasure (Of Ethick in General, §8). From these considerations, Locke suggests that the proper foundation of morality, a foundation that will entail an obligation to moral principles, needs two things. First, we need the proof of a law, which presupposes the existence of a lawmaker who is superior to those to whom the law is decreed. The lawmaker has the right to ordain the law and the power to reward and punish. Second, it must be shown that the content of the law is discoverable to humankind (Of Ethick in General, §12). In this text it seems that Locke suggests that both the force and authority of the divine decree and the promise of reward and punishment are necessary for the proper foundation of an obligating moral law.

A similar line of argument is found in the Essay. There, Locke asserts that in order to judge moral success or failure, we need a rule by which to measure and judge action. Further, each rule of this sort has an “enforcement of Good and Evil.” This is because, according to Locke, “where-ever we suppose a Law, suppose also some Reward or Punishment annexed to that Law” (Essay, II.xxviii.6). Locke states that some promise of pleasure or pain is necessary in order to determine the will to pursue or avoid certain actions. Indeed, he puts the point even more strongly, saying that it would be in vain for the intelligent being who decrees the rule of law to so decree without entailing reward or punishment for the obedient or the unfaithful (see also Government, II.7). It seems, then, that reason discovers the fact that a divine law exists and that it derives from the divine will and, as such, is binding. We might think, as Stephen Darwall suggests in The British Moralists and the Internal Ought, that if reason is that which discovers our obligation to the law, the role for reward and punishment is to motivate our obedience to the law. While this succeeds in making room for both the rationalist and hedonist strains in Locke’s view, some other texts seem to indicate that by reason alone we ought to be motivated to follow moral laws.

One striking instance of this kind of suggestion is found in the third book of the Essay where Locke boldly states that “Morality is capable of Demonstration” in the same way as mathematics (Essay, III.xi.16). He explains that once we understand the existence and nature of God as a supreme being who is infinite in power, goodness, and wisdom and on whom we depend, and our own nature “as understanding, rational Beings,” we should be able to see that these two things together provide the foundation of both our duty and the appropriate rules of action. On Locke’s view, with focused attention the measures of right and wrong will become as clear to us as the propositions of mathematics (Essay, IV.iii.18). He gives two examples of such certain moral principles to make the point: (1) “Where there is no Property, there is no Injustice” and (2) “No Government allows absolute Liberty.” He explains that property implies a right to something and injustice is the violation of a right to something. So, if we clearly see the intensional definition of each term, we see that (1) is necessarily true. Similarly, government indicates the establishment of a society based on certain rules, and absolute liberty is the freedom from any and all rules. Again, if we understand the definitions of the two terms in the proposition, it becomes obvious that (2) is necessarily true. And, Locke states, following this logic, 1 and 2 are as certain as the proposition that “a Triangle has three Angles equal to two right ones” (Essay, IV.iii.18). If moral principles have the same status as mathematical principles, it is difficult to see why we would need further inducement to use these principles to guide our behavior. While there is no clear answer to this question, Locke does provide a way to understand the role of reward and punishment in our obligation to moral principles despite the fact that it seems that they ought to obligate by reason alone.

Early in the Essay, over the course of giving arguments against the existence of innate ideas, Locke addresses the possibility of innate moral principles. He begins by saying that for any proposed moral rule human beings can, with good reason, demand justification. This precludes the possibility of innate moral principles because, if they were innate, they would be self-evident and thus would not be candidates for justification. Next, Locke notes that despite the fact that there are no innate moral principles, there are certain principles that are undeniable, for example, that “men should keep their Compacts.” However, when asked why people follow this rule, different answers are given. A “Hobbist” will say that it is because the public requires it, and the “Leviathan” will punish those who disobey the law. A “Heathen” philosopher will say that it is because following such a law is a virtue, which is the highest perfection for human beings. But a Christian philosopher, the category to which Locke belongs, will say that it is because “God, who has the Power of eternal Life and Death, requires it of us” (Essay, I.iii.5). Locke builds on this statement in the following section when he notes that while the existence of God and the truth of our obedience to Him is made manifest by the light of reason, it is possible that there are people who accept the truth of moral principles, and follow them, without knowing or accepting the “true ground of Morality; which can only be the Will and Law of God” (Essay, I.iii.6). Here Locke is suggesting that we can accept a true moral law as binding and follow it as such, but for the wrong reasons. This means that while the Hobbist, the Heathen, and the Christian might all take the same law of keeping one’s compacts to be obligating, only the Christian does it for the right reason—that God’s will requires our obedience to that law. Indeed, Locke states that if we receive truths by revelation they too must be subject to reason, for to follow truths based on revelation alone is insufficient (see Essay, IV.xviii).

Now, to determine the role of pain and pleasure in this story, we turn to Locke’s discussion of the role of pain and pleasure in general. He says that God has joined pains and pleasures to our interaction with many things in our environment in order to alert us to things that are harmful or helpful to the preservation of our bodies (Essay, II.vii.4). But, beyond this, Locke notes that there is another reason that God has joined pleasure and pain to almost all our thoughts and sensations: so that we experience imperfections and dissatisfactions. He states that the kinds of pleasures that we experience in connection to finite things are ephemeral and not representative of complete happiness. This dissatisfaction coupled with the natural drive to obtain happiness opens the possibility of our being led to seek our pleasure in God, where we anticipate a more stable and, perhaps, permanent happiness. Appreciating this reason why pleasure and pain are annexed to most of our ideas will, according to Locke, lead the way to the ultimate aim of the enquiry in human understanding—the knowledge and veneration of God (Essay, II.vii.5–6). So, Locke seems to be suggesting here that pain and pleasure prompt us to find out about God, in whom complete and eternal happiness is possible. This search, in turn, leads us to knowledge of God, which will include the knowledge that He ought to be obeyed in virtue of His decrees alone. Pleasure and pain, reward and punishment, on this interpretation, are the means by which we are led to know God’s nature, which, once known, motivates obedience to His laws. This mechanism supports Locke’s claim that real happiness is to be found in the perfection of our intellectual nature—in embarking on the search for knowledge of God, we embark on the intellectual journey that will lead to the kind of knowledge that brings permanent pleasure. This at least suggests that the knowledge of God has the happy double-effect of leading to both more stable happiness and the understanding that God is to be obeyed in virtue of His divine will alone.

But given that all human beings experience pain and pleasure, Locke needs to explain how it is that certain people are virtuous, having followed the experience of dissatisfaction to arrive at the knowledge of God, and other people are vicious, who seek pleasure and avoid pain for no reason other than their own hedonic sensations.

4. Power, Freedom, and Suspending Desire

a. Passive and Active Powers

In any discussion of ethics, it is important not only to determine what, exactly, counts as virtuous and vicious behavior, but also the extent to which we are in control of our actions. This is important because we want to be able to adequately connect behavior to agents in order to attribute praise or blame, reward or punishment to an agent, we need to be able to see the way in which she is the causal source of her own actions. Locke addresses this issue in one of the longest chapters of the Essay—“Of Power.” In this chapter, Locke describes how he understands the nature of power, the human will, freedom and its connection to happiness, and, finally, the reasons why many (or even most) people do not exercise their freedom in the right kind of way and are unhappy as a result. It is worth noting here that this chapter of the Essay underwent major revisions throughout the five editions of the Essay and in particular between the first and second edition. The present discussion is based on the fourth edition of the Essay (but see the “References and Further Reading” below for articles that discuss the relevance of the changes throughout all five editions).

Locke states that we come to have the idea of “power” by observing the fact that things change over time. Finite objects are changed as a result of interactions with other finite objects (for example fire melts gold) and we notice that our own ideas change either as a result of external stimulus (for example the noise of a jackhammer interrupts the contemplation of a logic problem) or as a result of our own desires (for example hunger interrupts the contemplation of a logic problem). The idea of power always includes some kind of relation to action or change. The passive side of power entails the ability to be changed and the active side of power entails the ability to make change. Our observation of almost all sensible things furnishes us with the idea of passive power. This is because sensible things appear to be in almost constant flux—they are changed by their interaction with other sensible things, with heat, cold, rain, and time. And, Locke adds, such observations give us no fewer instances of the idea of active power, for “whatever Change is observed, the Mind must collect a Power somewhere, able to make that Change” (Essay, II.xxi.4). However, when it comes to active powers, Locke states that the clearest and most distinct idea of active power comes to us from the observation of the operations of our own minds. He elaborates by stating that there are two kinds of activities with which we are familiar: thinking and motion. When we consider body in general, Locke states that it is obvious that we receive no idea of thinking, which only comes from a contemplation of the operations of our own minds. But neither does body provide the idea of the beginning of motion, only of the continuation or transfer of motion. The idea of the beginning of motion, which is the idea associated with the active power of motion, only comes to us when we reflect “on what passes in our selves, where we find by Experience, that barely by willing it, barely by a thought of the Mind, we can move the parts of our Bodies, which were before at rest” (Essay, II.xxi.4). So, it seems, the operation of our minds, in particular the connection between one kind of thought, willing, and a change in either the content of our minds or the orientation of our bodies, provides us with the idea of an active power.

b. The Will

The power to stop, start, or continue an action of the mind or of the body is what Locke calls the will. When the power of the will is exercised, a volition (or willing) occurs. Any action (or forbearance of action) that follows volition is considered voluntary. The power of the will is coupled with the power of the understanding. This latter power is defined as the power of perceiving ideas and their agreement or disagreement with one another. The understanding, then, provides ideas to the mind and the will, depending on the content of these ideas, prefers certain courses of action to others. Locke explains that the will directs action according to its preference—and here we must understand “preference” in the most general sense of inclination, partiality, or taste. In short, the will is attracted to actions that promise the procurement of pleasing things and/or the distancing from displeasing things. The technical term that Locke uses to describe that which determines the will is uneasiness. He elaborates, stating that the reason why any action is continued is “the present satisfaction in it” and the reason why any action is taken to move to a new state is dissatisfaction (Essay, II.xxi.29). Indeed, Locke affirms that uneasiness, at bottom, is really no more than desire, where the mind is disturbed by a “want of some absent good” (Essay, II.xxi.31). So, any pain or discomfort of the mind or body is a motive for the will to command a change of state so as to move from unease to ease. Locke notes that it is a common fact of life that we often experience multiple uneasinesses at one time, all pressing on us and demanding relief. But, he says, when we ask the question of what determines the will at any one moment, the answer is the most pressing uneasiness (Essay, II.xxi.31). Imagine a situation where you are simultaneously experiencing discomfort as a result of hunger and the anxiety of being under-prepared for tomorrow’s philosophy exam. On Locke’s view the most intense or the most pressing of these uneasinesses will determine your will to command the action that will relieve it. This means that no matter how much you want to stay at the library to study, if hunger comes to be the more pressing than the desire to pass the exam, hunger will determine the will to act, commanding the action that will result in the procurement of food.

While Locke states that the most pressing uneasiness determines the will, he adds that it does so “for the most part, but not always.” This is because he takes the mind to have the power to “suspend the execution and satisfaction of any of its desires” (Essay, II.xxi.47). While a desire is suspended, Locke says, our mind, being temporarily freed from the discomfort of the want for the thing desired, has the opportunity to consider the relative worth of that thing. The idea here is that with appropriate deliberation about the value of the desired thing we will come to see which things are really worth pursuing and which are better left alone. And, Locke states, the conclusion at which we arrive after this intellectual endeavor of consideration and examination will indicate what, exactly, we take to be part of our happiness. And, in turn, by a mechanism that Locke does not describe in any detail, our uneasiness and desire for that thing will change to reflect whether we concluded that the thing does, indeed, play a role in our happiness or not (Essay, II.xxi.56). The problem is that there is no clear explanation for how, exactly, the power to suspend works. Despite this, Locke nowhere indicates that suspension is an action of the mind that is determined by anything other than volition of the will. We know that Locke takes all acts of the will to be determined by uneasiness. So, suspending our desires must be the result of uneasiness for something. Investigating how Locke understands human freedom and judgment will allow us to see what, exactly, we are uneasy for when we are determined to suspend our desires.

c. Freedom

When the nature of the human will is under discussion, we often want to know the extent of this faculty’s freedom. The reason why this question is important is because we want to see how autonomously the will can act. Typically, the question takes the form of: is the will free? Locke unequivocally denies that the will is free, implying, in fact, that it is a category mistake to ask the question at all. This is because, on his view, both the will and freedom are powers of agents, and it is a mistake to think that one power (the will) can have as a property a second power (freedom) (Essay, II.xxi.20). Instead, Locke thinks that the right question to pose is whether the agent is free. He defines freedom in the following way:

[T]he Idea of Liberty, is the Idea of a Power in any Agent to do or forbear any particular Action, according to the determination or thought of the mind, whereby either of them is preferr’d to the other; where either of them is not in the Power of the Agent to be produced by him according to his Volition here he is not a Liberty, that Agent is under Necessity. (Essay, II.xxi.8)

So, Locke considers that an agent is free in acting when her action is connected to her volition in the right kind of way. That is, when her action (or forbearance of action) follows from her volition, she is free. And, her volition is determined by the “thought of the mind” that indicates which action is preferred.

Notice here that Locke takes an agent to be free in acting when she acts according to her preference—this means that her actions are determined by her preference. This plainly shows that Locke does not endorse a kind of freedom of indifference, according to which the will can choose to command an action other than the thing most preferred at a given moment. This is the kind of freedom most often associated with indeterminism. Freedom, then, for Locke, is no more than the ability to execute the action that is taken to result in the most pleasure at a given moment. The problem with this way of defining freedom is that it seems unable to account for the kinds of actions we typically take to be emblematic of virtuous or vicious behavior. This is because we tend to think that the power of freedom is a power that allows us to avoid vicious actions, perhaps especially those that are pleasurable, in order to pursue a righteous path instead. For instance, on the traditional Christian picture, when we wonder about why God would allow Adam to sin, the response given is that Adam was created as a free being. While God could have created beings that, like automata, unfailingly followed the good and the true, He saw that it was all things considered better to create beings that were free to choose their own actions. This decision was made despite the fact that God foresaw the sinful use to which this freedom would be put. This traditional view explains Adam’s sin in the following way: Adam knew that it was God’s commandment that he was not to eat of the tree of knowledge. Adam also knew that following God’s commandment was the right thing to do. So, in the moment where he was tempted to eat the fruit of the tree of knowledge, he knew it was the wrong thing to do, but did it anyway. This is because, the story goes, and in that moment he was free to decide whether to follow the commandment or to give in to temptation. Of his own free choice, Adam decided to follow temptation. This means that in the moment of original sin, both following God’s commandment and eating the fruit were live options for Adam, and he chose the fruit of his own agency.

Now, on Locke’s system, a different explanation obtains. Given his definition of freedom, it is difficult, at least prima facie, to see how Adam could be blamed for choosing the fruit over the commandment. For, according to Locke, an agent acts freely when her actions are determined by her volitions. So, if Adam’s greatest uneasiness was for the fruit, and the act of eating the fruit was the result of his will commanding such action based on his preference, then he acted freely. But, on this understanding of freedom, it is difficult to see how, exactly, Adam can be morally blamed for eating the fruit. The question now becomes: is Adam to be blamed for anticipating more pleasure from the consumption of the fruit than from following God’s command? In other words, was it possible for Adam to alter the intensity of his desire for the fruit? It seems that on Locke’s view, the answer must be connected to one of the powers he takes human beings to possess—the power to suspend desires. And, in certain passages of the Essay, Locke implies that suspending desires and freedom are linked, suggesting that while agents are acting freely whenever their volitions and actions are linked in the right kind of way, there is, perhaps, a proper use of the power to act freely.

d. Judgment

Locke asserts that the “highest perfection of intellectual nature” is the “pursuit of true and solid happiness.” He adds that taking care not to mistake imaginary happiness for real happiness is “the necessary foundation of our liberty.” And, he writes that the more closely we are focused on the pursuit of true happiness, which is our greatest good, the less our wills are determined to command actions to pursue lesser goods that are not representative of the true good (Essay, II.xxi.51). In other words, the more we are determined by true happiness, the more we will to suspend our desires for lesser things. This suggests that Locke takes there to be a right way to use our power of freedom. Locke indicates that there are instances where it is impossible to resist a particular desire—when a violent passion strikes, for instance. He also states, however, that aside from these kinds of violent passions, we are always able to suspend our desire for any thing in order to give ourselves the time and the emotional distance from the thing desired in which to consider the worth of thing relative to our general goal: true happiness. True happiness, or real bliss, on Locke’s view, is to be found in the pursuit of things that are true intrinsic goods, which promise “exquisite and endless Happiness” in the next life (Essay, II.xxi.70). In other words, true good is something like the Beatific Vision.

Now, Locke admits that it is a common experience to be carried by our wills towards things that we know do not play a role in our overall and true happiness. However, while he allows that the pursuit of things that promise pleasure, even if only a temporary pleasure, represents the action of a free agent, he also says that it is possible for us to be “at Liberty in respect of willing” when we choose “a remote Good as an end to be pursued” (Essay, II.xxi.56). The central thing to note here is that Locke is drawing a distinction between immediate and remote goods. The difference between these two kinds of goods is temporal. For instance, acting to obtain the pleasure of intoxication is to pursue an immediate good while acting to obtain the pleasure of health is to pursue a remote good. So, we can suppose here that Locke is suggesting that forgoing immediate goods and privileging remote goods is characteristic of the right use of liberty (but see Rickless for an alternative interpretation). If this is so, it is certainly not a difficult suggestion to accept. Indeed, it is fairly straightforwardly clear that many immediate pleasures do not, in the end, contribute to overall and long-lasting happiness.

The question now, and it is a question that Locke himself poses, is “How Men come often to prefer the worse to the better; and to chase that, which, by their own Confession, has made them miserable” (Essay, II.xxi.56). Locke gives two answers. First, bad luck can account for people not pursuing their true happiness. For instance, someone who is afflicted with an illness, injury, or tragedy is consumed by her pain and is thus unable to adequately focus on remote pleasures. Quoting Locke’s second answer “Other uneasinesses arise from our desire of absent good; which desires always bear proportion to, and depend on the judgment we make, and the relish we have of any absent good; in both which we are apt to be variously misled, and that by our own fault” (Essay, II.xxi.57).

Here Locke states that our own faulty judgment is to blame for our preferring the worse to the better. This is because, on his view, the uneasiness we have for any given object is directly proportional to the judgments we make about the merit of the things to which we are attracted. So, if we are most uneasy for immediate pleasures, it is our own fault because we have judged these things to be best for us. In this way, Locke makes room in his system for praiseworthiness and blameworthiness with respect to our desires: absent illness, injury, or tragedy, we ourselves are responsible for endorsing, through judgment, our uneasinesses. He continues, stating that the major reason why we often misjudge the value of things for our true happiness is that our current state fools us into thinking that we are, in fact, truly happy. Because it is difficult for us to consider the state of true, eternal happiness, we tend to think that in those moments when we enjoy pleasure and feel no uneasiness, we are truly happy. But such thoughts are mistaken on his view. Indeed, as Locke says, the greatest reason why so few people are moved to pursue the greatest, remote good is that most people are convinced that they can be truly happy without it.

The cause of our mistaken judgments is the fact that it is very difficult for us to compare present and immediate pleasures and pains with future or remote pleasures and pains. In fact, Locke likens this difficulty to the trouble we typically experience in correctly estimating the size of distant objects. When objects are close to us, it is easy to determine their size. When they are far away, it is much more difficult. Likewise, he says, for pleasures and pains. He notes that if every sip of alcohol were accompanied by headache and nausea, no one would ever drink. But, “the fallacy of a little difference in time” provides the space for us to mistakenly judge that the alcohol contributes to our true happiness (Essay, II.xxi.63). We experience this difficulty of judging remote pleasures and pains due to the “weak and narrow Constitution of our Minds” (Essay, II.xxi.64). The condition of our minds makes it easy for us to think that there could be no greater good than the relief of being unburdened of a present pain. In order to correct this problem and convince a man to judge that his greatest good is to be found in a remote thing, Locke says that all we must do is convince him that “Virtue and Religion are necessary to his Happiness” (Essay, II.xxi.60). Locke explains that a “due consideration will do it in most cases; and practice, application, and custom in most” (Essay, II.xxi.69). The suggestion is that contemplation and deliberation alone may be sufficient to correct our problem of considering all immediate pleasures and pains to be greater than any future ones. And, if that does not work, practice and habit can also correct this problem. By practice and exposure, we can, according to Locke, change the agreeableness or disagreeableness of things. It seems, then, that the power to suspend desire must be the power to reject immediate pleasures in favor of the pursuit of remote or future pleasures. However, it seems that in order to suspend in this way, we must already have judged that these immediate pleasures are not representative of the true good. For, without this kind of prior judgment, it seems that we would not be in a position to suspend in the way that is required. This is because absent the prior judgment, there would be no reason for the uneasiness we felt for the perceived good to not determine the will. The question to resolve now is how to get ourselves into a position where we are uneasy for the remote, true good and can suspend our desires for immediate pleasures. In other words, we must determine how we can come to seriously judge immediate pleasures to not have a part in our true happiness.

5. Living the Moral Life

In order to behave in a way that will lead us to the greatest and truest happiness, we must come to judge the remote and future good, the “unspeakable,” “infinite,” and “eternal” joys of heaven to be our greatest and thus most pleasurable good (Essay, II.xxi.37–38). But, on Locke’s view, our actions are always determined by the thing we are most uneasy about at any given moment. So, it seems, we need to cultivate the uneasiness for the infinite joys of heaven. But if, as Locke suggests, the human condition is such that our minds, in their weak and narrow states, judge immediate pleasures to be representative of the greatest good, it is difficult to see how, exactly, we can circumvent this weakened state in order to suspend our more terrestrial desires and thus have the space to correctly judge which things will lead to our true happiness. While in the Essay Locke does not say as much as we might like on this topic, elsewhere in his writings we can get a sense for how he might respond to this question.

In 1684, Locke was asked by his friend Edward Clarke, for advice about raising and educating his children. In 1693, Locke’s musings on this topic were published as Some Thoughts Concerning Education (hereafter: Education). This text provides insight into the importance that Locke places on the connection between the pursuit of true happiness and early childhood education in general. Locke begins his discussion by noting that happiness is crucially dependent on the existence of both a sound mind and a sound body. He adds that it sometimes happens that by a great stroke of luck, someone is born whose constitution is so strong that they do not need help from others to direct their minds towards the things that will make them happy. But this is an extraordinarily rare occurrence. Indeed, Locke notes: “I think I may say, that, of all the men we meet with, nine parts of ten are what they are, good or evil, useful or not, by their education” (Education, §1). It is the education we receive as young children, on Locke’s view, that determines how adept we are at targeting the right objects in order to secure our happiness. He observes that the minds of young children are easily distracted by all kinds of sensory stimuli and notes that the first step to developing a mind that is focused on the right kind of things is to ensure that the body is healthy. Indeed, the objective in physical health is to get the body in the perfect state to be able to obey and carry out the mind’s commands. The more difficult part of this equation is training the mind to “be disposed to consent to nothing, but what may be suitable to the dignity and excellency of a rational creature” (Education, §31). And Locke goes further still, stating that the foundation of all virtue is to be placed in the ability of a human being to “deny himself his own desires, cross his own inclinations, and purely follow what reason directs as best, though the appetite lean the other way” (Education, §33). The way to do this, he says, is to resist immediately present pleasures and pains and to wait to act until reason has determined the value of the desirable things in one’s environment.

Locke states that we must recognize the difference between “natural wants” and “wants of fancy.” The former are the kinds of desires that must be obeyed and that no amount of reasoning will allow us to give up. The latter, however, are created. Locke states that parents and teachers must ensure that children develop the habit of resisting any kind of created fancy, thus keeping the mind free from desires for things that do not lead to true happiness (Education, §107). If parents and teachers are successful in blocking the development of “wants of fancy,” Locke thinks that the children who benefit from this success will become adults who will be “allowed greater liberty” because they will be more closely connected to the dictates of reason and not the dictates of passion (Education, §108). So, in order to live the moral life and listen to reason over passions, it seems that we need to have had the benefit of conscientious care-givers in our infancy and youth (see also Government, II.63). This raises the difficulty of how to connect an individual’s moral successes or failures with the individual herself. For, if she had the bad moral luck of unthinking or careless parents and teachers, it seems difficult to see how she could be blamed for failing to follow a virtuous path.

One way of approaching this difficulty is to recall that Locke takes the content of law of nature, the moral law decreed by God, to be the preservation both of ourselves and of the other people in our communities in order to glorify God (Law, IV). The dictate to help to preserve the other people in our community shifts some of the moral burden from the individual onto the community. This means that it is every individual’s responsibility to do all they can, all things considered, to preserve themselves and to ensure, to the best of their ability, that the children in their communities are raised to avoid developing wants of fancy. In this way, children will develop the habit of suspending their desires for terrestrial pleasures and focusing their efforts on attaining the true happiness that results from acting to secure remote goods.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Edited by Peter H. Nidditch. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1975.
- This is the critical edition of Locke’s Essay. The body of the text is based on the fourth edition of the Essay and all the changes from the first edition through the fifth (1689, 1694, 1695, 1700, 1706) are indicated in the footnotes. The text also includes a comprehensive forward by Nidditch. Note that Locke’s orthography, grammar, and style are often quite different from the way that academic English is written today. In the citations from this text in particular, all emphases, capitalization, and odd spelling are original to Locke.
Essays on the Laws of Nature. Edited and translated by W. von Leyden. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1954.
- This edition includes both the original Latin and the English translation of the essays. It also includes Locke’s valedictory speech as censor of moral philosophy at Christ Church and some other shorter pieces of writing. Von Leyden’s introduction provides a very detailed discussion of the sources of Locke’s arguments in these essays, the arguments themselves, and the relations these arguments bear to other of Locke’s writings. It is worth noting here that on von Leyden’s interpretation, it is not possible to render Locke’s discussion of natural law consistent with his endorsement of a hedonistic motivational system in later works.
Political Essays. Edited by Mark Goldie. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997.
- This collection includes major writings on politics and government, including Essays on the Laws of Nature, Of Ethick in General, and An Essay on Toleration, in addition to many other minor essays.
The Correspondence of John Locke, in Eight Volumes. Edited by E.S. De Beer. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1976–89.
- A complete database of Locke’s correspondence including notes about his correspondents, notes about events and proper names mentioned in letters, as well as signposts for what was going on in Locke’s life at the time he was writing. The first volume of the collection includes an exhaustive introduction to Locke’s life, work, and contacts in the academic and social world; an explanation of how Locke’s letters were preserved; a discussion of previous publications of Locke’s correspondence and how they relate to this collection; and information about transcription practices, including details about editorial grammar decision and dating of the letters.
The Works of John Locke, in Nine Volumes, 12th edition. London: Rivington, 1824.
- This collection includes most of Locke’s longer texts, some shorter texts and a selection of letters. Among other things, the collection contains: Essay (vols.1 and 2), his correspondence with Stillingfleet (vol.3), Two Treatises of Government (vol.4), Letters on Toleration (vol.5), The Reasonableness of Christianity (vol.6), notes on St. Paul’s Epistles (vol.7), Some Thoughts Concerning Education and A Discourse of Miracles (vol.8), and a selection of letters (vol.9).

b. Secondary Sources: Books

Aaron, Richard I. John Locke. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1971.
- This is a comprehensive study of Locke’s life and works and includes fifteen very nice pages on Locke’s moral philosophy. Importantly, Aaron concludes that Locke fails to provide his readers with a science of morals and, in fact, that Locke’s disparate comments about ethics and moral principles cannot be reconciled.
Colman, John. John Locke’s Moral Philosophy. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1983.
- In this study, Colman addresses the major themes and problems of Locke’s moral theory including the connection between law and obligation, and the connection between moral principles and demonstrability.
Darwall, Stephen. The British Moralists and the Internal ‘Ought’: 1640–1740. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
- This is a deep and broad study of moral philosophy from the mid 17th to the mid 18th century. Locke is one among several central figures under discussion. The reader greatly benefits from Darwall’s careful discussions of the theoretical connections between Locke and his contemporaries and his influences on the topics of natural law, autonomy, motivation, duty, and freedom.
Lolordo, Antonia. Locke’s Moral Man. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2012.
- In this study, Lolordo draws on different parts of the Essay in order to see Locke’s theory of agency. She argues in favor of the interpretation according to which there are two senses of freedom in Locke’s view, one of which is properly used to attain the goal proper to a moral agent. Of particular interest is her discussion that links Locke’s comments about personal identity to moral agency and her claim that, for Locke, metaphysics is unnecessary for ethics.
Mabbot, J.D. John Locke. London: Macmillan Press, 1973.
- This is a study of Locke’s philosophical system that focuses on knowledge acquisition, logic and language, ethics and theology, and political theory. In his discussion of ethics and theology, Mabbot traces Locke’s discussions of moral principles, their demonstrability, and their binding force through The Two Treatises of Government, The Essays on the Laws of Nature, and An Essay Concerning Human Understanding.
Schouls, Peter A. Reasoned Freedom: John Locke and Enlightenment. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1992.
- This is a defense of the view that Locke was a great influence on enlightenment thought, in particular in the domains of reason and freedom. Schouls also points out what he takes to be many inconsistencies across and sometimes within Locke’s texts.
Yaffe, Gideon. Liberty Worth the Name: Locke on Free Agency. New Jersey: Princeton University Press, 2000.
- This is a book-length study of Locke’s view of human freedom. The content includes careful analysis of the chapter ‘Of Power’ of the Essay in addition to comments about how this chapter is connected to Locke’s discussion of personal identity. Yaffe defends an interpretation according to which Locke’s view contains two definitions of freedom, only one of which is “worth the name”—the kind of freedom that allows the pursuit of true good.

c. Secondary Sources: Articles

Chappell, Vere. “Locke on the Intellectual Basis of Sin.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 32 (1994): 197–207.
Chappell, Vere. “Locke on the Liberty of the Will.” In Locke’s Philosophy: Content and Context. Edited by G.A.J. Rogers, 101–21. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1994.
Chappell, Vere. “Power in Locke’s Essay.” In The Cambridge Companion to Locke’s “An Essay Concerning Human Understanding.” Edited by Lex Newman, 130–56. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007.
- In these articles, Chappell advances the interpretation that changes made in the fifth edition of the Essay indicate that Locke changed his view about human freedom.
Darwall, Stephen. “The Foundations of Morality,” In The Cambridge Companion to Early Modern Philosophy. Edited by Donald Rutherford, 221–49.
- This paper canvasses the main themes explored by and influences on early modern moral theories, including Locke’s.
Glauser, Richard. “Thinking and Willing in Locke’s Theory of Human Freedom,” Dialogue 42 (2003): 695–724.
- Glauser argues that Locke’s view remains consistent across the changes made in the various editions of the Essay.
Magri, Tito. “Locke, Suspension of Desire, and the Remote Good,” British Journal for the History of Philosophy 8 (2000): 55–70.
- Magri argues that Locke’s view changes over the course of the different editions of the Essay, in particular that he moves from having an “internalist” view of motivation to having an “externalist” view of motivation. Magri casts doubt on the consistency of Locke’s position.
Mathewson, Mark D. “John Locke and the Problems of Moral Knowledge,” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 87 (2006): 509–26.
- Mathewson argues that Locke’s comments about the nature of moral ideas leads to moral subjectivity and relativism.
Rickless, Samuel. “Locke on Active Power, Freedom, and Moral Agency,” Locke Studies 13 (2013): 31–51.
Rickless, Samuel. “Locke on the Freedom to Will.” Locke Newsletter 31 (2000): 43–68.
- In these papers, Rickless argues that Locke holds one and only one definition of freedom: the ability to act according to our volitions. According to Rickless, Locke holds the same definition of freedom as Hobbes. The 2013 paper is a direct argument against the interpretation advanced by Lolordo in Locke’s Moral Man.
Schneewind, J.B. “Locke’s Moral Philosophy,” The Cambridge Companion to Locke. Edited by Vere Chappell. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1994.
- Schneewind is one commentator who thinks that Locke’s moral philosophy ends up in a contradiction between the natural law view and hedonism.
Walsh, Julie. “Locke and the Power to Suspend Desire,” Locke Studies, 14 (2014).
- Walsh argues that Locke’s view remains consistent and coherent across the various editions of the Essay and emphasizes the role played by suspension and judgment in attaining true happiness.

Author Information

Julie Walsh
Email: julie.walsh@wellesley.edu
Wellesley College
U. S. A.

Truthmaker Theory

Truthmaker theory is the branch of metaphysics that explores the relationships between what is true and what exists. Discussions of truthmakers and truthmaking typically start with the idea that truth depends on being, and not vice versa. For example, if the sentence ‘Kangaroos live in Australia’ is true, then there are kangaroos living in Australia. And if there are kangaroos living in Australia, then the sentence ‘Kangaroos live in Australia’ is true. But we can ask whether the sentence is true because of the way the world is, or whether the world is the way it is because the sentence is true. Truthmaker theorists make the former claim that the sentence is true because of what exists in the world; it is not the case that the world is the way it is because of which sentences are true. Truthmaker theorists use this fundamental idea as a starting point for clarifying the nature of truth and its relationship to ontology, and to advance various views in metaphysics concerning the nature of the past and future, counterfactual conditionals, modality, and many others. Because truthmaker theorists end up with differing views concerning all these matters, what ultimately unites them is not any single thesis but rather a commitment to thinking that the idea of truthmaking is a useful one for pursuing metaphysical inquiry. Others might conceive of ‘truthmaker theory’ more strictly (such as by requiring a commitment to all truths having truthmakers, or all truthmakers being of a particular ontological variety), though defining the enterprise in this way will inevitably fail to capture all those earnestly pursuing investigation into truthmaking.

Philosophical discussion of truthmakers falls into two broad categories. First, there are ‘internal’ debates about the nature of truthmaker theory itself. For instance, there are open questions as to which truths have truthmakers: do all truths have truthmakers, or just some proper subset of truths (such as the positive truths or synthetic truths)? There are questions as to the nature of the truthmaking relation: is it a necessary relation or a contingent one? Is it a kind of supervenience, dependence, or something else? And it is an open question as to what sorts of objects serve as truthmakers: perhaps there are states of affairs, tropes, or counterparts that serve as truthmakers, or perhaps none of these. There is also frequent debate as to whether truthmaker theory constitutes a theory of truth (similar to, in particular, the correspondence theory of truth), or whether it is an entirely separate philosophical enterprise, one concerned more with metaphysics rather than semantics.

There are also ‘external’ truthmaking discussions that apply basic ideas about truthmaking to longstanding metaphysical topics. The hope is that truthmaker theory can bring new insights and argumentative resources to bear on traditional metaphysical inquiries. For example, truthmaker theorists investigate whether presentism—the view that only the present exists—can satisfy the obligations of truthmaker theory. Truthmaker theory has also been wielded against metaphysical views such as behaviorism and phenomenalism, and it has made contributions to the metaphysics of modality.

History of Truthmaker Theory
The Truthmaking Relation
Maximalism and Non-Maximalism
Kinds of Truthmakers
Truthmaking Principles
Truthmaking and Truth
Truthmaking and the Past
Truthmaking and Modality
Objections to Truthmaker Theory
References and Further Reading

1. History of Truthmaker Theory

Perhaps the first occurrence of a basic truthmaking idea is found in Aristotle’s Categories. There Aristotle points out that if a certain man exists, then a statement that that man exists is true, and vice versa. But it seems that there is a difference in priority between these two states of affairs. The statement is true because the man exists; it is not the case that the man exists because the statement is true. Aristotle is, in effect, raising a ‘Euthyphro’ question, drawing on Plato’s famous dialogue. Is the statement true because of the way the world is, or is the world the way it is because of which statements are true? Aristotle chose the former answer, and set the stage for discussions of truthmakers far down the road.

The idea of a truthmaker did not play a significant role in philosophy until the rise of logical atomism in the work of Bertrand Russell and Ludwig Wittgenstein. In the Philosophy of Logical Atomism, Russell takes it to be a truism that there are facts, and says that facts are the sort of thing that make propositions true or false. The project of logical atomism is then to determine what sorts of facts are ontologically required in order to make true all the different kinds of propositions. The most basic kind of fact for Russell is the atomic fact, which consists of no more than the possession of a quality by a particular object (or of the holding of a relation between multiple objects). Sentences like ‘X is green’ and ‘X is heavier than Y’, if true, are made true by atomic facts. More complex sentences like ‘X is green and is heavier than Y’ do not call for more complex, ‘molecular’ facts. Instead, the same atomic facts from before can explain the truth of conjunctive sentences. Particularly worrisome are negative truths, such as ‘X is not red’. Russell believed that there need to be negative facts to account for negative truths. In advocating for the existence of negative facts, Russell claims to have ‘nearly produced a riot’ when he suggested the idea at a seminar at Harvard (1985: 74). The idea that reality contains entities that are fundamentally negative in nature has long struck many philosophers as puzzling and metaphysically unacceptable, and there has been continuing controversy over what, if anything, makes negative truths true.

The next major advance in truthmaker theory came from the work of the Australian philosopher David Armstrong. Armstrong—who credits fellow philosopher Charlie Martin with inspiring him on the topic—has long advocated the use of truthmakers in metaphysics. Armstrong cites two paradigm examples of how truthmakers can be put to work in philosophy. First, there is the case of behaviorism, as defended by Gilbert Ryle (1949). Ryle’s philosophy of mind relies heavily on dispositions; Ryle thought that claims involving mental terms could be analyzed into subjunctive conditionals involving dispositions. What it is for Ryle to believe that he is a philosopher is that if he were to be asked what his profession was, he would reply ‘philosopher’. While this counterfactual may be true, the truthmaker theorist asks: but what is it that makes it true? The behaviorist faces a challenge of either accepting this counterfactual as a brute truth, a truth with no further explanation, or admitting that it is made true by some sort of mental state, thus abandoning the supposed ontological economy of behaviorism.

Similarly, Armstrong argues that the phenomenalism of philosophers such as Berkeley and Mill faces a parallel difficulty. According to phenomenalism, all that exists are sensory impressions. But might it not be true that there is a rock on the dark side of the moon that no one has ever observed? The phenomenalist accounts for this idea by claiming that if you were to go to that part of the moon, you would have a rock-like sensory impression. But again: what makes that counterfactual true? The anti-phenomenalist will say that the counterfactual is true because it is made true (at least in part) by the rock itself. The phenomenalist, limited by an ontology of actual sense impressions, is hard-pressed to find a plausible answer to the truthmaker theorist’s question.

In the wake of Armstrong’s (and others’) writings, truthmaker theory became a lively corner of contemporary metaphysics.

2. The Truthmaking Relation

A key concern of truthmaker theory is giving an account of the truthmaking relation. When some object X is a truthmaker for some truth Y, what is the nature of the relationship that X and Y stand in?

One universally agreed upon fact about the truthmaking relation is that it is not a one-one relation. That is, in principle an object can be a truthmaker for multiple truths, and any given truth can have multiple truthmakers. For example, Socrates is frequently thought to be a truthmaker not only for ‘Socrates exists’, but also for ‘Socrates is human’ and ‘There are humans’. For it is impossible that Socrates—who is essentially human—could exist and yet any of those sentences be false (at least given some familiar assumptions about essences). Similarly, ‘There are humans’ is made true by many things—anything that is essentially human, in fact. Hence, it can be misleading to ask what the truthmaker for some truth is, since it is not necessary that truths have only one, unique truthmaker.

So what exactly is the nature of the relation? To ask this question is to probe what sort of analysis, if any, can be given of the truthmaking relation. Many truthmaker theorists have argued that the truthmaking relation, at the least, requires metaphysical necessitation. Some object X necessitates the truth of Y if and only if it is metaphysically impossible for X to exist, and yet Y not be true. In the language of possible worlds, X necessitates Y if and only if every possible world in which X exists is a world in which Y is true. Necessitation is thought to be a necessary component of the truthmaking relation because it shows that the truthmaker’s existence is a sufficient condition on the truth in question. If X’s existence were not enough to guarantee Y’s truth, then X would not yet adequately explain or account for the truth of Y. Something else, in addition to X, would be needed to properly account for Y’s truth.

Not all theorists have agreed that necessitation is necessary for truthmaking. Hugh Mellor (2003), for instance, at one point argued that truthmakers need not necessitate the truths that they make true. Mellor relied on the controversial case of general truths, such as ‘All gold spheres are less than a mile in diameter’. Suppose there are three such spheres, A, B, and C. Then there are three states of affairs (Mellor calls them ‘facta’): A’s being less than a mile in diameter, B’s being less than a mile in diameter, and C’s being less than a mile in diameter. For Mellor, the truthmaker for the general truth is no more than the sum of the three states of affairs. But these three states of affairs do not necessitate the truth of ‘All gold spheres are less than a mile in diameter’, since it is possible that that very sum could exist, and yet the sentence be false. That is a case where, for example, A, B, and C all exist with diameters less than a mile, but a fourth gold sphere D exists whose diameter is greater than a mile. Mellor reasons that the sum of the three states of affairs is the truthmaker for ‘All gold spheres are less than a mile in diameter’, and thus concludes that truthmaking does not require necessitation. (Furthermore, on his view, the truthmaking relation is contingent in the sense that whether X is a truthmaker for Y can vary from world to world. Those who accept necessitation would reject this consequence.) Other theorists argue that truthmaking does require necessitation, and so the sum is not a truthmaker for the sentence; something else (such as one of the totality states of affairs discussed below) is needed to provide a truthmaker, or perhaps it has no truthmaker at all (according to advocates of the supervenience accounts discussed below).

It is more common for philosophers to challenge the sufficiency of the necessitation condition, rather than its necessity. The concern that necessitation is not enough derives in large part from the fact that all objects necessitate the truth of all necessary truths. This is the problem of trivial truthmakers for necessary truths. For example, Socrates necessitates ‘2 + 2 = 4’, for it is metaphysically impossible for Socrates to exist and yet ‘2 + 2 = 4’ be false. Similarly, if God exists, and exists necessarily, then a torn, dog-eared copy of Lolita rotting away in some landfill necessitates the truth of ‘God exists’. If it is impossible for that sentence to be false, then it is impossible for that sentence to be false should that rotting copy of Lolita exist. But—according to this line of thought—Socrates is not a truthmaker for ‘2 + 2 = 4’, and the copy of Lolita is not a truthmaker for ‘God exists’. Truthmaking requires more than just necessitation.

Theories divide as to what exactly else is required of the truthmaking relation. Trenton Merricks (2007) has argued that truthmaking requires ‘aboutness’, in that X is a truthmaker for Y only if Y is about X. Mathematical claims are not about Socrates, and so Socrates cannot make them true. ‘God exists’ is about God, so only God is a candidate truthmaker for it. Those who accept Merricks’s proposal thereby avoid the problem of trivial truthmakers for necessary truths.

E. J. Lowe (2007) conceives of truthmaking as depending upon the essences of propositions. X is a truthmaker for Y only if it is part of the essence of Y that it be true should an object like X exist. This amendment solves the problem of trivial truthmakers because it is no part of the essence of the proposition expressed by ‘God exists’ that it be true should the copy of Lolita exist. The essence of the proposition that God exists has nothing to do with the rotting copy of Lolita, just as the proposition that two and two are four has nothing to do with Socrates. Lowe criticizes his own view on the grounds that it implies that propositions can be related to things that do not exist. For example, Batman could have been a truthmaker for ‘There are humans’, since the nature of the proposition that there are humans is such that it is true if things like Batman existed. So according to Lowe’s account, the proposition’s essence appears to stand in a relation to a non-existent entity, which is concerning for anyone who takes relations to entail the existence of their relata.

Regardless of how the problem of trivial truthmakers is solved, theorists seem to be agreed that the truthmaking relation, however ultimately analyzed, needs to be treated as a hyperintensional relation. That is, as a matter of necessity, a particular object could exist and a particular claim could be true in all the same possible worlds without that object being a truthmaker for the claim. Hence, truthmaking is a relation that is more discriminating than modal relations such as necessitation. Truthmaking is thus more like a dependence relation, or a grounding relation, than relations like necessitation or supervenience. Sometimes it is said that truthmaking is an ‘in virtue of’ relation: X is a truthmaker for Y because Y is true ‘in virtue’ of the existence of X (for example, Rodriguez-Pereyra 2006c). X is somehow ontologically responsible for the truth of Y, and no merely intensional relation is thought to capture this deeper connection between a truth and its truthmaker.

Some theorists accept that truthmaking is a kind of ‘in virtue of’ relation, but deny that it can be further analyzed. This is the view of, for example, Gonzalo Rodriguez-Pereyra (2006c), who holds that the truthmaking relation is a primitive notion that resists analysis.

In addition to the project of analyzing the components of the truthmaking relation (or admitting that such an analysis cannot be offered), there is also a question of what the structural and logical features of the relation are. One issue concerns the nature of the kinds of relata that the relation takes. The relation is typically understood to hold between a truth and a truthmaker. In this sense it is usually ‘cross-categorial’ in that it obtains between very different kinds of things, items from different categories. The truth that Socrates exists is made true by Socrates: here we have a case where the truthmaking relation obtains between a person and a truthbearer.

For many truthmaker theorists, there is no restriction on the kind of object that can be a truthmaker. To be a truthmaker, something just needs to appropriately account for the truth of some truthbearer. On this view, truthmakers are just whatever sorts of things are ontologically available. Other views impose restrictions. For example, one might argue that only facts or state of affairs are properly thought of as truthmakers. On this view, Socrates could not be a truthmaker for ‘Socrates exists’ because Socrates himself is not a fact or state of affairs. (At best he is a sort of abstraction from various states of affairs or facts.) There must be some other entity, such as the fact that Socrates exists, or a state of affairs composed by Socrates and an existence property, that makes the sentence true. Other views would find this perspective ontologically inflating: we do not need, in addition to Socrates, some further state of affairs that requires a property of existence in order to give an ontological account of the truth of ‘Socrates exists’. Finally, some have thought that only certain entities deserve to be thought of as truthmakers, such as fundamental entities (for example, Cameron 2008). On this view, X is a truthmaker for Y only if X is a fundamental entity.

As for the other side of the truthmaking relation, theorists disagree as to what sorts of objects are the bearers of truth. More restrictive views maintain that there is only one sort of truthbearer, or that there is only one primary kind of truthbearer, compared to which all other truthbearers are derivative. For example, a common view is that some sentence or belief bears truth only in virtue of expressing a true proposition, where propositions are the primary bearers of truth and falsity. More liberal views are happy to concede that there are a variety of truthbearers, and that they can all stand in the truthmaking relation. It is not clear that substantive questions about truthmaker theory turn on one’s background views about truthbearers, but it is wise to be sensitive to the ways in which truthmaking considerations might be affected by issues concerning truthbearers. For example, one could argue that while Socrates is a sufficient truthmaker for the proposition that Socrates exists (for it is impossible for Socrates to exist and yet that proposition be false), he is not a sufficient truthmaker for the sentence ‘Socrates exists’ because it is possible for Socrates to exist and yet the sentence be false, should the sentence have turned out to have a different meaning. For example, it is possible that ‘Socrates exists’ could have meant something else—such as that Socrates is Persian—and so it is possible that Socrates could have existed and that sentence be false. On this reading, then, one might take the truthmaker for the (uninterpreted) sentence to be more involved than the truthmaker for the proposition that sentence contingently expresses. What makes ‘Socrates exists’ true is Socrates plus whatever it is that makes it true that ‘Socrates exists’ means that Socrates exists.

Finally, consider some of the logical features of the truthmaking relation. In particular, there is the issue of how truthmaking stands with respect to reflexivity, symmetry, and transitivity. A relation is reflexive when every object that stands in the relation stands in the relation to itself. This would mean that every truth is its own truthmaker. The cross-categorial nature of truthmaking prohibits this possibility. Because not all truthmakers are truthbearers, the truthmaking relation is not reflexive.

Many theorists argue that truthmaking is irreflexive, in that there is no instance of something standing in the truthmaking relation to itself. (Hence, irreflexivity is stronger than the view that truthmaking is non-reflexive, which means that not every truth is its own truthmaker.) The general thought here is that truthmaking is a kind of dependence relation, and nothing can depend upon itself. But there are plausible counterexamples to irreflexivity. For example, the proposition that there are propositions appears to be a case of self-truthmaking. Because that proposition exists, it is true. One might respond by saying that the relation in this case actually holds between the existence of the proposition and the truth of the proposition, and so not between one and the same thing. This response, however, requires a substantial rethinking of the nature of the truthmaking relation (such that it no longer holds between truthmakers and truthbearers), and the apparent reification of properties like truth and existence.

Similar remarks apply to symmetry. A symmetric relation is one where if X bears it to Y, Y bears it to X. The cross-categorial nature of truthmaking again shows that the truthmaking relation is not in general symmetric. Not all truthmakers are truthbearers. But because some truthbearers can be truthmakers, the possibility for symmetry arises, in which case the relation is just non-symmetric. (Again, some will resist by suggesting that truthmaking, as a kind of dependence, must be anti-symmetric: if X depends on Y, Y does not depend on X.) In fact, any case of reflexive truthmaking will provide a case of symmetric truthmaking.

Finally consider transitivity: if X stands in R to Y, and Y stands in R to Z, then X stands in R to Z. Transitivity fails for obvious reasons. Socrates is a truthmaker for the proposition that Socrates exists, and the proposition that Socrates exists is a truthmaker for the proposition that there are propositions. But Socrates is no truthmaker for the proposition that there are propositions. Truthmaking is not transitive in general, but there could be individual instances of it (drawing on the same cases of reflexivity and symmetry).

3. Maximalism and Non-Maximalism

Another central question any truthmaker theorist must address concerns which truths have truthmakers. Perhaps all truths have truthmakers, or perhaps just some proper subset of the truths have truthmakers. Truthmaker maximalism is the thesis that all truths have truthmakers. Truthmaker non-maximalism maintains that there are truthmaker gaps: truths that have no truthmaker.

There have not been many arguments for maximalism. Its defenders frequently claim that the view is on its own quite intuitive and plausible. Resisting maximalism, according to such advocates, threatens to court the view that truths can ‘float free’ of reality. A truth without a truthmaker, on this view, is a brute truth, a truth for which there can be no explanation. Such truths, if they exist, are thought by maximalists to be metaphysically mysterious. Others have argued for maximalism by conceiving of having a truthmaker as being somehow essential to being true. If what it is to be true is to have a truthmaker, then something cannot be true without having a truthmaker. (The relationship between truth and truthmaking is further discussed in section 5.)

One motivation for non-maximalism is the existence of plausible counterexamples to the thesis that all truths have truthmakers. Consider negative existential truths, such as ‘There are no merlions’. On the face of it, the sentence is true not because some kind of thing exists; it is true because nothing of a different kind exists. A truthmaker for the negative existential would have to be some sort of entity whose existence excluded the existence of merlions, and explained their non-existence. But there is nothing in the world among the ‘positive’ entities that can guarantee that there are no merlions. Take, for example, the set of all the actually existing animals. Taken together, their existence does not guarantee the absence of merlions. For that set of animals could exist and yet it still be true that there are, in addition, merlions. It is only if we somehow combine the existence of those animals together with the fact that those animals are all the animals that we can find a suitable truthmaker for the negative existential.

Armstrong introduced a ‘totaling’ relation in response to these difficulties. For example, there is a state of affairs composed of the sum of all the animals standing in the totaling relation to the property of being an animal. This state of affairs fixes which animals exist, and so excludes the existence of any merlions. Armstrong generalizes this approach when he argues for the existence of what he calls the ‘totality state of affairs’. This is a second-order state of affairs that is composed of the sum of all the first-order state of affairs standing in the totaling relation to the property of being a first-order state of affairs. The existence of this second-order state of affairs thereby guarantees that the first-order states of affairs that partially compose it are all the first-order states of affairs there are. This single totality state of affairs can be a truthmaker for all negative existentials (and every other truth besides).

Like Russell’s negative facts, totality states of affairs are thought by many to be entities that are not fully ‘positive’. Their existence seems to concern what is not in addition to what is, and this is thought to be metaphysically suspicious. One way of putting the worry is that they are entities whose existence bears on the existence of things that are fully distinct from them. Ordinarily, one object’s existence does not bear on the existence of other objects that are separate from it. The existence of the Statue of Liberty neither entails nor excludes the existence of the Eiffel Tower. Neither does their existence exclude the existence of other potential landmarks that happen not to exist (such as a replica of the Statue of Liberty in Victoria Harbour). Totality states of affairs are different. The totality of animals excludes the existence of merlions, though merlions are entirely distinct from totalities of animals. For this reason, some philosophers have sought to develop non-maximalist approaches to truthmaker theory.

One prominent way of defending non-maximalism is to defend alternate principles that attempt to capture the dependence of truth upon being, but without admitting that all truths have truthmakers. One such principle is the thesis that truth supervenes on being, and it has been defended in both strong and weak versions. The strong version, defended by John Bigelow (1988), is the principle that if some proposition P is true at some world W₁ but not world W₂, then there must exist some entity at W₁ that does not exist at W₂, or some entity that exists at W₂ but not W₁. This principle captures the idea that what is true cannot vary from possible world to possible world unless there is some corresponding difference in the ontology of those worlds. Truth thus depends on being, although some truths escape having truthmakers. To see why, suppose that ‘There are merlions’ is false at W₁ but true at W₂. The principle implies that something must exist in one of these worlds but not the other. In this case, there is a merlion that exists at W₂ but does not exist at W₁. Although the negative existential ‘There are no merlions’ is true at W₁, it has no truthmaker in that world. Nevertheless, its truth depends on the ontology of the world in the sense that, had it been false, there would have been something in the world’s ontology (namely, a merlion) that it does not currently have.

David Lewis (2001) has defended a weaker supervenience principle. For Lewis, if some proposition P is true at some world W₁ but not world W₂, then either there must exist some entity at only one of the worlds, or some group of things must stand in some fundamental relation at one of the worlds but not the other. Like the strong supervenience principle, this weaker principle allows one to accept negative existentials as truthmaker gaps, but also allows one to treat contingent predications as truthmaker gaps. For example, suppose that while W₁ and W₂ contain all the same objects, they differ with respect to the properties those objects have. For example, suppose some object O is blue in W₁, but red in W₂. Because ‘O is blue’ is true in W₁ but false in W₂, the strong supervenience principle requires that there be some entity that exists in one of the worlds but not the other. But ex hypothesi the two worlds have the same ontology. The advocate of strong supervenience (alongside the maximalist) requires something like a blueness trope or state of affairs (that is, O’s being blue) to exist in W₁ but not W₂. The contingent predication still needs a truthmaker. The advocate of weak supervenience, by contrast, does not require the contingent predication to have a truthmaker. While there is no entity that guarantees the truth of ‘O is blue’ in W₁, its truth nevertheless depends on being in the sense that had it been false, there must be some difference in what exists, or in what properties those things have and what relations they stand in. The worlds where ‘O is blue’ is false are worlds where either O does not exist, or has different properties, such as being red.

Maximalism, strong supervenience, and weak supervenience are all attempts to capture the basic intuition behind truthmaker theory, and avoid the commitment to there being truths that ‘float free’ of reality. Some philosophers, however, have admitted that there are truths that do not depend on being at all, in any sense. Roy Sorensen (2001), for example, has argued that the puzzling truthteller sentence ‘This very sentence is true’ has a determinate truth value, but that it can never be known. Unlike the paradoxical liar sentence (‘This very sentence is false’), the truthteller is consistent: it can be true or false without contradiction. Sorensen argues that the truthteller is what we might call a deep truthmaker gap. Its truth does not depend on being in any sense, whereas shallow truthmaker gaps like contingent predications and negative existentials (if indeed they are truthmaker gaps) still in some sense depend on being. Sorensen argues that the truthteller’s status as a deep truthmaker gap explains why its truth value is unknowable: because we usually come to know truths by way of some kind of connection to their truthmakers, the fact that the truthteller (or its negation) lacks a truthmaker explains why we do not know its truth value.

Other forms of non-maximalism include the thesis that only ‘positive’ truths have truthmakers (however the positive/negative distinction may be articulated), that only synthetic truths have truthmakers, and that only contingent truths have truthmakers. It is incumbent upon theorists adopting such views that they explain why negative, analytic, or necessary truths are best thought of as not requiring truthmakers when accounting for their truth.

Finally, consider the following argument against maximalism, which does not turn at all on the plausibility of the various sorts of ontological truthmaking posits. Consider the sentence ‘This very sentence has no truthmaker’. This sentence is provably true (see Milne 2005). To see why, first suppose it is false. In that case, it has a truthmaker, in which case it is true: contradiction. So it must be true after all. Therefore, it has no truthmaker, since that is what it says about itself. It is a truthmaker gap. Here, simple reasoning leads to the view that there is at least one truth without a truthmaker. Many maximalists reject this argument (sometimes by assimilating it to the liar paradox), but nevertheless it remains to be seen where the reasoning goes wrong (see, for example, Rodriguez-Pereyra 2006a).

4. Kinds of Truthmakers

Truthmaker theorists are motivated by ontological questions: we can make progress on figuring out what exists by pursuing questions about what truthmakers there are. Considerations about truthmaking have thus led to different views about what exactly is included in the world’s ontology. These considerations often go hand in hand with the ancient metaphysical debate between realists and nominalists in discussions over the nature and existence of universals.

In his logical atomism, Russell just accepted as a truism the existence of facts, which are the sorts of things that make propositions true. Armstrong accepts the existence of similar objects, but he calls them ‘states of affairs’. A state of affairs is a complex object composed (in a non-mereological way) by a particular together with a universal. To offer a simplified example, suppose there is a universal of being a philosopher. Socrates instantiates this universal, and so in addition to the existence of Socrates and the universal, there is a third thing—we might call it ‘Socrates’s being a philosopher’—that is a kind of fusion of the other two.

Armstrong offers a truthmaking argument for the existence of states of affairs. It is true that Socrates is a philosopher. But Socrates does not make this claim true. Because the claim is a contingent predication, it is possible that Socrates could have existed and yet not been a philosopher. So Socrates does not necessitate the truth of ‘Socrates is a philosopher’, and so is not a truthmaker for the sentence. Nor does the universal being a philosopher necessitate ‘Socrates is a philosopher’, for it might have existed without Socrates being a philosopher. (Something else could have instantiated the universal.) Furthermore, not even the mereological sum of Socrates together with being a philosopher necessitates ‘Socrates is a philosopher’. For a world in which Socrates exists but is not a philosopher, though someone else is, is a world where the mereological sum exists but the sentence is false. On this basis, Armstrong argues that there must be something else, a state of affairs, that is a fusion of the particular and the property. Every world where the state of affairs composed by Socrates and being a philosopher is a world where ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ is true. On this basis, Armstrong defends the existence of states of affairs in the name of offering a satisfying truthmaker theory for contingent predications.

Similarly, Armstrong argues that we also need totality states of affairs in order to find truthmakers for negative and general truths. All the first-order states of affairs that exist are not enough to guarantee that there are no unicorns, or that all spheres of gold are less than a mile in diameter. So Armstrong posits the existence of a totaling relation, and second-order states of affairs partially composed by it. Again we see truthmaking considerations driving an ontological argument for the existence of entities that we might not ordinarily posit.

Not all truthmaker theorists accept Armstrong’s pro-universals and pro-states of affairs approach to truthmaker theory. Others have defended nominalist positions that reject the existence of universals, and so maintain the thesis that reality is exhausted by the particular. One popular ‘moderate’ form of nominalism is the view that there are tropes, which are individual, particularized property instances. Whereas the realist maintains that there is one unified thing, the universal of being a philosopher that is commonly instantiated by both Plato and Aristotle, the trope nominalist argues that there are two different ‘being a philosopher’ tropes: the trope associated with Plato is a distinct existence from the trope associated with Aristotle. Tropes, at least if thought of as essentially tied to their bearers, can serve as truthmakers for contingent predications. If Socrates’s being a philosopher trope exists, it must be true that Socrates is a philosopher. That trope, whose identity is bound up with Socrates, cannot in any sense be ‘transferred’ to Aristotle or anyone else. So tropes are sufficient necessitators for contingent predications. For those who find tropes ontologically advantageous over universals and states of affairs, this is a compelling argument. (It remains to be seen, however, whether trope theorists can provide truthmakers for negative and general truths, and so whether they must also, in the end, posit the existence of states of affairs.)

Another nominalist-friendly approach to truthmakers comes from David Lewis (2003), who uses counterpart theory to resist the above arguments for states of affairs and tropes. On Lewis’s view, an object exists in only one possible world, but has counterparts in different possible worlds. But there are multiple ways of thinking about objects, and so multiple ways of identifying an object’s counterparts. For example, we can use the name ‘Socrates qua philosopher’ to identify a series of counterparts to Socrates, all of whom are philosophers. Similarly, ‘Socrates qua Greek’ identifies Socrates in a way such that all his counterparts are Greek. Lewis next maintains that objects under counterpart relations can be truthmakers for contingent predications: every possible world in which Socrates qua philosopher exists is a world in which Socrates (or his counterpart) is a philosopher. So Lewis provides necessitating truthmakers for contingent predications without admitting the existence of tropes or states of affairs.

The previous arguments presuppose that contingent predications and/or negative and general truths require truthmakers. If they do, then truthmaker theorists are led to positing the existence of objects such as universals, tropes, states of affairs, and counterparts. A competing perspective, however, derives from a refusal to assume maximalist truthmaking principles, and so avoids such arguments. This alternative approach does not assume from the beginning that contingent predications and/or negative and general truths require truthmakers, and so is not ready to concede that we need an ontology of counterparts, tropes, or states of affairs. Instead of defending the existence of such entities, these truthmaker theorists defend the truth of non-maximalist truthmaker principles (as discussed in section 3). For example, advocates of the strong supervenience principle—that any difference in truth between two possible worlds requires a difference in ontology between the two worlds—believe that negative and general truths do not require truthmakers, and so, for example, Armstrong’s argument for totality states of affairs is unsuccessful. Similarly, advocates of the weak supervenience principle—that any difference in truths between two possible worlds requires either a difference in ontology or a difference in what fundamental relations objects stand in—argue that contingent predications do not require truthmakers, and so the arguments above do not succeed in showing that such posits exist.

5. Truthmaking Principles

Some very general and controversial principles concerning truthmaker theory have been canvassed above, such as maximalism, strong and weak supervenience, and principles concerning whether the truthmaking relation is irreflexive (or merely non-reflexive), asymmetric (or merely non-symmetric), or anti-transitive (or merely non-transitive). Other disputed truthmaking principles concern how truthmakers relate to one another, and what other logical principles apply in the theory of truthmaking.

One such principle in truthmaker theory is the entailment principle: if X is a truthmaker for Y, then X is a truthmaker for anything entailed by Y. For example, suppose that the state of affairs of Socrates’s being a philosopher exists, and is a truthmaker for ‘Socrates is a philosopher’. Because ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ entails ‘Something is a philosopher’, the entailment principle holds that the state of affairs of Socrates’s being a philosopher is also a truthmaker for ‘Something is a philosopher’. Furthermore, any other state of affairs involving the universal being a philosopher will also be a truthmaker for ‘Something is a philosopher’, since the truthmaking relation is not one-one.

While seemingly quite plausible, the entailment principle runs into an immediate difficulty: the problem of trivial truthmakers for necessary truths. ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ also entails ‘2 + 2 =4’, at least when entailment is thought of on the model of necessary truth preservation. Every world where ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ is true is a world where ‘2 + 2 = 4’ is true. But, presumably, the state of affairs of Socrates’s being a philosopher is not a truthmaker for ‘2 + 2 =4’, though the entailment principle suggests otherwise. In response, truthmaker theorists find ways to restrict the entailment principle, or offer alternate understandings of the kind of entailment in question. Generally speaking, truthmaker theorists attempt to articulate a hyperintensional account of entailment that is more modally discriminating than standard entailment. For example, one might think that some sort of relevance notion of entailment is at stake (for example, Restall 1996); the hope is to develop a conception of entailment that maintains that while ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ entails ‘Someone is a philosopher’, it does not entail ‘2 + 2 =4’.

Another plausible truthmaking principle—and one entailed by the entailment principle—is the conjunction principle. According to this principle, any truthmaker for a conjunction is also a truthmaker for the individual conjuncts. The conjunction principle follows from the entailment principle simply because conjuncts are entailed by the conjunctions they compose. While plausible, the principle has been doubted (for example, Rodriguez-Pereyra 2006c). The principle might seem appealing so long as we think of the truthmaking relation as tracking entailment relations. But recall that the truthmaking relation is not just a necessitation or entailment relation. As an ‘in virtue of’ relation, there is more to being a truthmaker than just being a necessitator. Take, for example, the conjunctive truth ‘Socrates exists and Aristotle exists’. A plausible truthmaker for this conjunction is the mereological sum composed by Socrates and Aristotle. If that sum exists, the conjunction has to be true. But is that mereological sum a truthmaker for the individual conjuncts? Put another way: is ‘Socrates exists’ true in virtue of the existence of the mereological sum Socrates + Aristotle? One might say: no, ‘Socrates exists’ is true in virtue of the existence of Socrates, period. The mereological sum, while a genuine necessitator of the truth of ‘Socrates exists’, is not the entity responsible for the sentence’s truth. The truthmaker for the conjunction, in effect, has ‘extraneous’ parts that are irrelevant to the truth of some of its conjuncts. Since truthmaking is thought of as a hyperintensional relation such that mere necessitation is not sufficient for truthmaking, there is room to doubt that Socrates + Aristotle is a genuine truthmaker for ‘Socrates exists’. Other philosophers who defend the conjunction principle may simply accept the sum as an adequate, albeit non-‘minimal’ truthmaker for the conjunct. (That is, the truthmaker has a proper part that is also a truthmaker.) After all, a truth may have multiple truthmakers on the standard view.

A similar candidate truthmaking principle is the disjunction principle: any truthmaker for a disjunction is a truthmaker for at least one of the disjuncts. For example, if Socrates is a truthmaker for ‘Socrates exists or Cthulhu exists’, then he is a truthmaker either for ‘Socrates exists’ or ‘Cthulhu exists’. The principle seems innocuous enough, until one considers necessary disjunctions of the form ‘p or it is not the case that p’. If one accepts the basic entailment principle, then any object whatsoever is a truthmaker for every claim of the form ‘p or it is not the case that p’. By the disjunction principle, any object whatsoever is therefore a truthmaker of either ‘p’ or ‘it is not the case that p’, depending upon which one is the true disjunct. As a result, every object is a truthmaker for every truth. This unfortunate result has led many to rethink the plausibility of the entailment and disjunction principles. (This problem may well be circumvented if a ‘relevance’ style amendment to the entailment principle is offered.)

A similar, but less controversial truthmaking principle about disjunction would be that any object that is a truthmaker for some truth is also a truthmaker for any disjunction that includes that truth as a disjunct. So since Socrates is a truthmaker for ‘Socrates exists’, he is also a truthmaker for ‘Socrates exists or Caesar sank in the Rubicon’. This sort of principle has been at work since the beginning of truthmaker theory; Russell (1985) relied on it when arguing that we need not posit a realm of disjunctive facts to make disjunctive propositions true. Atomic facts on their own suffice to serve as truthmakers for disjunctions.

6. Truthmaking and Truth

This section is a halfway house in the transition away from the internal concerns of truthmaker theory, and toward its external connections with other domains of philosophy, for it is controversial whether or not the theory of truth is a distinct domain from the theory of truthmakers. This section explores the relationship between the theory of truth and the theory of truthmakers, and surveys the possible attitudes one might take about their relationship to one another.

The history of truthmaker theory is inextricably linked with the correspondence theory. The metaphysical ambitions of Russell’s logical atomism are a natural extension of the correspondence theory of truth that he was beginning to accept around the same time period. Nowadays truthmaker theory is sometimes thought of as a modified, contemporary update of correspondence theory. It is no great mystery why. According to correspondence theories of truth, a proposition is true if and only if it stands in the correspondence relation to some worldly entity. (Oftentimes these entities are thought to be facts.) According to truthmaker theory, it seems that propositions are true if and only if they have a truthmaker; that is, a proposition is true just in case it stands in the truthmaking relation to some worldly entity, its truthmaker. If one identifies the truthmaking relation with the correspondence relation, and the set of truthmakers (facts or not) with the set of corresponding objects, then it certainly appears that truthmaker theory provides a correspondence-style theory of truth.

Notice that the above perspective presupposes maximalism. The only possible way of finding a theory of truth (let alone a correspondence theory of truth) inside truthmaker theory is to first commit to the thesis that every truth has a truthmaker. Any truthmaker gap would be an exception to anyone trying to explain the nature of truth by way of truthmakers. So the fact that maximalism is an optional requirement of truthmaker theory shows that taking truthmaker theory to be a theory of truth is also optional at best.

Even granting maximalism, anyone who seeks to define truth in terms of truthmakers still faces a crucial challenge. The truthmaking relation is itself typically understood in terms of truth. Truthmakers are objects that necessitate the truth of certain propositions, and not their other features. The accounts of the truthmaking relation canvassed in section 2 all presuppose the notion of truth. The essential dependence account, for example, holds that X is a truthmaker for Y only if Y is essentially such that it is true if X exists. Unless truthmaking can somehow be analyzed without further resort to truth, it cannot, on pain of circularity, be put to work in defining truth. Truth, it seems, is prior to truthmaking. Truthmaker theory presupposes the notion of truth, and so is not fit to serve as a theory of truth itself.

If truthmaker theory presupposes the notion of truth, does it presuppose any particular conception of truth? Again, many might think that truthmaker theory presupposes a correspondence theory of truth, or some similar substantive theory of truth. Several philosophers have also argued that truthmaker theory is incompatible with deflationary theories of truth (for example, Vision 2005). According to deflationary theories, truth is not a substantive property of propositions, in virtue of which they are true. The proposition that snow is white is not true in virtue of its having some property, or standing in a particular relation (for example, correspondence) to some object (or fact). Rather, the deflationist maintains, there is nothing more to the truth of the proposition that snow is white other than snow being white.

Accordingly, some might see deflationary theories of truth as containing an implicit rejection of truthmaker theory. As a result, truthmaker theory is incompatible with deflationary theories, and must presuppose some substantive theory of truth. (If not correspondence, there are coherence theories, pragmatic theories, epistemic theories, and others.) But it is not at all clear that anything in truthmaker theory conflicts with deflationary theories of truth. The latter tend to consist of axioms such as ‘The proposition that snow is white is true if and only if snow is white’ and ‘The proposition that Socrates is a philosopher is true if and only if Socrates is a philosopher’. These biconditionals themselves do not conflict with anything in truthmaker theory (or, typically, with any other theory of truth, either). Deflationists also maintain, in addition, that these axioms exhaust all there is to be said about the nature of truth. (It is this negative claim that substantive theories of truth must reject.) But truthmaker theorists need not be offering the claims of their theories as in any way revealing the nature of truth itself. To say that the truthmaker for the proposition that Socrates is a philosopher is a particular trope, state of affairs, or Socrates under a counterpart relation is not to say anything about the nature of truth itself. Rather, it is a claim about the particular ontological grounds needed for a particular claim about Socrates. In principle, truthmaker theorists and deflationists have nothing that they must disagree about.

7. Truthmaking and the Past

A longstanding metaphysical question concerns the reality of the past. Everyone can agree that entities in the present exist. But what about the objects that do not currently exist but someday will? And what about objects that used to exist but exist no longer? Presentism is the view that reality is exhausted by the present; the only things that exist are entities in the present. Eternalism, by contrast, is the view that there is no time limit on what exists: entities from the past are just as real as presently existing entities, which are just as real as future entities.

The existence of non-present entities is a highly contentious issue in philosophy. What is less controversial is the fact that there are, presently, truths about entities from the past. Presentists and eternalists disagree as to whether Socrates, a past entity, exists. But they agree that ‘Socrates existed’ is true. (What is more contentious is whether or not there are, right now, truths about the future. Parallel problems arise for those who think that there are truths about the future, but do not believe in the existence of purely future entities.) Eternalists face no difficulty in accounting for how such claims can be true. Socrates is the truthmaker for ‘Socrates existed’ in just the way that the Eiffel Tower is the truthmaker for ‘The Eiffel Tower exists’. Socrates and the Eiffel Tower are equally real, from the eternalist’s metaphysical point of view. One is located entirely in the past, and the other is located (but not entirely) in the present. But the present is not metaphysically privileged, so entities from the past and future are freely available to eternalists to serve as truthmakers.

Presentism, by contrast, faces a challenge from truthmaker theory. Given that there are truths about the past, but nothing (fully) from the past that exists, presentists are at pains when accounting for what, if anything, there is that can make those truths about the past true. Presentists have two available options: First, they can deny that truths about the past have truthmakers. Second, they can attempt to show that there are sufficient ontological resources in the present to ground the truths about the past.

Consider first the strategy of denying that truths about the past have truthmakers. This is a form of non-maximalism that limits truthmakers to truths about the present. Recall from section 3 that there are two distinct ways of conceiving of truthmaker gaps, that is, truths without truthmakers. There are deep truthmaker gaps, which are truths that do not depend in any way whatsoever upon what exists. Deep truthmaker gaps violate the principle that truth supervenes upon being: a deep truthmaker gap could be true in one world, but false in another, without there being any other difference between the two worlds. Shallow truthmaker gaps, by contrast, do not have truthmakers, but their truth is nonetheless ontologically accountable (by way, perhaps, of their adherence to one of the supervenience principles).

It appears that presentists cannot take advantage of the supervenience principles that have been defended by truthmaker theorists, and so appear to be forced into the view that if truths about the past are truthmaker gaps, they are deep truthmaker gaps. To see why, consider two presentist universes. These worlds are metaphysically indiscernible at the present moment: all the same things exist, and stand in the same fundamental relations. But they have different histories. In one of the universes, at some point some radioactive atom A decayed within its half-life, while a neighboring atom B did not. In the other universe, B decayed within its half-life, that is, within the predicted time it would take for half of a group of B-like atoms to radioactively decay, while A did not. So in the first universe, ‘A decayed within its half-life’ is true, while it is false in the second universe. But this difference has made no later difference in the histories of these universes, and so now, at present, the two universes are indiscernible. Yet something is true in one of them but not the other. So supervenience has been violated: they are discernible with respect to truth, but indiscernible with respect to being. Hence, presentists cannot defend a non-maximalist perspective on truths about the past without conceding that those truths are deep truthmaker gaps. But deep truthmaker gaps are highly unattractive—they make the truths in question brute, inexplicable truths. Given that eternalists have an easy, straightforward account of truthmakers for truths about the past, presentists face a serious objection. Presentists might respond by claiming that the supervenience principles need to be appropriately modified, such that truth supervenes on not just present being, but past being as well. But this response requires that present truths stand in relations to past entities, which is impossible for presentists who do not believe in past entities. If there are no past entities, there are no past entities for present truths to supervene upon.

The second strategy for presentism is to deny that there are no presently available truthmakers for truths about the past. On this kind of account, the burden is on the presentist to offer an ontological account of what present entities are available that can provide grounds for truths about the past. An eclectic menagerie of entities has been posited by presentists over the years to serve as truthmakers. Some have suggested that the world—the present world—has a variety of ‘tensed properties’ (for example, Bigelow 1996). For example, while echidnas make true ‘There are echidnas’, the world’s having the property there having been dinosaurs makes true ‘There were dinosaurs’. Others have posited a realm of ‘tensed facts’ (for example, Tallant 2009). A tensed fact is a sui generis entity posited solely to provide a truthmaker for past truths. So the truthmaker for ‘There were dinosaurs’ is on this view just an entity of some sort that we call ‘the fact that there were dinosaurs’. Still others have suggested that, for example, God’s memory of there being dinosaurs is a truthmaker for ‘There were dinosaurs’ (for example, Rhoda 2009).

Anyone can posit an entity to be a truthmaker. Such posits constitute a genuine solution to the truthmaking challenge to presentism only if those entities are the right sorts of entities to be truthmakers, and only if they are entities whose existence is plausible and can be independently motivated (lest they remain ad hoc posits). After all, the eternalist stands ready with plausible, independently motivated truthmakers. Hence, presentists do not need to just offer some account of truthmakers for past truths; they need to provide an equally good account.

Tensed facts fail both sorts of challenges. Consider Socrates’s last moments, as the hemlock spread through his blood. During those moments, ‘Socrates exists’ was true, and made true by Socrates. A few moments later, ‘Socrates existed’ is true, and made true by a tensed fact that has just sprung into existence. That two truths so similar should be made true by such drastically different entities should be fairly disquieting. Socrates seems to be the perfect sort of thing to explain why ‘Socrates exists’ is true. After all, the sentence is about Socrates, a human being, and so a human being seems fit to provide the grounds for its truth. ‘Socrates existed’ is also about a human being, but now the supposed truthmaker is some sort of sui generis entity, something that is certainly composed in no way by a human being. There is no independent reason to believe in tensed facts; they are put forward as truthmakers for truths about the past by brute force, since it is unclear what they are apart from their stipulated role of being truthmakers for truths about the past.

Tensed property views face a similar sort of objection. ‘Socrates exists’ is true at some moment in virtue of Socrates. ‘Socrates existed’ is true the next moment, but in virtue of the world’s having some tensed property. Why, one might wonder, is not ‘Socrates exists’ true, when it is true, in virtue of the world having the tensed property presently containing Socrates? If such properties are not motivated to account for the present, it is unclear why we should posit them to account for the past.

In general, any strategy using presently existing entities to make true truths about the past will face a common explanatory problem (Sanson and Caplan 2010). Why are truths about the past true in virtue of things in the present? After all, truths about the past seem to be about the past, and so it is unclear how anything not from the past could be an adequate explanation of why they are true. Truthmakers are not mere necessitators; they have to give the right sort of grounds for their truths. God’s memory of there being Socrates certainly necessitates the truth of ‘Socrates existed’. But it is fair to claim that ‘Socrates existed’ is not true in virtue of God’s having a particular memory. (To deny this seems to accept some form of divine idealism.) So God’s memories aren’t the right kind of thing to make true ‘Socrates existed’. (To the view’s credit, the existence of God’s memories can at least be motivated independently—for anyone motivated to believe in God. The view is obviously a non-starter for naturalistic metaphysics.)

8. Truthmaking and Modality

Another traditionally problematic domain of truths are the modal claims: claims involving possibility and necessity, as well as related kinds of claims such as counterfactuals. For example, there are claims about mere possibilities, that is, possibilities that do not obtain, but could have. There are also necessary and impossible truths, and truths that those truths are necessary or impossible. Since such claims appear to concern a realm beyond the actual world, the grounds for their truth have long intrigued metaphysicians.

Though defended independently of his views about truthmaking, David Lewis’s modal realism can be put to work as a theory of truthmakers for some modal truths. According to Lewis, there exists, in addition to the actual world, infinitely many other concrete worlds. These other possible worlds are just as real as the actual world; the actual world bears no special metaphysical significance. While objects exist only in one possible world, they have counterparts in other worlds. An object’s counterparts are the entities in other possible worlds that are highly similar to the object (where similarity is explicated contextually). These counterparts can serve as truthmakers for modal truths concerning the actual world. For example, Socrates could have been a sophist. What makes that true, Lewis could maintain, is one of Socrates’s sophistic counterparts. Because there exists a counterpart of Socrates that is a sophist, ‘Socrates could have been a sophist’ is true in the actual world. At the same time, this view might face a relevance objection: the truth in question is a claim about Socrates, so how could it be made true by some individual existing in a separate, causally isolated possible world?

Armstrong hopes for a more austere account of the truthmakers for truths of mere possibility. To do this, he defends the principle that any truthmaker for a contingent truth is also a truthmaker for the truth that that truth is contingent. So, if some object X is a truthmaker for some contingent proposition that p, then X is a truthmaker for the truth that it is contingent that p. And if it is contingent that p, it follows that it is possible that it is not the case that p. X will therefore provide a truthmaker for the truth of mere possibility (assuming the truth of the right sort of entailment principle). For example, Socrates might not have been a philosopher, even though he was. Suppose the truthmaker for ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ is the state of affairs of Socrates’s being a philosopher. In that case, Socrates’s being a philosopher also makes it true that it is contingent that Socrates is a philosopher. By the entailment principle, Socrates’s being a philosopher is also a truthmaker for the claim that it is possible that Socrates is not a philosopher. In this way, Armstrong defends an account of truthmakers for truths of mere possibilities that does not employ resources above and beyond the ordinary truthmakers needed to grounds truths solely about the actual world.

As for necessary truths (and claims that such truths are necessary), most truthmaker theorists are agreed that not just any old entity will do, since mere necessitation is not sufficient for truthmaking. If it is true that God exists, and necessarily so, then presumably God is the truthmaker for such claims, not every object whatsoever. What is more contentious is what it is that makes mathematical statements true. Platonists might defend their view on the basis that numbers, understood Platonically, are necessary for giving an account of truthmakers for mathematical truths (for example, Baron 2013). Others might hope for a non-Platonic basis for mathematical truthmakers. Since it is agreed that truthmakers need to be ‘about’ or relevant to their corresponding truths, non-Platonists face the challenge of explaining how their purported truthmakers ground the truth of claims that at least appear to concern Platonic entities.

There are many more modal cases to keep truthmaker theorists busy. There are truths of natural necessity (for example, that all copper conducts electricity), conceptual truths (for example, that all bachelors are male), and logical truths (for example, that someone is human only if someone is human). All pose unique challenges for truthmaker theory.

9. Objections to Truthmaker Theory

Many philosophers are unmoved by truthmaker theory. A common thread running between the various objections that have been raised is that truthmaker theory lacks the sufficient motivation that would be necessary to justify its ontological posits. Truthmaker theory traditionally defends the existence of ontologically controversial entities (such as states of affairs or tropes), and so such posits should figure into theories only when they have some indispensable theoretical role to play. And many are convinced that no such role exists.

One line of objection maintains that truthmaker principles that are weaker than maximalism are not worthy of the name, and that the ontological posits required for maximalism are unacceptable. So no form of truthmaker theory is tenable. (See, for example, Dodd 2002 and Merricks 2007.) Such objections rely on conceptions of truthmaker theory that are substantially narrower than what is actually found in the literature; non-maximalists will be unmoved by such supposed refutations. It is up to truthmaker theorists, not their opponents, to decide who counts as a truthmaker theorist.

Another common style of objection is to claim that the intuitions behind truthmaker theory can be saved far more economically by ontologically innocuous principles (for example, Hornsby 2005). As a result, the key but controversial principles supporting truthmaker theory (and the ontological results they produce) are unmotivated, and so should be rejected. The objection runs as follows. As above, a central motivating thought behind truthmaker theory is that truth depends on reality. Maximalists account for this intuition by way of requiring that every truth be made true by some entity, in virtue of which that truth is true. Non-maximalists might look to the strong or weak supervenience principles to explain how what is true is not independent from what exists and how those things are arranged. But other philosophers find these principles to be overreactions to the idea that truth depends on being. For these philosophers, that idea is best cashed out by pointing to the instances of the following schema:

The proposition that p is true because p.

For instance, the proposition that Socrates is a philosopher is true because Socrates is a philosopher. According to the objection, this ‘because principle’ suffices to explain how the truth of the proposition that Socrates is a philosopher depends upon reality. After all, this maneuver seems to capture the asymmetry between truth and reality. For instances of the reverse schema are false:

p because the proposition that p is true.

It is not the case that Socrates is a philosopher because the proposition that Socrates is a philosopher is true. Hence, there is no need to entertain the existence of a state of affairs or trope, and no need to posit general claims about the supervenience of truth on being.

The most natural response for truthmaker theorists to make is that the above ‘because principles’ remain silent on the questions of interest to truthmaker theorists. Advocates of the objection claim that such principles express the appropriate dependency between truth and reality. But there is no mention of reality anywhere in the principles. Consider what is being expressed by the ‘because principles’. They appear to apply a relation—the ‘because’ relation—between two sentences, or perhaps two propositions. The first sentence applies truth to a proposition; the second is just the use of a sentence that expresses that proposition. The ‘because principle’ cannot be expressing a relation involving entities such as facts or states of affairs, since the objector does not believe in the need for an ontology of those kinds of things. In fact, one can endorse a ‘because principle’ without taking any metaphysical or ontological stand about anything. The sentence ‘Socrates is a philosopher’ is completely silent on what exists. The sentence itself does not tell you what its ontological commitments are; one must bring to the sentence a theory of ontological commitment or truthmaking in order to determine what its metaphysical implications are. Presumably, advocates of the ‘because principles’ think that the used sentence following ‘because’ somehow involves reality. In so doing, they betray the fact that they are reading ontological implications already into the sentence. They are bringing, in other words, an implicit theory of truthmaking to the table.

Consider again the sorts of suspicious counterfactual conditionals that motivated truthmaker theory in the first place. The counterfactual ‘If I were to go to the quad I would have a tree-like sensory impression’ appears to be true, and true in virtue of the existence of a real, live tree in the quadrangle courtyard. That is the view that puts pressure on ontologies limited to actual sensory impressions: they have no available truthmakers for such counterfactuals, and so must take such claims to be primitive, brute truths. The objector to truthmaker theory points out that the proposition that if I were to go to the quad I would have a tree-like sensory impression is true because if I were to go to the quad I would have a tree-like sensory impression. That is true, but beside the point. It does not explain the need for something to exist in order for something to be true. We’re left wondering why I would have a tree-like sensory impression if I were to go to the quad. All the ‘because principle’ does (at least on the readings available to the objector) is cite a relation that obtains between two sentences or propositions; but truthmaker theorists are after a relation between truth and reality.

10. References and Further Reading

Armstrong, D. M. 2004. Truth and Truthmakers. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- A systematic account of truthmaker theory by one of its most established proponents.
Baron, Sam. 2013. A truthmaker indispensability argument. Synthese 190: 2413-2427.
- Argues for mathematical Platonism on the basis of certain truthmaking considerations.
Beebee, Helen and Julian Dodd. 2005. Truthmakers: The Contemporary Debate. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- An anthology of various essays both critical and supportive of truthmaker theory.
Bigelow, John. 1988. The Reality of Numbers: A Physicalist’s Philosophy of Mathematics. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Defends the strong supervenience principle, offering a non-maximalist approach to truthmaker theory.
Bigelow, John. 1996. Presentism and properties. Philosophical Perspectives 10: 35-52.
- Discusses the relationship between truthmaker theory and presentism; defends the view that truths about the past have truthmakers in the present.
Cameron, Ross P. 2008. Truthmakers and ontological commitment: or how to deal with complex objects and mathematical ontology without getting into trouble. Philosophical Studies 140: 1-18.
- Defends a view that requires truthmakers to be fundamental entities.
Caplan, Ben and David Sanson. 2011. Presentism and truthmaking. Philosophy Compass 6: 196-208.
- Provides an accessible introduction to presentism and truthmaker theory.
Dodd, Julian. 2002. Is truth supervenient on being? Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society (New Series) 102: 69-85.
- Argues that truthmaker theory is unmotivated.
Hornsby, Jennifer. 2005. Truth without truthmaking entities. In Truthmakers: The Contemporary Debate, eds. Helen Beebee and Julian Dodd, 33-47. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Argues that the intuitions behind truthmaking can be captured without resort to contentious ontological posits.
Lewis, David. 2001. Truthmaking and difference-making. Noûs 35: 602-615.
- Provides an important critical perspective on maximalist truthmaker theory that relies on defending the weak supervenience principle.
Lewis, David. 2003. Things qua truthmakers. In Real Metaphysics: Essays in Honour of D. H. Mellor, eds. Hallvard Lillehammer and Gonzalo Rodriguez-Pereyra, 25-42. London: Routledge.
- Provides a nominalist-friendly account of truthmaker theory that employs counterpart theory.
Lowe, E. J. 2009. An essentialist approach to truth-making. In Truth and Truth-Making, eds. E. J. Lowe and A. Rami, 201-216. Stocksfield: Acumen.
- Defends the view that the truthmaking relation is a kind of essential dependence.
Lowe, E. J. and A. Rami, eds. 2009. Truth and Truth-Making. Stocksfield: Acumen.
- An anthology of papers on truthmaker theory, including several on this list, that provides an introduction to core issues in truthmaker theory.
MacBride, Fraser. 2014. Truthmakers. In The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Spring 2014 Edition), ed. Edward N. Zalta.
- Provides a detailed overview of several main theoretical concerns within truthmaker theory.
Mellor, D. H. 2003. Real metaphysics: replies. In Real Metaphysics: Essays in Honour of D. H. Mellor, eds. Hallvard Lillehammer and Gonzalo Rodriguez-Pereyra, 212-238. London: Routledge.
- Offers an argument that the truthmaking relation does not require necessitation.
Merricks, Trenton. 2007. Truth and Ontology. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Offers a sustained and ultimately negative critical evaluation of truthmaker theory.
Milne, Peter. 2005. Not every truth has a truthmaker. Analysis 65: 221-224.
- Raises a potential paradox for maximalism.
Molnar, George. 2000. Truthmakers for negative truths. Australasian Journal of Philosophy 78: 72-86.
- Introduces and discusses the problem of negative truths for truthmaker theory.
Mulligan, Kevin, Peter Simons and Barry Smith. 1984. Truth-makers. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 44: 287-321.
- Offers a non-maximalist approach to truthmaker theory without resorting to states of affairs that begins by finding truthmakers for atomic facts.
Restall, Greg. 1996. Truthmakers, entailment and necessity. Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 331-340.
- Discusses problems (such as that related to the disjunction principle) with treating the truthmaking relation merely as a relation of necessitation.
Rhoda, Alan R. 2009. Presentism, truthmakers, and God. Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 90: 41-62.
- Posits the existence of God’s memories as providing presentist-friendly truthmakers for truths about the past.
Rodriguez-Pereyra, Gonzalo. 2006a. Truthmaker Maximalism defended. Analysis 66: 260-264.
- Defends truthmaker maximalism against Milne’s argument on the grounds that it begs the question.
Rodriguez-Pereyra, Gonzalo. 2006b. Truthmakers. Philosophy Compass 1: 186-200.
- Provides a highly accessible introduction to central issues in truthmaker theory.
Rodriguez-Pereyra, Gonzalo. 2006c. Truthmaking, entailment, and the conjunction thesis. Mind (New Series) 115: 957-982.
- Argues against certain core principles discussed in the truthmaking literature.
Russell, Bertrand. 1985. The Philosophy of Logical Atomism. ed. David Pears. La Salle, IL: Open Court.
- An early work that makes use of truthmaking ideas that gave rise to and inspired future contemporary work on truthmakers.
Ryle, Gilbert. 1949. The Concept of Mind. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
- Presents Ryle’s behaviorism that becomes a later target of truthmaker theory.
Sanson, David and Ben Caplan. 2010. The way things were. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 81: 24-39.
- Argues against various defenses of truthmakers for presentism on the ground that such posits are insufficiently explanatory.
Sorensen, Roy. 2001. Vagueness and Contradiction. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- In the last chapter of this book Sorensen argues that the truthtelling sentence ‘This very sentence is true’ is a deep truthmaker gap: a truth without a truthmaker that depends in no way upon reality.
Tallant, Jonathan. 2009. Presentism and truth-making. Erkenntnis 71: 407-416.
- Discusses various strategies for presentist truthmaking.
Vision, Gerald. 2005. Deflationary truthmaking. European Journal of Philosophy 13: 364-380.
- Discusses the relationship between truthmaker theory and the deflationary theory of truth, and finds the two projects difficult to combine.

Author Information

Jamin Asay
Email: asay@hku.hk
University of Hong Kong
Hong Kong

Pejorative Language

Some words can hurt. Slurs, insults, and swears can be highly offensive and derogatory. Some theorists hold that the derogatory capacity of a pejorative word or phrase is best explained by the content it expresses. In opposition to content theories, deflationism denies that there is any specifically derogatory content expressed by pejoratives.

As noun phrases, ‘insult’ and ‘slur’ refer to symbolic vehicles designed by convention to derogate targeted individuals or groups. When used as verb phrases, ‘insult’ and ‘slur’ refer to actions performed by agents (Anderson and Lepore 2013b). Insulting or slurring someone does not require the use of language. Many different kinds of paralinguistic behavior could be used to insult_(verb)or slur_(verb) a targeted individual. Slamming a door in an interlocutor’s face is one way to insult them. Another way would be to sneer at them. Arguably, one could slur a Jewish person by performing a “Nazi salute” gesture in their presence. This article focuses on the linguistic meaning(s) that pejorative words encode as symbolic vehicles designed by convention to derogate (or harm) their targets.

Furthermore, it is important to delineate the differences between slurring and insulting. The latter is a matter of causing someone to be offended, where offense is a subjective psychological state (Hom 2012, p 397). Slurring, contrastly, does not require offending a target or eliciting any reaction whatsoever. For instance, the word ‘nigger’, used pejoratively at a Ku Klux Klan rally, derogates African Americans even if none are around to be offended by its use.

Desiderata
Content Theories
A Deflationary Theory
Broader Applications
References and Further Reading

1. Desiderata

This section focuses on five central features of pejoratives: practical features, descriptive features, embedded uses, expressive autonomy and appropriation. An explanation of these features is among the desiderata for an adequate theory of pejoratives.

a. Practical Features

There is a family of related practical features exhibited by pejoratives. First, pejoratives have the striking power to influence and motivate listeners. Insults and slurs can be used as tools for promoting destructive ways of thinking about their targets. Calling someone ‘loser’, for example, is a way of soliciting listeners to view them as undesirable, damaged, inferior, and so forth. Racial slurs have the function of propagating racism in a speech community. ‘Nigger’, for example, has the function of normalizing hateful attitudes and harmful discriminatory practices toward various “non-white” groups. Speakers have used the term to derogate African Americans, Black Africans, East Indians, Arabs, and Polynesians (among others). This is not to suggest that the derogation accomplished by means of pejoratives is always highly destructive. In some circumstances, insults like ‘asshole’ can be used to facilitate mild teasing between friends.

Second, some pejoratives tend to make listeners feel sullied. In some cases, merely overhearing a slur is sufficient for making a non-prejudiced listener feel complicit in a speaker’s slurring performance (Camp 2013) (Croom 2011). Third, different pejoratives vary in their levels of intensity (Saka 2007, p 148). For instance, ‘nigger’ is much more derogatory toward Blacks than ‘honky’ is toward Whites. Even different slurs for a particular group can vary in their derogatory intensity (for example, ‘nigger’ is more derogatory than ‘negro’). Further, pejoratives exhibit derogatory variation across time. While ‘negro’ was once used as a neutral classifying term, it is now highly offensive (Hom 2010, p 166). A successful theory of pejoratives will need to account for their various practical features.

b. Descriptive Features

Gibbard (2003) suggests that the notion of a thick ethical concept, due to Williams (1985), can shed light on the meaning of slurs. In comparison with thin ethical concepts (such as right and wrong, just and unjust), thick ethical concepts contain both evaluative and descriptive content. Paradigm examples include cruel, cowardly and unchaste. For Williams, terms that express thick ethical concepts not only play a role in prescribing and motivating action; they also purport to describe how things are. To say that a person is cruel, for example, is to say that they bring about suffering, and they are morally wrong for doing so. (For more on the distinction between thick and thin moral terms, see Metaethics.) According to Gibbard,

[r]acial epithets may sometimes work this way: where the local population stems from different far parts of the world, classification by ancestry can be factual and descriptive, but, alas, the terms people use for this are often denigrating. Nonracists can recognize things people say as truths objectionably couched. (2003, p 300)

Although Gibbard’s claim that slurring statements express truths that are “objectionably couched” is controversial, it does seem that slurs classify their respective targets. A speaker who calls an Italian person ‘spic’ does not merely say something offensive and derogatory – said speaker simulateneously makes a factual error in classifying his target incorrectly. Similarly, the insult ‘moron’ appears to both ascribe a low level of intelligence to its targets and evaluate them negatively for it. Additionally, as the following example illustrates, some swear words seem to contain descriptive content:

(1) A: Tom fucked Jerry for the first time last week.

B: No, they fucked for the second time last week; the first was two months ago.

Also, consider the following example (Hom 2010, p 170):

(2) Random fucking is risky behavior.

There appears to be genuine disagreement between A and B in (1) and someone who asserts (2) has surely made a claim capable of being true or false. A successful theory of pejoratives should explain, or explain away, apparent descriptive, truth-conditional features.

c. Embedded Uses

Potts (2007) observes that most pejoratives appear to exhibit nondisplaceability: the use of a pejorative is derogatory even as an embedded term in a larger construction. An indirect report or a conditional sentence are often vehicles of nondisplacibility; direct quotations, however, are excluded. Consider, for example, that Sue has uttered (3) and another speaker attempts to report on her utterance with (4):

(3) That asshole Steve is on time today.

(4) Sue said that that asshole Steve is on time today.

As long as the occurrence of ‘asshole’ is not read as implicitly metalinguistic—with a change in intonation or an accompanying gesture indicating that the speaker wishes to distance herself from any negative feelings toward Steve—listeners will interpret the speaker of (4) as making a disparaging remark about Steve, even if the speaker is merely attempting to report on Sue’s utterance.

Like the insult ‘asshole’, the gendered slur ‘bitch’ appears to scope out of indirect reports. Suppose Eric utters (5) and someone tries to report on his utterance with (6):

(5) A bitch ran for President of the United States in 2008.

(6) Eric said that a bitch ran for President of the United States in 2008.

It would be difficult to use (6) to give a neutral (non-sexist) report of Eric’s offensive claim. Unless a metalinguistic reading is available for the occurrence of ‘bitch’, anyone who utters (6) in an attempt to report on Eric’s utterance of (5) risks making an offensive claim about women (Anderson and Lepore 2013a, p 29).

Potts claims that one way in which pejoratives are nondisplaceable is that they always tell us about the current utterance situation (2007, p 169-71). Consider

(7) That bastard Kresge was late for work yesterday (#But he’s no bastard today, because he was on time)

Despite the fact that ‘bastard’ is within the scope of a tense operator in (7), it would be implausible to read the speaker as claiming that she disliked Kresge only in the past, as the defective parenthetical (indicated by the hash sign) illustrates.

However, not all pejoratives behave the same way when embedded. Consider (8)-(11):

(8) If Steve doesn’t finish his report by the end of the week, he’s fucked (but I suspect he’ll finish on time.)

(9) Suppose our new employee, Steve, is a bastard (On the other hand, maybe he’ll be nice)

(10) Steve is not a bastard (I think he’s a good guy).

(11) Steve used to be a real fucker in law school (but I like him much better now).

A speaker who utters (8)-(11) need not be said to have made a disparaging claim about Steve. This is because the occurrences of ‘fucked’, ‘bastard’, and ‘fucker’ in (8)-(11) appear to be “narrow-scoping” (Hom 2012, p.387). Thus, at least some embedded uses of pejoratives seem not to commit the speaker to an offensive claim (compare the non-defective parentheticals in these cases with the defective one in (7)).

Slurring words, however, appear to behave differently. As (12) and (13) illustrate, slurs are just as offensive and derogatory when uttered as part of a supposition or embedded in a conditional sentence as when they are used in predicative assertions:

(12) If the guys standing at the end of my driveway are spics, I’ll tell them to leave (#Fortunately, there is no such thing as a spic, since no one is inferior for being Hispanic)

(13) Suppose the next job applicant is a nigger. (#Of course that won’t happen, since no one is inferior for being Black.)

Notice the defectiveness of the parentheticals as attempts to cancel the derogatoriness of the preceding sentences. In general, slurs appear to take wide scope relative to all truth-conditional operators, including negation. Consider the following explicit attempt to reject a racist claim:

(14) It is not the case that Ben is a kike; he is not Jewish!

(14) fails to undermine the derogatoriness of the slur ‘kike’. Seemingly, the trouble is that it only disavows a derogatory way of thinking about Ben, and so it cannot be used to reject a racist attitude toward Jews in general (Camp 2013). Further, as Saka (2007, p 122) observes, even Tarskian disquotational sentences containing slurs appear to express hostility:

(15) “Nietzsche was a kraut” is true iff Nietzsche was a kraut.

A successful theory of pejoratives must explain the behavior of embedded pejorative words and phrases, and more specifically, must account for the fact that slurring words and insulting words appear to behave differently within the scope of truth-conditional and intensional operators. A successful theory must also resolve the apparent tension between the putative descriptive features of slurs, and their behavior under embedding.

d. Expressive Autonomy

The expressive power of a pejorative term is autonomous to the extent that it is independent of the attitudes of particular speakers who use the term. Slurring words appear to exhibit derogatory autonomy– their derogatory capacity is independent of the attitudes of speakers who use them (Hom 2008, p426). For instance, a racist who intends to express affection toward Italians by asserting, ‘I love wops; they are my favorite people on Earth’, has still used the slur in a patently offensive manner (Anderson and Lepore 2013a, p33). Likewise, a competent speaker who knows that ‘kike’ is a term of abuse for Jews could not stipulate a non-derogatory meaning by uttering, “What’s wrong with saying that kikes are smart? By ‘kike’, I just mean Jews, and Jews are smart, aren’t they?” (Saka 2007, p 148).

e. Appropriation

Some pejoratives are used systematically to accomplish aims other than those for which they were designed. Appropriation refers to the various systematic ways in which agents repurpose pejorative language. For certain slurs, the target group takes over the term to transform its meaning to lessen or to eliminate its derogatory force. This is one variety of appropriation known as linguistic reclamation(Brontsema 2004). The term ‘queer’ is a paradigm case. Although ‘queer’ once derogated those who engaged in sexually abnormal behavior, the term ‘queer’ now contains little to no derogatory force as a result of homosexual women and men appropriating the term. Now, non-prejudiced speakers can use the term ‘queer’ in a various contexts. For instance, phrases such as ‘queer studies program’ and ‘queer theory’ do not derogate homosexuals. In contrast, the slur ‘nigger’ -often marked by an alternative spelling ‘nigga’- has been appropriated more exclusively by the target group, and is often used as a means of expressing camaraderie between group members (Saka 2007, p145). Barring a few rare exceptions, targeted speakers can use the term to refer to one another in a non-denigrating way. Appropriated uses of ‘nigger’ are common in comedic performances and satire. The use of ‘nigger’ in a comedy bit designed to mock and criticize racism need not commit the speaker to racist attitudes (Richard 2008, p.12).

Insults are also subject to appropriation. In some contexts, an insult can be used to express something more jocular or affectionate than hateful, such as in the phrase: ‘George is the most lovable bastard I know’. A successful theory of these phenomena need to account for their various appropriated uses.

2. Content Theories

According to content theories, pejorative words are derogatory in virtue of the content they express. This section contains an overview and discussion of several content theories and their merits, followed by standard criticisms.

a. Pejorative Content as Fregean Coloring

For Gottlob Frege, two aspects to the meaning of a term are its reference and its sense. The reference is what the term denotes, while the sense provides instructions for picking out the reference. (For more on this distinction see Gottlob Frege: Language.) Additionally, Frege posited an expressive realm of meaning separate from sense and reference. For Frege, a word’s färbung (often translated as ‘coloring’ or ‘shading’) is constituted by the negative or positive psychological states associated with it that play no role in determining the truth-value of utterances that include it. The terms ‘dog’ and ‘cur’, for example, share the same sense and reference, but the latter has a negative coloring – something like disgust or contempt for the targeted canine (Frege 1892, p.240). Likewise for the neutral term ‘English’ and the slur ‘Limey’, which was once applied exclusively to English sailors, but now targets English people generally:

(16) Mary is English.

(17) Mary is a Limey.

For Frege, both (16) and (17) are true just in case Mary is English. However, for most speakers, ‘English’ is neutral in coloring, while ‘Limey’ is associated with negative feelings for English people.

Although the Fregean approach accounts for the descriptive features of pejoratives as well as the behavior of slurs when embedded, most contemporary theorists reject it (see, for example, Hom (2008)). For Frege, “coloring and shading are not objective, and must be evoked by each hearer or reader” (1897, p 155). On his view, a pejorative term’s coloring is not conventional (in any sense of the term); rather, coloring consists only in subjective (non-conventional) associations speakers have with the term. Dummett (1981) diagnoses the problem with positing an essentially subjective realm of meaning: the meaning of a linguistic sign or symbol cannot be in principle subjective, since it is what speakers conveyto listeners. Given the subjective nature of coloring, Fregeans are committed to holding that the derogatory power of slurs is due to subjective associations held by speakers and listeners. As a result, Fregeans will have difficulty accounting for expressive autonomy (Hom 2008, p 421). For instance, Fregeans will have trouble explaining why ‘nigger’ can be just as derogatory in the mouth of a racist as it is when uttered by a non-racist. In reply, Fregeans might offer a dispositional theory of coloring. Consider an analogy with a dispositional theory of color, according to which a thing is yellow, for example, if it disposes normal agents in appropriate conditions to have a qualitative experience of yellow. Similarly, Fregeans might hold that a slur S has a negative coloring to the extent that uttering or hearing S disposes speakers and listeners to have derogatory attitudes toward the target. This approach could generalize to other pejorative terms. Consider Frege’s example of ‘cur’. On the revised version of the theory, ‘cur’ has a negative coloring to the extent that competent listeners who hear the term predicated of a dog are disposed to think of the targeted canine as flea-ridden, mangy, and dangerous. Such an account might be promising, but much more would need to be said about how hearing the word disposes listeners to think in derogatory ways. As it stands, the Fregean view does little to explain how pejoratives can be so rhetorically powerful.

b. Expressivism

Another main theory of pejoratives is a descendent of the metaethical view known as expressivism. According to the version of expressivism developed by Ayer (1936), moral and aesthetic statements do not express propositions capable of being true or false, and merely serve to express and endorse the speaker’s own moral sentiments. For Ayer, an assertion of ‘Stealing is wrong’ does not express a truth-evaluable proposition; rather, it merely expresses the speaker’s disapproval of stealing. (For more on expressivism, see Non-Cognitivism in Ethics.)

One might extend Ayer’s expressivism to cover pejoratives. On this view, derogatory statements containing pejoratives do not express propositions capable of being true or false – they merely express a non-cognitive attitude, such as disapproval, of the target group. An expressivist theory of pejoratives is well suited to explain the behavior of slurs under embedding. However, it will have difficulty accounting for their descriptive features. As noted above, a speaker who calls an Italian person ‘spic’ has seemingly made a classificatory error. If slurs lack descriptive content, and merely serve to express non-cognitive attitudes, then it is unclear how they could classify their targets.

Saka (2007) offers an alternative, hybrid expressivist theory of slurs, according to which slurs contain both expressive and descriptive content (see also Kaplan (2004)). Saka denies that there is a single belief or proposition expressed by slurring statements such as ‘Nietzsche was a kraut’. Rather, such statements express an attitude complex, which includes (i) the pure belief that Nietzsche was German, and (ii) a cognitive-affective state toward Germans (Saka 2007, p 143). Saka’s hybrid theory could plausibly account for the descriptive, truth-conditional features of pejoratives.

However, it is not clear that either the pure expressivist theory of pejoratives or Saka’s hybrid theory can extend to all pejoratives. According to a standard objection to metaethical expressivism, the so-called Frege-Geach problem, one can utter a sentence containing a moral predicate (such as ‘good’, ‘evil’, ‘right’, and ‘wrong’) as the antecedent or consequent of a conditional sentence without making a moral judgment. Expressivists about moral terms are unable to account for the sameness of content in both asserted and non-asserted contexts, so the objection goes. For example, as Geach (1965) observed, the following is a valid argument:

(18) If tormenting the cat is wrong, then getting your brother to do it is wrong.

(19) Tormenting the cat is wrong.

(20) Therefore, getting your brother to do it is wrong.

If, as the metaethical expressivist claims, ‘wrong’ merely expresses a speaker’s approval, then it is a mystery how the term ‘wrong’ could carry the same content in (19) and when embedded in the antecedent of the conditional sentence in (18), given that (19) expresses a moral judgment while (18) does not. Hom (2010) argues that expressivist theories of swears face a similar challenge. Consider the following argument:

(21) If George fucked up his presentation, he will be fired.

(22) George fucked up his presentation.

(23) Therefore, he will be fired.

In order for this argument to be valid, the pejorative term ‘fucked’ must have the same semantic content in (21) and (22), despite the fact that (21) does not express a negative attitude about George, while (22) does. It is difficult to see how the pure expressivist theory could account for this. Although Saka’s hybrid theory has the potential to explain the preservation of content between (21) and (22), his view will have difficulty accounting for the fact that (21) expresses no negative attitude about George.

Additionally, one might worry that the non-cognitive attitudes posited by expressivism are too underspecified to account for derogatory variation (‘kraut’ is less derogatory than ‘nigger’ is, and so forth). Do all pejoratives express something like ‘contempt’ or ‘hostility’ or do the negative attitudes differ for each term? Saka claims that derogatory variation among slurs is due to the historical circumstances that led to their introduction and sustain their derogatory power (Saka 2007, p148). But the appeal to historical context here is illicit if the derogatoriness of slurs is to be explained by an attitude complex expressed by speakers who use the term. After appealing to external institutions to explain the derogatory features of slurs, it appears that the posited attitude complex has no remaining explanatory work.

Finally, expressivists need to do more to explain how the expression of negative attitudes relates to the practical features of slurs. In particular, they need to specify a notion of expression that makes it clear how the expression of hostility (or contempt, and so forth) toward a target could motivate listeners to feel similarly.

c. Slurs and Truth-Value Gaps

Richard (2008) holds that slurs express derogatory attitudes toward their targets, but unlike Saka he claims that slurs lack truth-conditional content. Richard is not a pure expressivist, since he does not take the derogatory content of slurs to be a negative affective state. He denies that slurring speech is false by claiming that to apply the term ‘false’ to an utterance is to claim that the speaker made an error that can be corrected by judicious use of negation. Nevertheless, examples like “My neighbor isn’t a chink; she’s Japanese,” suggest that it cannot. Richard also denies that derogatory statements containing slurs can be true. He acknowledges that predicating a slur of someone entails classifying him or her as a member of a particular group, but he denies that correct classification suffices for truth. For instance, Richard holds that the anti-Semite can correctly classify a person as Jewish by calling them ‘kike’, but when a speaker slurs a Jewish person with ‘kike’, they have not simply classified them as Jewish nor have they merely expressed an affective state (like hatred or contempt) – they have misrepresented the target as being despicable for being Jewish. According to Richard, we cannot endorse the classification as true without also endorsing the representation as accurate. On his view, whatever truth belongs to a classification is truth it inherited from the thought expressed in making it, and the thought expressed by the anti-Semite who uses the slur ‘kike’ is the mistaken thought that Jews are despicable for being Jewish (Richard 2008, p. 24).

Although Richard’s view could potentially make sense of the behavior of slurs under embedding, he does not offer a positive theory of how slurs represent their targets. He might hold that the relevant sort of representation is imagistic. Perhaps hearing a slur puts an unflattering image of the target group in the minds of listeners. In any event, Richard offers no help here. Instead, he is interested only in establishing that there are numerous statements – among them, derogatory statements containing slurs – that have a determinate content, yet are not truth-apt. Others include applications of vague predicates to borderline cases and statements that give rise to liar paradoxes. As it stands, nothing in Richard’s view helps us see how misrepresenting a target by means of calling them a pejorative word has the power to motivate listeners to think derogatory thoughts about them. Thus, Richard’s view leaves the practical features of slurs unexplained.

Further, there are reasons to be doubtful of Richard’s claim that slurs always misrepresent their targets. While this claim seems plausible in the case of racial slurs, it is not obviously true of all slurring words. Consider ‘fascist’, which is a slur for officials in an authoritarian political system. On Richard’s view, to call Mussolini and Hitler fascists is to represent them as contemptible for their political affiliation. Presumably, this would not be to misrepresent them. Richard might agree, and respond that the concept of truth is not what we should use when evaluating a slurring performance as accurate or inaccurate. In that case, Richard still owes a positive account of how such words can accurately represent their targets. Absent these details, it is difficult to evaluate Richard’s claims.

d. A Gestural Theory

Hornsby (2001) offers a theory of the derogatory content of slurs, but her view could be extended to cover other pejoratives:

It is as if someone who used, say, the word ‘nigger’ had made a particular gesture while uttering the word’s neutral counterpart. An aspect of the word’s meaning is to be thought of as if it were communicated by means of this (posited) gesture. The gesture is made, ineludibly, in the course of speaking, and is thus to be explicated…in illocutionary terms. (p 140)

According to Hornsby, the gestural content of a slur cannot be captured in terms of a proposition or thought. Rather, “the commitments incurred by someone who makes the gesture are commitments to targeted emotional attitudes” (2001, p140). Hornsby’s gestural theory has the potential to account for slurs’ expressive autonomy and their offensiveness when embedded. Unfortunately, Hornsby’s central thesis is unclear. On one interpretation, she holds that a speaker who uses a slur actually performs a pejorative gesture in the course of uttering it, although the gesture itself is elliptical. On another interpretation, she is claiming only that using a slur is analogous to performing a derogatory gesture. For either interpretation, there is a lacunae in Hornsby’s theory. If the first interpretation is what Hornsby intends, she owes an account of what the posited gestures are supposed to be. Perhaps she thinks that to call an African American ‘nigger’ is to perform an elliptical “throat slash” in their direction (Hom 2008, p418). Or maybe uttering ‘nigger’ amounts to giving targets “the finger”. If this is what Hornsby intends, she owes an account of how it is possible to perform an elided gesture. On the other hand, if Hornsby is merely claiming that derogatory uses of slurs are analogous to pejorative gestures, she needs to specify how tight the analogy is.

e. A Perspectival Theory

Camp (2013) offers a perspectival theory of slurs. On her view, slurs are so rhetorically powerful because they signal allegiance to a perspective, which is an integrated, intuitive way of thinking about the target group (p335). For Camp, a speaker who slurs some group G non-defeasibly signals his affiliation with a way of thinking and feeling about Gs as a whole (p340). The perspectival account offers an explanation for why slurs produce a feeling of complicity in their hearers, that is, why non-racist listeners tend to feel implicated in a speaker’s slurring performance. Camp describes two kinds of complicity. First, there is cognitive complicity:

The nature of semantic understanding, along with the fact that perspectives are intuitive cognitive structures only partially under conscious control, means that simply hearing a slur activates an associated perspective in the mind of a linguistically and culturally competent hearer. This in turn affects the hearer’s own intuitive patterns of thought: she now thinks about G’s in general, about the specific G (if any) being discussed, and indeed about anyone affiliated with Gs in the slurs’ light, however little she wants to. (p343)

Second, there is social complicity: the fact that there exists a word designed by convention to express the speaker’s perspective indicates that the perspective is widespread in the hearer’s culture, and being reminded of this may be painful for non-prejudiced listeners (Camp 2013, p344; see also Saka 2007, p 142). Camp’s theory also has the potential to explain linguistic reclamation. When a slur is taken over by its target group and its pejorative meaning is transformed; the derogatory perspective it once signaled becomes detached and the term comes to signal allegiance to a neutral (or positive) perspective on the target.

One might take issue with Camp’s claim that complicity is due to speakers signaling the presence of racist attitudes. In general, merely signaling one’s own perspective is insufficient for generating complicity. For instance, one might signal one’s libertarian political perspective by placing a ‘Ron Paul’ bumper sticker on one’s car, yet this behavior is not likely to make observers feel complicit in the expression of a libertarian perspective. Even signaling one’s racist attitudes need not lead others to feel complicit. For instance, one might overtly signal a racist perspective by refusing to sit next to members of a certain race on a bus or by crossing the street whenever a member of a certain race is walking toward them; however, in most cases, this sort of behavior is not likely to activate a derogatory perspective in observers or make observers feel complicit. Thus, the fact that slurs signal a derogatory perspective, if it is a fact, does not explain why slurs tend to make listeners feel complicit in the expression of a derogatory attitude.

f. Implicature Theories

In some cases, what a speaker means is not exhausted by what she literally says. Grice (1989) distinguishes what a speaker literally says with her words from what she implies or suggests with them. Grice posited two kinds of implicature: conversational and conventional. When a speaker communicates something by means of conversational implicature, she violates (or makes as if to violate) a conversational norm, such as provide as much information as is required given the aim of the conversation. The hearer, working on the assumption that the speaker is being cooperative, attempts to derive the implicatum (that is, what the speaker meant, but did not literally say) based on the words used by the speaker and what conversational norm she has (apparently) violated. Suppose that Professor A has written a letter of recommendation for her philosophy student, X, that reads, “Mr. X’s command of English is excellent, and his attendance at tutorials has been regular” (Grice 1989, p 33). The reader, recognizing that A does not wish to opt out, will observe that she has apparently violated the maxim of quantity: seemingly, she has not provided enough information about X’s philosophical abilities for the reader to make an assessment. The most reasonable explanation for A’s behavior is that she thinks X is a rather bad student, but is reluctant to explicitly say so, since doing so would entail saying something impolite or violating some other norm. According to Grice, sometimes the conventional meaning of a term determines what is implied by usage of the word, in addition to determining what is said by it. If a sentence s conventionally implies that Q, then it is possible to find another sentence s*, which is truth-conditionally equivalent to s, yet does not imply that Q. Consider the sentences ‘Alexis is rich and kind’ and ‘Alexis is rich, but kind’. For Grice, these two sentences have the same literal truth-conditions (they are true just in case Alexis is both rich and kind), but only the latter implies that there is a contrast between being rich and kind (in virtue of the conventional meaning of ‘but’). (For more on Grice’s theory of implicature, see Philosophy of Language.)

One might apply Grice’s theory of implicature to pejoratives. A theory that understands pejorative content as conversationally implicated content has little chance of succeeding. First, it seems that the pejorative meaning of a slur needn’t be worked out by the listener in the way that a conversational implicature must be (Saka 2007, p136). Second, conversational implicata are supposed to be cancellable, but the derogatory content of a slur is not (Hom 2008, p434). According to Grice, for any putative conversational implicatureP, it will always be possible to explicitly cancel P by adding something like ‘but not P’ or ‘I do not mean to imply that P’. And it is clear that the derogatory contents of slurs are not explicitly cancellable, as the following defective example illustrates: ‘That house is full of kikes, but I don’t mean to disparage Jewish people’.

Stenner (1981), Whiting (2007, 2013) and Williamson (2009) have argued that the derogatory content of some pejorative words and phrases is best understood in terms of conventional implicature. According to a conventional implicature account of slurs (hereafter, the ‘CI account’), slurs and their neutral counterparts have the same literal meaning, but slurs conventionally imply something negative that their neutral counterparts do not. For instance, ‘Franz was German’ and ‘Franz was a Boche’ are the same at the level of what is said – they have the same literal truth-conditions, that is, they are both true just in case Franz was German. But ‘Franz was a Boche’ conventionally implies the false and derogatory propositionthat Franz was cruel and despicable because he was German. One virtue of the CI account is that it explains the descriptive features of pejoratives as well as expressive autonomy.

One objection to the CI account is that it is controversial whether there is any such thing as conventional implicature. Bach (1999) argues that putative cases of conventional implicature are actually part of what is said by an utterance. Bach devised the indirect quotation (IQ) test for conventionally implicated content. Suppose that speaker A has uttered (24), and speaker B has reported on A’s utterance with (25):

(24) She is wise, but short.

(25) A said that she is wise and short.

According to Bach, since B has left out important information in her indirect report, namely information about the purported contrast between being wise and short, that information must have been part of what was said, as opposed to what was implied, by A’s utterance. Hom (2008) uses Bach’s IQ test to undermine the CI account of slurs. Suppose A uttered (26) and B reported on A’s utterance with (27):

(26) Bill is a spic.

(27) A said that Bill is Hispanic.

According to Hom, since B has misreported A, the derogatory content of the slur must be part of what is said, and so the CI account fails. Notice, however, that Hom’s use of Bach’s test does not show that the derogatoriness of slurs must be part of their literal semantic content, since “what is said” could refer to pragmatically enriched content (see, for example, Bach (1994)). A more serious objection is that even if Griceans are correct in holding that an utterance of ‘Italians are wops’ carries a negative implicature about Italians, more would need to be said in order to explain how implying something negative about Italians could bring about complicity in listeners, and motivate listeners to discriminate against Italians. Consider a paradigm case of conventional implicature: a speaker who asserts ‘P but Q’ commits herself to a contrast between P and Q by virtue of the conventional meaning of ‘but’. However, there is no reason to think that bystanders would automatically feel complicit in the speaker’s claim. Yet listeners often find themselves feeling complicit in the expression of a negative attitude just by overhearing a slur. Even if terms like ‘but’ are capable of triggering a kind of complicity, it is surely not the robust sort of complicity triggered by slurs. Potts (2007) offers a non-propositional version of the CI account. Potts understands pejorative content in terms of expressive indices, which model a speaker’s negative (or positive) attitudes in a conversational context. He offers the following schema for an expressive index:

<a I b>

where a and b are individuals, and I is an interval that represents a’s positive or negative feelings for b in the conversational context. The more narrow the interval, the more intense the feeling. If I = [-1, 1], then ais essentially indifferent toward b. If I = [0.8, 1], then a has a highly positive attitude toward b. If I = [-0.5, 0], then a has negative feelings for b. For Potts, the conventionally implicated content of a pejorative is a function that alters the expressive index of a conversational context. So, for example, if Bill calls George a ‘spic’, the expressive index might shift from <Bill [-1, 1] George>, where Bill is indifferent to George, to <Bill [-0.5, 0] George>, where Bill has negative feelings toward George. Potts’s theory could potentially account for complicity. He might argue that a feeling of complicity results from taking part in a conversation whose expressive index has been lowered due to the use of a slur. One problem with Potts’s theory is that expressive indices are supposed to measure psychological states of conversation participants, and these can depend on a variety of idiosyncratic features of the participants – their background beliefs, values, and so forth. This makes it difficult to see how the expressive content of pejoratives could be objective and speaker-independent (Hom 2010, p180).

Additionally, Potts’s numerical modeling of attitudes seems too coarse-grained to explain the differences between slurs and other pejoratives. One could shift the expressive index of a conversation by using an insult like ‘asshole’ or even by using non-pejorative language. For instance, Bill might lower the expressive index in a conversation about his colleague, George, by pointing out that George is late for work and that he’s not dressed appropriately for the office. Bill could also lower the index by uttering, ‘Here comes George!’ in a contemptuous tone of voice. If Potts is correct, the pejorative content of slurs like ‘nigger’, ‘chink’, and ‘spic’ should be understood in terms of expressive indices. However, in that case, Potts will have difficulty explaining the distinctively racist nature of these words, which derogate individuals qua members of particular racial groups.

g. A Presupposition Theory

In the philosophical literature, to presuppose a proposition P is to take P for granted in a way that contrasts with asserting that P (Soames 1989, p.553). According to one widely accepted theory, presupposed content is best understood in terms of attitudes and background beliefs of speakers. According to Robert Stalnaker’s theory of pragmatic presupposition, each conversation is governed by a conversational record, which includes the common ground, that is, the background assumptions mutually accepted by participants for the purposes of the conversation. The pragmatic presuppositions of an utterance are the requirements it places on sets of common background assumptions built up among conversational participants (Soames 1989, p.556). Mutually accepted background assumptions are subject to change over the course of a conversation. Lewis (1979) observes that information can be added to (or removed from) the conversational record when necessary in order to forestall presupposition failure and make what is said conversationally acceptable. For instance, if a speaker says, ‘Avery broke the copy machine’ in the course of a conversation, and it was not already mutually understood by the speaker and her listeners that a copy machine was damaged, then it will be assumed for the purposes of the conversation that some salient copy machine was broken. Schlenker (2007) argues that pejorative content is best understood in terms of presupposition. Consider how the presupposition theory covers slurs. Suppose (28) is asked in a conversation:

(28) Was there a honky on the subway today?

According to Schlenker, if none of the conversation participants dissent, a derogatory proposition (or set of such propositions) – for example, that Caucasians are despicable for being Caucasian, that the speaker and the audience are willing to treat Caucasians as despicable – is incorporated into common ground.

There are several problems with the presupposition theory of pejoratives. First, as Potts (2007), Hom (2010), and Anderson and Lepore (2013a) observe, presuppositions can be cancelled when sentences that trigger them are embedded in an indirect report, but the derogatoriness of embedded slurs cannot be cancelled. Compare (29) with (30):

(29) Frank believes that John stopped smoking, but John has never smoked.

(30) #Eric said that a nigger is in the white house, but Blacks are not inferior for being Black.

Ordinarily, an assertion of ‘John stopped smoking’ presupposes that John previously smoked. When embedded in an indirect report, however, the presupposition can be cancelled, as (29) illustrates. In contrast, (30) appears to convey something highly offensive, which cannot be cancelled by the right conjunct. If the presupposition account were correct, we would expect (30) to be inoffensive and non-derogatory. Also, as Richard (2008) has observed, derogation with slurs needn’t be a rational, cooperative effort between speakers. According to Richard,

[a] pretty good rule of thumb is that someone who is using these words is insulting and being hostile to their targets. But there is a rather large gap between doing that and putting something on the conversational record. If I yell ‘Smuck!’ at someone who cuts me off…[a]m I entitled to assume, if you don’t say ‘He’s not a smuck’, that you assume that the person in question is a smuck, or are hostile towards him? Surely not. (2008, pp.21-2)

h. Inferentialism

Inferentialism is the thesis that knowing the meaning of a statement is a matter of knowing the conditions under which one is justified in making the statement; and the consequences of accepting it, which include both the inferential powers of the statement and anything that counts as acting on the truth of the statement (Dummett 1981, p 453). In this view, one knows the meaning of the term ‘valid’, for example, if one knows the criteria for applying ‘valid’ to arguments, and one understanding the consequences of such an application, namely that an argument’s validity provides a basis for accepting its conclusion so long as one accepts its premises.

Dummett (1981) offers an inferentialist account of slurs (see also Tirrell (1999) and Brandom (2000)). Dummett posits two inference rules for slurs: an introduction rule and an elimination rule. The introduction rule gives sufficient conditions for applying the slur to someone and the elimination rule specifies what one commits oneself to by doing so. Consider the slur ‘boche’, which was once commonly applied to people of German origin:

The condition for applying the term to someone is that he is of German nationality; the consequences of its application are that he is barbarous and more prone to cruelty than other Europeans. We should envisage the connections in both directions as sufficiently tight as to be involved in the very meaning of the word: neither could be severed without altering its meaning (454).

Williamson (2009) formalizes Dummett’s inference rules for ‘boche’ as follows:

Boche introduction:

x is a German

Therefore, x is a boche

Boche elimination:

x is a boche

Therefore, x is cruel

Brandom (2000) endorses the inferentialist account of slurs, and notes a sense in which slurs are unsayable for non-prejudiced speakers. On his view, once one uses a term like ‘boche’, one commits oneself to the thought that Germans are cruel because of being German. The only recourse for non-xenophobic speakers, Brandom concludes, is to refuse to employ the concept, since it embodies an inference one does not endorse. The inferentialist theory is well suited to explain the descriptive features of slurs as well as expressive autonomy. The theory also accounts for why a slur is derogatory toward an entire group of individuals, even when a speaker intends only to derogate a single person in a particular context with the term.

However, there are numerous objections to the inferentialist’s treatment of slurs. First, Hornsby (2001) questions whether it is possible to spell out for every slur the consequences to which its users are committed. Further, as Williamson (2009) observes, a speaker might grow up in a community where only the pejorative word for a group is used. For instance, someone may only know Germans as people who are ‘boche’ without knowing the term ‘Germans’. In that case, the speaker could be competent with ‘boche’ (she could know that it is a xenophobic term of abuse) without knowing the word ‘German’. Thus, knowing the ‘boche-introduction’ rule is not necessary for competency with the slur.

i. Combinatorial Externalism

Hom (2008) offers a theory of the semantic content of slurs. According to Hom, the derogatory content of a pejorative term is wholly constituted by its literal meaning. Hom makes use of the semantic externalist framework first developed by Putnam (1975) and Kripke (1980). Semantic externalism holds that the internal state of the particular speaker of a word does not fully determine the word’s meaning, which is instead determined, at least partly, by external social practices of the linguistic community to which the word actively belongs. For more on semantic externalism, see Internalism and Externalism in the Philosophy of Mind and Language. According to Putnam (1975), one can competently use terms like ‘elm’ and ‘beech’ without understanding the complex biological properties of each kind of tree, as long as one stands in the right sort of causal relation to the social institutions that determine their meaning. Similarly, according to Hom, the meaning of a slur is determined by a social institution of racism that is constituted by a racist ideology and a set of harmful discriminatory practices. Hom offers the following formal schema for the semantic content of slurs:

Ought to be subject to p*₁ + … + p*_n because of being d*₁ + … + d*_nall because of being NPC*,

where p*₁ + … + p*_nare prescriptions for harmful discriminatory treatment derived from a set of racist practices, d*₁ + … + d*_nare negative properties derived from a racist ideology, and NPC* is the semantic value of the slur’s neutral counterpart (Hom 2008, p.431). Hom calls his view Combinatorial Externalism (CE). On this view, ‘chink’ expresses the following complex, socially constructed property as part of its literal meaning: ought to be subject to higher college admissions standards, excluded from managerial positions…, because of being slanty-eyed, devious…, all because of being Chinese.

According to Hom, one motivation for CE is that it accounts for the common intuition that slurs have empty extensions. A non-racist might say ‘There are no chinks; there are only Chinese.’ Given that no one ought to be subject to discriminatory practices because of their race, CE predicts that all racial slurs have null extensions. Hom’s semantic analysis also accounts for expressive autonomy, since the social institutions that determine the meanings of slurs are independent of the attitudes of particular speakers. Finally, CE accounts for non-derogatory, appropriated uses of slurs by in-group members. For Hom, when a targeted group appropriates a slur, they create a new supporting social institution for the term which imbues the term with a new (non-pejorative) semantic content.

Hom (2012) extends CE to cover swears. Consider Hom’s analysis of ‘John fucked Mary’:

to say that John fucked Mary is to say (something like) that they each ought to be scorned, ought to go to hell, ought to be treated as less desirable (if female), ought to be treated as more desirable (if male), ought to be treated as damaged (if female), …, for being sinful, unchaste, lustful, impure, … because of having sexual intercourse with each other. (Hom 2012, p 395)

In speech communities wherein ideologies support progressive ideas about sex and reject the meaning of the term, the term will come to have a different semantic content because the above prescriptions will no longer be a part of the semantic content of ‘fucked’.

CE faces several objections. First, the behavior of embedded slurs poses a problem for CE (see Richard (2008), Jeshion (2013) and Whiting (2013)). According to Hom (2012), derogation requires the actual predication of a slur to a targeted individual. Notice that a speaker who utters (31) has not literally assigned negative properties to anyone or prescribed negative practices for anyone, yet the utterance appears to be highly offensive and derogatory:

(31) If there are any spics among the job applicants, do not hire them.

If Hom is correct, non-prejudiced speakers should be able to endorse utterances like (31), since they would be true, given their false antecedents (Richard 2008, p17). In response, Hom (2012) suggests that wide-scoping intuitions about pejoratives can be explained by what they conversationally imply. (31) indicates that the speaker thinks that some Hispanic individuals are inferior and ought to be excluded from employment opportunities. However, if this is correct, there should be contexts where the speaker can felicitously follow up her utterance with ‘not that I mean to imply that Hispanic people are inferior or that they should be discriminated against’, since conversational implicata are cancellable. But the use of the slur in (31) seems non-defeasibly racist and derogatory. As Jeshion (2013) observes, following the utterance up with ‘but I don’t mean to imply anything derogatory’ does not get the speaker off the hook.

Finally, Jeshion (2013) objects that CE’s account of the semantic content of slurs has it backwards. She argues that ideologies and social practices must antedate slurs, and this is a problem because the use of a slur for a particular group often plays a role in the creation and development of such institutions and practices. If so, a social institution could not be the source of a slur’s pejorative content.

3. A Deflationary Theory

Anderson and Lepore (2013a, 2013b) deny that the characteristic features of slurs are due to the contents they express. Their proposal is simply that “slurs are prohibited words; as such, their uses are offensive to whomever these prohibitions matter” (2013a, p.21). Anderson and Lepore note that quotation does not always eliminate the offensiveness of pejoratives (see also Saka 1998, p.122). An utterance of (32), for example, would be offensive despite the quotational use of the slur it contains:

(32) ‘Nigger’ is a term for blacks.

Anderson and Lepore argue that content theorists will have difficulty accounting for the widespread practice of avoiding the word ‘nigger’ completely (using the locution ‘the N-word’ in place of quoting the term).

Deflationism accounts for the behavior of embedded slurs. However, it faces several objections. First, the theory offers little by way of an explanation of the practical features of slurs. (Croom 2011) Pointing out that slurs are prohibited words does not help us understand how they are such effective vehicles for spreading prejudice. Additionally, Whiting (2013) observes that it is possible for there to be slurs in the absence of taboos or social prohibitions. In a society in which the vast majority of speakers are prejudiced toward a particular racial group, and the targeted group members have internalized racist attitudes, it may be that no one objects to the use of slurs or finds them offensive, yet slurs might still be derogatory. Thus, social prohibitions cannot be all there is to the derogatoriness of slurs.

Finally, by defining slurs as merely prohibited words, Anderson and Lepore rule out a priori the possibility of slurs that are appropriate and morally permissible. One example might be ‘fascist’, which targets individuals based on political affiliation; using this slur to denigrate an authoritarian dictator need not (and perhaps should not) be prohibited.

4. Broader Applications

Since the 1980s, philosophical work on pejoratives has focused primarily on two questions: what (if anything) do pejoratives mean, and how is derogation by means of pejoratives accomplished? Researchers working on these questions would do well to familiarize themselves with empirical literature on pejoratives (for empirical studies on the behavioral and psychological effects of overhearing slurs, see Kirkland and others. 1987, Carnaghi and Maass 2007, and Gadon and Johnson 2009).

Work on slurs in the philosophy of language and linguistics has implications for debates in other disciplines. For instance, in answering the question of whether there should be legal restrictions on hate speech (which may involve the use of slurs), we will need to get clear on how hate speech harms its targets (Hornsby 2001). Legal theorists interested in these issues will want to pay careful attention to the literature discussed in this article. (For a discussion of whether laws against hate speech are justified, see Waldron 2012.)

5. References and Further Reading

Anderson, L. and E. Lepore 2013a, “Slurring Words,” Nous 47.1, 25-48
- [Offers a deflationary theory of slurs]
Anderson, L. and E. Lepore 2013b, “What Did you Call Me? Slurs as Prohibited Words: Setting Things Up,” Analytic Philosophy 54.3, 350-363.
- [Responds to objections to the deflationary theory defended in their 2013a]
Ayer, A. J. 1936, Language, Truth and Logic, Dover, New York.
- [Defends an expressivist theory of moral and aesthetic terms]
Bach, K. 1994, “Conversational Impliciture,” Mind and Language 9.2, 124-162.
- [Argues that Grice’s distinction between what a speaker literally says and what she implies is not exhaustive, and posits a third, intermediate category]
Bach, K. 1999, “The Myth of Conventional Implicature,” Linguistics and Philosophy 22.4, 327-366.
- [Argues that what is commonly held to be conventionally implicated content is actually part of what is said]
Brandom, R. 2000, Articulating Reasons: An Introduction to Inferentialism, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Defends an inferentialist theory of slurs]
Brontsema, R. 2004, “A Queer Revolution: Reconceptualizing the Debate over Linguistic Reclamation,” Colorado Research in Linguistics 17.1, 1-17.
- [Gives an overview of the notion of linguistic appropriation as it applies to slurs]
Camp, E. 2013, “Slurring Perspectives,” Analytic Philosophy 54.3, 330-349.
- [Defends a perspectival theory of slurs]
Carnaghi, A. and A. Maass 2007, “In-Group and Out-Group Perspectives in the Use of Derogatory Group Labels: Gay versus Fag,” Journal of Language and Social Psychology 26.2, 142-156.
- [A study that measures the effects of slurs on targeted individuals compared with non-targets]
Croom, A.M. 2011, “Slurs,” Language Sciences 33, 343-358.
- [Offers a stereotype theory of slurs]
Dummett, M. 1981, Frege: Philosophy of Language 2^nd ed., Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Defends an inferentialist theory of slurs]
Frege, G. 1892, “On Sinn and Bedeutung,” in M. Beany (ed.) 1997, The Frege Reader Blackwell, Malden, MA, 151-171.
- [A classic paper in which Frege defends his theory of sense and reference]
Frege, G. 1897, “Logic,” in M. Beany (ed.) The Frege Reader, Blackwell, Malden, MA, 227-250.
- [Frege explicates his notion of “coloring”]
Gadon, O. and C. Johnson 2009, “The Effect of a Derogatory Professional Label: Evaluations of a “Shrink”,” Journal of Applied Social Psychology 39.3, 634-55.
- [Empirical study on the effects of overhearing a psychologist referred to as a ‘shrink’]
Geach, P. 1965, “Assertion,” Philosophical Review 69, 449-465.
- [Poses the famous Frege-Geach problem]
Gibbard, A. 2003, “Reasons Thick and Thin: A Possibility Proof,’ Journal of Philosophy 100.6, 288-304.
- [Argues that slurs are like thick evaluative terms in that they express both descriptive and evaluative content]
Grice, P. 1989, Studies in the Way of Words, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [A collection of papers on various topics in the philosophy of language]
Hom, C. 2008, “The Semantics of Racial Epithets,” Journal of Philosophy 105, 416-440.
- [Defends a truth-conditional, semantic theory of slurs]
Hom, C. 2010, “Pejoratives,” Philosophy Compass 5.2, 164-185.
- [Gives a general overview of various theories of pejoratives]
Hom, C. 2012, “A Puzzle about Pejoratives,” Philosophical Studies 159.3, 383-405.
- [Extends the semantic theory of slurs developed in his (2008) to swear words]
Hornsby, J. 2001, “Meaning and Uselessness: How to Think About Derogatory Words,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 25, 128-141.
- [Defends a gestural theory of slurs]
Jeshion, R. 2013, “Slurs and Stereotypes,” Analytic Philosophy 54.3, 314-329.
- [Raises objections to the theories of slurs developed by Hom (2008) and Camp (2013)]
Kaplan, D. 2004, “The Meaning of Ouch and Oops” (unpublished transcription of the Howison Lecture in Philosophy at U.C. Berkeley)
- [Defends a broadly expressivist theory of pejoratives]
Kirkland, S., J. Greenberg, and T. Pyszczynski 1987, “Further Evidence of the Deleterious Effects of Overheard Ethnic Labels: Derogation Beyond the Target,” Personality and Social Psychology Bulletin 13.2, 216-227.
- [Empirical study on how overhearing the slur ‘nigger’ affects evaluations of those targeted by the slur]
Kripke, S. 1980, Naming and Necessity, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Gives a defense of semantic externalism]
Lewis, D. 1979, “Scorekeeping in a Language Game,” Journal of Philosophical Logic 8, 339-359.
- [Offers a theory of conversational kinematics]
Neale, S. 1999, “Colouring and Composition,” in R. Stainton and K. Murasugi (eds.) Philosophy and Linguistics, Westview press, Boulder, CO, 35-82.
- [Explicates Frege’s notion of coloring]
Potts, C. 2007, “The Expressive Dimension,” Theoretical Linguistics 33.2, 255-268.
- [Offers a non-propositional version of the conventional implicature theory of slurs]
Putnam, H. 1975, “The Meaning of Meaning,” in Mind, Language and Reality: Philosophical Papers Volume 2, C.U.P., Cambridge: Cambridge, 215-271.
- [Offers a defense of semantic externalism]
Richard, M. 2008, When Truth Gives Out, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Argues that utterances containing derogatory uses of slurs are not truth-apt]
Saka, P. 1998, “Quotation and the Use-Mention Distinction” Mind 107, 113-136.
- [Notes that quotation does not entirely eliminate the offensiveness of swear words]
Saka, P. 2007, How to Think About Meaning, Springer, Berlin.
- [Defends a hybrid expressivist theory of slurs]
Schlenker, P. 2007, “Expressive Presuppositions,” Theoretical Linguistics 33.2, 237-245.
- [Defends a presupposition theory of pejoratives]
Soames, S. 1989, “Presupposition,” in M. Gabbay and F. Guenthner (eds.) Handbook of Philosophical Logic, Kulwer, Dordrecht, 553-616.
- [Explicates the notion of linguistic presupposition]
Stenner, A.J. 1981, “A Note on Logical Truth and Non-Sexist Semantics,” in M. Vetterling-Braggin (ed.) Sexist Language: A Modern Philosophical Analysis, Littlefield, Adams and Co, New York, 299-306.
- [Defends a conventional implicature theory of slurs]
Tirrell, L. 1999, “Derogatory Terms,” in C. Hendriks and K. Oliver (eds.) Language and Liberation: Feminism, Philosophy and Language, SUNY Press, Albany, NY, 41-79.
- [Defends an inferentialist theory of slurs]
Waldron, J. 2012, The Harm in Hate Speech, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Makes the case for legal restrictions on hate speech]
Whiting, D. 2007, “Inferentialism, Representationalism and Derogatory Words,” International Journal of Philosophical Studies 15.2, 191-205.
- [Offers a conventional implicature theory of slurs]
Whiting, D. 2013, “It’s Not What You Said, It’s the Way You Said It: Slurs and Conventional Implicature,” Analytic Philosophy 54.3, 364-377.
- [Responds to objections to the conventional implicature theory by Hom (2008) and others]
Williams, B. 1985, Ethics and the Limits of Philosophy, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, MA.
- [Explicates the notion of a thick evaluative term]
Williamson, T. 2009, “Reference, Inference and the Semantics of Pejoratives,” in J. Almog and P. Leonardi (eds.) The Philosophy of David Kaplan, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 137-158.
- [Raises objections to the inferentialist theory of slurs; defends a conventional implicature theory.]

Author Information

Ralph DiFranco
Email: ralph.difranco@uconn.edu
University of Connecticut
U. S. A.

Continental Rationalism

Continental rationalism is a retrospective category used to group together certain philosophers working in continental Europe in the 17^th and 18^th centuries, in particular, Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz, especially as they can be regarded in contrast with representatives of “British empiricism,” most notably, Locke, Berkeley, and Hume. Whereas the British empiricists held that all knowledge has its origin in, and is limited by, experience, the Continental rationalists thought that knowledge has its foundation in the scrutiny and orderly deployment of ideas and principles proper to the mind itself. The rationalists did not spurn experience as is sometimes mistakenly alleged; they were thoroughly immersed in the rapid developments of the new science, and in some cases led those developments. They held, however, that experience alone, while useful in practical matters, provides an inadequate foundation for genuine knowledge.

The fact that “Continental rationalism” and “British empiricism” are retrospectively applied terms does not mean that the distinction that they signify is anachronistic. Leibniz’s New Essays on Human Understanding, for instance, outlines stark contrasts between his own way of thinking and that of Locke, which track many features of the rationalist/empiricist distinction as it tends to be applied in retrospect. There was no rationalist creed or manifesto to which Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz all subscribed (nor, for that matter, was there an empiricist one). Nevertheless, with due caution, it is possible to use the “Continental rationalism” category (and its empiricist counterpart) to highlight significant points of convergence in the philosophies of Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz, inter alia. These include: (1) a doctrine of innate ideas; (2) the application of mathematical method to philosophy; and (3) the use of a priori principles in the construction of substance-based metaphysical systems.

Origin and History of the Term “Rationalism”
Innate Ideas
1. Descartes
2. Spinoza
3. Leibniz
4. Malebranche
Mathematical Method
A Priori Principles
1. Intelligibility and the Cartesian Circle
2. Substance Metaphysics
Continental Rationalism, Experience, and Experiment
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Origin and History of the Term “Rationalism”

According to the Historisches Worterbuch der Philosophie, the word “rationaliste” appears in 16^th century France, as early as 1539, in opposition to “empirique.” In his New Organon, first published in 1620 (in Latin), Francis Bacon juxtaposes rationalism and empiricism in memorable terms:

Those who have treated of the sciences have been either empiricists [Empirici] or dogmatists [Dogmatici]. Empiricists [Empirici], like ants, simply accumulate and use; Rationalists [Rationales], like spiders, spin webs from themselves; the way of the bee is in between: it takes material from the flowers of the garden and the field; but it has the ability to convert and digest them. (The New Organon, p. 79; Spedding, 1, 201)

Bacon’s association of rationalists with dogmatists in this passage foreshadows Kant’s use of the term “dogmatisch” in reference, especially, to the Wolffian brand of rationalist philosophy prevalent in 18^th century Germany. Nevertheless, Bacon’s use of “rationales” does not refer to “Continental rationalism,” which developed only after the New Organon, but rather to the Scholastic philosophy that dominated the medieval period. Moreover, while Bacon is, in retrospect, often considered the father of modern empiricism, the above-quoted passage shows him no friendlier to the empirici than to the rationales. Thus, Bacon’s juxtaposition of rationalism and empiricism should not be confused with the distinction as it develops over the course of the 17^th and 18^th centuries, although his imagery is certainly suggestive.

The distinction appears in an influential form as the backdrop to Kant’s critical philosophy (which is often loosely understood as a kind of synthesis of certain aspects of Continental rationalism and British empiricism) at the end of the 18^th century. However, it was not until the time of Hegel in the first half of the 19^th century that the terms “rationalism” and “empiricism” were applied to separating the figures of the 17^th and 18^th centuries into contrasting epistemological camps in the fashion with which we are familiar today. In his Lectures on the History of Philosophy, Hegel describes an opposition between “a priori thought,” on the one hand, according to which “the determinations which should be valid for thought should be taken from thought itself,” and, on the other hand, “the determination that we must begin and end and think, etc., from experience.” He describes this as the opposition between “Rationalismus” and “Empirismus” (Werke 20, 121).

2. Innate Ideas

Perhaps the best recognized and most commonly made distinction between rationalists and empiricists concerns the question of the source of ideas. Whereas rationalists tend to think (with some exceptions discussed below) that some ideas, at least, such as the idea of God, are innate, empiricists hold that all ideas come from experience. Although the rationalists tend to be remembered for their positive doctrine concerning innate ideas, their assertions are matched by a rejection of the notion that all ideas can be accounted for on the basis of experience alone. In some Continental rationalists, especially in Spinoza, the negative doctrine is more apparent than the positive. The distinction is worth bearing in mind, in order to avoid the very false impression that the rationalists held to innate ideas because the empiricist alternative had not come along yet. (In general, the British empiricists came after the rationalists.) The Aristotelian doctrine, nihil in intellectu nisi prius in sensu (nothing in the intellect unless first in the senses), had been dominant for centuries, and it was in reaction against this that the rationalists revived in modified form the contrasting Platonic doctrine of innate ideas.

a. Descartes

Descartes distinguishes between three kinds of ideas: adventitious (adventitiae), factitious (factae), and innate (innatae). As an example of an adventitious idea, Descartes gives the common idea of the sun (yellow, bright, round) as it is perceived through the senses. As an example of a factitious idea, Descartes cites the idea of the sun constructed via astronomical reasoning (vast, gaseous body). According to Descartes, all ideas which represent “true, immutable, and eternal essences” are innate. Innate ideas, for Descartes, include the idea of God, the mind, and mathematical truths, such as the fact that it pertains to the nature of a triangle that its three angles equal two right angles.

By conceiving some ideas as innate, Descartes does not mean that children are born with fully actualized conceptions of, for example, triangles and their properties. This is a common misconception of the rationalist doctrine of innate ideas. Descartes strives to correct it in Comments on a Certain Broadsheet, where he compares the innateness of ideas in the mind to the tendency which some babies are born with to contract certain diseases: “it is not so much that the babies of such families suffer from these diseases in their mother’s womb, but simply that they are born with a certain ‘faculty’ or tendency to contract them” (CSM I, 304). In other words, innate ideas exist in the mind potentially, as tendencies; they are then actualized by means of active thought under certain circumstances, such as seeing a triangular figure.

At various points, Descartes defends his doctrine of innate ideas against philosophers (Hobbes, Gassendi, and Regius, inter alia) who hold that all ideas enter the mind through the senses, and that there are no ideas apart from images. Descartes is relatively consistent on his reasons for thinking that some ideas, at least, must be innate. His principal line of argument proceeds by showing that there are certain ideas, for example, the idea of a triangle, that cannot be either adventitious or factitious; since ideas are either adventitious, factitious, or innate, by process of elimination, such ideas must be innate.

Take Descartes’ favorite example of the idea of a triangle. The argument that the idea of a triangle cannot be adventitious proceeds roughly as follows. A triangle is composed of straight lines. However, straight lines never enter our mind via the senses, since when we examine straight lines under a magnifying lens, they turn out to be wavy or irregular in some way. Since we cannot derive the idea of straight lines from the senses, we cannot derive the idea of a true triangle, which is made up of straight lines, through the senses. Sometimes Descartes makes the point in slightly different terms by insisting that there is “no similarity” between the corporeal motions of the sense organs and the ideas formed in the mind on the occasion of those motions (CSM I, 304; CSMK III, 187). One such dissimilarity, which is particularly striking, is the contrast between the particularity of all corporeal motions and the universality that pure ideas can attain when conjoined to form necessary truths. Descartes makes this point in clear terms to Regius:

I would like our author to tell me what the corporeal motion is that is capable of forming some common notion to the effect that ‘things which are equal to a third thing are equal to each other,’ or any other he cares to take. For all such motions are particular, whereas the common notions are universal and bear no affinity with, or relation to, the motions. (CSM I, 304-5)

Next, Descartes has to show that the idea of a triangle is not factitious. This is where the doctrine of “true and immutable natures” comes in. For Descartes, if, for example, the idea that the three angles of a triangle are equal to two right angles were his own invention, it would be mutable, like the idea of a gold mountain, which can be changed at whim into the idea of a silver mountain. Instead, when Descartes thinks about his idea of a triangle, he is able to discover eternal properties of it that are not mutable in this way; hence, they are not invented (CSMK III, 184).

Since, therefore, the triangle can be neither adventitious nor factitious, it must be innate; that is to say, the mind has an innate tendency or power to form this idea from its own purely intellectual resources when prompted to do so.

Descartes’ insistence that there is no similarity between the corporeal motions of our sense organs and the ideas formed in the mind on the occasion of those motions raises a difficulty for understanding how any ideas could be adventitious. Since none of our ideas have any similarity to the corporeal motions of the sense organs – even the idea of motion itself – it seems that no ideas can in fact have their origin in a source external to the mind. The reason that we have an idea of heat in the presence of fire, for instance, is not, then, because the idea is somehow transmitted by the fire. Rather, Descartes thinks that God designed us in such a way that we form the idea of heat on the occasion of certain corporeal motions in our sense organs (and we form other sensory ideas on the occasion of other corporeal motions). Thus, there is a sense in which, for Descartes, all ideas are innate, and his tripartite division between kinds of ideas becomes difficult to maintain.

b. Spinoza

Per his so-called doctrine of “parallelism,” Spinoza conceives the mind and the body as one and the same thing, conceived under different attributes (to wit, thought and extension). (See Benedict de Spinoza: Metaphysics.) As a result, Spinoza denies that there is any causal interaction between mind and body, and so Spinoza denies that any ideas are caused by bodily change. Just as bodies can be affected only by other bodies, so ideas can be affected only by other ideas. This does not mean, however, that all ideas are innate for Spinoza, as they very clearly are for Leibniz (see below). Just as the body can be conceived to be affected by external objects conceived under the attribute of extension (that is, as bodies), so the mind can (as it were, in parallel) be conceived to be affected by the same objects conceived under the attribute of thought (that is, as ideas). Ideas gained in this way, from encounters with external objects (conceived as ideas) constitutes knowledge of the first kind, or “imagination,” for Spinoza, and all such ideas are “inadequate,” or in other words, confused and lacking order for the intellect. “Adequate ideas,” on the other hand, which can be formed via Spinoza’s second and third kinds of knowledge (reason and intuitive knowledge, respectively), and which are clear and distinct and have order for the intellect, are not gained through chance encounters with external objects; rather, adequate ideas can be explained in terms of resources intrinsic to the mind. (For more on Spinoza’s three kinds of knowledge and the distinction between adequate and inadequate ideas, see Benedict de Spinoza: Epistemology.)

The mind, for Spinoza, just by virtue of having ideas, which is its essence, has ideas of what Spinoza calls “common notions,” or in other words, those things which are “equally in the part and in the whole.” Examples of common notions include motion and rest, extension, and indeed God. Take extension for example. To think of any body – however small or however large – is to have a perfectly complete idea of extension. So, insofar as the mind has any idea of body (and, for Spinoza, the human mind is the idea of the human body, and so always has ideas of body), it has a perfectly adequate idea of extension. The same can be said for motion and rest. The same can also be said for God, except that God is not equally in the part and in the whole of extension only, but of all things. Spinoza treats these common notions as principles of reasoning. Anything that can be deduced on their basis is also adequate.

It is not clear if Spinoza’s common notions should be considered innate ideas. Spinoza speaks of active and passive ideas, and adequate and inadequate ideas. He associates the former with the intellect and the latter with the imagination, but “innate idea” is not an explicit category in Spinoza’s theory of ideas as it is in Descartes’ and also Leibniz’s. Common notions are not “in” the mind independent of the mind’s relation with its object (the body); nevertheless, since it is the mind’s nature to be the idea of the body, it is part of the mind’s nature to have common notions. Commentators differ over the question of whether Spinoza had a positive doctrine of innate ideas; it is clear, however, that he denied that all ideas come about through encounters with external objects; moreover, he believed that those ideas which do come about through encounters with external objects are of an inferior epistemic value than those produced through the mind’s own intrinsic resources; this is enough to put him in the rationalist camp on the question of the origin of ideas.

c. Leibniz

Of the three great rationalists, Leibniz propounded the most thoroughgoing doctrine of innate ideas. For Leibniz, all ideas are strictly speaking innate. In a general and relatively straightforward sense, this viewpoint is a direct consequence of Leibniz’s conception of individual substance. According to Leibniz, “each substance is a world apart, independent of everything outside of itself except for God. Thus all our phenomena, that is to say, all the things that can ever happen to us, are only the results of our own being” (L, 312); or, in Leibniz’s famous phrase from the Monadology, “monads have no windows,” meaning there is no way for sensory data to enter monads from the outside. In this more general sense, then, to give an explanation for Leibniz’s doctrine of innate ideas would be to explain his conception of individual substance and the arguments and considerations which motivate it. (See Section 4, b, iii, below for a discussion of Leibniz’s conception of substance; see also Gottfried Leibniz: Metaphysics.) This would be to circumvent the issues and questions which are typically at the heart of the debate over the existence of innate ideas, which concern the extent to which certain kinds of perceptions, ideas, and propositions can be accounted for on the basis of experience. Although Leibniz’s more general reasons for embracing innate ideas stem from his unique brand of substance metaphysics, Leibniz does enter into the debate over innate ideas, as it were, addressing the more specific questions regarding the source of given kinds of ideas, most notably in his dialogic engagement with Locke’s philosophy, New Essays on Human Understanding.

Due to Leibniz’s conception of individual substance, nothing actually comes from a sensory experience, where a sensory experience is understood to involve direct concourse with things outside of the mind. However, Leibniz does have a means for distinguishing between sensations and purely intellectual thoughts within the framework of his substance metaphysics. For Leibniz, although each monad or individual substance “expresses” (or represents) the entire universe from its own unique point of view, it does so with a greater or lesser degree of clarity and distinctness. Bare monads, such as comprise minerals and vegetation, express the rest of the world only in the most confused fashion. Rational minds, by contrast, have a much greater proportion of clear and distinct perceptions, and so express more of the world clearly and distinctly than do bare monads. When an individual substance attains a more perfect expression of the world (in the sense that it attains a less confused expression of the world), it is said to act; when its expression becomes more confused, it is said to be acted upon. Using this distinction, Leibniz is able to reconcile the terms of his philosophy with everyday conceptions. Although, strictly speaking, no monad is acted upon by any other, nor acts upon any other directly, it is possible to speak this way, just as, Leibniz says, Copernicans can still speak of the motion of the sun for everyday purposes, while understanding that the sun does not in fact move. It is in this sense that Leibniz enters into the debate concerning the origin of our ideas.

Leibniz distinguishes between “ideas” (idées) and “thoughts” (pensées) (or, sometimes, “notions” (notions) or “concepts” (conceptus)). Ideas exist in the soul whether we actually perceive them or are aware of them or not. It is these “ideas” that Leibniz contends are innate. “Thoughts,” by contrast is Leibniz’s designation for ideas which we actually form or conceive at any given time. In this sense, “thoughts” can be formed on the basis of a sensory experience (with the above caveats regarding the meaning a sensory experience can have in Leibniz’s thought) or on the basis of an internal experience, or a reflection. Leibniz alternatively characterizes our “ideas” as “aptitudes,” “preformations,” and as “dispositions” to represent something when the occasion for thinking of it arises. On multiple occasions, Leibniz uses the metaphor of the veins present in marble to illustrate his understanding of innate ideas. Just as the veins dispose the sculptor to shape the marble in certain ways, so do our ideas dispose us to have certain thoughts on the occasion of certain experiences.

Leibniz rejects the view that the mind cannot have ideas without being aware that it has them. (See Gottfried Leibniz: Philosophy of Mind.) Much of the disagreement between Locke and Leibniz on the question of innate ideas turns on this point, since Locke (at least as Leibniz represents him in the New Essays) is not able to make any sense out of the notion that the mind can have ideas without being aware of them. Much of Leibniz’s defense of his innate ideas doctrine takes the form of replying to Locke’s charge that it is absurd to hold that the mind could think (that is, have ideas) without being aware of it.

Leibniz marshals several considerations in support of his view that the mind is not always aware of its ideas. The fact that we can store many more ideas in our understanding than we can be aware of at any given time is one. Leibniz also points to the phenomenology of attention; we do not attend to everything in our perceptual field at any given time; rather we focus on certain things at the expense of others. To convey a sense of what it might be like for the mind to have perceptions and ideas in a dreamless sleep, Leibniz asks the reader to imagine subtracting our attention from perceptual experience; since we can distinguish between what is attended to and what is not, subtracting attention does not eliminate perception altogether.

While such considerations suggest the possibility of innate ideas, they do not in and of themselves prove that innate ideas are necessary to explain the full scope of human cognition. The empiricist tends to think that if innate ideas are not necessary to explain cognition, then they should be abandoned as gratuitous metaphysical constructs. Leibniz does have arguments designed to show that innate ideas are needed for a full account of human cognition.

In the first place, Leibniz recalls favorably the famous scenario from Plato’s Meno where Socrates teaches a slave boy to grasp abstract mathematical truths merely by asking questions. The anecdote is supposed to indicate that mathematical truths can be generated by the mind alone, in the absence of particular sensory experiences, if only the mind is prompted to discover what it contains within itself. Concerning mathematics and geometry, Leibniz remarks: “one could construct these sciences in one’s study and even with one’s eyes closed, without learning from sight or even from touch any of the needed truths” (NE, 77). So, on these grounds, Leibniz contends that without innate ideas, we could not explain the sorts of cognitive capacities exhibited in the mathematical sciences.

A second argument concerns our capacity to grasp certain necessary or eternal truths. Leibniz says that necessary truths can be suggested, justified, and confirmed by experience, but that they can be proved only by the understanding alone (NE, 80). Leibniz does not explain this point further, but he seems to have in mind the point later made by both Hume and Kant (to different ends), that experience on its own can never account for the kind of certainty that we find in mathematical and metaphysical truths. For Leibniz, if it can be granted that we can be certain of propositions in mathematics and metaphysics – and Leibniz thinks this must be granted – recourse must be had to principles innate to the mind in order to explain our ability to be certain of such things.

d. Malebranche

It is worth noting briefly the position of Nicolas Malebranche on innate ideas, since Malebranche is often considered among the rationalists, yet he denied the doctrine of innate ideas. Malebranche’s reasons for rejecting innate ideas were anything but empiricist in nature, however. His leading objection stems from the infinity of ideas that the mind is able to form independently of the senses; as an example, Malebranche cites the infinite number of triangles of which the mind could in principle, albeit not in practice, form ideas. Unlike Descartes and Leibniz, who view innate ideas as tendencies or dispositions to form certain thoughts under certain circumstances, Malebranche understands them as fully formed entities that would have to exist somehow in the mind were they to exist there innately. Given this conception, Malebranche finds it unlikely that God would have created “so many things along with the mind of man” (The Search After Truth, p. 227). Since God already contains the ideas of all things within Himself, Malebranche thinks that it would be much more economical if God were simply to reveal to us the ideas of things that already exist in him rather than placing an infinity of ideas in each human mind. Malebranche’s tenet that “we see all things in God” thus follows upon the principle that God always acts in the simplest ways. Malebranche finds further support for this doctrine from the fact that it places human minds in a position of complete dependence on God. Thus, if Malebranche’s rejection of innate ideas distinguishes him from other rationalists, it does so not from an empiricist standpoint, but rather because of the extent to which his position on ideas is theologically motivated.

3. Mathematical Method

In one sense, what it means to be a rationalist is to model philosophy on mathematics, and, in particular, geometry. This means that the rationalist begins with definitions and intuitively self-evident axioms and proceeds thence to deduce a philosophical system of knowledge that is both certain and complete. This at least is the goal and (with some qualifications to be explored below) the claim. In no work of rationalist philosophy is this procedure more apparent than in Spinoza’s Ethics, laid out famously in the geometrical manner (more geometrico). Nevertheless, Descartes’ main works (and those of Leibniz as well), although not as overtly more geometrico as Spinoza’s Ethics, are also modelled after geometry, and it is Descartes’ celebrated methodological program that first introduces mathematics as a model for philosophy.

a. Descartes

Perhaps Descartes’ clearest and most well-known statement of mathematics’ role as paradigm appears in the Discourse on the Method:

Those long chains of very simple and easy reasonings, which geometers customarily use to arrive at their most difficult demonstrations, had given me occasion to suppose that all the things which can fall under human knowledge are interconnected in the same way. (CSM I, 120)

However, Descartes’ promotion of mathematics as a model for philosophy dates back to his early, unfinished work, Rules for the Direction of the Mind. It is in this work that Descartes first outlines his standards for certainty that have since come to be so closely associated with him and with the rationalist enterprise more generally.

In Rule 2, Descartes declares that henceforth only what is certain should be valued and counted as knowledge. This means the rejection of all merely probable reasoning, which Descartes associates with the philosophy of the Schools. Descartes admits that according to this criterion, only arithmetic and geometry thus far count as knowledge. But Descartes does not conclude that only in these disciplines is it possible to attain knowledge. According to Descartes, the reason that certainty has eluded philosophers has as much to do with the disdain that philosophers have for the simplest truths as it does with the subject matter. Admittedly, the objects of arithmetic and geometry are especially pure and simple, or, as Descartes will later say, “clear and distinct.” Nevertheless, certainty can be attained in philosophy as well, provided the right method is followed.

Descartes distinguishes between two ways of achieving knowledge: “through experience and through deduction […] [W]e must note that while our experiences of things are often deceptive, the deduction or pure inference of one thing from another can never be performed wrongly by an intellect which is in the least degree rational […]” (CSM I, 12). This is a clear statement of Descartes’ methodological rationalism. Building up knowledge through accumulated experience can only ever lead to the sort of probable knowledge that Descartes finds lacking. “Pure inference,” by contrast,” can never go astray, at least when it is conducted by right reason. Of course, the truth value of a deductive chain is only as good as the first truths, or axioms, whose truth the deductions preserve. It is for this reason that Descartes’ method relies on intuition as well as deduction. Intuition provides the first principles of a deductive system, for Descartes. Intuition differs from deduction insofar as it is not discursive. Intuition grasps its object in an immediate way. In its broadest outlines, Descartes’ method is just the use of intuition and deduction in the orderly attainment and preservation of certainty.

In subsequent Rules, Descartes goes on to elaborate a more specific methodological program, which involves reducing complicated matters step by step to simpler, intuitively graspable truths, and then using those simple truths as principles from which to deduce knowledge of more complicated matters. It is generally accepted by scholars that this more specific methodological program reappears in a more iconic form in the Discourse on the Method as the four rules for gaining knowledge outlined in Part 2. There is some doubt as to the extent to which this more specific methodological program actually plays any role in Descartes’ mature philosophy as it is expressed in the Meditations and Principles (see Garber 2001, chapter 2). There can be no doubt, however, that the broader methodological guidelines outlined above were a permanent feature of Descartes’ thought.

In response to a request to cast his Meditations in the geometrical style (that is, in the style of Euclid’s Elements), Descartes distinguishes between two aspects of the geometrical style: order and method, explaining:

The order consists simply in this. The items which are put forward first must be known entirely without the aid of what comes later; and the remaining items must be arranged in such a way that their demonstration depends solely on what has gone before. I did try to follow this order very carefully in my Meditations […] (CSM II, 110)

Elsewhere, Descartes contrasts this order, which he calls the “order of reasons,” with another order, which he associates with scholasticism, and which he calls the “order of subject-matter” (see CSMK III, 163). What Descartes understands as “geometrical order” or the “order of reasons” is just the procedure of starting with what is most simple, and proceeding in a step-wise, deliberate fashion to deduce consequences from there. Descartes’ order is governed by what can be clearly and distinctly intuited, and by what can be clearly and distinctly inferred from such self-evident intuitions (rather than by a concern for organizing the discussion into neat topical categories per the order of subject-matter)

As for method, Descartes distinguishes between analysis and synthesis. For Descartes, analysis and synthesis represent different methods of demonstrating a conclusion or set of conclusions. Analysis exhibits the path by which the conclusion comes to be grasped. As such, it can be thought of as the order of discovery or order of knowledge. Synthesis, by contrast, wherein conclusions are deduced from a series of definitions, postulates, and axioms, as in Euclid’s Elements, for instance, follows not the order in which things are discovered, but rather the order that things bear to one another in reality. As such, it can be thought of as the order of being. God, for example, is prior to the human mind in the order of being (since God created the human mind), and so in the synthetic mode of demonstration the existence of God is demonstrated before the existence of the human mind. However, knowledge of one’s own mind precedes knowledge of God, at least in Descartes’ philosophy, and so in the analytic mode of demonstration the cogito is demonstrated before the existence of God. Descartes’ preference is for analysis, because he thinks that it is superior in helping the reader to discover the things for herself, and so in bringing about the intellectual conversion which it is the Meditations’ goal to effectuate in the minds of its readers. According to Descartes, while synthesis, in laying out demonstrations systematically, is useful in preempting dissent, it is inferior in engaging the mind of the reader.

Two primary distinctions can be made in summarizing Descartes’ methodology: (1) the distinction between the order of reasons and the order of subject-matter; and (2) the analysis/synthesis distinction. With respect to the first distinction, the great Continental rationalists are united. All adhere to the order of reasons, as we have described it above, rather than the order of subject-matter. Even though the rationalists disagree about how exactly to interpret the content of the order of reasons, their common commitment to following an order of reasons is a hallmark of their rationalism. Although there are points of convergence with respect to the second, analysis/synthesis distinction, there are also clear points of divergence, and this distinction can be useful in highlighting the range of approaches the rationalists adopt to mathematical methodology.

b. Spinoza

Of the great Continental rationalists, Spinoza is the most closely associated with mathematical method due to the striking presentation of his magnum opus, the Ethics, (as well as his presentation of Descartes’ Principles), in geometrical fashion. The fact that Spinoza is the only major rationalist to present his main work more geometrico might create the impression that he is the only philosopher to employ mathematical method in constructing and elaborating his philosophical system. This impression is mistaken, since both Descartes and Leibniz also apply mathematical method to philosophy. Nevertheless, there are differences between Spinoza’s employment of mathematical method and that of Descartes (and Leibniz). The most striking, of course, is the form of Spinoza’s Ethics. Each part begins with a series of definitions, axioms, and postulates and proceeds thence to deduce propositions, the demonstrations of which refer back to the definitions, axioms, postulates and previously demonstrated propositions on which they depend. Of course, this is just the method of presenting findings that Descartes in the Second Replies dubbed “synthesis.” For Descartes, analysis and synthesis differ only in pedagogical respects: whereas analysis is better for helping the reader discover the truth for herself, synthesis is better in compelling agreement.

There is some evidence that Spinoza’s motivations for employing synthesis were in part pedagogical. In Lodewijk Meyer’s preface to Spinoza’s Principles of Cartesian Philosophy, Meyer uses Descartes’ Second Replies distinction between analysis and synthesis to explain the motivation for the work. Meyer criticizes Descartes’ followers for being too uncritical in their enthusiasm for Descartes’ thought, and attributes this in part to the relative opacity of Descartes’ analytic mode of presentation. Thus, for Meyer, the motivation for presenting Descartes’ Principles in the synthetic manner is to make the proofs more transparent, and thereby leave less excuse for blind acceptance of Descartes’ conclusions. It is not clear to what extent Meyer’s explanation of the mode of presentation of Spinoza’s Principles of Cartesian Philosophy applies to Spinoza’s Ethics. In the first place, although Spinoza approved the preface, he did not author it himself. Secondly, while such an explanation seems especially suited to a work in which Spinoza’s chief goal was to present another philosopher’s thought in a different form, there is no reason to assume that it applies to the presentation of Spinoza’s own philosophy. Scholars have differed on how to interpret the geometrical form of Spinoza’s Ethics. However, it is generally accepted that Spinoza’s use of synthesis does not merely represent a pedagogical preference. There is reason to think that Spinoza’s methodology differs from that of Descartes in a somewhat deeper way.

There is another version of the analysis/synthesis distinction besides Descartes’ that was also influential in the 17^th century, that is, Hobbes’ version of the distinction. Although there is little direct evidence that Spinoza was influenced by Hobbes’ version of the distinction, some scholars have claimed a connection, and, in any case, it is useful to view Spinoza’s methodology in light of the Hobbesian alternative.

Synthesis and analysis are not modes of demonstrating findings that have already been made, for Hobbes, as they are for Descartes, but rather complementary means of generating findings; in particular, they are forms of causal reasoning. For Hobbes, analysis is reasoning from effects to causes; synthesis is reasoning in the other direction, from causes to effects. For example, by analysis, we infer that geometrical objects are constructed via the motions of points and lines and surfaces. Once motion has been established as the principle of geometry, it is then possible, via synthesis, to construct the possible effects of motion, and thereby, to make new discoveries in geometry. According to the Hobbesian schema, then, synthesis is not merely a mode of presenting truths, but a means of generating and discovering truths. (For Hobbes’ method, see The English Works of Thomas Hobbes of Malmesbury, vol. 1, ch. 6.) There is reason to think that synthesis had this kind of significance for Spinoza, as well – as a means of discovery, not merely presentation. Spinoza’s methodology, and, in particular, his theory of definitions, bear this out

Spinoza’s method begins with reflection on the nature of a “given true idea.” The “given true idea” serves as a standard by which the mind learns the distinction between true and false ideas, and also between the intellect and the imagination, and how to direct itself properly in the discovery of true ideas. The correct formulation of definitions emerges as the most important factor in directing the mind properly in the discovery of true ideas. To illustrate his conception of a good definition, Spinoza contrasts two definitions of a circle. On one definition, a circle is a figure in which all the lines from the center to the circumference are equal. On another, a circle is the figure described by the rotation of a line around one of its ends, which is fixed. For Spinoza, the second definition is superior. Whereas the first definition gives only a property of the circle, the second provides the cause from which all of the properties can be deduced. Hence, what makes a definition a good definition, for Spinoza, is its capacity to serve as a basis for the discovery of truths about the thing. The circle, of course, is just an example. For Spinoza, the method is perfected when it arrives at a true idea of the first cause of all things, that is, God. Only the method is perfected with a true idea of God, however, not the philosophy. The philosophy itself begins with a true idea of God, since the philosophy consists in deducing the consequences from a true idea of God. With this in mind, the definition of God is of paramount importance. In correspondence, Spinoza compares contrasting definitions of God, explaining that he chose the one which expresses the efficient cause from which all of the properties of God can be deduced.

In this light, it becomes clear that the geometrical presentation of Spinoza’s philosophy is not merely a pedagogic preference. The definitions that appear at the outset of the five parts of the Ethics do not serve merely to make explicit what might otherwise have remained only implicit in Descartes’ analytic mode of presentation. Rather, key definitions, such as the definition of God, are principles that underwrite the development of the system. As a result, Hobbes’ conception of the analysis/synthesis distinction throws an important light on Spinoza’s procedure. There is a movement of analysis in arriving at the causal definition of God from the preliminary “given true idea.” Then there is a movement of synthesis in deducing consequences from that causal definition. Of course, Descartes’ analysis/synthesis distinction still applies, since, after all, Spinoza’s system is presented in the synthetic manner in the Ethics. But the geometrical style of presentation is not merely a pedagogical device in Spinoza’s case. It is also a clue to the nature of his system.

c. Leibniz

Leibniz is openly critical of Descartes’ distinction between analysis and synthesis, writing, “Those who think that the analytic presentation consists in revealing the origin of a discovery, the synthetic in keeping it concealed, are in error” (L, 233). This comment is aimed at Descartes’ formulation of the distinction in the Second Replies. Leibniz is explicit about his adherence to the viewpoint that seems to be implied by Spinoza’s methodology: synthesis is itself a means of discovering truth no less than analysis, not merely a mode of presentation. Leibniz’s understanding of analysis and synthesis is closer to the Hobbesian conception, which views analysis and synthesis as different directions of causal reasoning: from effects to causes (analysis) and from causes to effects (synthesis). Leibniz formulates the distinction in his own terms as follows:

Synthesis is achieved when we begin from principles and run through truths in good order, thus discovering certain progressions and setting up tables, or sometimes general formulas, in which the answers to emerging questions can later be discovered. Analysis goes back to the principles in order to solve the given problems only […] (L, 232)

Leibniz thus conceives synthesis and analysis in relation to principles.

Leibniz lays great stress on the importance of establishing the possibility of ideas, that is to say, establishing that ideas do not involve contradiction, and this applies a fortiori to first principles. For Leibniz, the Cartesian criterion of clear and distinct perception does not suffice for establishing the possibility of an idea. Leibniz is critical, in particular, of Descartes’ ontological argument on the grounds that Descartes neglects to demonstrate the possibility of the idea of a most perfect being on which the argument depends. It is possible to mistakenly assume that an idea is possible, when in reality it is contradictory. Leibniz gives the example of a wheel turning at the fastest possible rate. It might at first seem that this idea is legitimate, but if a spoke of the wheel were extended beyond the rim, the end of the spoke would move faster than a nail in the rim itself, revealing a contradiction in the original notion.

For Leibniz, there are two ways of establishing the possibility of an idea: by experience (a posteriori) and by reducing concepts via analysis down to a relation of identity (a priori). Leibniz credits mathematicians and geometers with pushing the practice of demonstrating what would otherwise normally be taken for granted the furthest. For example, in Meditations on Knowledge, Truth, and Ideas, Leibniz writes, “That brilliant genius Pascal agrees entirely with these principles when he says, in his famous dissertation on the geometrical spirit […] that it is the task of the geometer to define all terms though ever so little obscure and to prove all truths though little doubtful” (L, 294). Leibniz credits his own doctrine of the possibility of ideas with clarifying exactly what it means for something to be beyond doubt and obscurity.

Leibniz describes the result of the reduction of concepts to identity variously as follows: when the thing is resolved into simple primitive notions understood in themselves (L, 231); “when every ingredient that enters into a distinct concept is itself known distinctly”; “when analysis is carried through to the end” (L, 292). Since, for Leibniz, all true ideas can be reduced to simple identities, it is, in principle, possible to derive all truths via a movement of synthesis from such simple identities in the way that mathematicians produce systems of knowledge on the basis of their basic definitions and axioms. This kind of a priori knowledge of the world is restricted to God, however. According to Leibniz, it is only possible for our finite minds to have this kind of knowledge – which Leibniz calls “intuitive” or “adequate” – in the case of things which do not depend on experience, or what Leibniz also calls “truths of reason,” which include abstract logical and metaphysical truths, and mathematical propositions. In the case of “truths of fact,” by contrast, with the exception of immediately graspable facts of experience, such as, “I think,” and “Various things are thought by me,” we are restricted to formulating hypotheses to explain the phenomena of sensory experience, and such knowledge of the world can, for us, only ever achieve the status of hypothesis, though our hypothetical knowledge can be continually improved and refined. (See Section 5, c, below for a discussion of hypotheses in Leibniz.)

Leibniz is in line with his rationalist predecessors in emphasizing the importance of proper order in philosophizing. Leibniz’s emphasis on establishing the possibility of ideas prior to using them in demonstrating propositions could be understood as a refinement of the geometrical order that Descartes established over against the order of subject-matter. Leibniz emphasizes order in another connection vis-à-vis Locke. As Leibniz makes clear in his New Essays, one of the clearest points of disagreement between him and Locke is on the question of innate ideas. In preliminary comments that Leibniz drew up upon first reading Locke’s Essay, and which he sent to Locke via Burnett, Leibniz makes the following point regarding philosophical order:

Concerning the question whether there are ideas and truths born with us, I do not find it absolutely necessary for the beginnings, nor for the practice of the art of thinking, to answer it; whether they all come to us from outside, or they come from within us, we will reason correctly provided that we keep in mind what I said above, and that we proceed with order and without prejudice. The question of the origin of our ideas and of our maxims is not preliminary in philosophy, and it is necessary to have made great progress in order to resolve it. (Philosophische Schriften, vol. 5, pp. 15-16)

Leibniz’s allusion to what he “said above” refers to remarks regarding the establishment of the possibility of ideas via experience and the principle of identity. This passage makes it clear that, from Leibniz’s point of view, the order in which Locke philosophizes is quite misguided, since Locke begins with a question that should only be addressed after “great progress” has already been made, particularly with respect to the criteria for distinguishing between true and false ideas, and for establishing legitimate philosophical principles. Empiricists generally put much less emphasis on the order of philosophizing, since they do not aim to reason from first principles grasped a priori.

4. A Priori Principles

A fundamental tenet of rationalism – perhaps the fundamental tenet – is that the world is intelligible. The intelligibility tenet means that everything that happens in the world happens in an orderly, lawful, rational manner, and that the mind, in principle, if not always in practice, is able to reproduce the interconnections of things in thought provided that it adheres to certain rules of right reasoning. The intelligibility of the world is sometimes couched in terms of a denial of brute facts, where a “brute fact” is something that “just is the case,” that is, something that obtains without any reason or explanation (even in principle). Many of the a priori principles associated with rationalism can be understood either as versions or implications of the principle of intelligibility. As such, the principle of intelligibility functions as a basic principle of rationalism. It appears under various guises in the great rationalist systems and is used to generate contrasting philosophical systems. Indeed, one of the chief criticisms of rationalism is the fact that its principles can consistently be used to generate contradictory conclusions and systems of thought. The clearest and best known statement of the intelligibility of the world is Leibniz’s principle of sufficient reason. Some scholars have recently emphasized this principle as the key to understanding rationalism (see Della Rocca 2008, chapter 1).

The intelligibility principle raises some classic philosophical problems. Chief among these is a problem of question-begging or circularity. The task of proving that the world is intelligible seems to have to rely on some of the very principles of reasoning in question. In the 17^th century, discussion of this fundamental problem centered around the so-called “Cartesian circle.” The problem is still debated by scholars of 17^th century thought today. The viability of the rationalist enterprise seems to depend, at least in part, on a satisfactory answer to this problem.

a. Intelligibility and the Cartesian Circle

The most important rational principle in Descartes’ philosophy, the principle which does a great deal of the work in generating its details, is the principle according to which whatever is clearly and distinctly perceived to be true is true. This principle means that if we can form any clear and distinct ideas, then we will be able to trust that they accurately represent their objects, and give us certain knowledge of reality. Descartes’ clear and distinct ideas doctrine is central to his conception of the world’s intelligibility, and indeed, it is central to the rationalists’ conception of the world’s intelligibility more broadly. Although Spinoza and Leibniz both work to refine understanding of what it is to have clear and distinct ideas, they both subscribe to the view that the mind, when directed properly, is able to accurately represent certain basic features of reality, such as the nature of substance.

For Descartes, it cannot be taken for granted from the outset that what we clearly and distinctly perceive to be true is in fact true. It is possible to entertain the doubt that an all-powerful deceiving being fashioned the mind so that it is deceived even in those things it perceives clearly and distinctly. Nevertheless, it is only possible to entertain this doubt when we are not having clear and distinct perceptions. When we are perceiving things clearly and distinctly, their truth is undeniable. Moreover, we can use our capacity for clear and distinct perceptions to demonstrate that the mind was not fashioned by an all-powerful deceiving being, but rather by an all-powerful benevolent being who would not fashion us so as to be deceived even when using our minds properly. Having proved the existence of an all-powerful benevolent being qua creator of our minds, we can no longer entertain any doubts regarding our clear and distinct ideas even when we are not presently engaged in clear and distinct perceptions.

Descartes’ legitimation of clear and distinct perception via his proof of a benevolent God raises notorious interpretive challenges. Scholars disagree about how to resolve the problem of the “Cartesian circle.” However, there is general consensus that Descartes’ procedure is not, in fact, guilty of vicious, logical circularity. In order for Descartes’ procedure to avoid circularity, it is generally agreed that in some sense clear and distinct ideas need already to be legitimate before the proof of God’s existence. It is only in another sense that God’s existence legitimates their truth. Scholars disagree on how exactly to understand those different senses, but they generally agree that there is some sense at least in which clear and distinct ideas are self-legitimating, or, otherwise, not in need of legitimation.

That some ideas provide a basic standard of truth is a fundamental tenet of rationalism, and undergirds all the other rationalist principles at work in the construction of rationalist systems of philosophy. For the rationalists, if it cannot be taken for granted in at least some sense from the outset that the mind is capable of discerning the difference between truth and falsehood, then one never gets beyond skepticism.

b. Substance Metaphysics

The Continental rationalists deploy the principle of intelligibility and subordinate rational principles derived from it in generating much of the content of their respective philosophical systems. In no aspect of their systems is the application of rational principles to the generation of philosophical content more evident and more clearly illustrative of contrasting interpretations of these principles than in that for which the Continental rationalists are arguably best known: substance metaphysics.

i. Descartes

Descartes deploys his clear and distinct ideas doctrine in justifying his most well-known metaphysical position: substance dualism. The first step in Descartes’ demonstration of mind-body dualism, or, in his terminology, of a “real” distinction (that is, a distinction between two substances) between mind and body is to show that while it is possible to doubt that one has a body, it is not possible to doubt that one is thinking. As Descartes makes clear in the Principles of Philosophy, one of the chief upshots of his famous cogito argument is the discovery of the distinction between a thinking thing and a corporeal thing. The impossibility of doubting one’s existence is not the impossibility of doubting that one is a human being with a body with arms and legs and a head. It is the impossibility of doubting, rather, that one doubts, perceives, dreams, imagines, understands, wills, denies, and other modalities that Descartes attributes to the thinking thing. It is possible to think of oneself as a thing that thinks, and to recognize that it is impossible to doubt that one thinks, while continuing to doubt that one has a body with arms and legs and a head. So, the cogito drives a preliminary wedge between mind and body.

At this stage of the argument, however, Descartes has simply established that it is possible to conceive of himself as a thinking thing without conceiving of himself as a corporeal thing. It remains possible that, in fact, the thinking thing is identical with a corporeal thing, in other words, that thought is somehow something a body can do; Descartes has yet to establish that the epistemological distinction between his knowledge of his mind and his knowledge of body that results from the hyperbolic doubt translates to a metaphysical or ontological distinction between mind and body. The move from the epistemological distinction to the ontological distinction proceeds via the doctrine of clear and distinct ideas. Having established that whatever he clearly and distinctly perceives is true, Descartes is in a position to affirm the real distinction between mind and body.

In this life, it is never possible to clearly and distinctly perceive a mind actually separate from a body, at least in the case of finite, created minds, because minds and bodies are intimately unified in the composite human being. So Descartes cannot base his proof for the real distinction of mind and body on the clear and distinct perception that mind and body are in fact independently existing things. Rather, Descartes’ argument is based on the joint claims that (1) it is possible to have a clear and distinct idea of thought apart from extension and vice versa; and (2) whatever we can clearly and distinctly understand is capable of being created by God exactly as we clearly and distinctly understand it. Thus, the fact that we can clearly and distinctly understand thought apart from extension and vice versa entails that thinking things and extended things are “really” distinct (in the sense that they are distinct substances separable by God).

The foregoing argument relies on certain background assumptions which it is now necessary to explain, in particular, Descartes’ conception of substance. In the Principles, Descartes defines substance as “a thing which exists in such a way as to depend on no other thing for its existence” (CSM I, 210). Properly speaking, only God can be understood to depend on no other thing, and so only God is a substance in the absolute sense. Nevertheless, Descartes allows that, in a relative sense, created things can count as substances too. A created thing is a substance if the only thing it relies upon for its existence is “the ordinary concurrence of God” (ibid.). Only mind and body qualify as substances in this secondary sense. Everything else is a modification or property of minds and bodies. A second point is that, for Descartes, we do not have a direct knowledge of substance; rather, we come to know substance by virtue of its attributes. Thought and extension are the attributes or properties in virtue of which we come to know thinking and corporeal substance, or “mind” and “body.” This point relies on the application of a key rational principle, to wit, nothingness has no properties. For Descartes, there cannot simply be the properties of thinking and extension without these properties having something in which to inhere. Thinking and extension are not just any properties; Descartes calls them “principal attributes” because they constitute the nature of their respective substances. Other, non-essential properties, cannot be understood without the principal attribute, but the principal attribute can be understood without any of the non-essential properties. For example, motion cannot be understood without extension, but extension can be understood without motion.

Descartes’ conception of mind and body as distinct substances includes some interesting corollaries which result from a characteristic application of rational principles and account for some characteristic doctrinal differences between Descartes and empiricist philosophers. One consequence of Descartes’ conception of the mind as a substance whose principal attribute is thought is that the mind must always be thinking. Since, for Descartes, thinking is something of which the thinker is necessarily aware, Descartes’ commitment to thought as an essential, and therefore, inseparable, property of the mind raises some awkward difficulties. Arnauld, for example, raises one such difficulty in his Objections to Descartes’ Meditations: presumably there is much going on in the mind of an infant in its mother’s womb of which the infant is not aware. In response to this objection, and also in response to another obvious problem, that is, that of dreamless sleep, Descartes insists on a distinction between being aware of or conscious of our thoughts at the time we are thinking them, and remembering them afterwards (CSMK III, 357). The infant is, in fact, aware of its thinking in the mother’s womb, but it is aware only of very confused sensory thoughts of pain and pleasure and heat (not, as Descartes points out, metaphysical matters (CSMK III, 189)) which it does not remember afterwards. Similarly, the mind is always thinking even in the most “dreamless sleep,” it is just that the mind often immediately forgets much of what it had been aware.

Descartes’ commitment to embracing the implications – however counter-intuitive – of his substance-attribute metaphysics, puts him at odds with, for instance, Locke, who mocks the Cartesian doctrine of the always-thinking soul in his An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. For Locke, the question whether the soul is always thinking or not must be decided by experience and not, as Locke says, merely by “hypothesis” (An Essay Concerning Human Understanding, Book II, Chapter 1). The evidence of dreamless sleep makes it obvious, for Locke, that the soul is not always thinking. Because Locke ties personal identity to memory, if the soul were to think while asleep without knowing it, the sleeping man and the waking man would be two different persons.

Descartes’ commitment to the always-thinking mind is a consequence of his commitment to a more basic rational principle. In establishing his conception of thinking substance, Descartes reasons from the attribute of thinking to the substance of thinking on the grounds that nothing has no properties. In this case, he reasons in the other direction, from the substance of thinking, that is, the mind, to the property of thinking on the converse grounds that something must have properties, and the properties it must have are the properties that make it what it is; in the case of the mind, that property is thought. (Leibniz found a way to maintain the integrity of the rational principle without contradicting experience: admit that thinking need not be conscious. This way the mind can still think in a dreamless sleep, and so avoid being without any properties, without any problem about the recollection of awareness.)

Another consequence of Descartes’ substance metaphysics concerns corporeal substance. For Descartes, we do not know corporeal substance directly, but rather through a grasp of its principal attribute, extension. Extension qua property requires a substance in which to inhere because of the rational principle, nothing has no properties. This rational principle leads to another characteristic Cartesian position regarding the material world: the denial of a vacuum. Descartes denies that space can be empty or void. Space has the property of being extended in length, breadth, and depth, and such properties require a substance in which to inhere. Thus, nothing, that is, a void or vacuum, is not able to have such properties because of the rational principle, nothing has no properties. This means that all space is filled with substance, even if it is imperceptible. Once again, Descartes answers a debated philosophical question on the basis of a rational principle.

ii. Spinoza

If Descartes is known for his dualism, Spinoza, of course, is known for monism – the doctrine that there is only one substance. Spinoza’s argument for substance monism (laid out in the first fifteen propositions of the Ethics) has no essential basis in sensory experience; it proceeds through rational argumentation and the deployment of rational principles; although Spinoza provides one a posteriori argument for God’s existence, he makes clear that he presents it only because it is easier to grasp than the a priori arguments, and not because it is in any way necessary.

The crucial step in the argument for substance monism comes in Ethics 1p5: “In Nature there cannot be two or more substances of the same nature or attribute.” It is at this proposition that Descartes (and Leibniz, and many others) would part ways with Spinoza. The most striking and controversial implication of this proposition, at least from a Cartesian perspective, is that human minds cannot qualify as substances, since human minds all share the same nature or attribute, that is, thought. In Spinoza’s philosophy, human minds are actually themselves properties – Spinoza calls them “modes” – of a more basic, infinite substance.

The argument for 1p5 works as follows. If there were two or more distinct substances, there would have to be some way to distinguish between them. There are two possible distinctions to be made: either by a difference in their affections or by a difference in their attributes. For Spinoza, a substance is something which exists in itself and can be conceived through itself; an attribute is “what the intellect perceives of a substance, as constituting its essence” (Ethics 1d4). Spinoza’s conception of attributes is a matter of longstanding scholarly debate, but for present purposes, we can think of it along Cartesian lines. For Descartes, substance is always grasped through a principal property, which is the nature or essence of the substance. Spinoza agrees that an attribute is that through which the mind conceives the nature or essence of substance. With this in mind, if a distinction between two substances were to be made on the basis of a difference in attributes, then there would not be two substances of the same attribute as the proposition indicates. This means that if there were two substances of the same attribute, it would be necessary to distinguish between them on the basis of a difference in modes or affections.

Spinoza conceives of an affection or mode as something which exists in another and needs to be conceived through another. Given this conception of affections, it is impossible, for Spinoza, to distinguish between two substances on the basis of a difference in affections. Doing so would be somewhat akin to affirming that there are two apples on the basis of a difference between two colors, when one apple can quite possibly have a red part and a green part. As color differences do not per se determine differences between apples, in a similar way, modal differences cannot determine a difference between substances – you could just be dealing with one substance bearing multiple different affections. It is notable that in 1p5, Spinoza uses virtually the same substance-attribute schema as Descartes to deny a fundamental feature of Descartes’ system.

Having established 1p5, the next major step in Spinoza’s argument for substance monism is to establish the necessary existence and infinity of substance. For Spinoza, if things have nothing in common with each other, one cannot be the cause of the other. This thesis depends upon assumptions that lie at the heart of Spinoza’s rationalism. Something that has nothing in common with another thing cannot be the cause of the other thing because things that have nothing in common with one another cannot be understood through one another (Ethics 1a5). But, for Spinoza, effects should be able to be understood through causes. Indeed, what it is to understand something, for Spinoza, is to understand its cause. The order of knowledge, provided that the knowledge is genuine, or, as Spinoza says, “adequate,” must map onto the order of being, and vice versa. Thus, Spinoza’s claim that if things have nothing in common with one another, one cannot be the cause of the other, is an expression of Spinoza’s fundamental, rationalist commitment to the intelligibility of the world. Given this assumption, and given the fact that no two substances have anything in common with one another, since no two substances share the same nature or attribute, it follows that if a substance is to exist, it must exist as causa sui (self-caused); in other words, it must pertain to the essence of substance to exist. Moreover, Spinoza thinks that since there is nothing that has anything in common with a given substance, there is therefore nothing to limit the nature of a given substance, and so every substance will necessarily be infinite. This assertion depends on another deep-seated assumption of Spinoza’s philosophy: nothing limits itself, but everything by virtue of its very nature affirms its own nature and existence as much as possible.

At this stage, Spinoza has argued that substances of a single attribute exist necessarily and are necessarily infinite. The last major stage of the argument for substance monism is the transition from multiple substances of a single attribute to only one substance of infinite attributes. Scholars have expressed varying degrees of satisfaction with the lucidity of this transition. It seems to work as follows. It is possible to attribute many attributes to one substance. The more reality or being each thing has, the more attributes belong to it. Therefore, an absolutely infinite being is a being that consists of infinite attributes. Spinoza calls an absolutely infinite being or substance consisting of infinite attributes “God.” Spinoza gives four distinct arguments for God’s existence in Ethics 1p11. The first is commonly interpreted as Spinoza’s version of an ontological argument. It refers back to 1p7 where Spinoza proved that it pertains to the essence of substance to exist. The second argument is relevant to present purposes, since it turns on Spinoza’s version of the principle of sufficient reason: “For each thing there must be assigned a cause, or reason, both for its existence and for its nonexistence” (Ethics 1p11dem). But there can be no reason for God’s nonexistence for the same reasons that all substances are necessarily infinite: there is nothing outside of God that is able to limit Him, and nothing limits itself. Once again, Spinoza’s argument rests upon his assumption that things by nature affirm their own existence. The third argument is a posteriori, and the fourth pivots like the second on the assumption that things by nature affirm their own existence.

Having proven that a being consisting of infinite attributes exists, Spinoza’s argument for substance monism is nearly complete. It remains only to point out that no substance besides God can exist, because if it did, it would have to share at least one of God’s infinite attributes, which, by 1p5, is impossible. Everything that exists, then, is either an attribute or an affection of God.

iii. Leibniz

Leibniz’s universe consists of an infinity of monads or simple substances, and God. For Leibniz, the universe must be composed of monads or simple substances. His justification for this claim is relatively straightforward. There must be simples, because there are compounds, and compounds are just collections of simples. To be simple, for Leibniz, means to be without parts, and thus to be indivisible. For Leibniz, the simples or monads are the “true atoms of nature” (L, 643). However, “material atoms are contrary to reason” (L, 456). Manifold a priori considerations lead Leibniz to reject material atoms. In the first place, the notion of a material atom is contradictory in Leibniz’s view. Matter is extended, and that which is extended is divisible into parts. The very notion of an atom, however, is the notion of something indivisible, lacking parts.

From a different perspective, Leibniz’s dynamical investigations provide another argument against material atoms. Absolute rigidity is included in the notion of a material atom, since any elasticity in the atom could only be accounted for on the basis of parts within the atom shifting their position with respect to each other, which is contrary to the notion of a partless atom. According to Leibniz’s analysis of impact, however, absolute rigidity is shown not to make sense. Consider the rebound of one atom as a result of its collision with another. If the atoms were absolutely rigid, the change in motion resulting from the collision would have to happen instantaneously, or, as Leibniz says, “through a leap or in a moment” (L, 446). The atom would change from initial motion to rest to rebounded motion without passing through any intermediary degrees of motion. Since the body must pass through all the intermediary degrees of motion in transitioning from one state of motion to another, it must not be absolutely rigid, but rather elastic; the analysis of the parts of the body must, in correlation with the degree of motion, proceed to infinity. Leibniz’s dynamical argument against material atoms turns on what he calls the law of continuity, an a priori principle according to which “no change occurs through a leap.”

The true unities, or true atoms of nature, therefore, cannot be material; they must be spiritual or metaphysical substances akin to souls. Since Leibniz’s spiritual substances, or monads, are absolutely simple, without parts, they admit neither of dissolution nor composition. Moreover, there can be no interaction between monads, monads cannot receive impressions or undergo alterations by means of being affected from the outside, since, in Leibniz’s famous phrase from the Monadology, monads “have no windows” (L, 643). Monads must, however, have qualities, otherwise there would be no way to explain the changes we see in things and the diversity of nature. Indeed, following from Leibniz’s principle of the identity of indiscernibles, no two monads can be exactly alike, since each monad stands in a unique relation to the rest, and, for Leibniz, each monad’s relation to the rest is a distinctive feature of its nature. The way in which, for Leibniz, monads can have qualities while remaining simple, or in other words, the only way there can be multitude in simplicity is if monads are characterized and distinguished by means of their perceptions. Leibniz’s universe, in summary, consists in monads, simple spiritual substances, characterized and distinguished from one another by a unique series of perceptions determined by each monad’s unique relationship vis-à-vis the others.

Of the great rationalists, Leibniz is the most explicit about the principles of reasoning that govern his thought. Leibniz singles out two, in particular, as the most fundamental rational principles of his philosophy: the principle of contradiction and the principle of sufficient reason. According to the principle of contradiction, whatever involves a contradiction is false. According to the principle of sufficient reason, there is no fact or true proposition “without there being a sufficient reason for its being so and not otherwise” (L, 646). Corresponding to these two principles of reasoning are two kinds of truths: truths of reasoning and truths of fact. For Leibniz, truths of reasoning are necessary, and their opposite is impossible. Truths of fact, by contrast, are contingent, and their opposite is possible. Truths of reasoning are by most commentators associated with the principle of contradiction because they can be reduced via analysis to a relation between two primitive ideas, whose identity is intuitively evident. Thus, it is possible to grasp why it is impossible for truths of reasoning to be otherwise. However, this kind of resolution is only possible in the case of abstract propositions, such as the propositions of mathematics (see Section 3, c, above). Contingent truths, or truths of fact, by contrast, such as “Caesar crossed the Rubicon,” to use the example Leibniz gives in the Discourse on Metaphysics, are infinitely complicated. Although, for Leibniz, every predicate is contained in its subject, to reduce the relationship between Caesar’s “notion” and his action of crossing the Rubicon would require an infinite analysis impossible for finite minds. “Caesar crossed the Rubicon” is a contingent proposition, because there is another possible world in which Caesar did not cross the Rubicon. To understand the reason for Caesar’s crossing, then, entails understanding why this world exists rather than any other possible world. It is for this reason that contingent truths are associated with the principle of sufficient reason. Although the opposite of truths of fact is possible, there is nevertheless a sufficient reason why the fact is so and not otherwise, even though this reason cannot be known by finite minds.

Truths of fact, then, need to be explained; there must be a sufficient reason for them. However, according to Leibniz, “a sufficient reason for existence cannot be found merely in any one individual thing or even in the whole aggregate and series of things” (L, 486). That is to say, the sufficient reason for any given contingent fact cannot be found within the world of which it is a part. The sufficient reason must explain why this world exists rather than another possible world, and this reason must lie outside the world itself. For Leibniz, the ultimate reason for things must be contained in a necessary substance that creates the world, that is, God. But if the existence of God is to ground the series of contingent facts that make up the world, there must be a sufficient reason why God created this world rather than any of the other infinite possible worlds contained in his understanding. As a perfect being, God would only have chosen to bring this world into existence rather than any other because it is the best of all possible worlds. God’s choice, therefore, is governed by the principle of fitness, or what Leibniz also calls the “principle of the best” (L, 647). The best world, according to Leibniz, is the one which maximizes perfection; and the most perfect world is the one which balances the greatest possible variety with the greatest possible order. God achieves maximal perfection in the world through what Leibniz calls “the pre-established harmony.” Although the world is made up of an infinity of monads with no direct interaction with one another, God harmonizes the perceptions of each monad with the perceptions of every other monad, such that each monad represents a unique perspective on the rest of the universe according to its position vis-à-vis the others.

According to Leibniz’s philosophy, in the case of all true propositions, the predicate is contained in the subject. This is often known as the “predicate-in-notion” principle. The relationship between predicate and subject can only be reduced to an identity relation in the case of truths of reason, whereas in the case of truths of fact, the reduction requires an infinite analysis. Nevertheless, in both cases, it is possible in principle (which is to say, for an infinite intellect) to know everything that will ever happen to an individual substance, and even everything that will happen in the world of an individual substance on the basis of an examination of the individual substance’s notion, since each substance is an expression of the entire world. Leibniz’s predicate-in-notion principle therefore unifies both of his two great principles of reasoning – the principle of contradiction and the principle of sufficient reason – since the relation between predicate and subject is either such that it is impossible for it to be otherwise or such that there is a sufficient reason why it is as it is and not otherwise. Moreover, it represents a particularly robust expression of the principle of intelligibility at the very heart of Leibniz’s system. There is a reason why everything is as it is, whether that reason is subject to finite or only to infinite analysis.

5. Continental Rationalism, Experience, and Experiment

Rationalism is often criticized for placing too much confidence in the ability of reason alone to know the world. The extent to which one finds this criticism justified depends largely on one’s view of reason. For Hume, for instance, knowledge of the world of “matters of fact” is gained exclusively through experience; reason is merely a faculty for comparing ideas gained through experience; it is thus parasitic upon experience, and has no claim whatsoever to grasp anything about the world itself, let alone any special claim. For Kant, reason is a mental faculty with an inherent tendency to transgress the bounds of possible experience in an effort to grasp the metaphysical foundations of the phenomenal realm. Since knowledge of the world is limited to objects of possible experience, for Kant, reason, with its delusions of grasping reality beyond those limits, must be subject to critique.

Sometimes rationalism is charged with neglecting or undervaluing experience, and with embarrassingly having no means of accounting for the tremendous success of the experimental sciences. While the criticism of the confidence placed in reason may be defensible given a certain conception of reason (which may or may not itself be ultimately defensible), the latter charge of neglecting experience is not; more often than not it is the product of a false caricature of rationalism

Descartes and Leibniz were the leading mathematicians of their day, and stood at the forefront of science. While Spinoza distinguished himself more as a political thinker, and as an interpreter of scripture (albeit a notorious one) than as a mathematician, Spinoza too performed experiments, kept abreast of the leading science of the day, and was renowned as an expert craftsman of lenses. Far from neglecting experience, the great rationalists had, in general, a sophisticated understanding of the role of experience and, indeed, of experiment, in the acquisition and development of knowledge. The fact that the rationalists held that experience and experiment cannot serve as foundations for knowledge, but must be fitted within, and interpreted in light of, a rational epistemic framework, should not be confused with a neglect of experience and experiment.

a. Descartes

One of the stated purposes of Descartes’ Meditations, and, in particular, the hyperbolic doubts with which it commences, is to reveal to the mind of the reader the limitations of its reliance on the senses, which Descartes regards as an inadequate foundation for knowledge. By leading the mind away from the senses, which often deceive, and which yield only confused ideas, Descartes prepares the reader to discover the clear and distinct perceptions of the pure intellect, which provide a proper foundation for genuine knowledge. Nevertheless, empirical observations and experimentation clearly had an important role to play in Descartes’ natural philosophy, as evidenced by his own private empirical and experimental research, especially in optics and anatomy, and by his explicit statements in several writings on the role and importance of observation and experiment.

In Part 6 of the Discourse on the Method, Descartes makes an open plea for assistance – both financial and otherwise – in making systematic empirical observations and conducting experiments. Also in Discourse Part 6, Descartes lays out his program for developing knowledge of nature. It begins with the discovery of “certain seeds of truth” implanted naturally in our souls (CSM I, 144). From them, Descartes seeks to derive the first principles and causes of everything. Descartes’ Meditations illustrates these first stages of the program. By “seeds of truth” Descartes has in mind certain intuitions, including the ideas of thinking, and extension, and, in particular, of God. On the basis of clearly and distinctly perceiving the distinction between what belongs properly to extension (figure, position, motion) and what does not (colors, sounds, smells, and so forth), Descartes discovers the principles of physics, including the laws of motion. From these principles, it is possible to deduce many particular ways in which the details of the world might be, only a small fraction of which represent the way the world actually is. It is as a result of the distance, as it were, between physical principles and laws of nature, on one hand, and the particular details of the world, on the other, that, for Descartes, observations and experiments become necessary.

Descartes is ambivalent about the relationship between physical principles and particulars, and about the role that observation and experiment play in mediating this relationship. On the one hand, Descartes expresses commitment to the ideal of a science deduced with certainty from intuitively grasped first principles. Because of the great variety of mutually incompatible consequences that can be derived from physical principles, observation and experiment are required even in the ideal deductive science to discriminate between actual consequences and merely possible ones. According to the ideal of deductive science, however, observation and experiment should be used only to facilitate the deduction of effects from first causes, and not as a basis for an inference to possible explanations of natural phenomena, as Descartes makes clear at one point his Principles of Philosophy (CSM I, 249). If the explanations were only possible, or hypothetical, the science could not lay claim to certainty per the deductive ideal, but merely to probability.

On the other hand, Descartes states explicitly at another point in the Principles of Philosophy that the explanations provided of such phenomena as the motion of celestial bodies and the nature of the earth’s elements should be regarded merely as hypotheses arrived at on the basis of a posteriori reasoning (CSM I, 255); while Descartes says that such hypotheses must agree with observation and facilitate predictions, they need not in fact reflect the actual causes of phenomena. Descartes appears to concede, albeit reluctantly, that when it comes to explaining particular phenomena, hypothetical explanations and moral certainty (that is, mere probability) are all that can be hoped for.

Scholars have offered a range of explanations for the inconsistency in Descartes’ writings on the question of the relation between first principles and particulars. It has been suggested that the inconsistency within the Principles of Philosophy reflects different stages of its composition (see Garber 1978). However the inconsistency might be explained, it is clear that Descartes did not take it for granted that the ideal of a deductive science of nature could be realized. Moreover, whether or not Descartes ultimately believed the ideal of deductive science was realizable, he was unambiguous on the importance of observation and experiment in bridging the distance between physical principles and particular phenomena. (For further discussion, see René Descartes: Scientific Method.)

b. Spinoza

The one work that Spinoza published under his own name in his lifetime was his geometrical reworking of Descartes’ Principles of Philosophy. In Spinoza’s presentation of the opening sections of Part 3 of Descartes’ Principles, Spinoza puts a strong emphasis on the hypothetical nature of the explanations of natural phenomena in Part 3. Given the hesitance and ambivalence with which Descartes concedes the hypothetical nature of his explanations in his Principles, Spinoza’s unequivocal insistence on hypotheses is striking. Elsewhere Spinoza endorses hypotheses more directly. In the Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect, Spinoza describes forming the concept of a sphere by affirming the rotation of a semicircle in thought. He points out that this idea is a true idea of a sphere even if no sphere has ever been produced this way in nature (The Collected Works of Spinoza, Vol. 1, p. 32). Spinoza’s view of hypotheses relates to his conception of good definitions (see Section 3, b, above). If the cause through which one conceives something allows for the deduction of all possible effects, then the cause is an adequate one, and there is no need to fear a false hypothesis. Spinoza appears to differ from Descartes in thinking that the formation of hypotheses, if done properly, is consistent with deductive certainty, and not tantamount to mere probability or moral certainty.

Again in the Treatise on the Emendation of the Intellect, Spinoza speaks in Baconian fashion of identifying “aids” that can assist in the use of the senses and in conducting orderly experiments. Unfortunately, Spinoza’s comments regarding “aids” are very unclear. This is perhaps explained by the fact that they appear in a work that Spinoza never finished. Nevertheless, it does seem clear that although Spinoza, like Descartes, emphasized the importance of discovering proper principles from which to deduce knowledge of everything else, he was no less aware than Descartes of the need to proceed via observation and experiment in descending from such principles to particulars. At the same time, given his analysis of the inadequacy of sensory images, the collection of empirical data must be governed by rules and rational guidelines the details of which it does not seem that Spinoza ever worked out.

A valuable perspective on Spinoza’s attitude toward experimentation is provided by Letter 6, which Spinoza wrote to Oldenburg with comments on Robert Boyle’s experimental research. Among other matters, at issue is Boyle’s “redintegration” (or reconstitution) of niter (potassium nitrate). By heating niter with a burning coal, Boyle separated the niter into a “fixed” part and a volatile part; he then proceeded to distill the volatile part, and recombine it with the fixed part, thereby redintegrating the niter. Boyle’s aim was to show that the nature of niter is not determined by a Scholastic “substantial form,” but rather by the composition of parts, whose secondary qualities (color, taste, smell, and so forth) are determined by primary qualities (size, position, motion, and so forth). While taking no issue with Boyle’s attempt to undermine the Scholastic analysis of physical natures, Spinoza criticized Boyle’s interpretation of the experiment, arguing that the fixed niter was merely an impurity left over, and that there was no difference between the niter and the volatile part other than a difference of state.

Two things stand out from Spinoza’s comments on Boyle. On the one hand, Spinoza exhibits a degree of impatience with Boyle’s experiments, charging some of them with superfluity on the grounds either that what they show is evident on the basis of reason alone, or that previous philosophers have already sufficiently demonstrated them experimentally. In addition, Spinoza’s own interpretation of Boyle’s experiment is primarily based in a rather speculative, Cartesian account of the mechanical constitution of niter (as Boyle himself points out in response to Spinoza). On the other hand, Spinoza appears eager to show his own fluency with experimental practice, describing no fewer than three different experiments of his own invention to support his interpretation of the redintegration. What Spinoza is critical of is not so much Boyle’s use of experiment per se as his relative neglect of relevant rational considerations. For instance, Spinoza at one point criticizes Boyle for trying to show that secondary qualities depend on primary qualities on experimental grounds. Spinoza thought the proposition needed to be demonstrated on rational grounds. While Spinoza acknowledges the importance and necessity of observation and experiment, his emphasis and focus is on the rational framework needed for making sense of experimental findings, without which the results are confused and misleading.

c. Leibniz

In principle, Leibniz thinks it is not impossible to discover the interior constitution of bodies a priori on the basis of a knowledge of God and the “principle of the best” according to which He creates the world. Leibniz sometimes remarks that angels could explain to us the intelligible causes through which all things come about, but he seems conflicted over whether such understanding is actually possible for human beings. Leibniz seems to think that while the a priori pathway should be pursued in this life by the brightest minds in any case, its perfection will only be possible in the afterlife. The obstacle to an a priori conception of things is the complexity of sensible effects. In this life, then, knowledge of nature cannot be purely a priori, but depends on observation and experimentation in conjunction with reason

Apart from perception, we have clear and distinct ideas only of magnitude, figure, motion, and other such quantifiable attributes (primary qualities). The goal of all empirical research must be to resolve phenomena (including secondary qualities) into such distinctly perceived, quantifiable notions. For example, heat is explained in terms of some particular motion of air or some other fluid. Only in this way can the epistemic ideal be achieved of understanding how phenomena follow from their causes in the same way that we know how the hammer stroke after a period of time follows from the workings of a clock (L, 173). To this end, experiments must be carried out to indicate possible relationships between secondary qualities and primary qualities, and to provide a basis for the formulation of hypotheses to explain the phenomena.

Nevertheless, there is an inherent limitation to this procedure. Leibniz explains that if there were people who had no direct experience of heat, for instance, even if someone were to explain to them the precise mechanical cause of heat, they would still not be able to know the sensation of heat, because they would still not distinctly grasp the connection between bodily motion and perception (L, 285). Leibniz seems to think that human beings will never be able to bridge the explanatory gap between sensations and mechanical causes. There will always be an irreducibly confused aspect of sensible ideas, even if they can be associated with a high degree of sophistication with distinctly perceivable, quantifiable notions. However, this limitation does not mean, for Leibniz, that there is any futility in human efforts to understand the world scientifically. In the first place, experimental knowledge of the composition of things is tremendously useful in practice, even if the composition is not distinctly perceived in all its parts. As Leibniz points out, the architect who uses stones to erect a cathedral need not possess a distinct knowledge of the bits of earth interposed between the stones (L, 175). Secondly, even if our understanding of the causes of sensible effects must remain forever hypothetical, the hypotheses themselves can be more or less refined, and it is proper experimentation that assists in their refinement.

6. References and Further Reading

When citing the works of Descartes, the three volume English translation by Cottingham, Stoothoff, Murdoch, and Kenny was used. For the original language, the edition by Adam and Tannery was consulted.

When citing Spinoza’s Ethics, the translation by Curley in A Spinoza Reader was used. The following system of abbreviation was used when citing passages from the Ethics: the first number designates the part of the Ethics (1-5); then, “p” is for proposition, “d” for definition, “a” for axiom, “dem” for demonstration, “c” for corollary, and “s” for scholium. So, 1p17s refers to the scholium of the seventeenth proposition of the first part of the Ethics. For the original language, the edition by Gebhardt was consulted.

For the original language in Leibniz, the edition by Gerhardt was consulted.

a. Primary Sources

Bacon, Francis. The Works of Francis Bacon. 7 Volumes. Edited by J. Spedding, R. L. Ellis, and D.D. Heath. London: Longmans, 1857-70. Cited above as Spedding, volume, page.
Bacon, Francis. The New Organon. Edited by Lisa Jardine and Michael Silverthorne. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 2000.
Descartes, René. Oeuvres de Descartes. 12 Volumes. Edited by C. Adam and P. Tannery. Paris: J. Vrin, 1964-76.
Descartes, René. The Philosophical Writings of Descartes. 3 vols. Vols. 1 and 2 translated by John Cottingham, Robert Stoothoff, and Dugald Murdoch. Vol. 3 translated by John Cottingham, Robert Stoothoff, Dugald Murdoch, and Anthony Kenny. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 1984-91. Cited above as CSM or CSMK, volume, page.
Hegel, G.W.F. Werke in zwanzig Bänden: Vorlesungen über die Geschichte der Philosophie: Werke XX. Edited by Eva Moldenhauer and Karl Markus Michel. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp Verlag, 1986. Cited as Werke, volume, page.
Hobbes, Thomas. The English Works of Thomas Hobbes of Malmesbury, Volume 1. London: John Bohn, 1839.
Leibniz, G.W. Philosophische Schriften. 7 Volumes. Edited by C.I. Gerhardt. Berlin, 1875-90.
Leibniz, G.W. Philosophical Papers and Letters. Second Edition. Translated and edited by Leroy E. Loemker. Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1989. Cited above as L, page.
Leibniz, G.W. New Essays on Human Understanding. Translated and edited by Peter Remnant and Jonathan Bennett. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 1996. Cited above as NE, page.
Locke, John. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Edited by Peter H. Nidditch. Oxford, UK: Oxford University Press, 1979.
Malebranche, Nicholas. The Search after Truth. Translated and edited by Thomas M. Lennon and Paul J. Olscamp. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 1997.
Spinoza, Benedict de. Spinoza Opera. 4 Volumes. Edited by C. Gebhardt. Heidelberg: Carl Winter, 1925.
Spinoza, Benedict de. The Collected Works of Spinoza. Vol. 1. Edited and translated by Edwin Curley. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1985.
Spinoza, Benedict de. A Spinoza Reader: The Ethics and Other Works. Edited and translated by Edwin Curley. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1994.
Spinoza, Benedict de. Spinoza: Complete Works. Translated by Samuel Shirley and edited by Michael L. Morgan. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett, 2002.

b. Secondary Sources

Ayers, Michael (ed.). Rationalism, Platonism and God. Oxford, UK: Oxford University Press, 2007.
Biasutti, Franco. “Reason and Experience in Leibniz and Spinoza” in Studia Spinozana, Volume 6, Spinoza and Leibniz (1990): 45-71.
Cottingham, John. The Rationalists. Oxford, UK: Oxford University Press, 1988.
Della Rocca, Michael. Spinoza. London: Routledge, 2008.
Fraenkel, Carlos; Perinetti, Dario; Smith, Justin E.H. (eds.). The Rationalists: Between Tradition and Innovation. Dordrecht: Springer, 2011.
Gabbey, Alan. “Spinoza’s natural science and methodology” in The Cambridge Companion to Spinoza, edited by Don Garrett. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
Garber, Daniel. “Science and Certainty in Descartes” in Descartes: Critical and Interpretive Essays, edited by Michael Hooker. Baltimore, MD: The Johns Hopkins University Press, 1978.
Garber, Daniel. Descartes Embodied: Reading Cartesian Philosophy through Cartesian Science. Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
Huenemann, Charlie. Understanding Rationalism. Durham, UK: Acumen Publishing, 2008.
Leduc, Christian. “Leibniz and Sensible Qualities” in British Journal for the History of Philosophy. 18(5), 2010: 797-819.
Nelson, Alan (ed.). A Companion to Rationalism. Oxford, UK: Blackwell, 2005.
Pereboom, Derk (ed.). The Rationalists: Critical Essays on Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz. Rowman & Littlefield, 1999.
Phemister, Pauline. The Rationalists: Descartes, Spinoza, and Leibniz. Polity, 2006.
Wilson, Margaret Dauler. Ideas and Mechanism: Essays on Early Modern Philosophy. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1999.

Author Information

Matthew Homan
Email: matthew.homan@cnu.edu
Christopher Newport University
U. S. A.

Knowledge Norms

Epistemology has seen a surge of interest in the idea that knowledge provides a normative constraint or rule governing certain actions or mental states. Such interest is generated in part by noticing that fundamentally epistemic notions, such as belief, evidence, and justification, figure prominently not only in theorizing about knowledge, but also in our everyday evaluations of each others’ actions, reasoning, and doxastic commitments. The three most prominent proposals to emerge from the epistemology literature have been that knowledge is the norm of assertion, the norm of action, and the norm of belief, though we shall consider other proposals as well.

‘Norm’ here is often, but not always, understood as a rule which is intimately related to the action/mental state type in question, such that this relationship is a constitutive one: the action or mental state is constituted (in part) by its relationship to the rule. Typically such views argue for a norm of permission such that knowledge is required, as a necessary condition, for permissibly acting or being in the relevant mental state: in schematic form, one must: X only if one knows a relevantly specified proposition. Some philosophers also endorse a sufficiency condition as well, so that knowledge is necessary and sufficient for (epistemic) permission to X, such that one must: X if and only if one knows a relevantly specific proposition. Such views put knowledge to work in elucidating normative concepts, practical rationality, and conceptual priorities in epistemology, mind, and decision theory. This article outlines the growing literature on these topics.

Knowledge Norm of Assertion
Knowledge Norm of Action
Knowledge Norm of Belief
1. The Belief-Assertion Parallel
2. Knowledge Disagreement Norm
References and Further Reading

1. Knowledge Norm of Assertion

Assertion is the speech act we use to make claims about the way things are: in English, asserting is the default speech act for uttering a sentence in the indicative or declarative mood, such as when one tells someone, “John is in his office” (for an overview of assertion, including ways of characterizing it that do not make essential appeal to epistemic norms, see MacFarlane 2011). The recent literature on the norms of assertion has concentrated on whether there is a rule governing the speech act of assertion which specifies a necessary condition for making the speech act permissible on that occasion; section 1.D below briefly discusses the idea of a sufficient condition for permissible assertion. The view has its roots in the work of philosophers who argued that when one asserts, claims, or declares that p (which are to be distinguished from simply uttering “p”) one somehow thereby represents oneself as knowing that p, even though p itself may not refer to the speaker’s knowledge at all (see Moore 1962: 277; Moore 1993: 211; Black 1952; and Unger 1975: 251ff.). The idea that when one asserts that p one represents oneself as knowing that p—call this position ‘RK’—enabled an explanation of certain problem sentences and conversational patterns.

a. Problem Sentences: Moore’s Paradox

G.E. Moore noted the paradoxical nature of asserted conjunctions where one affirms a proposition but also denies that one believes it or that one knows it. Conjunctions such as (1) and (2), he said, sound “absurd” (Moore 1942: 542-43; 1962: 277):

(1) Dogs bark, but I don’t believe that they do.

(2) Dogs bark, but I don’t know that they do.

The order of the conjuncts does not matter to their absurdity, as (3) and (4) make clear (Moore 1993: 207):

(3) I don’t believe that dogs bark, but they do.

(4) I don’t know that [whether] dogs bark, but they do.

What captured Moore’s interest about such asserted sentences is that they could be true and yet it seems incoherent to state that truth: “It is a paradox that it should be perfectly absurd to utter assertively words of which the meaning is something which may quite well be true—is not a contradiction” (Moore 1993: 209). Moore’s own diagnosis of their absurdity appeals to something like RK, namely that “by asserting p positively, you imply, though you don’t assert, that you know that p” (1962: 277). So in asserting one of (1) – (4), one asserts, in one conjunct, a proposition and thereby also represents oneself as knowing it; but one also denies, in the other conjunct, that one knows it (or believes it, entailed by knowing it), thus generating a contradiction between what one claims (that one doesn’t know) and what one represents as being the case (that one does know).

b. Conversational Patterns

Peter Unger (1975) pointed to certain conversational patterns which seem to support RK, because RK well-explains them. One of these concerns the common use of the question “How do you know?” in response to someone’s assertion: such a question may be used to elicit clarification about why one is flat-out asserting, but importantly, it also may be used to challenge someone’s assertion. What is more, it is rare that this question is condemned as out of line in response to an assertion. Such questions are appropriate even though an asserter has said nothing at all about knowing what she’s asserted, and an asserter cannot acceptably answer such questions by claiming that she never claimed that she knew it. And an asserter who concedes with “I don’t know,” or modifies her original assertion by moving to “I believe p” or “I think p” or “Probably p” will normally be taken to be retreating from her original outright assertion that p: she has instead replaced her claim with a weaker one. RK explains all these points (Unger 1975: 263-64; cf. also Slote 1979).

Timothy Williamson (1996; 2000, Ch. 11), provides a fuller defense of the view, and pointed to further conversational patterns explained by RK. Williamson’s account replaces RK with the Knowledge Norm of Assertion, sometimes called the ‘Knowledge Account of Assertion’, which says that

(KNA) One must: assert that p only if one knows that p

KNA can be thought of “as giving the condition on which a speaker has the authority to make an assertion. Thus asserting p without knowing p is doing something without having the authority to do it, like giving someone a command without having the authority to do so” (2000: 257). Williamson thinks of KNA as constitutive of the speech act of assertion, conceived of by analogy with the rules of a game: just as the rules of chess are essential to it in that they constitute what the game is and what it is to play chess, so Williamson thinks of the speech act of assertion as constituted by its relation to KNA. In this sense, mastering the speech act of assertion involves implicitly grasping this norm and the practice which it governs (2000: 241); indeed, the speech act plausibly functions to express one’s knowledge (Turri 2011). If this is correct, KNA would explain RK, a descriptive fact about what speakers who assert represent about themselves: for it is in virtue of engaging in a practice whose norm we all implicitly grasp that one would represent oneself as conforming to that norm. (For helpful discussion of Williamson’s approach to constitutivity, see Turri 2014a; for an account on which the KNA is derived from a more fundamental norm of intellectual flourishing, see Brogaard 2014.)

Williamson notes that in addition to the “How do you know?” question which can be used to implicitly challenge one’s authority to assert, the stronger challenge question “Do you know that?” explicitly challenges one’s authority, and the dismissal “You don’t know that!” rejects one’s authority. KNA explains this range of aggressiveness (Williamson 2000: 253; 2009: 344). Turri (2010) further points out that there is an asymmetry between the acceptability of certain kinds of prompts to assertion:

(5) Do you know whether p?

(6) Is p?

are typically interchangeable as prompts to an assertion, and the flat-out assertion “p” serves to answer each equally well; but certain stronger questions, such as “Are you certain that p?” typically cannot be used, as can (5) and (6), as an initial prompt for assertion, whereas weaker prompts such as “Do you think that p?” or “Do you have any idea whether p?” seem to request something weaker than a flat-out assertion (perhaps a hedged assertion or a prediction), are thereby not interchangeable with (5) and (6). Related to this data is that a standard response when one feels not well-positioned to assert, in reply to a prompt like (6), is to answer “I don’t know.” The appropriateness of the “I don’t know” response is telling given that the query was about p, not about whether one knows that p. Thus KNA seems confirmed by these data.

In addition to prompts and challenges, and our responses to them, there is data from lottery assertions (Williamson 2000: 246-252, Hawthorne 2004: 21-23). Many people find it somehow inappropriate for people to flat-out assert of a particular lottery ticket (before the draw has been announced) that it will lose, even though given a large enough lottery its losing is overwhelmingly probable. Many also find it plausible that one does not know that such a ticket will lose. KNA proponents aim to explain the first point in terms of the second: the reason it is inappropriate for one to make such lottery assertions, absent special knowledge about the lottery being rigged, is that one does not know that the ticket will lose.

Benton (2011) and Blaauw (2012) also point to peculiar facts about the parenthetical positioning of “I know” in assertive sentences, which seem well-explained by KNA. Notice that “I believe” (or “I think,” or “probably”) can occur in assertive constructions to hedge one’s assertion, and syntactically they can occur in prefaced or utterance-initial position (7), parenthetical position (8), or utterance-final parenthetical position (9), with each sounding as good as the other:

(7) I believe that John is in his office.

(8) John is, I believe, in his office.

(9) John is in his office, I believe.

Yet with “I know,” (10) sounds perfectly in order, but (11) and (12), while coherent, can seem oddly redundant:

(10) I know that John is in his office.

(11) ? John is, I know, in his office.

(12) ? John is in his office, I know.

KNA is able to explain why: if flat-out assertions express one’s knowledge, or represent one as knowing, it will be expressively redundant to add to it that one knows (where (10) is not redundant because it seems to be the amplified claim that: one knows that John’s in his office). However this explanatory argument from KNA of such data has been critiqued as incomplete or inadequate (see McKinnon & Turri 2013, McGlynn 2014).

Finally, knowledge seems to be connected to assertion in parallel with its connection to showing someone how to do something: in the same way that knowing that p seems to be required for permissibly asserting that p, knowing how to X seems to be required for permissibly showing someone how to X. In this sense, knowing is the pedagogical norm of showing, for structurally parallel considerations to the linguistic data discussed above (Moorean conjunctions, challenges, prompts, etc.) is available for pedagogical contexts (Buckwalter & Turri 2014).

In short, KNA claims to offer the best explanation of these data from Moorean conjunctions, challenges, prompts, responses to prompts, lottery assertions, parenthetical positioning, and pedagogical norms.

c. Rivals and Objections

Though KNA has been widely defended, its opponents offer substantial criticism and suggest rival accounts requiring other epistemic or alethic conditions: most rival norms of assertion appeal to justified or reasonable or well-supported belief, or that it be reasonable or credible for one to believe, or that one’s assertion be true.

Williamson (2000: 244-249) considered a Truth Norm to be the most significant rival to KNA. Because knowledge is factive, the KNA requires its assertions to be true; but according to the Truth Norm, one must assert that p only if p is true (a further norm requiring evidence for p would be derivable from the requirement of truth), and thus is less demanding than the KNA. Weiner (2005) argues for a Truth Norm by noting that cases of prediction and retrodiction seem to be counterexamples to KNA, that is, they are assertions which seem intuitively acceptable even though the propositions affirmed are not known. Weiner further argues that the Truth Norm can rely on Gricean pragmatic resources to explain the data from lotteries and Moorean conjunctions, for the Truth Norm on its own does not predict the inappropriateness of such assertions. While Weiner (2005) and Whiting (2013) argue for truth as necessary and sufficient for the epistemic propriety of assertion, Littlejohn (2012) and Turri (2013b) argue (compatibly with the KNA) that truth is necessary for epistemically proper assertion; Littlejohn’s defense of factivity focuses on the requirement that assertions about what a subject ought to do would have to satisfy the truth requirement to be properly asserted, whereas Turri’s draws on experimental investigation of people’s judgments of false assertions. For criticisms of Weiner’s Truth Norm, see Pelling (2011) and Benton (2012). A related norm is that proposed by Maitra and Weatherson (2010): they argue that a certain class of statements, namely those concerned with what is “the thing for one to do,” form an important exception to the KNA. Their rival norm, the Action Rule, says “Assert that p only if acting as if p is true is the thing for you to do” (2010: 114). They argue that their Action Rule collapses into the Truth Norm for propositions concerning what one should do (“if an agent should do X, then that agent is in a position to say that they should do X,” 2010: 100), though it does not do so for other propositions.

Douven (2006) argues for a Rational Credibility Norm, and Lackey (2007) argues for a Reasonable-to-Believe Norm; for related norms, see also McKinnon’s (2013) Supportive Reasons Norm. These views roughly hold that to be epistemically acceptable, an assertion that p need not be known, but must be credible or reasonable for the speaker to believe, even if it is not actually believed by the speaker. Douven’s approach argues that his norm is as adequate as the KNA in explaining most of the linguistic data canvassed above, but that his Rational Credibility norm is a priori simpler than, and so preferable to, the KNA (cf. Douven 2009 which updates some of his arguments). Lackey’s influential discussion argues for this view by suggesting that cases of selfless assertion are intuitively acceptable. Selfless assertions involve cases in which an asserter possesses knowledge-worthy evidence, appreciates the strength of that evidence, yet for non-epistemic reasons fails to believe that p (and asserts that p anyway). Thus on Lackey’s particular account, the speaker need not even believe what is asserted (for criticism of Lackey’s view, see Turri 2014b). Because these norms sanction lottery assertions and Moorean assertions, Douven and Lackey both attempt to explain away the impropriety attending to such assertions.

Kvanvig (2009, 2011a) argues for a Justified Belief Norm; somewhat related is Neta’s (2009) Justified-Belief-that-One-Knows Norm. These norms require, for permissible assertion, a justified belief of some kind, either that the asserter justifiably believe what is asserted, perhaps even knowledge-level justification; or that the asserter hold the higher order justified belief that she knows what she’s asserted (the latter of which will, on many views, itself require that she justifiably believe the asserted proposition). These norms do not actually require an assertion to be true, and thus their proponents have to explain the apparent defect in a false assertion, even if one is largely absolved from blame given that that one was justified in believing what was asserted (for discussion see Williamson 2009: 345). Similarly, Coffman (2014) argues for a Would-Be Knowledge Norm, which is stronger than a justified belief norm in that it requires not only knowledge-level justification, but also that the belief not be Gettiered. This norm also, however, does not require truth, for one might have a false belief which (given one’s knowledge-level justification) would be knowledge if only it were true.

Another rival approach is a context-sensitive norm of assertion which accepts that an epistemic norm governs assertion, but claims that its content can vary according to context. There are different ways of formulating such an account. On Gerken’s (2012) view, the epistemic norm of a central type of assertion is an internalist norm of “Discursive Justification,” according to which an asserter must be able to articulate reasons for her belief in the proposition asserted. This approach is context-sensitive in that what counts as adequate reason-giving will vary according to context (for other norms of assertion that impose primarily ‘down stream’ requirements on the speaker, see also Rescorla 2009 and MacFarlane 2009: 90ff.).

Goldberg (2009, 2011) initially applied the KNA to issues in the epistemology of testimony. More recently, Goldberg (2015) formulates and defends a context-sensitive norm on which knowledge is often required for permissible assertion—perhaps knowledge is even the default value—but in other contexts justification or reasonable belief might be enough, and in still other contexts, perhaps something even stronger than knowledge is required (certainty, perhaps). Goldberg draws on Grice’s (1989) maxim of quality, according to which assertions are governed by the first supermaxim and its two submaxims:

Quality: Try to make your contribution one that is true.

Do not say that which you believe to be false.
Do not say that for which you lack adequate evidence. (1989, 27)

Grice’s quality maxim, invoking as it does the notion of ‘adequate’ evidence, would seem to be just such a context-sensitive norm (though see Benton 2014a, for reasons to doubt this). Goldberg’s hypothesis is that there is Mutually-Manifest Epistemic Norm of Assertion (MMENA), which is comprised of a norm (ENA), and the context-sensitive mechanism (RMBS) which fixes the epistemic condition required by ENA:

ENA S must: assert p, only if S satisfies epistemic condition E with respect to p, i.e., only if S has the relevant warranting authority regarding p.

RMBS When it comes to a particular assertion that p, the relevant warranting authority regarding p depends in part on what it would be reasonable for all parties to believe is mutually believed among them (regarding such things as the participants’ interests and informational needs, and the prospects for high-quality information in the domain in question) (Goldberg, 2015, Chap. 12)

McKinnon’s (2013) Supportive Reasons Norm is designed to be similarly context-sensitive, and on a natural reading, Lackey’s Reasonable-to-Believe Norm can be understood this way as well; Stone (2007: 100-101) also prefers, but does not develop, a kind of context-sensitive norm opposed to the KNA. Such rival norms have the intuitive benefit of explaining a great range of conversational contexts in which we seem to assert acceptably; however with this flexibility comes the burden of having to provide plausible explanations of the data, considered in sections I.A and I.B above, which invoke knowledge.

Note however that opting for a context-sensitive norm need not mean that one eschews the KNA. DeRose (2002; 2009 Chap. 3) accepts a version of KNA, but regards “know(s)” as semantically context-sensitive. Thus the standard for the truth of “knowledge” ascriptions at a context sets the standard for permissible assertion: for a given speaker S in a conversational context C, the truth conditions for “S knows that p” at C are the assertibility conditions for S to assert that p in C. On this view, knowledge remains the norm of assertion. Relatedly, Schaffer (2008) argues for a contextualist version of KNA which he claims supports contrastivism about knowledge.

Many of the rival norms to KNA are motivated in part by the idea that KNA is just too strong an epistemic requirement on assertion: many KNA opponents find it implausible to think that one has done anything wrong by asserting what one doesn’t know, so long as one’s assertion, or one’s decision to assert p, is supported in the relevant way by adequate evidence or reasons for p (see McGlynn 2014 for a thorough discussion). Some of these objections to KNA come from appeals to intuitions about cases, in particular, cases in which one asserts with strong grounds or evidence, but one is in a Gettier situation, or what one asserts is unluckily false. In general, such cases appeal to what are judged to be blameless assertion (for concerns about relying on such judgments of blame, see Turri & Blouw 2014). Some proponents of KNA respond that in such cases one asserts reasonably if one reasonably took oneself to know, even though on KNA, one still asserts impermissibly: its being reasonable is what excuses one for having violated the norm, and the plausibility of calling it an ‘excuse’ suggests that a norm was violated (Williamson 2000: 256; DeRose 2009: 93-95, Sutton 2007: 80, Hawthorne & Stanley 2008: 573, 586); but this excuse maneuver has been heavily criticized for multiplying senses of propriety or for being too general (Lackey 2007, Gerken 2011, Kvanvig 2011a). See also Littlejohn 2012 and 2014 for extensive discussion of the notion of excuse, as related to these norms.

Other opponents of the KNA are particularly motivated to preserve the acceptability of our assertive practices within special contexts which are nevertheless familiar and ones in which it seems that we do assert, such as the philosophy seminar room (see Goldberg, 2015). Still others rely on intuitions about cases and a desire to give a normative role to the hearer of an assertion (see Pelling’s 2013b “knowledge provision” account). Some express skepticism at the very idea of there being a constitutive epistemic norm of assertion in Williamson’s sense, preferring instead the idea that more general norms of cooperation and rationality (perhaps those given by Grice) will suffice to explain any normativity in our practice of saying and asserting (e.g. Cappelen 2011; see Benton, 2014a, and Montgomery 2014 for discussion). Maitra (2011) in particular presents a challenge to Williamson’s way of formulating the notion of constitutive rules on analogy with the rules of a game. Yet the general idea that a constitutive epistemic norm can individuate speech acts has been deployed for other speech acts on the assertive spectrum: Turri (2013) thereby individuates the stronger speech act of guaranteeing, and Benton & Turri (2014) individuate the speech act of prediction.

The final rival to the KNA considered here is a Certainty Norm (Stanley 2008), on which to assert that p one must be (subjectively) certain that p. This norm is motivated in part by the idea that the Moorean conjunction schemas

(13) p but I’m not certain that p

(14) p but it is not certain that p

strike many to be just as problematic as the knowledge and belief conjunctions (1)-(4) considered above; a Certainty Norm could explain them, and if certainty is required for knowledge, it could also explain (1)-(4). However, the Certainty Norm inherits the ‘too strong’ objection with which many charge KNA, and as noted above, certainty does not figure in both prompts and challenges to assertions (Turri 2010). Also, it is unclear how the Certainty Norm will handle the truth desideratum insofar as conversational participants generally seem to care about truth, and not just a speaker’s confidence, in assertion.

d. Sufficiency

Even if KNA can seem to impose an overly demanding condition on the propriety of assertion, on first pass it might seem that knowledge at least provides a sufficient condition on epistemically permissible assertion. After all, this idea goes, even if some epistemic/alethic standard weaker than knowledge is necessary for permissible assertion, nevertheless surely having knowledge is sufficient. Most of the rivals to KNA ought to agree that when one knows, one thereby arguably meets the less stringent standards of: truth, it being reasonable/credible to believe, being justified in believing, and (if the contextually set standards for certainty do not easily come apart from those of knowledge) being certain enough to assert. Thus some of KNA’s defenders (cf. Hawthorne 2004: 23 n. 58, and 87; DeRose 2009: 93), and many of its opponents, could be tempted to endorse a sufficiency direction of the knowledge norm, such as the following:

(KNA-S) One is properly epistemically positioned to assert that p if one knows that p.

(As shall be seen below in section 2.c, similar sufficiency principles, tying knowledge to action, undergird pragmatic encroachment views of knowledge.)

But Lackey (2011, 2013) has argued that in fact, KNA-S is false (compare Pelling 2013a for another argument). She appeals to cases of what she calls isolated second-hand knowledge to show that in some settings, particularly those involving experts, asserting even though one knows is epistemically deficient. Consider a case in which an oncologist has referred her patient for lab tests, which arrive back on her day off. She must meet with the patient to provide the diagnosis, if any, and is only able to confer briefly with the oncologist from the lab about what the diagnosis is (that he has pancreatic cancer). The doctor can learn from her colleague’s testimony that her patient has pancreatic cancer, but this knowledge is isolated (she knows no other facts about the test results or the diagnosis), and entirely second-hand (via testimony with the lab oncologist). Given her epistemic situation, Lackey argues, it is intuitively (epistemically) impermissible for the doctor to assert to her patient that he has pancreatic cancer, even though she knows this. More generally, for experts asserting as experts, it seems that asserting with merely isolated second-hand knowledge is (epistemically) improper, because experts ought to engage their expertise first-hand, or ought to have more than isolated knowledge gained entirely through expert testimony. Thus Lackey argues that KNA-S is false. (See Carter & Gordon 2011 for an appeal to the idea that understanding is needed. For a challenge to Lackey’s cases, see Benton 2014b; for her reply, see Lackey 2014.)

2. Knowledge Norm of Action

Knowledge seems intimately connected to our reasons for, and our evaluations of, action. Recently many philosophers have endorsed normative connections between knowledge and action, and have deployed principles according to which knowledge is either necessary, sufficient, or both necessary and sufficient for appropriate action. Some of these discussions are focused on action as the result of practical reasoning, or on the connection between knowledge and reasons, or on knowledge as a sufficient epistemic position for acting on a proposition. We will consider these in turn.

a. Knowledge and Practical Reasoning

Some philosophers have noticed intuitive connections between knowledge, assertion, and practical reasoning (see Fantl & McGrath 2002; Hawthorne 2004, esp. 21-32, and Ch. 4; Stanley 2005; and Hawthorne & Stanley 2008). Many thus argue that knowledge plays an important normative role in practical reasoning: when one faces a decision over whether to act that depends on the truth of some proposition, then acting without knowing that proposition can seem epistemically suspect and deserving of criticism. We often invoke knowledge when justifying someone’s decision to act, and we often cite their lack of knowledge when censuring others for acting on inadequate grounds; knowledge figures in our appraisals of blame, negligence, and in conditional orders wherein one is commanded to X just in case one knows a specified condition to obtain.

These facts support the idea that one ought only to use known propositions as premises in one’s practical deliberations. For example, if you opt against purchasing very affordable health insurance, on the grounds that you are plenty healthy, you may be criticized by your loved ones precisely because you do not know that you will not soon fall gravely ill. To take another example: suppose that you spent a dollar on a lottery ticket in a 10,000 ticket lottery with a $5,000 prize, and you are deliberating about whether to sell your ticket. Suppose you reason as follows:

The ticket is a loser.

So if I keep the ticket, I will get nothing.

But if I sell the ticket, I will get a penny.

So I should sell the ticket. (Hawthorne 2004: 29, 85)

Such reasoning should strike us as unacceptable and a plausible reason for why is that the first premise isn’t known. Similarly, suppose that someone offered to sell you their ticket in the same lottery for a cent: if you decline on the basis that you know their ticket will lose, that may also strike us as the wrong basis for declining, for it seems (to many) that you don’t know the ticket will lose. Indeed, if you do know the first premise, standard decision theory validates the reasoning; this suggests that only one’s beliefs which amount to knowledge should figure in to shaping one’s decision table (cf. Weatherson 2012).

These kinds of considerations suggest the following necessary direction norm, Action-Knowledge Principle (AKP), which gives a necessary condition on appropriately treating a proposition as a reason for acting:

(AKP) Treat the proposition that p as a reason for acting only if you know that p (Hawthorne & Stanley 2008: 578)

AKP plausibly lies behind our epistemic evaluations of actions, and also provides a nice diagnosis of some comparative intuitions about low stakes vs. high stakes cases (e.g. Stanley 2005, 9-10).

A parallel debate concerns the idea that there is a common epistemic norm—say, knowledge, or perhaps epistemic ‘warrant,’ or justification—which provides a necessary condition on both appropriate assertion in particular and appropriate action/practical reasoning more generally: see Brown 2011 and 2012, Montminy 2013, Gerken 2013. As we will see in the next section, a structurally similar question concerns whether a common epistemic norm governs practical reason as well as theoretical reason (that is, on what one can appropriately take as a reason for believing).

Some important criticisms of AKP are the following. First, as with the KNA above, it doesn’t license acting on p when one holds a justified belief that p; indeed, one might be Gettiered with respect to p (see Brown 2008, Neta 2009). Acting on p in such cases seems to many to be entirely appropriate, and thus these are counterexamples to AKP. As with the KNA, the reply (Hawthorne & Stanley 2008: 573-74, 586) is that such subjects are blameless for making an excusable mistake, and the need for an excuse is explained by AKP.

Second, it has been objected that AKP doesn’t license acting on subjective probabilities of a proposition, and thus that it can seem in conflict with Bayesian decision theory. Sometimes one is only in a position to treat propositions that are probable for one as reasons for acting; Cresto (2010) argues that when probabilistic talk is interpreted in subjectivist terms, AKP can be violated even though it seems as though one has done nothing wrong. On standard Bayesian decision theory, one plugs one’s probabilities, along with one’s values for possible outcomes, into one’s decision table to discern the act which maximizes expected utility. If you assign 0.7 probability to (have 0.7 credence in) the proposition that it will rain, and on that basis choose to carry an umbrella on your walk, have you violated AKP? Perhaps not, for if you know that you assign 0.7 probability to it raining, and use this knowledge as your reason for acting, then you do not violate AKP: the proposition that you treat as your reason for so acting is that rain is 0.7 probable (Hawthorne & Stanley 2008: 580-583). Arguably, one’s credences are not always luminous to one, and thus there is still a role for knowledge (and thus AKP) to play. Weatherson (2012) argues that the role for knowledge in decision theory is that it sets the standard for what gets on to one’s decision table; moreover, it might be that one’s credences can constitute knowledge (Moss 2013), and if so there is room for AKP to govern actions based on them. But still, it might be implausible to suppose that every such case of appropriately acting on a probability involves your knowing what your credence is: though your credence in it may be 0.7 on this occasion, this may not be transparent to you. It may be sufficient for you to act on the more coarse-grained probability that it’s more likely than not that it will rain, even if you do not form the belief that it is more likely than not that will rain. On this way of looking at things, the objection remains. For important constructive work adjudicating these issues and proposing some ways in which a knowledge norm for practical reasoning and Bayesian decision theory are compatible, see Weisberg (2013).

b. Knowledge and Reasons

We standardly cite reasons as propositions which ought to make a difference to someone’s decision to act one way or another. Such normative reasons are reasons there are for a particular agent to believe, feel, or act a certain way. (Such reasons are distinguishable from both explanatory reasons—reasons why an agent believed or felt or acted—and from motivating reasons—reasons for which an agent acted in a particular way.) Normative reasons can be either possessed by an agent or not possessed by an agent: if Iris is at the bar and there is petrol in the glass in front of her, then there is a reason for her not to drink the liquid in her glass, but it will not be a reason Iris possesses unless she is aware that there is petrol in the glass.

A natural way to approach the connection between knowledge and action is by noting that possessing a reason for some action arguably depends on knowing a proposition, and that lacking knowledge can rob one of possessing the relevant reason (see Hyman 1999, Unger 1975, Ch. 5, Alvarez 2010, and Littlejohn 2014). If Iris knows that there is petrol in the glass, then that is a reason she possesses to refrain from drinking it; but if she does not know it, then she does not possess that reason to refrain, even though there is a reason for her to refrain. There being petrol in the glass can only be a reason Iris possesses if she knows it.

This view connects naturally with the above discussion of the normative relation between knowledge and action: where one treats a proposition as one’s reason for action, and then acts for that reason, one only acts properly when one knows that proposition. This is because, on the view being considered, one cannot possess p as a reason to ϕ unless one knows that p. Of course, one’s motivating reason for ϕ-ing might be a falsehood: one might falsely believe that q and thereby take q as one’s reason for ϕ-ing, and one’s belief that q explains why one ϕ’d. On the view being considered then, one cannot in that circumstance have had q as a reason, for one cannot (because q is false) know that q. That is, the reasons one takes to be one’s reasons can come apart from the reasons one in fact possesses. If this is correct, it has consequences for how to understand the normative concept of justification. In particular, knowledge figures importantly in understanding what reasons justify one in believing or in acting, such that the mark of justification is not an internalist or subjectivist notion of rationality but instead an externalist or objectivist notion explicable in terms of facts or knowledge of facts. See Littlejohn (2014) for more.

Some philosophers question the claim, crucial to the above line of reasoning, that one can possess p as a reason, or properly treat p as a reason for acting, only if p is true (and known). Comesaña and McGrath (2014) call this “factualism about reasons-had,” and against it they argue that one can have false reasons (see also Schroeder 2008, Fantl & McGrath 2009: 100-104, and Dancy 2014, among others). The case for the possibility of having false reasons is built primarily upon two ideas. First, it seems to them that ascribing a reason to someone for their action can be done even if that reason is (or entails) a false proposition. That is, they claim that one could acceptably say of someone that “The reason she turned down the job was that she had another job offer,” even if she did not have another job offer and the speaker knows this. Second, when someone acts on a mistaken belief, there is pressure to claim that she acted for the same reason as she would’ve had her belief in fact been true. On this way of looking at things, there must be the same psychological state that rationalizes Iris’s taking and drinking from the glass with petrol in it as would (counterfactually) rationalize Iris’s taking and drinking from a glass with gin and tonic in it; in other words, such views take what it is that rationalizes to be what it is that provides ones with reasons, both motivating and normative: one has the same normative reasons in both the good and bad cases. Such views are at odds with the standard semantics about schemas such as “S’s reason for X-ing was/is that p” or “The reason S had for X-ing was that p”, which entail that p and so are factive; see Comesaña and McGrath (2014) for ways of handling these semantic issues.

As noted in the last section, there is a parallel question about whether the epistemic norm governing practical reason is the same as that governing theoretical reason. Hawthorne & Stanley’s AKP is a knowledge norm on practical reason, but they also note the analogous principle regarding reasons for belief:

(TKP) Treat the proposition that p as a reason for believing q only if one knows that p. (2008, 577)

Littlejohn (2014) notes a compelling argument that AKP is true just in case TKP, and that more generally, whatever epistemic status norms practical reason must also norm theoretical reason. The argument for it goes thus. Suppose (for reductio) that in fact, the norm for theoretical reason were less epistemically demanding than that for practical reason: for concreteness, suppose that one could treat p as a reason for believing that q only if one were justified in believing that p, but that knowledge still governed practical reason along the lines suggested by AKP. In that case, if you justifiably believe that this liquid is gin, and you knew that you ought (if you can) to make another round of drinks for your guests, you could take your justified belief that it is gin as your reason for believing that: you can make them another round of drinks. But AKP says that you may treat that latter proposition (that you can make them another round of drinks) as a reason only if you know it; and let’s suppose you don’t know it, because in fact it’s not gin but petrol. In this situation, though it’s proper for you to treat your justified belief as a reason to form another belief, AKP says that you cannot properly treat this new belief as a reason for acting, namely making another round of drinks. If the epistemic norms diverged in this way, they would “demand that you were akratic,” and this seems absurd (Littlejohn 2014: 135-136). Things go similarly if the divergence goes the other way, namely if the norm of theoretical reason were more demanding than the norm of action: together these would permit situations in which one can act on a proposition (say, because one justifiably believes it), but not use it as a premise from which to deduce, and form beliefs in, other propositions. Thus there is a case for the unity thesis that a single epistemic status governs both practical and theoretical reasoning, even if it is not knowledge; for arguments that it is something weaker than knowledge, like justification or warrant, see Gerken (2011).

c. Sufficiency and Pragmatic Encroachment

Though Fantl & McGrath question the necessary direction principles AKP, they and others do endorse and defend sufficiency direction principles on which knowledge of a proposition is sufficient to rationalize acting on that proposition. Hawthorne & Stanley (2008, 578) defend a biconditional principle which adds to AKP a sufficiency direction, given a choice one faces which depends on a particular proposition. Where a choice between options X1… Xn is “p-dependent” just in case the most preferable of X1… Xn conditional on the proposition that p is not the same as the most preferable of X1… Xn conditional on the proposition that not-p, the Reason-Knowledge Principle (RKP) says:

(RKP) Where one’s choice is p-dependent, it is appropriate to treat the proposition that p as a reason for acting just in case one knows that p.

RKP gives necessary and sufficient conditions for appropriately treating a proposition as a reason for acting. Similarly Fantl & McGrath (2002, 2009, 2012) defend at length a variety of sufficiency conditions tying knowledge to action:

(Action) If you know that p, then if the question of whether p is relevant to the question of what to do, it is proper for you to act on p.

(Preference) If you know that p, then you are rational to prefer as if p.

(Inquiry) If you know that p, then you are proper not to inquire further into whether p.

(KJ) If you know that p, then p is warranted enough to justify you in ϕ-ing, for any ϕ.

On the face of them, these principles can seem exactly right: for example, it might seem obvious that if one knows a proposition, then one is in good enough position to act upon it. But these principles admit of modus tollens as well: if it is not proper for one to act on p, or rational to prefer as if p, or proper to close off inquiry regarding p, or where p is not warranted to enough for one to act, for any action one considers undertaking, then one does not know that p. These principles bear out the intuitive judgments of many about such cases: to the extent that one’s epistemic position in some p seems inadequate when facing a decision that depends on that p, to that same extent we tend to be inclined to deny that one knows that p. That is, in cases where the practical stakes for one make it irrational for one to act on a proposition, such principles entail that one does not know that proposition (even though in other contexts where one faces no such decision, where one has the same evidence or is in the same “epistemic” position, one might know that proposition). Thus such views endorse “pragmatic encroachment” in epistemology (also known as “subject-sensitive invariantism” in Hawthorne 2004: Ch. 4, Brown 2008, and DeRose 2009), for practical considerations can seem to encroach on whether one knows. See Neta 2009 and Kvanvig 2011b for some criticisms, and Fantl & McGrath 2012 for arguments that pragmatic encroachment isn’t only about knowledge.

3. Knowledge Norm of Belief

a. The Belief-Assertion Parallel

Some philosophers (going back to at least Frege, Peirce, and Ramsey) find plausible the idea that belief or judgment amount to a kind of “inner assertion” where (full) belief is the inner analogue to outward (flat-out) assertion. For those inclined to this view who also accept the Knowledge Norm of Assertion, there is a motivation to accept a parallel Knowledge Norm of Belief. Williamson gestures at this idea thus:

It is plausible, nevertheless, that occurrently believing p stands to asserting p as the inner stands to the outer. If so, the knowledge rule for assertion corresponds to the norm that one should believe p only if one knows p. Given that norm, it is not reasonable to believe p when one knows that one does not know p. (2000, 255-56)

Adler (2002: 276ff.) calls this idea the “Belief-Assertion Parallel,” and offers a range of considerations suggesting that belief and assertion are on a par in this way.

Note however, that this Parallel is likewise intuitive should one prefer some kind of evidential or justification norm, rather than a knowledge norm, on both assertion and on belief. If, epistemically speaking, one shouldn’t assert to others that p without some sufficient evidence or justification for p, then one shouldn’t (epistemically speaking) believe that p without some similar sufficient evidence or justification for p; and in reverse, if (epistemically speaking) one shouldn’t believe that p without some sufficient evidence or justification for p, then one shouldn’t (epistemically speaking) assert to others that p without some similar sufficient evidence or justification for p. Thus to the extent that one finds the epistemic standard for assertion to be similar, if not identical, to the epistemic standard for belief, to that extent the Belief-Assertion Parallel will seem intuitive. Only if one takes the standard for one to be higher than the standard for the other will one be motivated to reject the Belief-Assertion Parallel. (For in-depth discussion, see Goldberg 2015, Chs. 6 and 7.)

Though Williamson does not formulate it explicitly, taking a cue from his KNA schema would provide us with a similar formulation for a Knowledge Norm of Belief, which gives a necessary condition for the propriety of belief:

(KNB) One must: believe p only if one knows p.

(Compare Sutton 2005, 2007; for clarification of how best to understand a norm like KNB, see Jackson 2012.) In addition to the inner/outer parallel noted above, Williamson also provides a different consideration in favor of KNB, one that invokes teleological considerations concerning the “aim” of belief:

If believing p is, roughly, treating p as if one knew p, then knowing is in that sense central to believing. Knowledge sets the standard of appropriateness for belief. That does not imply that all cases of knowing are paradigmatic cases of believing, for one might know p while in a sense treating p as if one did not know p—that is, while treating p in ways untypical of those in which subjects treat what they know. Nevertheless, as a crude generalization, the further one is from knowing p, the less appropriate it is to believe p. Knowing is in that sense the best kind of believing. Mere believing is a kind of botched knowing. In short, belief aims at knowledge (not just truth). (Williamson 2000, 47)

Notice that the KNB provides an elegant and unified account of Moore’s Paradox at the level of belief, a desideratum of many approaches to theorizing about Moore’s Paradox (e.g. Sorenson 1988): these authors note that while the sentences (1)-(4), uttered assertively, are absurd, it also seems absurd to believe (the propositions of) any of their conjuncts together. Huemer (2007) argues explicitly for the idea that theorizing about Moorean conjunctions in this way should lead us to accept both KNA and KNB.

Sosa (2010/2011, Chap. 3: 41-53) provides an interesting argument for another version of the Belief-Assertion Parallel, which arrives at norms similar to KNA and KNB, but he does so by explicit appeal to teleological considerations about the aim of belief. Sosa argues for what he calls the Affirmative Conception of Belief (2011: 41; cf. Sosa 2014):

Consider a concept of affirming that p, defined as: concerning the proposition that p, either (a) asserting it publicly, or (b) assenting to it privately.

With this Affirmative Conception in hand, he then applies considerations from the propriety of means-end action in general to the action of assertion as a special case, using the terminology of his virtue-theoretic epistemology (cf. Sosa 2007):

If one asserts that p as means thereby to assert that p with truth, this essentially involves the relevant means-end belief. I mean the belief that asserting that p is a means to thereby assert that p with truth. And this belief is equivalent to the belief that p. Accordingly, if that means-end belief needs to amount to knowledge in order for the means-end action to be apt, then in order for a sincere assertion that p to be apt, the agent must know that p. In this way, knowledge is a norm of assertion. If an assertion (in one’s own person) that p is not to fall short epistemically it must be sincere, and a sincere assertion that p will be apt only if the subject knows that p. This is, moreover, not just a norm in the sense that the subject does better in his assertion that p provided he knows that p. Rather, if his assertion is not apt, it then fails to meet minimum standards of performance normativity. Any performance (with an aim) that is inapt is thereby flawed. … Knowledge is said to be necessary for proper assertion … If knowledge is the norm of assertion, it is plausibly also the norm of affirmation, whether the affirming be private or public. (2011: 48)

Sosa goes on to develop an intriguing argument for the “equivalence” of the knowledge norm of assertion and the value-of-knowledge thesis (2011: 49-52). For a related view tying the norms of belief and assertion to a virtue-theoretic account, see Wright (2014).

Instructive here is Bach’s combination of views (Bach & Harnisch 1979, Bach 2008). Bach holds a Belief Norm of Assertion, on which the only norm fundamental to assertion is that assertions must be sincere (one must outright believe what one flat-out asserts), but he also holds a Knowledge Norm of Belief much like KNB (2008: 77). Because Bach accepts the KNB, he gets a derived version of the KNA: for one must believe only what one knows, but given his Belief Norm of Assertion, one must assert only what one believes; thus one must assert only what one knows, if one is believing as one ought. This combination of views is one which accepts KNB, accepts (the derivative) KNA, but which denies the Belief-Assertion Parallel at the level of what norms are constitutive of assertion and of belief.

An objection to the KNB, similar in spirit to objections to KNA considered above, is that many find it implausible to hold that one is doing epistemically poorly, or doing anything epistemically impermissible, by believing many propositions which we nevertheless do not know, and which we furthermore properly take ourselves not to know. For some important criticisms of KNB, stemming from arguments that there is nothing epistemically problematic or improper about lottery propositions, see McGlynn (2013, 2014). Relatedly, while most find it incoherent or irrational to believe the Moorean conjunction form (1) considered above, many find it unproblematic to believe some conjunctions of the form (2), namely believing a proposition and also believing that one does not know that proposition. Those who object to KNB on these grounds tend to deny a parallel between the epistemic standard for belief and the epistemic standard for knowledge. Couched in evidential terminology, many epistemologists intuitively think of belief in terms of an evidence-threshold model, according to which the evidential threshold which one must meet in order permissibly belief some proposition is lower than the evidential threshold for knowledge: more evidence is required to know than to (permissibly) believe.

b. Knowledge Disagreement Norm

In a spirit related to considerations stemming from endorsement of the KNB, Hawthorne & Srinivasan (2013) argue for a Knowledge Norm of Disagreement. In the growing literature on the epistemology of disagreement, debate ensues over what one should do in the face of disagreement about some proposition, particularly when those disagreeing with one are regarded as one’s intellectual or evidential peers. Typically such cases of peer disagreement are formulated such that you have formed a belief or a judgment on (or assigned a credence to) some proposition p, and have done so on the basis of some evidence: perhaps it is a judgment about which of two horses won a very close race, and the evidence is visual; or perhaps it is a judgment about what you and your friend each owe from calculating your share of a restaurant bill which you are splitting, in which case the evidence is intellectual and inferential. Many philosophers writing on such cases of disagreement are “conciliationists” of one sort or another, that is, they endorse the idea that in some such disagreements, one does something improper or irrational if one does not either suspend judgment on p, or reduce one’s credence in p. Opposed to conciliationists are “dogmatists” who advocate the idea that in face of such disagreements, it is sometimes appropriate or rational for one to hold steadfast or “stick to one’s guns” by retaining one’s belief or one’s credence. (See essays in Feldman & Warfield 2010, and Christensen & Lackey 2013 for more.)

Hawthorne & Srinivasan (2013: 11-12), drawing on a knowledge-centric epistemology which takes knowledge to be the central goal of our epistemic activity, articulate a position which is in some ways a middle ground between these two views. They argue for the following Knowledge Disagreement Norm:

(KDN) In a case of disagreement about whether p, where S believes that p and H believes that not-p:

(i) S ought to trust H and believe that not-p iff were S to trust H, this would result in S’s knowing not-p

(ii) S ought to dismiss H and continue to believe that p iff were S to stick to her guns this would result in S’s knowing p, and

(iii) in all other cases, S ought to suspend judgment about whether p.

KDN’s ‘ought’ clauses are motivated by a ranking of actions according to their counterfactual outcomes: according to KDN’s clause (i), one should be ‘conciliatory’ in the face of disagreement just in case trusting one’s disagreeing interlocutor would result in one gaining knowledge, whereas according to clause (ii), one should be ‘dogmatic’ in the face of disagreement just in case would lead to retaining one’s knowledge. Finally, in cases where neither party knows whether the proposition under dispute is true, each should suspend judgment.

Notice that KDN, formulated in the terminology of knowledge and outright belief, is neutral on the matter of how to respond when the ‘disagreement’ concerns divergences in credences toward a proposition: its clause (iii) is capable of accommodating many different approaches here. Further, KDN is fully general in that it does not hold only for cases of peer disagreement: its clauses (i) and (ii) are designed to capture the appropriateness of occasions in which someone defers to an expert or someone in a better evidential position, and thereby can come to know by trusting them. If it is plausible to suppose that becoming apprised of peer disagreement can defeat one’s knowledge, then such cases may be subsumed to clause (iii) (2013: 13-14, 21ff). Finally, KDN has the merit that, if followed, knowledge will tend to be maximized for all parties to a disagreement: if we disagree, but by trusting you, I can come to know what you believe, I ought to do so.

It may be objected that KDN is not easily followed, precisely because knowledge is a non-luminous condition, that is, one is not always in a position to know when one knows; and this is particularly pressing in the case of disagreement, for it is clear that (at least) one of the disagreeing parties doesn’t know, and it can be utterly unclear to most such disputants which one (if any) knows. This objection, and similar objections that are occasionally pressed against the norms of assertion and practical reasoning covered in earlier sections, seems to assume that norms must be perfectly operationalizable, that is, they must be such that one is always in a position to know whether one is complying with them (Williamson 2008). On this idea, a norm N, which requires that one X in circumstances C, will be perfectly operationalizable just in case S can know she is in C, and is thus in a position to reason that, given that she is in C, and could X by A-ing, and that N says she ought to X in C, that S ought to A. But it is a substantive question whether norms are or must be perfectly operationalizable; and given that many such conditions of epistemological interest are arguably non-luminous (see Williamson 2000: Ch. 4), one might reconsider the worth of that assumption. For more discussion of this issue and how it relates to the hypological categories of praise and blame, see Hawthorne & Srinivasan (2013: 15-21).

4. References and Further Reading

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Author Information

Matthew A. Benton
Email: matthew.benton@philosophy.ox.ac.uk
University of Oxford
United Kingdom

Legal Validity

Legal validity governs the enforceability of law, and the standard of legal validity enhances or restricts the ability of the political ruler to enforce his will through legal coercion. Western law adopts three competing standards of legal validity. Each standard emphasizes a different dimension of law (Berman 1988, p. 779), and each has its own school of jurisprudence.

Legal positivism emphasizes law’s political dimension. Legal positivism recognizes political rulers as the only source of valid law and adopts the will of the political ruler as its validity standard. Leading legal positivists include Jeremy Bentham, John Austin, and H.L.A. Hart.

Natural law theory emphasizes law’s moral dimension. Natural law theory recognizes universal moral principles as the primary source of valid law. These moral principles provide a standard of legal validity that imposes moral limits on the ruler’s coercive powers. Leading natural law theorists include Aristotle, Cicero, Justinian, and Thomas Aquinas.

The historicist school emphasizes law’s historical dimension. The historicist school recognizes legal custom as the primary source of valid law. Legal custom provides a standard of legal validity that imposes customary limits on the political ruler’s coercive powers. Leading historicists include Sir Edward Coke, John Selden, Sir Matthew Hale, and Sir William Blackstone.

Legal positivism recognizes positive law as the only real law and rejects law’s moral and historical dimensions as sources of valid laws. Natural law theory and the historicist school, on the other hand, often integrate law’s three dimensions. They recognize each dimension as a potential source of valid law but emphasize a particular dimension through their validity standard. Blackstone’s unique jurisprudence adopts two validity standards, one from law’s historical dimension, and one from law’s moral dimension.

Standards of legal validity are historically cyclical. A society typically adopts a standard of legal validity based on moral principles, custom, or both. This validity standard restricts the ruler’s ability to enforce his will through legal coercion. Then, intellectual challenges to moral principles and legal custom minimize their esteem. A new validity standard is adopted based on the will of the political ruler. Abuses of coercive powers by political rulers eventually stimulate renewed restrictions on those powers. The society adopts a revived standard of legal validity based on moral principles, custom, or both. The revived validity standard will typically endure until the memory of abuse fades, when the cycle begins again.

This cycle began with Hesiod in 700 B. C. E. and continued into the 21st Century. In common law jurisprudence, judicial acceptance of Hart’s legal positivism eroded Blackstone’s validity standards based on moral principles and custom. In civil law jurisprudence, Soviet and Nazi abuses of positivist legal systems revived validity standards based on moral principles. This essay describes the cycle of legal validity in Western law and proposes a fresh approach to legal validity to break this cycle.

The Sophists
Plato
Aristotle
Cicero
Justinian’s Corpus Juris Civilis
Aquinas
Blackstone
Bentham
Austin
Hart
Radbruch
Positivism in American Jurisprudence
A Fresh Approach
References and Further Reading

1. The Sophists

The first standard of legal validity in the Western legal tradition appears in Hesiod’s religious poem Works and Days, circa 700 B. C. E. Hesiod presents an archetypal jurisprudence that integrates law’s three dimensions. Dikê, the goddess of human justice, personifies law’s moral dimension. Dikê’s father Zeus personifies law’s political dimension. Dikê’s mother Thetis, the Titan embodiment of custom and social order, personifies law’s historical dimension.

Justice “sets the laws straight with righteousness” and distinguishes men from beasts. Divinely decreed moral principles establish the validity standard for human law and customs, and conforming laws and customs establish the nomoi (law). Just men obey the nomoi, and obedience brings peace and prosperity. Disobedience brings punishment to the individual and his city through famine, plague, infertility, and military disaster.

The Sophists, wandering teachers of the fifth century B. C. E., challenged Greek conventions in religion, morality, and political conduct. They rejected Hesiod’s moral dimension by rejecting the existence of divine lawgivers and universal moral principles. They rejected Hesiod’s historical dimension by denying any normative authority to custom. Might was right, and law functioned only in the political dimension as the will of the strongest.

The Sophist Protagoras of Abdera (b. circa 481 B. C. E.), rejected law’s moral dimension. As an agnostic, Protagoras rejected the divine lawgiver. As a moral relativist, Protagoras rejected the existence of universal moral principles. Unlike later Sophists, however, Protagoras accepted the validity of custom in law’s historical dimension.

Protagoras based his moral relativism on the argument that a shared factual knowledge of the world is impossible. The foundation of Protagoras’ relativism is the “man-measure” of the Aletheia (Truth). “Man is the measure of all things, of those that are that they are, of those that are not that they are not.”

Sense perception forms the basis of all knowledge, Protagoras believed, and every sense impression that a person receives is securely true. The data of sense perception, however, are private, subjective states. The wind is truly warm to the man who perceives it as warm, but the same wind is truly cold to the man who perceives it as cold. Perceived objects therefore have contradictory properties and there are no public facts.

Protagoras maintained that all knowledge claims are thus equally true. Furthermore, their truth endures regardless of conflicting claims. Protagoras therefore claimed “it is equally possible to affirm and deny anything of anything.” (Aristotle, Metaphysics, 1007b).

Protagoras extended his doctrine that all knowledge claims are equally true to claim that all virtue claims are equally true. Virtue claims are relative to the claimant because virtue is only another form of knowledge. (Plato, Protagoras, 323a-328d). There are no universal moral principles, and law’s moral dimension does not exist.

Although Protagoras rejected law’s moral dimension, he embraced law’s historical dimension. Although all knowledge and virtue claims are equally true, Protagoras argued they are not all equally sound. Only the ignorant equated truth with soundness. One set of thoughts can therefore be “better than another, but not in any way truer.” The same is true of laws. All laws are equally true, but not all laws are equally sound.

Protagoras accepted a duty to obey the law. Since no moral or legal code is truer than any other, no individual should assert his moral or legal judgments over those advanced by the state. Society is required to preserve humanity. The perpetuation of society, in turn, requires respect for law and custom. Men should obey the state’s laws and customs so long as they function soundly. (Plato, Protagoras, 322d; Theaetetus, 167b).

The Sophist Callicles (b. circa 484 B. C. E.), rejected law’s historical dimension and denied any duty to obey the law. Using “nature” to mean the antithesis of mind, Callicles argued that nature’s normative authority (phusis) supersedes the normative authority of man’s laws and customs (nomoi). Man’s laws and customs violate “nature’s own law” and “natural justice.” Nature’s law, not man’s, should govern our actions.

Callicles said that what men call “right” merely expresses what men believe to be to their advantage. Legal conventions in democracies wrongfully elevate the weak over the strong. The majority of weaker folk frame the laws for their advantage to prevent the stronger from gaining advantage over them. The true nature of right is established by nature, not men, and nature’s law establishes right in the strong. Natural justice provides that the better and wiser man should rule over and have more than the inferior. Might, therefore, makes right. All animals and races of man recognize right as the sovereignty and advantage of the stronger over the weaker. (Plato, Gorgias, 483b-d, 490a).

The Sophist Thrasymachus (b. circa 459 B. C. E.) argued for disobeying laws and customs. Defining justice as obedience to the laws, Thrasymachus argues that justice is nothing but the advantage of the stronger. Obedience furthers the advantage of others and reduces the obedient to a form of slavery. Only disobedience to law profits a man and leads to his advantage. Injustice is therefore “a stronger, freer, and more masterful thing than justice.” (Plato, Republic, 338c-344c).

Solon’s constitution created an archetypal positivist legal system in Athens in 594 B. C. E. Solon reposed political and judicial authority in the heliastic courts. The courts enforced undefined laws with no standard of legal validity other than the unrestrained will of the jurors. Pericles’ introduction of payments for jurors in 451 B. C. E. enthroned Athens’ poorest and least educated class as dikasts in the heliastic courts. The Athenian courts became infamous for injustice and gullibility. Xenophon writes that Athenian courts often acted on emotion to put innocent men to death and acquit wrongdoers. (Xenophon 1990, pp.41-42). Eighty dikasts who found Socrates innocent voted for his death.

Athenian ostracism (ostrakismos) permitted the conviction, exile, and execution of any Athenian without charges, hearing, or defense. Originally intended for removing tyrants, Plutarch records that ostracism quickly became a way of pacifying jealousy of the eminent. Ostracism breathed out malice in exile and death. Every one was liable to it whose reputation, birth, or eloquence rose above the common level. (Plutarch 1914, pp. 2, 230, 233).

Athens ostracized its greatest heroes from envy of their honors. Athens ostracized Aristides, the hero of the Battle of Marathon, in 483 B. C. E. Athens ostracized Themistocles, savior of Athens at the Battle of Salamis, in 471 B. C. E. Both men were exiled for ten years without charges or a hearing.

Lack of procedural safeguards encouraged frivolous public prosecutions (graphai) and impeachments (eisangeliai), giving free reign to Athens’ gullible and imprudent dikasts. Frivolous political prosecutions destroyed Athens’ leadership, spawning bloody regime changes and military disasters. The frivolous prosecution of Pericles in 443 B. C. E. precipitated the Peloponnesian War with Sparta. The frivolous prosecution of Alcibiades in 415 B. C. E. caused Athens’ ablest general to switch sides and lead Sparta against Athens.

The greatest ignominy involves the Arginusae generals in 404 B. C. E. Six Athenian naval commanders won a great naval victory against Sparta at Arginusae. A violent storm prevented their recovering the dead and shipwrecked. The generals were nevertheless impeached and executed for failing to do so. Deprived of her best generals, Athens lost the war the next year in a devastating naval defeat at Aegospotami.

Political prosecutions wreaked political havoc as well. Five regime changes rocked Athens between 411 B. C. E. and 403 B. C. E. These regimes included the reign of terror by the Thirty Tyrants in 404 B. C. E.

Athenian positivism criminalized thought and expression in frivolous prosecutions against philosophers. Anaxagoras circa 430 B. C. E., Protagoras circa 415 B. C. E., and Socrates in 399 B. C. E. were all convicted on manufactured charges of impiety (asebeia). Impiety was undefined by Athenian law. Every juror defined it anew in every case as he pleased.

Athens often regretted its decisions. Socrates’ lead accuser Anytus was stoned for his role in Socrates’ death. Athens honored Socrates with a bronze statue by Lysippus. Athens thus gained “the indelible reproach of decreeing to the same citizens the hemlock on one day and statues on the next.” (Hamilton 2010, p. 289).

2. Plato

Plato described Socrates as the bravest, wisest, and most upright man of his time. Plato planned a career in politics but “withdrew in disgust” after observing how Athenian courts “corrupted the written laws and customs.” (Plato, Letter VII, 325a-c). Plato reacted to Socrates’ death by repudiating the Sophists, reviving law’s moral and historical dimensions, and formulating a natural law standard of legal validity based on principles of universal justice.

Plato begins his revival of law’s historical dimension by emphasizing the autonomy of law, which he considered the most important aspect of government. Autonomous laws wield supremacy over political rulers. Political rulers are subject to the same laws as other citizens, and they may not alter the laws to suit their will.

Plato wrote that the preservation or ruin of a community depends on the autonomy of laws more than anything else. Respecting law’s autonomy preserves the entire community. Disregarding it brings destruction. Autonomy is so important that “the man who is most perfect in obedience to established law” should receive the highest post in government. The second most obedient man should receive the second highest post, and so on for all the posts. (Plato, Laws, 715c-d.)

Plato begins his revival of law’s moral dimension by persuasively refuting Protagoras’ moral relativism in the Theaetetus. Protagoras claimed that all sense perceptions are equally true. Since knowledge is perception, all knowledge claims are equally true. Since moral claims are a species of knowledge claims, all moral claims are equally true. Therefore, no one set of moral principles has authority to guide the laws.

Plato offers eleven objections to Protagoras’ arguments in the Theaetetus. Three are recounted here. First, Plato denies that knowledge is perception. If knowledge were perception, we would understand anyone speaking to us in a foreign tongue. This is clearly not the case. Second, remembered knowledge refutes Protagoras’ claim that knowledge is perception. Remembered knowledge involves no perception, but it is knowledge nonetheless.

Third, moral relativism is self-refuting. Assume, as Protagoras claims, that “all beliefs are true.” Assume also that another man exists who believes that “not all beliefs are true.” If Protagoras is correct, then the second man’s belief must be true. Protagoras’ belief that “all beliefs are true” is thus refuted. (Plato, Theaetetus, 160e-177b).

Plato continues his revival of law’s moral and historical dimensions in the Crito. The Crito considers whether a duty exists to obey the law. Socrates’ friend Crito argues for Socrates to escape and avoid his unjust execution.

Socrates replies that the soul is more precious than the body. Good actions benefit our souls, but wrong actions mutilate them. The important thing is not living, but living well. This means living honorably. Socrates utilizes three principles in determining whether to escape. First, circumstances never justify wrong action. Second, one should not injure others, even when they injure you. Third, one “ought to honor one’s agreements, provided they are right.” (Plato, Crito, 47e-49e).

Plato defines law’s moral dimension through these principles. Justinian’s Corpus Juris Civilis defines its moral dimension by these same principles in the sixth century. (Justinian, Digest, 1.1.10). Blackstone’s Commentaries does the same in the eighteenth century. (Blackstone 1828, p. 27).

Plato next refutes Thrasymachus’ claim in the Republic that disobeying the law “is a stronger, freer, and more masterful thing” than obeying the law. In the Crito’s “Speech of the Laws,” the Laws present two arguments for obedience. The first is the “argument from agreement.” Socrates has undertaken to live his life in obedience to Athens’ laws. Athens did not force Socrates to live in its precincts. Socrates was free to leave at any time. By choosing to stay in Athens with full knowledge of how the laws functioned, Socrates promised obedience to the laws.

The Laws’ orders are “in the form of proposals, not savage commands.” Socrates can either obey the Laws or persuade (the personification of) the Law that they are at fault. If Socrates escapes without persuading the personification of the Laws that they were at fault, he would dishonor his agreement to obey the laws. Dishonoring a just agreement violates the ethic of “living well” and damages the soul.

The Laws’ second argument is the “argument from injury.” Disobedience destroys both the Laws and the city, which cannot exist if legal judgments are ignored. Socrates concludes that “both in war and in the law courts and everywhere else you must do whatever your city and your country command, or else persuade them in accordance with universal justice” that they are at fault.

The Laws’ second argument implies a natural law standard of validity based on principles of universal justice. The Laws insist they operate as “proposals, not savage commands.” Socrates’ duty to obey the Laws is contingent on the Laws’ compliance with principles of universal justice. By implication, there is no duty to obey the Laws if they violate principles of universal justice. (Plato, Crito, 51e-52d).

3. Aristotle

Aristotle designs his legal philosophy to avoid the catastrophes described in his Athenian Constitution. Aristotle accepts the necessity of law’s political dimension because laws cannot enforce themselves. Nevertheless, the Athenian legal history proves the political dimension is not sufficient to preserve a society or achieve its happiness.

Human nature demands more than political power from law. Law must accomplish justice and foster virtue. Justice is required to prevent revolution, and virtue is required for human happiness. Man separated from justice is “the worst of animals,” and man without virtue “is the most unholy and the most savage of animals.” (Aristotle, Politics 1253a).

Aristotle writes in the Politics that securing justice is the state’s most important function. Justice is more essential to the state than providing the necessities of life. Governments must be founded on justice to endure. Governments that rule unjustly and give unequal treatment to similarly placed subjects provoke revolutions. Justice maintained, however, forms a bond between the members of society that preserves the state. (Aristotle, Politics 1328b, 1332b, 1253a).

Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics defines justice as lawfulness concerned with the common advantage and happiness of the political community. Aristotle distinguishes between legal justice (to nomikon dikaion) and natural justice (physikon dikaion). Legal justice involves positive laws and custom enacted by man, such as conventional measures for grain and wine. These “are just not by nature but by human enactment” and “are not everywhere the same.”Aristotle secures legal justice by granting autonomy to law and by utilizing custom to encourage obedience. (Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics, 1134b-1135a).

Natural justice, on the other hand, involves principles of natural law that originate in nature. Such principles do not arise in the minds of men “by people’s thinking this or that.” Natural law principles apply with equal force everywhere, just as fire burns both in Greece and in Persia. Aristotle secures natural justice by adopting natural law precepts as the standard of legal validity. Positive laws that violate natural law precepts are nullified. (Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics, 1134b).

Aristotle secures legal justice by restricting the will of the political ruler through autonomous laws. The Politics teaches that unrestrained power produces tyranny, even in democracies. Aristotle considers whether societies function best under the “rule of men” or the “rule of law.” He concludes that laws, when good, should be supreme. Political rulers should merely complement the law by acting as its guardians and ministers. They should only regulate those matters on which the laws are unable to speak with precision owing to the difficulty of any general principle embracing all particulars. (Aristotle, Politics, 1282b).

Aristotle gives four reasons for emphasizing law’s autonomy over the will of the political ruler. First, law frees the state from the desires and passions that afflict political rulers. “The law is reason unaffected by desire. Desire … is a wild beast, and passion perverts the minds of rulers, even when they are the best of men.” (Aristotle, Politics, 1287a). Second, tyranny results when political rulers exercise autonomy over law, even in democracies. Third, the orderly rotation of political offices requires autonomous laws. Equality, liberty, justice, and expediency mandate that every mature citizen participates in governing the state. Fourth, the orderly rotation of political offices preserves the state by assuring evenhanded administration by magistrates.

Aristotle utilizes law’s historical dimension to secure legal justice through custom. Aristotle uses the term nomos for law, and nomos includes custom and convention as components of the social norm. Aristotle writes in the Politics that legal custom is itself a form of justice. Custom and convention maintain social stability by encouraging obedience to the law. The law has no power to command obedience except that of habit, which can only be given by time. Aristotle urges caution in changing the law because changes enfeeble the power of the law. If the advantage of a change is small, it is wiser to leave errors in the law. The citizens usually lose more by the habit of disobedience than they gain by changing the law. (Aristotle, Politics, 1255a, 1269a).

Aristotle utilizes law’s moral dimension to secure natural justice in two ways. The first is by nullifying positive laws that subvert natural law precepts. Aristotle formulates a natural law standard of legal validity. Aristotle’s Rhetoric describes natural law as an unwritten law, based on nature, and common to all people. “There is in nature a common principle of the just and unjust that all people in some way divine.” (Aristotle, Rhetoric, 1373b).

Natural law provides immutable and universal standards of justice. Natural law constitutes a separate body of binding law that exceeds positive law in authority. Human actions should complete nature rather than subvert it, and natural law nullifies positive laws that subvert natural law precepts. (Aristotle, Rhetoric, 1373b).

Like Plato, Aristotle argues that the universal standards of natural law justify disobeying positive laws. Aristotle’s Rhetoric provides two examples invalidating positive law for violating natural law precepts. The first is the case of Sophocles’ Antigone, where Antigone disobeys Creon’s order and provides funeral rites to her brother Polyneices. The second is Aristotle’s guide to jury nullification of written law by appealing to higher principles of natural law. (Aristotle, Rhetoric, 1373b, 1375a-b).

Aristotle never explains why natural law wields supremacy over positive law. The supremacy of natural law is consistent, however, with Aristotle’s view in the Physics that the ultimate causes of nature are divine. (Aristotle, Physics, 198b-199b).

The second way that Aristotle secures natural justice is by fostering virtue. Aristotle believed that human happiness depended on virtue more than liberty. The government is thus responsible for producing a virtuous state, and this is best accomplished through law. Although virtue encompasses more than mere conformity to law, virtue will only develop and flourish in a state that supports the legal enforcement of virtue. The state must provide moral education through its laws to make its citizens just and good. Failing to do so undermines the state’s political system and harms its citizens. (Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics, 1179b; Politics, 1280b, 1310a, 1337a).

4. Cicero

Marcus Tullius Cicero (106-43 B. C. E.) was a politician, philosopher, orator, and attorney. Cicero’s De Legibus (The Laws), De Officis (On Duties), and De Re Publica (The Republic) greatly influence the natural law tradition. Cicero esteemed Plato and Aristotle. Although not a Stoic, Cicero adopted Stoicism’s divine Nature as the source of natural law precepts that dictate legal validity. The histories of Herodotus, Thucydides, Xenophon, and Polybius persuaded Cicero that natural law imposes justice on human events.

Cicero’s signature contribution to jurisprudence is his explication of Nature as divine lawgiver. Law and justice originate in Nature as a divinely ordained set of universal moral principles. Cicero describes Nature as the omnipotent ruler of the universe, the omnipresent observer of every individual’s intentions and actions, and the common master of all people. Belief in divine Nature stabilizes society, encourages obedience to law, and leads to individual virtue. (Cicero, De Legibus, 2.15-16).

Law’s moral dimension dominates Cicero’s jurisprudence. Cicero defines natural law as perfect reason in commanding and prohibiting. These principles are the sole source of justice and provide the sole standard of legal validity. “True law is right reason in agreement with Nature.” (Cicero, De Re Publica, 3.33).

The precepts of natural law are eternal and immutable. They apply universally at all places, at all times, and to all people. Natural law summons to duty by its commands, and averts from wrongdoing by its prohibitions. Nature serves as the enforcing judge of natural law precepts, and Nature’s punishment for violating natural law precepts is inescapable. (Cicero, De Re Publica, 3.33).

Natural law provides the naturae norma, the standard of legal validity for positive law and custom. The naturae norma provides the only means for separating good provisions from bad. Justice entails that laws and customs comply with the naturae norma and preserve the peace, happiness, and safety of the state and its citizens. Positive laws and customs that fail to do so are not regarded as laws at all. (Cicero, De Legibus, 1.44, 2.11-2.14).

Regarding Cicero’s political dimension of law, the magistrate’s limited role is to govern and to issue orders that are just and advantageous in keeping with the laws. Although the magistrate has some control of the people, the laws are fully in control of the magistrate. An official is the speaking law, and the law is a nonspeaking official. (Cicero, De Legibus, 3.2).

Political rulers cannot alter, repeal, or abolish natural law precepts. Furthermore, political rulers have no role in interpreting or explaining natural law precepts. Every man can discern the precepts of natural law for himself through reason. (Cicero, De Re Publica, 3.33).

Political rulers must issue just commands as measured by natural law precepts. Individuals are protected against unjust coercion. Although rulers may use sanctions to enforce legitimate commands, every affected subject has the right to appeal to the people before enforcement of any sanction. Furthermore, no ruler can issue commands concerning single individuals. Any significant sanction against an individual, such as execution or loss of citizenship, is reserved to the highest assembly of the people. As a further protection, all laws must be officially recorded by the censors. (Cicero, De Re Publica, 2.53-2.54; De Legibus, 3.10-3.47).

Like Aristotle, Cicero requires that magistrates be subject to the power of others. Successive terms are forbidden, and ten years must pass before the magistrate becomes eligible for the same office. Every magistrate leaving office must submit an account of his official acts to the censors. Misconduct is subject to prosecution. No magistrate may give or receive any gifts while seeking or holding office, or after the conclusion of his term. (Cicero, De Legibus, 3.9-3.11).

Regarding Cicero’s historical dimension of law, Cicero agrees with Aristotle that custom maintains social stability by encouraging obedience to law. Custom can even achieve immortality for the commonwealth. The commonwealth will be eternal if citizens conduct their lives in accordance with ancestral laws and customs. (Cicero, De Re Publica, 3.41).

5. Justinian’s Corpus Juris Civilis

The Corpus Juris Civilis (Body of Civil Law) codified Roman law pursuant to the decree of Justinian I. Completed in A.D. 535, the four works of the Corpus became the sole legal authorities in the empire. The Institutes was a law school text. The Codex contained statutes dating from A.D. 76. The Digest contained commentaries by leading jurists, and the New Laws was supplemented as new laws became necessary.

The Corpus is the direct ancestor of modtern Wester civil law systems. Its influence on canon law is seen in the medieval maim Ecclesia vivit lege romana (the Church lives on Roman law). Common law jurisprudence never accepted the Corpus as binding authority. Nevertheless, its twelfth century revival profoundly influenced the formation of common law jurisprudence through the works of the father of the common law, Henry de Bracton (C. E. 1210 – C. E. 1268).

The Corpus divides law into public law involving state interests and private law governing individuals. Private law is a mixture of natural law, the law of nations, and municipal law. The Corpus establishes a clear hierarchy among law’s three dimensions. The moral dimension occupies the highest position and provides the standard of legal validity. The historical dimension of legal custom occupies the second position, and the political dimension of Roman municipal law occupies the lowest position.

The Corpus’ moral dimension resides in two bodies of law, natural law and the law of nations. Like Cicero, the Corpus originates natural law in a divine lawgiver. “The laws of nature, which are observed by all nations alike, are established by divine providence.” The precepts of natural law are universal, eternal, and immutable. (Justinian, Institutes, 1.2.11; Digest, 1.3.2).

Natural law governs all land, air, and sea creatures, including man. “The law of nature is that which she has taught all animals; a law not peculiar to the human race, but shared by all living creatures.” The Corpus extends natural law to “all living creatures” to repudiate the Sophist arguments that law is merely a human convention with no basis in nature, justice does not exist, and there is no duty to obey law. The Corpus‘ rebuttal focuses on the highly socialized behavior of such animal species as ants, bees, and birds. Although animals cannot legislate or form social conventions, they nevertheless follow norms of behavior. These norms affirm the existence of natural law. (Justinian, Institutes, 1.1.3, 2.1.11).

The Institutes and the Digest state three precepts of natural law: “Honeste vivere, alterum non laedere, suum cuique tribuere.” Live honorably, injure no one, and give every man his due. (Justinian, Institutes, 1.1.3; Digest, 1.1.10). These precepts track the Crito’s admonishments to live well, harm no one, and honor agreements so long as they are honorable. (Plato, Crito, 47e-49e). Blackstone’s Commentaries adopts these exact precepts. (Blackstone 1828, p. 27).

The law of nations is the portion of natural law that governs relations between human beings. (Justinian, Digest, 1.4). Its rules are “prescribed by natural reason for all men” and “observed by all peoples alike.” The law of nations is the source of duties to God, one’s parents, and one’s country. It recognizes human rights to life, liberty, and self-defense, and its recognition of property rights enables contracts and commerce between peoples.

The precepts of natural law provide the standard for legal validity. This standard voids any right or duty violating natural law precepts. The Institutes provides illustrative examples: Contracts created for immoral purposes, such as carrying out a homicide or a sacrilege, are not enforceable. (Justinian, Institutes, 3.19.24). Immorality invalidates wrongful profits. Anyone profiting from wrongful dominion over another’s property must disgorge those profits.(Justinian, Digest, 5.3.52).

Immorality invalidates agency relationships. Agents are not obliged to carry out immoral instructions from their principals. If they do, they are not entitled to indemnity from their principals for any liability the agents incur. (Justinian, Institutes, 3.26.7). Immorality even invalidates bequests and legacies if the bequest is contingent upon immoral conduct.(Justinian, Institutes, 2.20.36).

The Corpus’ historical dimension provides custom as a source of enforceable law. The Corpus defines legal custom as the tacit consent of a people established by long-continued habit. Since custom evidences the consent of the people, it is a higher source of law than positive or statutory law.Statutory provisions, if customarily ignored, are treated like repealed legislation. (Justinian, Digest, 1.1.3).

Legal custom establishes the autonomy of law over political rulers. Custom binds judges. A judge’s first duty is “to not judge contrary to statutes, the imperial laws, and custom.” Legal custom even controls statutory interpretation. “Custom is the best interpreter of statutes.” (Justinian, Institutes, 4.17; Digest, 1.1.37).

The Corpus’ political dimension resides in its six categories of Roman municipal law, the “statutes, plebiscites, senatusconsults, enactments of the Emperors, edicts of the magistrates, and answers of those learned in the law.” In contrast to natural law and the law of nations, Roman municipal law was unique to Rome. Its provisions were also “subject to frequent change, either by the tacit consent of the people, or by the subsequent enactment of another statute.” (Justinian, Institutes, 1.2.3, 1.2.11).

6. Aquinas

Thomas Aquinas‘ Summa Theologica recognizes all three dimensions of law as potential sources of valid law. The moral dimension wields supremacy, however, through a rigid standard of legal validity. Human laws that fail this standard are not merely unenforceable; they are “perversions of law,” “acts of violence,” and “no law at all.” (Aquinas, Summa Theologica, quest. 94 art. 4; quest. 95 art. 2).

Common law jurisprudence has never accepted Aquinas’ natural law theory. It differs in important ways from Blackstone’s natural law theory. Thomism nevertheless influenced the philosophical method taught in Roman Catholic institutions. Martin Luther King Jr. invoked Aquinas’ natural law theory in the Birmingham jail to justify civil disobedience, and Aquinas’ theory motivates contemporary opponents of abortion and euthanasia.

Question 97 establishes both God and man as lawgivers. Divine and natural law come from the rational will of God. Human law comes from the will of man, regulated by reason. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 97 art. 3).

Question 90 defines four existence conditions for law. The first condition is that law is an ordinance of reason, that law is created by a being with reason to achieve a goal. The second condition is that the law has the common good as its goal and that laws must distribute their burdens equitably and proportionately among their subjects. The third condition is a lawgiver who has care of the community because unless the lawgiver holds sufficient power to coerce obedience, the law cannot induce its subjects to virtue. The fourth condition is publication, which is required for law to have the binding force to compel obedience. Each condition is necessary for law, and together they are sufficient. Failing any condition renders a purported law an act of violence. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 1-4).

Question 91 divides law into four types. Eternal law is the set of timeless truths that govern the movement and behavior of all things in the universe, including human beings. Divine law is the word of God revealed to man to guide him to his supernatural end. God reveals divine law to operate because human reason is inadequate to discover its precepts. Natural law is that portion of the eternal law that governs the behavior of human beings. Natural law is derived from eternal law, and its precepts are discovered by reason. Human law is any law of human authorship. Man creates human law in order to implement the precepts of natural law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 91 art. 1-4).

Question 94 presents Aquinas’ theory of natural law. God writes natural law in the hearts of men, and man discerns the natural law using practical reason. Four natural inclinations enable man to discern the precepts of natural law. The first is an inclination to seek after good. The second is an inclination to preserve one’s own according to one’s nature. Man shares these first two inclinations with all substances. The third is an inclination to reproduce, raise, and educate one’s offspring. Man shares this inclination with animals. The fourth is an inclination “to know the truth about God and to live in society.” This inclination is unique to man. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 94 art. 2).

Aquinas divides natural law into “first principles” and “secondary principles.” First principles are unchanging. They are always known by all human beings and they are binding on all human beings. They are mutually consistent, and conflict between them is impossible. They cannot be “blotted out from men’s hearts.” (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 94 art. 6).

The first principles of natural law contain four precepts, each reflecting one of man’s natural inclinations. The first precept is to pursue good and avoid evil. The second is to preserve life and ward off its obstacles. The third is to reproduce, raise, and educate one’s offspring. The fourth is to pursue knowledge and to live together in society. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 94 art. 2).

Secondary principles of natural law differ significantly from first principles. Secondary principles are subject to change, albeit rarely and for special causes. They are not always known by all persons and they are not always binding. These differences result from practical reason’s susceptibility to perversion by passion, evil habits, and evil dispositions. Lastly, secondary principles can be blotted out from men’s hearts through “evil persuasions,” errors in “speculative matters,” vicious customs,” and “corrupt habits.” (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 94 art. 6).

Secondary principles form three categories. The first involves secondary principles that are always known by all persons and are always binding, such as “do not murder or slay the innocent.” The second category involves principles that are always binding but not always known, such as “do not steal.” Julius Caesar reports in the Gallic Wars, for example, that the Germans did not know it was wrong to steal. The third category involves principles that are not always binding, such as “goods entrusted to another should be restored.” Although usually binding, this principle does not bind the return of another’s weapons to be used against one’s country. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 94 art. 4).

Questions 95 through 97 discuss human law. Human law exists because the great variety of human affairs prevents the first principles of natural law from being applied to all men in the same way. Human reason derives human law from natural law precepts for particular matters, and this process creates a diversity of positive law among different peoples. The “force” accorded to human law depends on the method by which it is derived from natural law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 95 art. 2).

Aquinas specifies two methods. The first method involves taking a “conclusion” from a premise of natural law. As in science, reason draws specific conclusions of human law by demonstration from natural law principles. Reason demonstrates the human law conclusion that “one must not kill” from the natural law principle that “one should do harm to no man.” Human laws derived by this method have some force of natural law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 95 art. 2).

The second method for deriving human law involves making a “determination” from generalities of natural law. As in the arts, details are derived from general forms. A carpenter begins with the general form of a house in his mind, but he must determine the details of its construction as he builds it. Reason determines that murderers should be imprisoned for twenty years from the natural law principle that evildoers should be punished. Unlike conclusions of human law, determinations have no force of natural law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 95 art. 2).

Question 96 provides a narrow scope for human law. Human laws should not repress all the vices forbidden by natural law. Since most people are incapable of abstaining from all vices, human law should only prohibit those vices whose suppression is essential for preserving society. Human laws should prohibit murder and theft but remain silent as to lesser vices. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 2).

The Summa provides a fully developed standard of legal validity. Question 96 provides that human laws must be just. Justice requires that human laws accomplish both divine good and human good as described below. Unjust laws are not merely unenforceable; they are perversions of law and acts of violence, and they are powerless to bind the conscience. They are, in fact, not laws at all. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 4).

Human laws accomplish divine good by satisfying the requirements of natural law and divine law. Purported laws that conflict with divine good, natural law or divine law should always be disobeyed. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 4).

Human laws accomplish human good if and only if they meet three conditions. First, the end of the law must be the common good. Second, the human lawgiver must not exceed his power in establishing the law. Third, the burdens of the law must be shared equitably and proportionately by all members of society. Failure to meet any of these conditions renders the purported law unjust. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 4).

Purported laws that conflict with human good are unjust and may usually be disobeyed. If the purported law fails to meet one of the standards for human good, it may be disobeyed. An exception arises, however, if disobedience results in “greater harm” or creates a scandal. The unjust human law should then be obeyed, even though it is not truly a law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 96 art. 4).

Critics often charge that Aquinas’ claim that “an unjust law is no law at all” is incoherent. This criticism seemingly disregards Aquinas’ definition of law in Question 95. Laws have “just so much of the nature of law” as they are derived from natural law. Natural law is always just. To be considered law “at all,” therefore, human laws must be just. A purported law that is unjust is not truly a law. (Aquinas, Summa, quest. 95 art. 2).

7. Blackstone

Sir William Blackstone’s Commentaries on the Laws of England is the standard statement of common law jurisprudence. Blackstone imposes two standards of legal validity, one based on custom and the other on natural law. Purported laws that fail these standards are not merely “bad law,” they are “not law.” (Blackstone 1838, p. 47).

Law’s historical dimension provides the validity standard based on custom and serves as the primary source of human law. The historical dimension also emphasizes the autonomy of custom over the will of political rulers. Law’s moral dimension provides the validity standard based on natural law. The moral dimension also establishes natural rights as limits on the will of the political ruler and protects these rights through due process. The political dimension provides only a limited source of law, and the historical and moral dimensions severely restrict the political ruler’s ability to enforce his will through legal coercion.

Law’s historical dimension dominates Blackstone’s jurisprudence. Custom is “the first ground and chief corner stone” of common law. Custom includes rules of law, such as the rule of primogeniture, which says the oldest male descendant inherits the entire estate. Custom also includes legal principles in the forms of maxims, such as “the king can do no wrong,” “no man is bound to accuse himself,” and “no man ought to benefit from his own wrong.” Law’s historical dimension is so strong in common law that approved statutes were strictly construed and interpreted whenever possible to comply with pre-existing custom. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 46, 50).

Blackstone divides customary law into three types. The first type, “general customs,” applies to the entire kingdom. The second type, “particular customs,” only apply to limited regions or specialized groups like merchants. For illustration, the “general custom” of inheritance for England is primogeniture where the eldest son inherits all. Nevertheless, the “particular custom” of gavelkind permits shared inheritance in Kent. The third type, “peculiar laws,” includes Roman civil law and Catholic canon law. These laws have no authority in England except as the people have consented to their provisions through customary observance. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 45-57).

The validity standard for custom includes seven requirements. First, the custom must “have been used so long, that the memory of man runs not to the contrary.” Proof of any time when the custom did not exist voids the custom. Second, the custom must enjoy continuous observance, interruption voids the custom. Third, the custom must enjoy peaceable observance. Custom depends upon consent, and disputed customs lack consent. Fourth, customs must be “reasonable” and must not create unnecessary hardships.Fifth, the custom must be certain. A custom that the worthiest son inherits is void because no certain standard for worthiness exists. Sixth, compliance must be mandatory. Optional customs have no coercive force. Lastly, customs must be consistent. Inconsistent customs lack mutual consent. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 53-55).

Law’s moral dimension provides a standard of legal validity based on natural law. Blackstone’s natural law founds justice on the eternal and immutable laws of good and evil to which the creator himself conforms. God is a being of infinite power, infinite wisdom, and infinite goodness. Although God endows man with reason and free will, man is still “entirely dependent” on God. Man is subject to God’s law, and God’s law is natural law. Natural law is binding over the entire globe, in all countries, and at all times. No human laws are of any validity if they conflict with natural law, and valid human laws derive all their force and authority from natural law.

Natural law precepts are discernible by reason as far as they are necessary for the conduct of human actions. Unlike Aquinas, however, Blackstone regards human reason as “frail, imperfect, and blind” since man’s fall. To overcome these defects of human reason, God reveals the precepts of natural law through direct revelation in scripture. The validity of human law depends on the two foundations of natural law and revealed law. Human laws contradicting their precepts are void.

Natural law permits acts that promote true happiness and prohibits acts that destroy it. Natural law derives from the precept “that man should pursue his own true and substantial happiness.” God created human nature so that man obtains happiness by pursuing justice. Injustice brings unhappiness.

Substantively, natural law consists of eternal immutable laws of good and evil. Blackstone adopts three precepts of natural law from Justinian’s Institutes. “Such, among others, are these principles: that we should live honestly, should hurt nobody, and should render to every one his due; to which three general precepts Justinian has reduced the whole doctrine of law.” (Blackstone 1838, pp. 27-28).

Blackstone divides jurisprudence into natural law and positive law. Positive law provisions contrary to natural law are invalid. Individuals are furthermore bound to disobey them, such as laws requiring murder. Nevertheless, natural law does not determine every legal issue. Natural law is indifferent, for example, as to whether positive law permits the export of wool. On most issues, man is at liberty to adopt positive laws that benefit society. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 28-29).

Blackstone divides rights into two types, absolute rights and relative rights. The “immutable laws of nature” vest absolute rights in individuals. Individuals enjoy absolute rights in the state of nature, prior to the formation of society. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 88, 94).

Blackstone names three absolute rights: personal security, personal liberty, and private property. The absolute right of personal security consists of the legal enjoyment of life, limb, body, health, and reputation. The absolute right of personal liberty consists of the free power of movement without imprisonment or restraint unless by due course of law. The absolute right of property consists of the free use and disposal of lawful acquisitions, without injury or illegal diminution. (Blackstone 1838, pp 93-100).

Relative rights, in contrast to absolute rights, exist only in society. Relative rights protect and maintain inviolate the three absolute rights of personal security, personal liberty, and private property. Unlike absolute rights, which are few and simple, relative rights are more numerous and more complicated. Such rights include due process protections as well as “Blackstone’s ratio,” which says it is better that ten guilty persons escape than one innocent party suffers. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 89, 102).

Law’s political dimension is severely delimited in Blackstone’s jurisprudence. Society is formed for the protection of individuals. In addition to the validity standards discussed above, Blackstone’s historical dimension dictates a near absolute standard of legal autonomy. Law wields supremacy over the will of political rulers, whether they are kings or judges. (Blackstone 1838, p. 32).

Regarding the autonomy of law over kings, the most important maxim in English history is “the law makes the king; the king does not make the law.” This maxim dates from Henry de Bracton’s 1235 treatise The Laws and Customs of the Kingdom of England. “The king must not be under man but under God and under the law, because the law makes the king … there is no king where the will and not the law has dominion.” (De Bracton 1968, p. 33).

Regarding the autonomy of law over judges, Blackstone’s “declaratory theory” prohibits judges from making new law. Judges may only find and declare existing law; they may never make law. Judge-made law unites the power to make and enforce law in one body, and this invites tyranny. The judge should determine the law according to the known laws and customs of the land, not his own private judgment. Judges are not appointed to pronounce new laws. (Blackstone 1838, p. 46, 105).

Nevertheless, since all law is subject to the standard of reason, judges may set aside common law precedents that are contrary to reason as “manifestly absurd or unjust.” Setting unreasonable precedents aside does not create new law. Instead, it vindicates the law from misrepresentation. Unreasonable rules of common law, by definition, are not law. Such precedents are not set aside because they are bad law, but because they are not law. (Blackstone 1838, pp. 46-47).

In applying statutory law, however, the judge may never exercise his discretion to set aside the will of Parliament. The only authority that can declare an act of Parliament void is Parliament itself. The judge must “interpret and obey” its mandates. Judges may never act as miniature legislatures. “In a democracy,” writes Blackstone, “the right of making laws resides in the people at large.” (Blackstone 1838, pp. 27, 33).

8. Bentham

Legal positivism rejects law’s moral and historical dimensions as sources of law or standards of legal validity. H. L. A. Hart is the most important figure in the positivist tradition that begins with Jeremy Bentham and John Austin. Bentham was sixteen when he attended a series of private lectures by Blackstone on the common law. These lectures were later published as Blackstone’s Commentaries.

The young Bentham listened with rebel ears. Bentham’s anonymous Fragment on Government describes Blackstone’s natural law theory as “theological grimgribber” and an “excursion into the land of fancy.” Bentham describes Blackstone as “the dupe of every prejudice,” “the accomplice of every chicanery,” “the abettor of every abuse,” and “a treasury of vulgar errors.” (Bentham 1977, 10).

Bentham’s legal theory has two distinctive features. The first is Bentham’s exclusion of law’s historical dimension. Bentham’s “imperative” theory of law defines law as (1) the assemblage of signs of a sovereign’s volition, (2) directing the conduct of persons under his power, (3) accompanied by an “expectation” in such persons, that (4) motivates obedience. The sovereign’s will provides its own validity standard. Custom is excluded and the ruler wields autonomy over law. (Bentham 1970, p. 1).

Bentham’s second distinctive feature is his exclusion of law’s moral dimension. Law for Bentham has no necessary conceptual connection with morality. Bentham abandons Blackstone’s immutable standards of right and wrong for physical sensations of pleasure and pain: “Nature has placed mankind under the governance of two sovereign masters, pain and pleasure. It is for them alone to point out what we ought to do.” (Bentham 1907, p. 1).

Bentham’s Anarchical Fallacies argues that natural laws and natural rights are imaginary. “Natural rights is simple nonsense: natural and imprescriptable rights, nonsense upon stilts.” Positive law is the only real law. Only positive law can create real rights, and positive law requires the existence of a sovereign. There can be no rights outside the existence of a sovereign command, and no rights can exist prior to the formation of a government. In sum, the will of the sovereign provides its own standard of legal validity, unrestrained by morality, custom, or the autonomy of law. (Bentham 1843, pp. 501-05).

9. Austin

John Austin‘s The Province of Jurisprudence Determined defines law’s political dimension as the sole source of law and legal validity. Like Bentham’s “imperative” theory, Austin’s “command” theory of law establishes the political ruler’s will as its own standard of legal validity. The sovereign can coerce his will through law without restraint by moral principles, custom, or the autonomy of law.

Austin’s “command” theory defines law as (a) commands, (b) backed by threat of sanctions, (c) from a sovereign, (d) to whom people have a habit of obedience. A common criticism of Austin’s theory is that the command of a gun-wielding highwayman arguably satisfies Austin’s definition of law.

The “command” theory rejects law’s historical dimension. Legal customs and principles play no part in law. Law wields no autonomy over the political ruler’s will, including the will of judges. In contrast to Blackstone, Austin encourages judges to legislate from the bench. Society cannot function unless judges are free to make new law to correct the negligence and incapacity of legislatures. (Austin 2000, p. 191, 225-31).

Austin’s “command” theory rejects law’s moral dimension as well. Austin labels Blackstone’s natural law validity standard “stark nonsense.” God’s law is uncertain, and Blackstone’s natural law standard preaches anarchy. Austin writes that “the existence of law is one thing; its merit and demerit another. Whether it be or be not is one enquiry; whether it be or be not conformable to an assumed standard, is a different enquiry. A law, which actually exists, is a law, though we happen to dislike it.” (Austin 2000, p. 184).

10. Hart

Hart’s 1957 lecture “Positivism and the Separation of Law and Morals” emphasizes three doctrines asserted by Bentham and Austin. The first, which Hart retains, is an emphasis on “the meaning of the distinctive vocabulary of the law.” The second doctrine, which Hart retains, is the separation of law and morals. Hart holds law “as it is” distinct from law “as it ought to be.” This distinction rejects moral standards as the test for legal validity. (Hart 1958, pp. 594, 601).

The third doctrine, which Hart rejects, is Austin’s command theory of law. Hart rejects Austin’s theory for four reasons. First, Austin fails to recognize that laws generally apply to those who enact them. Second, Austin does not account for laws granting public powers, such as the power to legislate or adjudicate, or for laws granting private powers to create or modify legal relations. Third, Austin fails to account for laws that originate, not from a sovereign, but out of common custom. Fourth, Austin fails to account for the continuity of legislative authority characteristic of a modern legal system. (Hart 1994, p. 70).

Hart replaces Austin’s “command” theory with a model of law as the union of primary and secondary social rules. A primary rule is a rule that imposes an obligation or a duty. “[P]rimary rules are concerned with the actions that individuals must or must not do,” such as restrictions on “violence, theft, and deception.” A rule imposes an obligation or duty when the demand for conformity is insistent and the social pressure brought to bear upon those who deviate from the rule is great. (Hart 1994, pp. 91, 94).

In order for a system of primary rules to function effectively, Hart states that secondary rules may also be necessary to provide an authoritative statement of all the primary rules. In contrast to primary rules, which impose obligations and duties, secondary rules confer powers to introduce, to change, or to modify a primary rule. These powers may be public or private. (Hart 1994, pp. 96-97).

There are three types of secondary rules. The first type is the rule of change. This rule allows legislators to make changes in the primary rules if the primary rules are defective or inadequate. The second type is the rule of adjudication. This rule enables courts to resolve disputes regarding the interpretation and application of primary rules. The third type of secondary rule is the rule of recognition. The rule of recognition provides “a rule for conclusive identification of the primary rules of obligation.” It also provides Hart’s criterion for legal validity. A rule of law is legally valid if it conforms to the requirements of the rule of recognition. (Hart 1994, pp. 95-98, 103-05).

Hart next turns from defining the validity criteria for individual laws to defining the validity criteria for entire legal systems. System validity is determined by the attitudes of citizens and public officials toward obedience to legal rules. Hart describes two contrasting attitudes, the “external” and “internal” points of view.

The external point of view is the view of a person who feels no obligation to follow the law. He has no sense that it is right to follow the law or wrong not to do so. He rejects law as the standard of conduct for himself or others. The internal point of view, on the other hand, is the view of a person who feels obligated to follow the law. He follows the law because he thinks it is right to do so and wrong not to do so. He feels that he ought, must, and should follow the law. (Hart 1994, pp. 56-57).

The validity of a legal system depends on only two conditions. First, private citizens must generally obey the primary rules of obligation. It is sufficient that citizens take an external point of view toward primary rules. Second, public officials must adopt the rule of recognition specifying the criteria for legal validity as their “public standard of official behavior.” It is a minimum, necessary condition that officials take the internal point of view toward secondary rules. (Hart 1994, pp. 116-17).

Hart’s standard of legal validity functions solely in law’s political dimension. The will of the political rulers determines the validity of law by their adoption of a rule of recognition. The will of the political rulers determines the validity of the legal system as well. The only necessary condition for a valid legal system is the political rulers’ adoption of the internal point of view.

Hart excludes the historical dimension from his standard of legal validity. Hart omits, for example, two of the historical dimension’s traditional restraints on the will of the political ruler. The first, emphasized since Aristotle, is the autonomy of law over political rulers. Instead, Hart’s political rulers wield autonomy over law by controlling the standard of legal validity. Hart also grants judges autonomy over law by rejecting Blackstone’s declaratory theory that judges find but do not make law. If the judge determines the meaning of a legal rule to be “indeterminate or incomplete,” the judge “must exercise his discretion and make law for the case instead of merely applying already pre-existing settled law.”

The second historical restraint, emphasized by Locke and Blackstone, is the validity requirement of consent by the governed. Consent is irrelevant to Hart’s legal validity. It is sufficient that each member of the population obeys Hart’s primary rules “from any motive whatsoever.” “Any motive,” as Hart’s critics point out, includes terror and force.

Hart also excludes law’s moral dimension from his standard of legal validity. Hart accepts “morally iniquitous” laws as legally valid. “There are no necessary conceptual connections between the content of law and morality; and hence morally iniquitous provisions may be valid as legal rules or principles. One aspect of this form of the separation of law from morality is that there can be legal rights and duties which have no moral justification or force whatever.” (Hart 1994, p. 268).

11. Radbruch

Gustav Radbruch utilizes legal history to support a validity standard invoking law’s moral dimension. Radbruch, once Germany’s leading positivist, argues that the positivist separation of law and morality facilitated Hitler’s atrocities through legal means. Radbruch argues that German positivism rendered “jurists and the people alike defenseless against arbitrary, cruel, or criminal laws, however extreme they might be. In the end, the positivistic theory equates law with power; there is law only where there is power.” (Radbruch 2006b, p. 13). Positivism, in other words, operates only in law’s political dimension.

Radbruch blames the positivistic legal thinking that held sway over German jurists for rendering impotent every possible defence against the abuses of National Socialist legislation. Radbruch warns, “We must arm ourselves against the recurrence of an outlaw state like Hitler’s by fundamentally overcoming positivism.” Radbruch’s solution is a standard of legal validity invoking law’s moral dimension. (Radbruch 2006a, p. 8).

This validity standard, known as “Radbruch’s Formula,” has been applied by German courts. In cases where the discrepancy between justice and statutory law becomes “unbearable,” the statute is held void ab initio in the interest of justice. “Radbruch’s Formula” holds such statutes void ab initio because they are not truly laws.

Radbruch explains: “Where there is not even an attempt at justice, where equality, the core of justice, is deliberately betrayed in the issuance of positive law, then the statute is not merely ‘flawed law’, it lacks completely the very nature of law. For law, including positive law, cannot be otherwise defined than as a system and an institution whose very meaning is to serve justice. Measured by this standard, whole portions of National Socialist law never attained the dignity of valid law.” (Radbruch 2006a, p. 7). Radbruch thus joins Cicero, Aquinas, and Blackstone in concluding that unjust laws are not laws at all.

12. Positivism in American Jurisprudence

Hart’s separation of law from morality stimulated significant criticism in the United States. Lon Fuller’s The Morality of Law argues that law is subject to an internal morality consisting of eight principles. Laws must be enforced, for example, in a manner consistent with their wording. Legal systems that violate these principles cannot achieve social order. They destroy any moral obligation to obey the law. (Fuller 1964, pp. 33-40).

Ronald Dworkin’s “The Model of Rules” argues that Hart’s model of law is incomplete. Courts often decide difficult cases according to legal principles that provide moral justifications for case outcomes. One example is the common law maxim that no man should profit from his own wrongful conduct. These legal principles are outside Hart’s definition of primary and secondary rules. (Dworkin 1967, pp. 23-24).

Hart’s legal positivism nevertheless exerts significant influence in American jurisprudence. Four factors enhance Hart’s influence. The first occurred in 1871 when Dean Christopher Langdell of Harvard Law School dropped Blackstone’s Commentaries from Harvard’s legal curriculum. Blackstone’s jurisprudence lost influence as other schools followed.

The second enhancing factor is the erosion of law’s moral dimension. Oliver Wendell Holmes, Jr. is a leading figure in this process. Holmes advocated for law without values and identified himself as a skeptic. Holmes defines truth as the majority vote of any nation that is more powerful than all the others. Holmes equates a jurist searching for validity criteria in natural law to the poor devil who must get drunk to satisfy his demand for the superlative. (Holmes 1918, p. 40).

Holmes’ “Path of the Law” presents an early form of positivism. Holmes argues for the separation of law and morality. Holmes supports banishing every word of moral significance from the law. He rejects every ethical obligation in contract law. Holmes advocates a “bad man” perspective that looks at law as a bad man who feels no obligation to obey it. This is an early statement of Hart’s “external point of view.” (Holmes 1997, pp. 991-997).

The third factor enhancing Hart’s influence is the erosion of law’s historical dimension. Dean Roscoe Pound of Harvard Law School illustrates its erosion. Pound’s “Mechanical Jurisprudence” advocates abandoning custom as a source of any law. Pound urged replacing the common law system based on custom with a civil code system based on statutes. (Pound 1908, 605-23).

The fourth factor enhancing Hart’s influence is the natural desire of judges to “make” new law. Blackstone’s “declaratory theory” forbids judge-made law, but Hart’s “penumbra doctrine” considers it an ordinary and necessary judicial function. One striking example of Hart’s influence is Griswold v. Connecticut, 281 U.S. 479 (1965). Griswold applies a penumbra analysis to imply a Constitutional right of privacy while admitting no such right appears in the language of the Constitution. The Supreme Court decided Roe v. Wade, 410 U.S. 113 (1973) based on Griswold’s implied right of privacy. The increased willingness of judges to legislate from the bench in 20th and 21st Century American courts is Hart’s most significant and controversial legacy in American jurisprudence.

13. A Fresh Approach

Augustine‘s City of God observes that kingdoms without justice are but great bands of robbers. Robbers become rulers, not by the removal of greed, but by the addition of impunity. (Augustine 1998, p.147-48). Validity standards are the primary means by which societies deny impunity to unjust rulers. Legal validity governs the enforceability of law, and the standard of legal validity controls the ruler’s ability to enforce his will through legal coercion.

Standards of legal validity are historically cyclical, and the cycle continued in the United States during the 21st Century. American law initially embraced Blackstone’s dual validity standards based on moral principles and legal custom. Centuries of challengers have eroded those standards. Bentham, Austin, Holmes, and Hart eroded Blackstone’s moral standard by advocating the separation of law from morality. Pound eroded Blackstone’s customary standard by advocating the abandonment of common law. Legal educators dropped Blackstone from their curriculum.

These challengers eroded Blackstone’s validity standards, but they did not supplant them. A validity schism divided American jurisprudence. There was no generally accepted validity standard in American law. Academic theorists and legal educators favored Hart for his analytical clarity. Liberal judges favored Hart for increasing their power to make new law. Practitioners and conservative judges favored Blackstone for his emphasis on consent of the governed, autonomy of law, predictability of law, and morally just decisions.

Two irreconcilable bodies of precedent emerge, one formulated by traditional judges who limit themselves to finding existing law, the other by positivist judges who make new law. As judges increasingly make new law, courts become unpredictable, ex post facto rulings increase, and laws are unevenly applied. Unelected federal judges set aside democratic resolutions of political questions and decide policy issues without public input. Justices devise or limit Constitutional rights according to personal preference to achieve their desired case outcome.

Despite fifty years of debate, the opposing camps remain estranged. Each side utilizes methods its opponent will never accept. Blackstone, for example, formulates his moral precepts in terms of divine law and human reason. This formulation is unpersuasive for two reasons. First, there is no general agreement regarding the terms of divine law, and many reject its very existence. Second, Blackstone adopts inconsistent views of human reason. On one hand, human reason is too “frail, imperfect, and blind” to generate just human laws. On the other hand, human reason is sufficient to generate the precepts of natural law from revelations of divine law.

Legal positivism is unpersuasive as well, insisting on a narrow philosophical method to formulate its standard of legal validity. Hart emphasizes “a purely analytical study of legal concepts, a study of the meaning of the distinctive vocabulary of the law.” (Hart 1958, p. 601). He describes all law as consisting of only two types of rules. Hart’s simplistic model of law is inadequate for three reasons.

First, Hart’s analysis excludes law’s historical and social contexts. Hart restricts his analysis to law’s linguistic context. Law is more than linguistics. It encompasses the entirety of the great variety of human affairs. Hart’s exclusion of these indispensible contexts commits the “analytical fallacy” described by John Dewey in “Context and Thought” (Dewey 1985, pp. 5-7).

Second, Hart’s standard of legal validity ignores the content of law. Hart only considers the pedigree of the law’s creation. Hart consequently accepts the validity of “morally iniquitous laws” whose content possesses “no moral justification or force whatsoever.” (Hart 1994, p. 268).

Hart ignores the grave consequences of enforcing “morally iniquitous” laws. For example, Hart validates legal systems if two conditions are met. First, citizens may take an external point of view toward primary rules. Obedience “from any motive whatsoever” is sufficient, permitting coercion through terror. Second, officials must take an internal point of view toward secondary rules. Objectively considered, the legal systems utilized by Stalin and Hitler satisfy both conditions.

Third, Hart’s model of law as rules is incomplete. Something important is missing from a legal philosophy that validates the Soviet and Nazi legal systems. That missing element is justice, and justice is a moral concept. As Ronald Dworkin explains, courts usually decide difficult cases according to legal principles that provide moral justifications for case outcomes. Hart’s model of rules excludes these principles. (Dworkin 1967, pp. 23-24).

Hart showed how to separate law from morality, but history showed why societies should not do so. Critics contend that a fresh approach is needed.

Neither Blackstone nor Hart assign legal history a significant role in formulating their validity standards. No major jurist since Cicero has done so. Nevertheless, a historical formulation of legal validity can avoid the problems described above. Unlike Blackstone, legal history does not require belief in a divine lawgiver, and unlike Hart, legal history does not ignore the content of law.

Legal history provides a long record of legal experimentation. A scientific approach identifies three principles that recur in just and stable legal systems. Legal systems without these principles repeatedly become arbitrary, unjust, and unstable.

The first principle is the principle of reason, which addresses the validity of law’s content. The principle of reason recognizes that every subject is a rational creature with a free will. To be stable, the legal system must treat its subjects as ends in themselves, and not as a mere means to another end. The legal system must also permit rational individuals to orient their own behavior in order to achieve a society based on ordered liberty. Procedural due process protects against the punishment of the innocent and the tyranny of the majority. Substantive due process enables laws to provide dependable guideposts to individuals in orienting their behavior.

The second principle is the principle of consent, which addresses the validity of law’s creation. This principle provides that the legitimacy of law derives from the consent of those subject to its power. Common law custom, the doctrine of stare decisis, and legislation sanctioned by the subjects’ legitimate representatives are all evidence of consent.

The third principle is the principle of autonomy, which addresses both the content and the creation of law. Laws must wield supremacy over political rulers. The ruler must be under the same laws as his subjects, and the laws must not be subject to arbitrary change to reflect the ruler’s will. To paraphrase de Bracton, the law must make the king. The king must not make the law. To paraphrase Aristotle, rightly constituted laws must be the final sovereign.

These principles operate in law’s moral and historical dimensions to restrain the ruler’s ability to enforce his will through legal coercion. Legal systems become unjust and unstable in the absence of such restraints. They project the power of the political ruler, but they are not valid legal systems. The history of the Western legal tradition is the history of revolutions against such systems. (Berman 1983).

14. References and Further Reading

Aquinas, Thomas. Treatise on Law (Summa Theologica, Questions 90-07). Ed. Ralph McInerny. Washington: Regnery, 1996. Print.
Aristotle. The Athenian Constitution. Trans. Sir Frederic G. Kenyon. Seaside, OR: Merchant, 2009. Print.
Aristotlte. Ethica Nichomachea. Trans. W.D. Ross. New York: Oxford UP, 2009. Print.
Aristotlte. Metaphysics. Trans. Joe Sachs. Santa Fe: Green Lion, 2002. Print.
Aristotlte. Physics. Trans. Robin Waterfield. Ed. David Bostock. Oxford: Oxford UP, 1996. Print.
Aristotlte. The Politics of Aristotle. Trans. Ernest Barker. Oxford: Oxford UP, 1946. Print.
Aristotlte. Rhetoric. Ed. W.D. Ross. Trans. W. Rhys Roberts. New York: Cosimo, 2010. Print.
Augustine. The City of God against the Pagans. Trans. R.W. Dyson. Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 1998. Print.
Austin, John. The Province of Jurisprudence Determined. Amherst, NY: Prometheus, 2000. Print.
Bentham, Jeremy. “Anarchical Fallacies; Being an Examination of the Declarations of Rights Issued During the French Revolution.” The Works of Jeremy Bentham. 11 vols. Edinburgh: William Tait, 1838-43. Print.
Bentham, Jeremy. A Comment on the Commentaries and A Fragment on Government. Ed. J.H. Burns and H.L.A. Hart. London: Athlone, 1977. Print.
Bentham, Jeremy. An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation. Oxford: Clarendon, 1907. Print.
Bentham, Jeremy. Of Laws in General. Ed. H.L.A. Hart. London: Athlone, 1970. Print.
Berman, Harold J. Law and Revolution: The Formation of the Western Legal Tradition. Cambridge: Harvard UP, 1983. Print.
Berman, Harold J. “Toward an Integrative Jurisprudence: Politics, Morality, History.” 76 (4) California Law Review (1988): 779-801. Print.
Blackstone, Sir William. Commentaries on the Laws of England. Vol. 1. New York: W.E. Dean, 1838. Print.
Cicero, De Officis (On Duties). Ed. M.T. Griffin and E.M. Atkins. Cambridge: Cambridge UP, 1991. Print.
Cicero, De Re Publica (On the Republic) and De Legibus (On the Laws). Trans. C.W. Keyes. Ed. Jeffrey Henderson. Bury St. Edmonds, UK: St. Edmondsbury, 2000. Print.
De Bracton, Henry. De Legibus et Consuetudinibus Angliae (On the Laws and Customs of England). Ed. George E. Woodbine. Trans. Samuel E. Thorne. 4 vols. Cambridge: Harvard UP, 1968. Print.
Dewey, John. “Context and Thought.” The Later Works of John Dewey. Ed. Jo Ann Boydston. Vol. 6. Carbondale, IL: S. Illinois UP, 1985. Print.
Dworkin, Ronald. “The Model of Rules.” U. Chi. L. Rev. 35 (1) (1967): 14-46. Print.
Fuller, Lon L. The Morality of Law. New Haven: Yale UP, 1964. Print.
Hamilton, Alexander, John Jay, and James Madison. “Federalist No. 63.” The Federalist Papers. Ed. Ernest O’Dell. Sundown, TX: CreateSpace, 2010. Print.
Hart, H. L. A. The Concept of Law. 2nd ed. Oxford: Clarendon, 1994. Print.
Hart, H. L. A. “Positivism and the Separation of Law and Morals.” Harv. L Rev. 71 (4) (1958): 593–629. Print.
Hesiod. Theogony, Works and Days, Shield. Trans. Apostolos N. Athanassakis. 2nd ed. Baltimore: Johns Hopkins Press, 2004. Print.
Holmes, Oliver Wendell, Jr. “Natural Law.” Harv. L. Rev. 32 (1) (1918): 40-44. Print.
Holmes, Oliver Wendell, Jr. “The Path of the Law.” Harv. L. Rev. 110 (5) (1997): 991-1009. Print.
Justinian. Corpus Juris Civilis, The Civil Law. Trans. S.P. Scott. 17 vols. Cincinnati: Central Trust, 1932. Print.
Plato. Crito. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. Protagoras. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. Gorgias. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. “Letter VII.” The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. Laws. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. Theaetetus. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plato. The Republic. The Collected Dialogues of Plato, including the Letters. Trans. Lane Cooper. Ed. Edith Hamilton and Huntington Cairns. Princeton: Princeton UP, 1961. Print.
Plutarch. “Themistocles.” Plutarch’s Lives. Trans. Bernadotte Perrin. Cambridge: Harvard UP, 1914. Print.
Pound, Roscoe. “Mechanical Jurisprudence.” Colum. L. Rev. 8 (3) (1908): 605-623. Print.
Radbruch, Gustav. “Five Minutes of Legal Philosophy.” Trans. Bonnie Litschewski Paulson and Stanley L. Paulson. Oxford J. Legal Stud. 26 (1) (2006b): 13-15. Print.
Radbruch, Gustav. “Statutory Lawlessness and Supra-Statutory Law.” Trans. Bonnie Litschewski Paulson and Stanley L. Paulson. Oxford J. Legal Stud. 26 (1) (2006a): 1-11. Print.
Xenophon. Socrates’ Defence. Ed. Robin Waterfield. Trans. Hugh Tredennick and Robin Waterfield. New York: Penguin, 1990. Print.

Author Information

John O. Tyler, Jr.
Email: jtyler@hbu.edu
Houston Baptist University
U. S. A.

Socrates (469—399 B.C.E.)

Socrates is one of the few individuals whom one could say has so-shaped the cultural and intellectual development of the world that, without him, history would be profoundly different. He is best known for his association with the Socratic method of question and answer, his claim that he was ignorant (or aware of his own absence of knowledge), and his claim that the unexamined life is not worth living, for human beings. He was the inspiration for Plato, the thinker widely held to be the founder of the Western philosophical tradition. Plato in turn served as the teacher of Aristotle, thus establishing the famous triad of ancient philosophers: Socrates, Plato, and Aristotle. Unlike other philosophers of his time and ours, Socrates never wrote anything down but was committed to living simply and to interrogating the everyday views and popular opinions of those in his home city of Athens. At the age of 70, he was put to death at the hands of his fellow citizens on charges of impiety and corruption of the youth. His trial, along with the social and political context in which occurred, has warranted as much treatment from historians and classicists as his arguments and methods have from philosophers.

This article gives an overview of Socrates: who he was, what he thought, and his purported method. It is both historical and philosophical. At the same time, it contains reflections on the difficult nature of knowing anything about a person who never committed any of his ideas to the written word. Much of what is known about Socrates comes to us from Plato, although Socrates appears in the works of other ancient writers as well as those who follow Plato in the history of philosophy. This article recognizes that finding the original Socrates may be impossible, but it attempts to achieve a close approximation.

Biography: Who was Socrates?
1. The Historical Socrates
  1. Birth and Early Life
  2. Later Life and Trial
    1. The Peloponnesian War and the Threat to Democracy
    2. Greek Religion and Socrates’ Impiety
2. The Socratic Problem: the Philosophical Socrates
Content: What does Socrates Think?
Method: How Did Socrates Do Philosophy?
Legacy: How Have Other Philosophers Understood Socrates?
1. Hellenistic Philosophy
2. Modern Philosophy
  1. Hegel
  2. Kierkegaard
  3. Nietzsche
  4. Heidegger
  5. Gadamer
References and Further Reading

1. Biography: Who was Socrates?

a. The Historical Socrates

i. Birth and Early Life

Socrates was born in Athens in the year 469 B.C.E. to Sophroniscus, a stonemason, and Phaenarete, a midwife. His family was not extremely poor, but they were by no means wealthy, and Socrates could not claim that he was of noble birth like Plato. He grew up in the political deme or district of Alopece, and when he turned 18, began to perform the typical political duties required of Athenian males. These included compulsory military service and membership in the Assembly, the governing body responsible for determining military strategy and legislation.

In a culture that worshipped male beauty, Socrates had the misfortune of being born incredibly ugly. Many of our ancient sources attest to his rather awkward physical appearance, and Plato more than once makes reference to it (Theaetetus 143e, Symposium, 215a-c; also Xenophon Symposium 4.19, 5.5-7 and Aristophanes Clouds 362). Socrates was exophthalmic, meaning that his eyes bulged out of his head and were not straight but focused sideways. He had a snub nose, which made him resemble a pig, and many sources depict him with a potbelly. Socrates did little to help his odd appearance, frequently wearing the same cloak and sandals throughout both the day and the evening. Plato’s Symposium (174a) offers us one of the few accounts of his caring for his appearance.

As a young man Socrates was given an education appropriate for a person of his station. By the middle of the 5^th century B.C.E., all Athenian males were taught to read and write. Sophroniscus, however, also took pains to give his son an advanced cultural education in poetry, music, and athletics. In both Plato and Xenophon, we find a Socrates that is well versed in poetry, talented at music, and quite at-home in the gymnasium. In accordance with Athenian custom, his father also taught him a trade, though Socrates did not labor at it on a daily basis. Rather, he spent his days in the agora (the Athenian marketplace), asking questions of those who would speak with him. While he was poor, he quickly acquired a following of rich young aristocrats—one of whom was Plato—who particularly enjoyed hearing him interrogate those that were purported to be the wisest and most influential men in the city.

Socrates was married to Xanthippe, and according to some sources, had a second wife. Most suggest that he first married Xanthippe, and that she gave birth to his first son, Lamprocles. He is alleged to have married his second wife, Myrto, without dowry, and she gave birth to his other two sons, Sophroniscus and Menexenus. Various accounts attribute Sophroniscus to Xanthippe, while others even suggest that Socrates was married to both women simultaneously because of a shortage of males in Athens at the time. In accordance with Athenian custom, Socrates was open about his physical attraction to young men, though he always subordinated his physical desire for them to his desire that they improve the condition of their souls.

Socrates fought valiantly during his time in the Athenian military. Just before the Peloponnesian War with Sparta began in 431 B.C.E, he helped the Athenians win the battle of Potidaea (432 B.C.E.), after which he saved the life of Alcibiades, the famous Athenian general. He also fought as one of 7,000 hoplites aside 20,000 troops at the battle of Delium (424 B.C.E.) and once more at the battle of Amphipolis (422 B.C.E.). Both battles were defeats for Athens.

Despite his continued service to his city, many members of Athenian society perceived Socrates to be a threat to their democracy, and it is this suspicion that largely contributed to his conviction in court. It is therefore imperative to understand the historical context in which his trial was set.

ii. Later Life and Trial

1. The Peloponnesian War and the Threat to Democracy

Between 431—404 B.C.E. Athens fought one of its bloodiest and most protracted conflicts with neighboring Sparta, the war that we now know as the Peloponnesian War. Aside from the fact that Socrates fought in the conflict, it is important for an account of his life and trial because many of those with whom Socrates spent his time became either sympathetic to the Spartan cause at the very least or traitors to Athens at worst. This is particularly the case with those from the more aristocratic Athenian families, who tended to favor the rigid and restricted hierarchy of power in Sparta instead of the more widespread democratic distribution of power and free speech to all citizens that obtained in Athens. Plato more than once places in the mouth of his character Socrates praise for Sparta (Protagoras 342b, Crito 53a; cf. Republic 544c in which most people think the Spartan constitution is the best). The political regime of the Republic is marked by a small group of ruling elites that preside over the citizens of the ideal city.

There are a number of important historical moments throughout the war leading up to Socrates’ trial that figure in the perception of him as a traitor. Seven years after the battle of Amphipolis, the Athenian navy was set to invade the island of Sicily, when a number of statues in the city called “herms”, dedicated to the god Hermes, protector of travelers, were destroyed. Dubbed the ‘Mutilation of the Herms’ (415 B.C.E.), this event engendered not only a fear of those who might seek to undermine the democracy, but those who did not respect the gods. In conjunction with these crimes, Athens witnessed the profanation of the Eleusinian mysteries, religious rituals that were to be conducted only in the presence of priests but that were in this case performed in private homes without official sanction or recognition of any kind. Amongst those accused and persecuted on suspicion of involvement in the crimes were a number of Socrates’ associates, including Alcibiades, who was recalled from his position leading the expedition in Sicily. Rather than face prosecution for the crime, Alcibiades escaped and sought asylum in Sparta.

Though Alcibiades was not the only of Socrates’ associates implicated in the sacrilegious crimes (Charmides and Critias were suspected as well), he is arguably the most important. Socrates had by many counts been in love with Alcibiades and Plato depicts him pursuing or speaking of his love for him in many dialogues (Symposium 213c-d, Protagoras 309a, Gorgias 481d, Alcibiades I 103a-104c, 131e-132a). Alcibiades is typically portrayed as a wandering soul (Alcibiades I 117c-d), not committed to any one consistent way of life or definition of justice. Instead, he was a kind of cameleon-like flatterer that could change and mold himself in order to please crowds and win political favor (Gorgias 482a). In 411 B.C.E., a group of citizens opposed to the Athenian democracy led a coup against the government in hopes of establishing an oligarchy. Though the democrats put down the coup later that year and recalled Alcibiades to lead the Athenian fleet in the Hellespont, he aided the oligarchs by securing for them an alliance with the Persian satraps. Alcibiades therefore did not just aid the Spartan cause but allied himself with Persian interests as well. His association with the two principal enemies of Athens reflected poorly on Socrates, and Xenophon tells us that Socrates’ repeated association with and love for Alcibiades was instrumental in the suspicion that he was a Spartan apologist.

Sparta finally defeated Athens in 404 B.C.E., just five years before Socrates’ trial and execution. Instead of a democracy, they installed as rulers a small group of Athenians who were loyal to Spartan interests. Known as “The Thirty” or sometimes as the “Thirty Tyrants”, they were led by Critias, a known associate of Socrates and a member of his circle. Critias’ nephew Charmides, about whom we have a Platonic dialogue of the same name, was also a member. Though Critias put forth a law prohibiting Socrates from conducting discussions with young men under the age of 30, Socrates’ earlier association with him—as well as his willingness to remain in Athens and endure the rule of the Thirty rather than flee—further contributed to the growing suspicion that Socrates was opposed to the democratic ideals of his city.

The Thirty ruled tyrannically—executing a number of wealthy Athenians as well as confiscating their property, arbitrarily arresting those with democratic sympathies, and exiling many others—until they were overthrown in 403 B.C.E. by a group of democratic exiles returning to the city. Both Critias and Charmides were killed and, after a Spartan-sponsored peace accord, the democracy was restored. The democrats proclaimed a general amnesty in the city and thereby prevented politically motivated legal prosecutions aimed at redressing the terrible losses incurred during the reign of the Thirty. Their hope was to maintain unity during the reestablishment of their democracy.

One of Socrates’ main accusers, Anytus, was one of the democratic exiles that returned to the city to assist in the overthrow of the Thirty. Plato’s Meno, set in the year 402 B.C.E., imagines a conversation between Socrates and Anytus in which the latter argues that any citizen of Athens can teach virtue, an especially democratic view insofar as it assumes knowledge of how to live well is not the restricted domain of the esoteric elite or privileged few. In the discussion, Socrates argues that if one wants to know about virtue, one should consult an expert on virtue (Meno 91b-94e). The political turmoil of the city, rebuilding itself as a democracy after nearly thirty years of destruction and bloodshed, constituted a context in which many citizens were especially fearful of threats to their democracy that came not from the outside, but from within their own city.

While many of his fellow citizens found considerable evidence against Socrates, there was also historical evidence in addition to his military service for the case that he was not just a passive but an active supporter of the democracy. For one thing, just as he had associates that were known oligarchs, he also had associates that were supporters of the democracy, including the metic family of Cephalus and Socrates’ friend Chaerephon, the man who reported that the oracle at Delphi had proclaimed that no man was wiser than Socrates. Additionally, when he was ordered by the Thirty to help retrieve the democratic general Leon from the island of Salamis for execution, he refused to do so. His refusal could be understood not as the defiance of a legitimately established government but rather his allegiance to the ideals of due process that were in effect under the previously instituted democracy. Indeed, in Plato’s Crito, Socrates refuses to escape from prison on the grounds that he lived his whole life with an implied agreement with the laws of the democracy (Crito 50a-54d). Notwithstanding these facts, there was profound suspicion that Socrates was a threat to the democracy in the years after the end of the Peloponnesian War. But because of the amnesty, Anytus and his fellow accusers Meletus and Lycon were prevented from bringing suit against Socrates on political grounds. They opted instead for religious grounds.

2. Greek Religion and Socrates’ Impiety

Because of the amnesty the charges made against Socrates were framed in religious terms. As recounted by Diogenes Laertius (1.5.40), the charges were stated as follows: “Socrates does criminal wrong by not recognizing the gods that the city recognizes, and furthermore by introducing new divinities; and he also does criminal wrong by corrupting the youth” (other accounts: Xenophon Memorabilia I.I.1 and Apology 11-12, Plato, Apology 24b and Euthyphro 2c-3b). Many people understood the charge about corrupting the youth to signify that Socrates taught his subversive views to others, a claim that he adamantly denies in his defense speech by claiming that he has no wisdom to teach (Plato, Apology 20c) and that he cannot be held responsible for the actions of those that heard him speak (Plato, Apology 33a-c).

It is now customary to refer to the principal written accusation on the deposition submitted to the Athenian court as an accusation of impiety, or unholiness. Rituals, ceremonies, and sacrifices that were officially sanctioned by the city and its officials marked ancient Greek religion. The sacred was woven into the everyday experience of citizens who demonstrated their piety by correctly observing their ancestral traditions. Interpretation of the gods at their temples was the exclusive domain of priests appointed and recognized by the city. The boundary and separation between the religious and the secular that we find in many countries today therefore did not obtain in Athens. A religious crime was consequently an offense not just against the gods, but also against the city itself.

Socrates and his contemporaries lived in a polytheistic society, a society in which the gods did not create the world but were themselves created. Socrates would have been brought up with the stories of the gods recounted in Hesiod and Homer, in which the gods were not omniscient, omnibenevolent, or eternal, but rather power-hungry super-creatures that regularly intervened in the affairs of human beings. One thinks for example of Aphrodite saving Paris from death at the hands of Menelaus (Homer, Iliad 3.369-382) or Zeus sending Apollo to rescue the corpse of Sarpedon after his death in battle (Homer, Iliad 16.667-684). Human beings were to fear the gods, sacrifice to them, and honor them with festivals and prayers.

Socrates instead seemed to have a conception of the divine as always benevolent, truthful, authoritative, and wise. For him, divinity always operated in accordance with the standards of rationality. This conception of divinity, however, dispenses with the traditional conception of prayer and sacrifice as motivated by hopes for material payoff. Socrates’ theory of the divine seemed to make the most important rituals and sacrifices in the city entirely useless, for if the gods are all good, they will benefit human beings regardless of whether or not human beings make offerings to them. Jurors at his trial might have thought that, without the expectation of material reward or protection from the gods, Socrates was disconnecting religion from its practical roots and its connection with the civic identity of the city.

While Socrates was critical of blind acceptance of the gods and the myths we find in Hesiod and Homer, this in itself was not unheard of in Athens at the time. Solon, Xenophanes, Heraclitus, and Euripides had all spoken against the capriciousness and excesses of the gods without incurring penalty. It is possible to make the case that Socrates’ jurors might not have indicted him solely on questioning the gods or even of interrogating the true meaning of piety. Indeed, there was no legal definition of piety in Athens at the time, and jurors were therefore in a similar situation to the one in which we find Socrates in Plato’s Euthyphro, that is, in need of an inquiry into what the nature of piety truly is. What seems to have concerned the jurors was not only Socrates’ challenge to the traditional interpretation of the gods of the city, but his seeming allegiance to an entirely novel divine being, unfamiliar to anyone in the city.

This new divine being is what is known as Socrates’ daimon. Though it has become customary to think of a daimon as a spirit or quasi-divinity (for example, Symposium 202e-203a), in ancient Greek religion it was not solely a specific class of divine being but rather a mode of activity, a force that drives a person when no particular divine agent can be named (Burkett, 180). Socrates claimed to have heard a sign or voice from his days as a child that accompanied him and forbid him to pursue certain courses of action (Plato, Apology 31c-d, 40a-b, Euthydemus 272e-273a, Euthyphro 3b, Phaedrus 242b, Theages 128-131a, Theaetetus 150c-151b, Rep 496c; Xenophon, Apology 12, Memorabilia 1.1.3-5). Xenophon adds that the sign also issued positive commands (Memorablia 1.1.4, 4.3.12, 4.8.1, Apology 12). This sign was accessible only to Socrates, private and internal to his own mind. Whether Socrates received moral knowledge of any sort from the sign is a matter of scholarly debate, but beyond doubt is the strangeness of Socrates’ insistence that he took private instructions from a deity that was unlicensed by the city. For all the jurors knew, the deity could have been hostile to Athenian interests. Socrates’ daimon was therefore extremely influential in his indictment on the charge of worshipping new gods unknown to the city (Plato, Euthyphro 3b, Xenophon, Memorabilia I.1.2).

Whereas in Plato’s Apology Socrates makes no attempt to reconcile his divine sign with traditional views of piety, Xenophon’s Socrates argues that just as there are those who rely on birdcalls and receive guidance from voices, so he too is influenced by his daimon. However, Socrates had no officially sanctioned religious role in the city. As such, his attempt to assimilate himself to a seer or necromancer appointed by the city to interpret divine signs actually may have undermined his innocence, rather than help to establish it. His insistence that he had direct, personal access to the divine made him appear guilty to enough jurors that he was sentenced to death.

b. The Socratic Problem: the Philosophical Socrates

The Socratic problem is the problem faced by historians of philosophy when attempting to reconstruct the ideas of the original Socrates as distinct from his literary representations. While we know many of the historical details of Socrates’ life and the circumstances surrounding his trial, Socrates’ identity as a philosopher is much more difficult to establish. Because he wrote nothing, what we know of his ideas and methods comes to us mainly from his contemporaries and disciples.

There were a number of Socrates’ followers who wrote conversations in which he appears. These works are what are known as the logoi sokratikoi, or Socratic accounts. Aside from Plato and Xenophon, most of these dialogues have not survived. What we know of them comes to us from other sources. For example, very little survives from the dialogues of Antisthenes, whom Xenophon reports as one of Socrates’ leading disciples. Indeed, from polemics written by the rhetor Isocrates, some scholars have concluded that he was the most prominent Socratic in Athens for the first decade following Socrates’ death. Diogenes Laertius (6.10-13) attributes to Antisthenes a number of views that we recognize as Socratic, including that virtue is sufficient for happiness, the wise man is self-sufficient, only the virtuous are noble, the virtuous are friends, and good things are morally fine and bad things are base.

Aeschines of Sphettus wrote seven dialogues, all of which have been lost. It is possible for us to reconstruct the plots of two of them: the Alcibiades—in which Socrates shames Alcibiades into admitting he needs Socrates’ help to be virtuous—and the Aspasia—in which Socrates recommends the famous wife of Pericles as a teacher for the son of Callias. Aeschines’ dialogues focus on Socrates’ ability to help his interlocutor acquire self-knowledge and better himself.

Phaedo of Elis wrote two dialogues. His central use of Socrates is to show that philosophy can improve anyone regardless of his social class or natural talents. Euclides of Megara wrote six dialogues, about which we know only their titles. Diogenes Laertius reports that he held that the good is one, that insight and prudence are different names for the good, and that what is opposed to the good does not exist. All three are Socratic themes. Lastly, Aristippus of Cyrene wrote no Socratic dialogues but is alleged to have written a work entitled To Socrates.

The two Socratics on whom most of our philosophical understanding of Socrates depends are Plato and Xenophon. Scholars also rely on the works of the comic playwright Aristophanes and Plato’s most famous student, Aristotle.

i. Origin of the Socratic Problem

The Socratic problem first became pronounced in the early 19^th century with the influential work of Friedrich Schleiermacher. Until this point, scholars had largely turned to Xenophon to identify what the historical Socrates thought. Schleiermacher argued that Xenophon was not a philosopher but rather a simple citizen-soldier, and that his Socrates was so dull and philosophically uninteresting that, reading Xenophon alone, it would be difficult to understand the reputation accorded Socrates by so many of his contemporaries and nearly all the schools of philosophy that followed him. The better portrait of Socrates, Schleiermacher claimed, comes to us from Plato.

Though many scholars have since jettisoned Xenophon as a legitimate source for representing the philosophical views of the historical Socrates, they remain divided over the reliability of the other three sources. For one thing, Aristophanes was a comic playwright, and therefore took considerable poetic license when scripting his characters. Aristotle, born 15 years after Socrates’ death, hears about Socrates primarily from Plato. Plato himself wrote dialogues or philosophical dramas, and thus cannot be understood to be presenting his readers with exact replicas or transcriptions of conversations that Socrates actually had. Furthermore, many scholars think that Plato’s so-called middle and late dialogues do not present the views of the historical Socrates.

We therefore see the difficult nature of the Socratic problem: because we don’t seem to have any consistently reliable sources, finding the true Socrates or the original Socrates proves to be an impossible task. What we are left with, instead, is a composite picture assembled from various literary and philosophical components that give us what we might think of as Socratic themes or motifs.

ii. Aristophanes

Born in 450 B.C.E., Aristophanes wrote a number of comic plays intended to satirize and caricature many of his fellow Athenians. His Clouds (423 B.C.E.) was so instrumental in parodying Socrates and painting him as a dangerous intellectual capable of corrupting the entire city that Socrates felt compelled in his trial defense to allude to the bad reputation he acquired as a result of the play (Plato, Apology 18a-b, 19c). Aristophanes was much closer in age to Socrates than Plato and Xenophon, and as such is the only one of our sources exposed to Socrates in his younger years.

In the play, Socrates is the head of a phrontistêrion, a school of learning where students are taught the nature of the heavens and how to win court cases. Socrates appears in a swing high above the stage, purportedly to better study the heavens. His patron deities, the clouds, represent his interest in meteorology and may also symbolize the lofty nature of reasoning that may take either side of an argument. The main plot of the play centers on an indebted man called Strepsiades, whose son Phidippides ends up in the school to learn how to help his father avoid paying off his debts. By the end of the play, Phidippides has beaten his father, arguing that it is perfectly reasonable to do so on the grounds that, just as it is acceptable for a father to spank his son for his own good, so it is acceptable for a son to hit a father for his own good. In addition to the theme that Socrates corrupts the youth, we therefore also find in the Clouds the origin of the rumor that Socrates makes the stronger argument the weaker and the weaker argument the stronger. Indeed, the play features a personification of the Stronger Argument—which represents traditional education and values—attacked by the Weaker Argument—which advocates a life of pleasure.

While the Clouds is Aristophanes’ most famous and comprehensive attack on Socrates, Socrates appears in other of his comedies as well. In the Birds (414 B.C.E.), Aristophanes coins a Greek verb based on Socrates’ name to insinuate that Socrates was truly a Spartan sympathizer (1280-83). Young men who were found “Socratizing” were expressing their admiration of Sparta and its customs. And in the Frogs (405), the Chorus claims that it is not refined to keep company with Socrates, who ignores the poets and wastes time with ‘frivolous words’ and ‘pompous word-scraping’ (1491-1499).

Aristophanes’ Socrates is a kind of variegated caricature of trends and new ideas emerging in Athens that he believed were threatening to the city. We find a number of such themes prevalent in Presocratic philosophy and the teachings of the Sophists, including those about natural science, mathematics, social science, ethics, political philosophy, and the art of words. Amongst other things, Aristophanes was troubled by the displacement of the divine through scientific explanations of the world and the undermining of traditional morality and custom by explanations of cultural life that appealed to nature instead of the gods. Additionally, he was reticent about teaching skill in disputation, for fear that a clever speaker could just as easily argue for the truth as argue against it. These issues constitute what is sometimes called the “new learning” developing in 5^th century B.C.E. Athens, for which the Aristophanic Socrates is the iconic symbol.

iii. Xenophon

Born in the same decade as Plato (425 B.C.E.), Xenophon lived in the political deme of Erchia. Though he knew Socrates he would not have had as much contact with him as Plato did. He was not present in the courtroom on the day of Socrates’ trial, but rather heard an account of it later on from Hermogenes, a member of Socrates’ circle. His depiction of Socrates is found principally in four works: Apology—in which Socrates gives a defense of his life before his jurors—Memorabilia—in which Xenophon himself explicates the charges against Socrates and tries to defend him—Symposium—a conversation between Socrates and his friends at a drinking party—and Oeconomicus—a Socratic discourse on estate management. Socrates also appears in Xenophon’s Hellenica and Anabasis.

Xenophon’s reputation as a source on the life and ideas of Socrates is one on which scholars do not always agree. Largely thought to be a significant source of information about Socrates before the 19^th century, for most of the 20^th century Xenophon’s ability to depict Socrates as a philosopher was largely called into question. Following Schleiermacher, many argued that Xenophon himself was either a bad philosopher who did not understand Socrates, or not a philosopher at all, more concerned with practical, everyday matters like economics. However, recent scholarship has sought to challenge this interpretation, arguing that it assumes an understanding of philosophy as an exclusively speculative and critical endeavor that does not attend to the ancient conception of philosophy as a comprehensive way of life.

While Plato will likely always remain the principal source on Socrates and Socratic themes, Xenophon’s Socrates is distinct in philosophically interesting ways. He emphasizes the values of self-mastery (enkrateia), endurance of physical pain (karteria), and self-sufficiency (autarkeia). For Xenophon’s Socrates, self-mastery or moderation is the foundation of virtue (Memorabilia, 1.5.4). Whereas in Plato’s Apology the oracle tells Chaerephon that no one is wiser than Socrates, in Xenophon’s Apology Socrates claims that the oracle told Chaerephon that “no man was more free than I, more just, and more moderate” (Xenophon, Apology, 14).

Part of Socrates’ freedom consists in his freedom from want, precisely because he has mastered himself. As opposed to Plato’s Socrates, Xenophon’s Socrates is not poor, not because he has much, but because he needs little. Oeconomicus 11.3 for instance shows Socrates displeased with those who think him poor. One can be rich even with very little on the condition that one has limited his needs, for wealth is just the excess of what one has over what one requires. Socrates is rich because what he has is sufficient for what he needs (Memorabilia 1.2.1, 1.3.5, 4.2.38-9).

We also find Xenophon attributing to Socrates a proof of the existence of God. The argument holds that human beings are the product of an intelligent design, and we therefore should conclude that there is a God who is the maker (dēmiourgos) or designer of all things (Memorabilia 1.4.2-7). God creates a systematically ordered universe and governs it in the way our minds govern our bodies (Memorabilia 1.4.1-19, 4.3.1-18). While Plato’s Timaeus tells the story of a dēmiourgos creating the world, it is Timaeus, not Socrates, who tells the story. Indeed, Socrates speaks only sparingly at the beginning of the dialogue, and most scholars do not count as Socratic the cosmological arguments therein.

iv. Plato

Plato was Socrates’ most famous disciple, and the majority of what most people know about Socrates is known about Plato’s Socrates. Plato was born to one of the wealthiest and politically influential families in Athens in 427 B.C.E., the son of Ariston and Perictione. His brothers were Glaucon and Adeimantus, who are Socrates’ principal interlocutors for the majority of the Republic. Though Socrates is not present in every Platonic dialogue, he is in the majority of them, often acting as the main interlocutor who drives the conversation.

The attempt to extract Socratic views from Plato’s texts is itself a notoriously difficult problem, bound up with questions about the order in which Plato composed his dialogues, one’s methodological approach to reading them, and whether or not Socrates, or anyone else for that matter, speaks for Plato. Readers interested in the details of this debate should consult “Plato.” Generally speaking, the predominant view of Plato’s Socrates in the English-speaking world from the middle to the end of the 20^th century was simply that he was Plato’s mouthpiece. In other words, anything Socrates says in the dialogues is what Plato thought at the time he wrote the dialogue. This view, put forth by the famous Plato scholar Gregory Vlastos, has been challenged in recent years, with some scholars arguing that Plato has no mouthpiece in the dialogues (see Cooper xxi-xxiii). While we can attribute to Plato certain doctrines that are consistent throughout his corpus, there is no reason to think that Socrates, or any other speaker, always and consistently espouses these doctrines.

The main interpretive obstacle for those seeking the views of Socrates from Plato is the question of the order of the dialogues. Thrasyllus, the 1^st century (C.E.) Platonist who was the first to arrange the dialogues according to a specific paradigm, organized the dialogues into nine tetralogies, or groups of four, on the basis of the order in which he believed they should be read. Another approach, customary for most scholars by the late 20^th century, groups the dialogues into three categories on the basis of the order in which Plato composed them. Plato begins his career, so the narrative goes, representing his teacher Socrates in typically short conversations about ethics, virtue, and the best human life. These are “early” dialogues. Only subsequently does Plato develop his own philosophical views—the most famous of which is the doctrine of the Forms or Ideas—that Socrates defends. These “middle” dialogues put forth positive doctrines that are generally thought to be Platonic and not Socratic. Finally, towards the end of his life, Plato composes dialogues in which Socrates typically either hardly features at all or is altogether absent. These are the “late” dialogues.

There are a number of complications with this interpretive thesis, and many of them focus on the portrayal of Socrates. Though the Gorgias is an early dialogue, Socrates concludes the dialogue with a myth that some scholars attribute to a Pythagorean influence on Plato that he would not have had during Socrates’ lifetime. Though the Parmenides is a middle dialogue, the younger Socrates speaks only at the beginning before Parmenides alone speaks for the remainder of the dialogue. While the Philebus is a late dialogue, Socrates is the main speaker. Some scholars identify the Meno as an early dialogue because Socrates refutes Meno’s attempts to articulate the nature of virtue. Others, focusing on Socrates’ use of the theory of recollection and the method of hypothesis, argue that it is a middle dialogue. Finally, while Plato’s most famous work the Republic is a middle dialogue, some scholars make a distinction within the Republic itself. The first book, they argue, is Socratic, because in it we find Socrates refuting Thrasymachus’ definition of justice while maintaining that he knows nothing about justice. The rest of the dialogue they claim, with its emphasis on the division of the soul and the metaphysics of the Forms, is Platonic.

To discern a consistent Socrates in Plato is therefore a difficult task. Instead of speaking about chronology of composition, contemporary scholars searching for views that are likely to have been associated with the historical Socrates generally focus on a group of dialogues that are united by topical similarity. These “Socratic dialogues” feature Socrates as the principal speaker, challenging his interlocutor to elaborate on and critically examine his own views while typically not putting forth substantive claims of his own. These dialogues—including those that some scholars think are not written by Plato and those that most scholars agree are not written by Plato but that Thrasyllus included in his collection—are as follows: Euthyphro, Apology, Crito, Alcibiades I, Alcibiades II, Hipparchus, Rival Lovers, Theages, Charmides, Laches, Lysis, Euthydemus, Protagoras, Gorgias, Meno, Greater Hippias, Lesser Hippias, Ion, Menexenus, Clitophon, Minos. Some of the more famous positions Socrates defends in these dialogues are covered in the content section.

v. Aristotle

Aristotle was born in 384 B.C.E., 15 years after the death of Socrates. At the age of eighteen, he went to study at Plato’s Academy, and remained there for twenty years. Afterwards, he traveled throughout Asia and was invited by Phillip II of Macedon to tutor his son Alexander, known to history as Alexander the Great. While Aristotle would never have had the chance to meet Socrates, we have in his writings an account of both Socrates’ method and the topics about which he had conversations. Given the likelihood that Aristotle heard about Socrates from Plato and those at his Academy, it is not surprising that most of what he says about Socrates follows the depiction of him in the Platonic dialogues.

Aristotle related four concrete points about Socrates. The first is that Socrates asked questions without supplying an answer of his own, because he claimed to know nothing (De Elenchis Sophisticus 1836b6-8). The picture of Socrates here is consistent with that of Plato’s Apology. Second, Aristotle claims that Socrates never asked questions about nature, but concerned himself only with ethical questions. Aristotle thus attributes to the historical Socrates both the method and topics we find in Plato’s Socratic dialogues.

Third, Aristotle claims that Socrates is the first to have employed epagōgē, a word typically rendered in English as “induction.” This translation, however, is misleading, lest we impute to Socrates a preference for inductive reasoning as opposed to deductive reasoning. The term better indicates that Socrates was fond or arguing via the use of analogy. For instance, just as a doctor does not practice medicine for himself but for the best interest of his patient, so the ruler in the city takes no account of his own personal profit, but is rather interested in caring for his citizens (Republic 342d-e).

The fourth and final claim Aristotle makes about Socrates itself has two parts. First, Socrates was the first to ask the question, ti esti: what is it? For example, if someone were to suggest to Socrates that our children should grow up to be courageous, he would ask, what is courage? That is, what is the universal definition or nature that holds for all examples of courage? Second, as distinguished from Plato, Socrates did not separate universals from their particular instantiations. For Plato, the noetic object, the knowable thing, is the separate universal, not the particular. Socrates simply asked the “what is it” question (on this and the previous two points, see Metaphysics I.6.987a29-b14; cf. b22-24, b27-33, and see XIII.4.1078b12-34).

2. Content: What does Socrates Think?

Given the nature of these sources, the task of recounting what Socrates thought is not an easy one. Nonetheless, reading Plato’s Apology, it is possible to articulate a number of what scholars today typically associate with Socrates. Plato the author has his Socrates claim that Plato was present in the courtroom for Socrates’ defense (Apology 34a), and while this cannot mean that Plato records the defense as a word for word transcription, it is the closest thing we have to an account of what Socrates actually said at a concrete point in his life.

a. Presocratic Philosophy and the Sophists

Socrates opens his defense speech by defending himself against his older accusers (Apology 18a), claiming they have poisoned the minds of his jurors since they were all young men. Amongst these accusers was Aristophanes. In addition to the claim that Socrates makes the worse argument into the stronger, there is a rumor that Socrates idles the day away talking about things in the sky and below the earth. His reply is that he never discusses such topics (Apology 18a-c). Socrates is distinguishing himself here not just from the sophists and their alleged ability to invert the strength of arguments, but from those we have now come to call the Presocratic philosophers.

The Presocratics were not just those who came before Socrates, for there are some Presocratic philosophers who were his contemporaries. The term is sometimes used to suggest that, while Socrates cared about ethics, the Presocratic philosophers did not. This is misleading, for we have evidence that a number of Presocratics explored ethical issues. The term is best used to refer to the group of thinkers whom Socrates did not influence and whose fundamental uniting characteristic was that they sought to explain the world in terms of its own inherent principles. The 6^th cn. Milesian Thales, for instance, believed that the fundamental principle of all things was water. Anaximander believed the principle was the indefinite (apeiron), and for Anaxamines it was air. Later in Plato’s Apology (26d-e), Socrates rhetorically asks whether Meletus thinks he is prosecuting Anaxagoras, the 5^th cn. thinker who argued that the universe was originally a mixture of elements that have since been set in motion by Nous, or Mind. Socrates suggests that he does not engage in the same sort of cosmological inquiries that were the main focus of many Presocratics.

The other group against which Socrates compares himself is the Sophists, learned men who travelled from city to city offering to teach the youth for a fee. While he claims he thinks it an admirable thing to teach as Gorgias, Prodicus, or Hippias claim they can (Apology 20a), he argues that he himself does not have knowledge of human excellence or virtue (Apology 20b-c). Though Socrates inquires after the nature of virtue, he does not claim to know it, and certainly does not ask to be paid for his conversations.

b. Socratic Themes in Plato’s Apology

i. Socratic Ignorance

Plato’s Socrates moves next to explain the reason he has acquired the reputation he has and why so many citizens dislike him. The oracle at Delphi told Socrates’ friend Chaerephon, “no one is wiser than Socrates” (Apology 21a). Socrates explains that he was not aware of any wisdom he had, and so set out to find someone who had wisdom in order to demonstrate that the oracle was mistaken. He first went to the politicians but found them lacking wisdom. He next visited the poets and found that, though they spoke in beautiful verses, they did so through divine inspiration, not because they had wisdom of any kind. Finally, Socrates found that the craftsmen had knowledge of their own craft, but that they subsequently believed themselves to know much more than they actually did. Socrates concluded that he was better off than his fellow citizens because, while they thought they knew something and did not, he was aware of his own ignorance. The god who speaks through the oracle, he says, is truly wise, whereas human wisdom is worth little or nothing (Apology 23a).

This awareness of one’s own absence of knowledge is what is known as Socratic ignorance, and it is arguably the thing for which Socrates is most famous. Socratic ignorance is sometimes called simple ignorance, to be distinguished from the double ignorance of the citizens with whom Socrates spoke. Simple ignorance is being aware of one’s own ignorance, whereas double ignorance is not being aware of one’s ignorance while thinking that one knows. In showing many influential figures in Athens that they did not know what they thought they did, Socrates came to be despised in many circles.

It is worth nothing that Socrates does not claim here that he knows nothing. He claims that he is aware of his ignorance and that whatever it is that he does know is worthless. Socrates has a number of strong convictions about what makes for an ethical life, though he cannot articulate precisely why these convictions are true. He believes for instance that it is never just to harm anyone, whether friend or enemy, but he does not, at least in Book I of the Republic, offer a systematic account of the nature of justice that could demonstrate why this is true. Because of his insistence on repeated inquiry, Socrates has refined his convictions such that he can both hold particular views about justice while maintaining that he does not know the complete nature of justice.

We can see this contrast quite clearly in Socrates’ cross-examination of his accuser Meletus. Because he is charged with corrupting the youth, Socrates inquires after who it is that helps the youth (Apology, 24d-25a). In the same way that we take a horse to a horse trainer to improve it, Socrates wants to know the person to whom we take a young person to educate him and improve him. Meletus’ silence condemns him: he has never bothered to reflect on such matters, and therefore is unaware of his ignorance about matters that are the foundation of his own accusation (Apology 25b-c). Whether or not Socrates—or Plato for that matter—actually thinks it is possible to achieve expertise in virtue is a subject on which scholars disagree.

ii. Priority of the Care of the Soul

Throughout his defense speech (Apology 20a-b, 24c-25c, 31b, 32d, 36c, 39d) Socrates repeatedly stresses that a human being must care for his soul more than anything else (see also Crito 46c-47d, Euthyphro 13b-c, Gorgias 520a4ff). Socrates found that his fellow citizens cared more for wealth, reputation, and their bodies while neglecting their souls (Apology 29d-30b). He believed that his mission from the god was to examine his fellow citizens and persuade them that the most important good for a human being was the health of the soul. Wealth, he insisted, does not bring about human excellence or virtue, but virtue makes wealth and everything else good for human beings (Apology 30b).

Socrates believes that his mission of caring for souls extends to the entirety of the city of Athens. He argues that the god gave him to the city as a gift and that his mission is to help improve the city. He thus attempts to show that he is not guilty of impiety precisely because everything he does is in response to the oracle and at the service of the god. Socrates characterizes himself as a gadfly and the city as a sluggish horse in need of stirring up (Apology 30e). Without philosophical inquiry, the democracy becomes stagnant and complacent, in danger of harming itself and others. Just as the gadfly is an irritant to the horse but rouses it to action, so Socrates supposes that his purpose is to agitate those around him so that they begin to examine themselves. One might compare this claim with Socrates’ assertion in the Gorgias that, while his contemporaries aim at gratification, he practices the true political craft because he aims at what is best (521d-e). Such comments, in addition to the historical evidence that we have, are Socrates’ strongest defense that he is not only not a burden to the democracy but a great asset to it.

iii. The Unexamined Life

After the jury has convicted Socrates and sentenced him to death, he makes one of the most famous proclamations in the history of philosophy. He tells the jury that he could never keep silent, because “the unexamined life is not worth living for human beings” (Apology 38a). We find here Socrates’ insistence that we are all called to reflect upon what we believe, account for what we know and do not know, and generally speaking to seek out, live in accordance with, and defend those views that make for a well lived and meaningful life.

Some scholars call attention to Socrates’ emphasis on human nature here, and argue that the call to live examined lives follows from our nature as human beings. We are naturally directed by pleasure and pain. We are drawn to power, wealth and reputation, the sorts of values to which Athenians were drawn as well. Socrates’ call to live examined lives is not necessarily an insistence to reject all such motivations and inclinations but rather an injunction to appraise their true worth for the human soul. The purpose of the examined life is to reflect upon our everyday motivations and values and to subsequently inquire into what real worth, if any, they have. If they have no value or indeed are even harmful, it is upon us to pursue those things that are truly valuable.

One can see in reading the Apology that Socrates examines the lives of his jurors during his own trial. By asserting the primacy of the examined life after he has been convicted and sentenced to death, Socrates, the prosecuted, becomes the prosecutor, surreptitiously accusing those who convicted him of not living a life that respects their own humanity. He tells them that by killing him they will not escape examining their lives. To escape giving an account of one’s life is neither possible nor good, Socrates claims, but it is best to prepare oneself to be as good as possible (Apology 39d-e).

We find here a conception of a well-lived life that differs from one that would likely be supported by many contemporary philosophers. Today, most philosophers would argue that we must live ethical lives (though what this means is of course a matter of debate) but that it is not necessary for everyone to engage in the sort of discussions Socrates had every day, nor must one do so in order to be considered a good person. A good person, we might say, lives a good life insofar as he does what is just, but he does not necessarily need to be consistently engaged in debates about the nature of justice or the purpose of the state. No doubt Socrates would disagree, not just because the law might be unjust or the state might do too much or too little, but because, insofar as we are human beings, self-examination is always beneficial to us.

c. Other Socratic Positions and Arguments

In addition to the themes one finds in the Apology, the following are a number of other positions in the Platonic corpus that are typically considered Socratic.

i. Unity of Virtue; All Virtue is Knowledge

In the Protagoras (329b-333b) Socrates argues for the view that all of the virtues—justice, wisdom, courage, piety, and so forth—are one. He provides a number of arguments for this thesis. For example, while it is typical to think that one can be wise without being temperate, Socrates rejects this possibility on the grounds that wisdom and temperance both have the same opposite: folly. Were they truly distinct, they would each have their own opposites. As it stands, the identity of their opposites indicates that one cannot possess wisdom without temperance and vice versa.

This thesis is sometimes paired with another Socratic, view, that is, that virtue is a form of knowledge (Meno 87e-89a; cf. Euthydemus 278d-282a). Things like beauty, strength, and health benefit human beings, but can also harm them if they are not accompanied by knowledge or wisdom. If virtue is to be beneficial it must be knowledge, since all the qualities of the soul are in themselves neither beneficial not harmful, but are only beneficial when accompanied by wisdom and harmful when accompanied by folly.

ii. No One Errs Knowingly/No One Errs Willingly

Socrates famously declares that no one errs or makes mistakes knowingly (Protagoras 352c, 358b-b). Here we find an example of Socrates’ intellectualism. When a person does what is wrong, their failure to do what is right is an intellectual error, or due to their own ignorance about what is right. If the person knew what was right, he would have done it. Hence, it is not possible for someone simultaneously to know what is right and to do what is wrong. If someone does what is wrong, they do so because they do not know what is right, and if they claim they have known what was right at the time when they committed the wrong, they are mistaken, for had they truly known what was right, they would have done it.

Socrates therefore denies the possibility of akrasia, or weakness of the will. No one errs willingly (Protagoras 345c4-e6). While it might seem that Socrates is equivocating between knowingly and willingly, a look at Gorgias 466a-468e helps clarify his thesis. Tyrants and orators, Socrates tells Polus, have the least power of any member of the city because they do not do what they want. What they do is not good or beneficial even though human beings only want what is good or beneficial. The tyrant’s will, corrupted by ignorance, is in such a state that what follows from it will necessarily harm him. Conversely, the will that is purified by knowledge is in such a state that what follows from it will necessarily be beneficial.

iii. All Desire is for the Good

One of the premises of the argument just mentioned is that human beings only desire the good. When a person does something for the sake of something else, it is always the thing for the sake of which he is acting that he wants. All bad things or intermediate things are done not for themselves but for the sake of something else that is good. When a tyrant puts someone to death, for instance, he does this because he thinks it is beneficial in some way. Hence his action is directed towards the good because this is what he truly wants (Gorgias 467c-468b).

A similar version of this argument is in the Meno, 77b-78b. Those that desire bad things do not know that they are truly bad; otherwise, they would not desire them. They do not naturally desire what is bad but rather desire those things that they believe to be good but that are in fact bad. They desire good things even though they lack knowledge of what is actually good.

iv. It is Better to Suffer an Injustice Than to Commit One

Socrates infuriates Polus with the argument that it is better to suffer an injustice than commit one (Gorgias 475a-d). Polus agrees that it is more shameful to commit an injustice, but maintains it is not worse. The worst thing, in his view, is to suffer injustice. Socrates argues that, if something is more shameful, it surpasses in either badness or pain or both. Since committing an injustice is not more painful than suffering one, committing an injustice cannot surpass in pain or both pain and badness. Committing an injustice surpasses suffering an injustice in badness; differently stated, committing an injustice is worse than suffering one. Therefore, given the choice between the two, we should choose to suffer rather than commit an injustice.

This argument must be understood in terms of the Socratic emphasis on the care of the soul. Committing an injustice corrupts one’s soul, and therefore committing injustice is the worst thing a person can do to himself (cf. Crito 47d-48a, Republic I 353d-354a). If one commits injustice, Socrates goes so far as to claim that it is better to seek punishment than avoid it on the grounds that the punishment will purge or purify the soul of its corruption (Gorgias 476d-478e).

v. Eudaimonism

The Greek word for happiness is eudaimonia, which signifies not merely feeling a certain way but being a certain way. A different way of translating eudaimonia is well-being. Many scholars believe that Socrates holds two related but not equivalent principles regarding eudaimonia: first, that it is rationally required that a person make his own happiness the foundational consideration for his actions, and second, that each person does in fact pursue happiness as the foundational consideration for his actions. In relation to Socrates’ emphasis on virtue, it is not entirely clear what that means. Virtue could be identical to happiness—in which case there is no difference between the two and if I am virtuous I am by definition happy—virtue could be a part of happiness—in which case if I am virtuous I will be happy although I could be made happier by the addition of other goods—or virtue could be instrumental for happiness—in which case if I am virtuous I might be happy (and I couldn’t be happy without virtue), but there is no guarantee that I will be happy.

There are a number of passages in the Apology that seem to indicate that the greatest good for a human being is having philosophical conversation (36b-d, 37e-38a, 40e-41c). Meno 87c-89a suggests that knowledge of the good guides the soul toward happiness (cf. Euthydemus 278e-282a). And at Gorgias 507a-c Socrates suggests that the virtuous person, acting in accordance with wisdom, attains happiness (cf. Gorgias 478c-e: the happiest person has no badness in his soul).

vi. Ruling is An Expertise

Socrates is committed to the theme that ruling is a kind of craft or art (technē). As such, it requires knowledge. Just as a doctor brings about a desired result for his patient—health, for instance—so the ruler should bring about some desired result in his subject (Republic 341c-d, 342c). Medicine, insofar as it has the best interest of its patient in mind, never seeks to benefit the practitioner. Similarly, the ruler’s job is to act not for his own benefit but for the benefit of the citizens of the political community. This is not to say that there might not be some contingent benefit that accrues to the practitioner; the doctor, for instance, might earn a fine salary. But this benefit is not intrinsic to the expertise of medicine as such. One could easily conceive of a doctor that makes very little money. One cannot, however, conceive of a doctor that does not act on behalf of his patient. Analogously, ruling is always for the sake of the ruled citizen, and justice, contra the famous claim from Thrasymachus, is not whatever is in the interest of the ruling power (Republic 338c-339a).

d. Socrates the Ironist

The suspicion that Socrates is an ironist can mean a number of things: on the one hand, it can indicate that Socrates is saying something with the intent to convey the opposite meaning. Some readers for instance, including a number in the ancient world, understood Socrates’ avowal of ignorance in precisely this way. Many have interpreted Socrates’ praise of Euthyphro, in which he claims that he can learn from him and will become his pupil, as an example of this sort of irony (Euthyphro 5a-b). On the other hand, the Greek word eirōneia was understood to carry with it a sense of subterfuge, rendering the sense of the word something like masking with the intent to deceive.

Additionally, there are a number of related questions about Socrates’ irony. Is the interlocutor supposed to be aware of the irony, or is he ignorant of it? Is it the job of the reader to discern the irony? Is the purpose of irony rhetorical, intended to maintain Socrates’ position as the director of the conversation, or pedagogical, meant to encourage the interlocutor to learn something? Could it be both?

Scholars disagree on the sense in which we ought to call Socrates ironic. When Socrates asks Callicles to tell him what he means by the stronger and to go easy on him so that he might learn better, Callicles claims he is being ironic (Gorgias 489e). Thrasymachus accuses Socrates of being ironic insofar as he pretends he does not have an account of justice, when he is actually hiding what he truly thinks (Republic 337a). And though the Symposium is generally not thought to be a “Socratic” dialogue, we there find Alcibiades accusing Socrates of being ironic insofar as he acts like he is interested in him but then deny his advances (Symposium 216e, 218d). It is not clear which kind of irony is at work with these examples.

Aristotle defines irony as an attempt at self-deprecation (Nicomachean Ethics 4.7, 1127b23-26). He argues that self-deprecation is the opposite of boastfulness, and people that engage in this sort of irony do so to avoid pompousness and make their characters more attractive. Above all, such people disclaim things that bring reputation. On this reading, Socrates was prone to understatement.

There are some thinkers for whom Socratic irony is not just restricted to what Socrates says. The 19^th century Danish philosopher Søren Kierkegaard held the view that Socrates himself, his character, is ironic. The 20^th century philosopher Leo Strauss defined irony as the noble dissimulation of one’s worth. On this reading, Socrates’ irony consisted in his refusal to display his superiority in front of his inferiors so that his message would be understood only by the privileged few. As such, Socratic irony is intended to conceal Socrates’ true message.

3. Method: How Did Socrates Do Philosophy?

As famous as the Socratic themes are, the Socratic method is equally famous. Socrates conducted his philosophical activity by means of question an answer, and we typically associate with him a method called the elenchus. At the same time, Plato’s Socrates calls himself a midwife—who has no ideas of his own but helps give birth to the ideas of others—and proceeds dialectically—defined either as asking questions, embracing the practice of collection and division, or proceeding from hypotheses to first principles.

a. The Elenchus: Socrates the Refuter

A typical Socratic elenchus is a cross-examination of a particular position, proposition, or definition, in which Socrates tests what his interlocutor says and refutes it. There is, however, great debate amongst scholars regarding not only what is being refuted but also whether or not the elenchus can prove anything. There are questions, in other words, about the topic of the elenchus and its purpose or goal.

i. Topic

Socrates typically begins his elenchus with the question, “what is it”? What is piety, he asks Euthyphro. Euthyphro appears to give five separate definitions of piety: piety is proceeding against whomever does injustice (5d-6e), piety is what is loved by the gods (6e-7a), piety is what is loved by all the gods (9e), the godly and the pious is the part of the just that is concerned with the care of the gods (12e), and piety is the knowledge of sacrificing and praying (13d-14a). For some commentators, what Socrates is searching for here is a definition. Other commentators argue that Socrates is searching for more than just the definition of piety but seeks a comprehensive account of the nature of piety. Whatever the case, Socrates refutes the answer given to him in response to the ‘what is it’ question.

Another reading of the Socratic elenchus is that Socrates is not just concerned with the reply of the interlocutor but is concerned with the interlocutor himself. According to this view, Socrates is as much concerned with the truth or falsity of propositions as he is with the refinement of the interlocutor’s way of life. Socrates is concerned with both epistemological and moral advances for the interlocutor and himself. It is not propositions or replies alone that are refuted, for Socrates does not conceive of them dwelling in isolation from those that hold them. Thus conceived, the elenchus refutes the person holding a particular view, not just the view. For instance, Socrates shames Thrasymachus when he shows him that he cannot maintain his view that justice is ignorance and injustice is wisdom (Republic I 350d). The elenchus demonstrates that Thrasymachus cannot consistently maintain all his claims about the nature of justice. This view is consistent with a view we find in Plato’s late dialogue called the Sophist, in which the Visitor from Elea, not Socrates, claims that the soul will not get any advantage from learning that it is offered to it until someone shames it by refuting it (230b-d).

ii. Purpose

In terms of goal, there are two common interpretations of the elenchus. Both have been developed by scholars in response to what Gregory Vlastos called the problem of the Socratic elenchus. The problem is how Socrates can claim that position W is false, when the only thing he has established is its inconsistency with other premises whose truth he has not tried to establish in the elenchus.

The first response is what is called the constructivist position. A constructivist argues that the elenchus establishes the truth or falsity of individual answers. The elenchus on this interpretation can and does have positive results. Vlastos himself argued that Socrates not only established the inconsistency of the interlocutor’s beliefs by showing their inconsistency, but that Socrates’ own moral beliefs were always consistent, able to withstand the test of the elenchus. Socrates could therefore pick out a faulty premise in his elenctic exchange with an interlocutor, and sought to replace the interlocutor’s false beliefs with his own.

The second response is called the non-constructivist position. This position claims that Socrates does not think the elenchus can establish the truth or falsity of individual answers. The non-constructivist argues that all the elenchus can show is the inconsistency of W with the premises X, Y, and Z. It cannot establish that ~W is the case, or, for that matter, replace any of the premises with another, for this would require a separate argument. The elenchus establishes the falsity of the conjunction of W, X, Y, and Z, but not the truth or falsity of any of those premises individually. The purpose of the elenchus on this interpretation is to show the interlocutor that he is confused, and, according to some scholars, to use that confusion as a stepping stone on the way to establishing a more consistent, well-formed set of beliefs.

b. Maieutic: Socrates the Midwife

In Plato’s Theaetetus Socrates identifies himself as a midwife (150b-151b). While the dialogue is not generally considered Socratic, it is elenctic insofar as it tests and refutes Theaetetus’ definitions of knowledge. It also ends without a conclusive answer to its question, a characteristic it shares with a number of Socratic dialogues.

Socrates tells Theaetetus that his mother Phaenarete was a midwife (149a) and that he himself is an intellectual midwife. Whereas the craft of midwifery (150b-151d) brings on labor pains or relieves them in order to help a woman deliver a child, Socrates does not watch over the body but over the soul, and helps his interlocutor give birth to an idea. He then applies the elenchus to test whether or not the intellectual offspring is a phantom or a fertile truth. Socrates stresses that both he and actual midwives are barren, and cannot give birth to their own offspring. In spite of his own emptiness of ideas, Socrates claims to be skilled at bringing forth the ideas of others and examining them.

c. Dialectic: Socrates the Constructer

The method of dialectic is thought to be more Platonic than Socratic, though one can understand why many have associated it with Socrates himself. For one thing, the Greek dialegesthai ordinarily means simply “to converse” or “to discuss.” Hence when Socrates is distinguishing this sort of discussion from rhetorical exposition in the Gorgias, the contrast seems to indicate his preference for short questions and answers as opposed to longer speeches (447b-c, 448d-449c).

There are two other definitions of dialectic in the Platonic corpus. First, in the Republic, Socrates distinguishes between dianoetic thinking, which makes use of the senses and assumes hypotheses, and dialectical thinking, which does not use the senses and goes beyond hypotheses to first principles (Republic VII 510c-511c, 531d-535a). Second, in the Phaedrus, Sophist, Statesman, and Philebus, dialectic is defined as a method of collection and division. One collects things that are scattered into one kind and also divides each kind according to its species (Phaedrus 265d-266c).

Some scholars view the elenchus and dialectic as fundamentally different methods with different goals, while others view them as consistent and reconcilable. Some even view them as two parts of one argument procedure, in which the elenchus refutes and dialectic constructs.

4. Legacy: How Have Other Philosophers Understood Socrates?

Nearly every school of philosophy in antiquity had something positive to say about Socrates, and most of them drew their inspiration from him. Socrates also appears in the works of many famous modern philosophers. Immanuel Kant, the 18^th century German philosopher best known for the categorical imperative, hailed Socrates, amongst other ancient philosophers, as someone who didn’t just speculate but who lived philosophically. One of the more famous quotes about Socrates is from John Stuart Mill, the 19^th century utilitarian philosopher who claimed that it is better to be a human being dissatisfied than a pig satisfied; better to be Socrates dissatisfied than a fool satisfied. The following is but a brief survey of Socrates as he is treated in philosophical thinking that emerges after the death of Aristotle in 322 B.C.E.

a. Hellenistic Philosophy

i. The Cynics

The Cynics greatly admired Socrates, and traced their philosophical lineage back to him. One of the first representatives of the Socratic legacy was the Cynic Diogenes of Sinope. No genuine writings of Diogenes have survived and most of our evidence about him is anecdotal. Nevertheless, scholars attribute a number of doctrines to him. He sought to undermine convention as a foundation for ethical values and replace it with nature. He understood the essence of human being to be rational, and defined happiness as freedom and self-mastery, an objective readily accessible to those who trained the body and mind.

ii. The Stoics

There is a biographical story according to which Zeno, the founder of the Stoic school and not the Zeno of Zeno’s Paradoxes, became interested in philosophy by reading and inquiring about Socrates. The Stoics took themselves to be authentically Socratic, especially in defending the unqualified restriction of ethical goodness to ethical excellence, the conception of ethical excellence as a kind of knowledge, a life not requiring any bodily or external advantage nor ruined by any bodily disadvantage, and the necessity and sufficiency of ethical excellence for complete happiness.

Zeno is known for his characterization of the human good as a smooth flow of life. Stoics were therefore attracted to the Socratic elenchus because it could expose inconsistencies—both social and psychological—that disrupted one’s life. In the absence of justification for a specific action or belief, one would not be in harmony with oneself, and therefore would not live well. On the other hand, if one held a position that survived cross-examination, such a position would be consistent and coherent. The Socratic elenchus was thus not just an important social and psychological test, but also an epistemological one. The Stoics held that knowledge was a coherent set of psychological attitudes, and therefore a person holding attitudes that could withstand the elenchus could be said to have knowledge. Those with inconsistent or incoherent psychological commitments were thought to be ignorant.

Socrates also figures in Roman Stoicism, particularly in the works of Seneca and Epictetus. Both men admired Socrates’ strength of character. Seneca praises Socrates for his ability to remain consistent unto himself in the face of the threat posed by the Thirty Tyrants, and also highlights the Socratic focus on caring for oneself instead of fleeing oneself and seeking fulfillment by external means. Epictetus, when offering advice about holding to one’s own moral laws as inviolable maxims, claims, “though you are not yet a Socrates, you ought, however, to live as one desirous of becoming a Socrates” (Enchiridion 50).

One aspect of Socrates to which Epictetus was particularly attracted was the elenchus. Though his understanding of the process is in some ways different from Socrates’, throughout his Discourses Epictetus repeatedly stresses the importance of recognition of one’s ignorance (2.17.1) and awareness of one’s own impotence regarding essentials (2.11.1). He characterizes Socrates as divinely appointed to hold the elenctic position (3.21.19) and associates this role with Socrates’ protreptic expertise (2.26.4-7). Epictetus encouraged his followers to practice the elenchus on themselves, and claims that Socrates did precisely this on account of his concern with self-examination (2.1.32-3).

iii. The Skeptics

Broadly speaking, skepticism is the view that we ought to be either suspicious of claims to epistemological truth or at least withhold judgment from affirming absolute claims to knowledge. Amongst Pyrrhonian skeptics, Socrates appears at times like a dogmatist and at other times like a skeptic or inquirer. On the one hand, Sextus Empiricus lists Socrates as a thinker who accepts the existence of god (Against the Physicists, I.9.64) and then recounts the cosmological argument that Xenophon attributes to Socrates (Against the Physicists, I.9.92-4). On the other hand, in arguing that human being is impossible to conceive, Sextus Empiricus cites Socrates as unsure whether or not he is a human being or something else (Outlines of Pyrrhonism 2.22). Socrates is also said to have remained in doubt about this question (Against the Professors 7.264).

Academic skeptics grounded their position that nothing can be known in Socrates’ admission of ignorance in the Apology (Cicero, On the Orator 3.67, Academics 1.44). Arcesilaus, the first head of the Academy to take it toward a skeptical turn, picked up from Socrates the procedure of arguing, first asking others to give their positions and then refuting them (Cicero, On Ends 2.2, On the Orator 3.67, On the Nature of the Gods 1.11). While the Academy would eventually move away from skepticism, Cicero, speaking on behalf of the Academy of Philo, makes the claim that Socrates should be understood as endorsing the claim that nothing, other than one’s own ignorance, could be known (Academics 2.74).

iv. The Epicurean

The Epicureans were one of the few schools that criticized Socrates, though many scholars think that this was in part because of their animus toward their Stoic counterparts, who admired him. In general, Socrates is depicted in Epicurean writings as a sophist, rhetorician, and skeptic who ignored natural science for the sake of ethical inquiries that concluded without answers. Colotes criticizes Socrates’ statement in the Phaedrus (230a) that he does not know himself (Plutarch, Against Colotes 21 1119b), and Philodemus attacks Socrates’ argument in the Protagoras (319d) that virtue cannot be taught (Rhetoric I 261, 8ff).

The Epicureans wrote a number of books against several of Plato’s Socratic dialogues, including the Lysis, Euthydemus, and Gorgias. In the Gorgias we find Socrates suspicious of the view that pleasure is intrinsically worthy and his insistence that pleasure is not the equivalent of the good (Gorgias 495b-499b). In defining pleasure as freedom from disturbance (ataraxia) and defining this sort of pleasure as the sole good for human beings, the Epicureans shared little with the unbridled hedonism Socrates criticizes Callicles for embracing. Indeed, in the Letter to Menoeceus, Epicurus explicitly argues against pursuing this sort of pleasure (131-132). Nonetheless, the Epicureans did equate pleasure with the good, and the view that pleasure is not the equivalent of the good could not have endeared Socrates to their sentiment.

Another reason for the Epicurean refusal to praise Socrates or make him a cornerstone of their tradition was his perceived irony. According to Cicero, Epicurus was opposed to Socrates’ representing himself as ignorant while simultaneously praising others like Protagoras, Hippias, Prodicus, and Gorgias (Rhetoric, Vol. II, Brutus 292). This irony for the Epicureans was pedagogically pointless: if Socrates had something to say, he should have said it instead of hiding it.

v. The Peripatetics

Aristotle’s followers, the Peripatetics, either said little about Socrates or were pointedly vicious in their attacks. Amongst other things, the Peripatetics accused Socrates of being a bigamist, a charge that appears to have gained so much traction that the Stoic Panaetius wrote a refutation of it (Plutarch, Aristides 335c-d). The general peripatetic criticism of Socrates, similar in one way to the Epicureans, was that he concentrated solely on ethics, and that this was an unacceptable ideal for the philosophical life.

b. Modern Philosophy

i. Hegel

In Socrates, Hegel found what he called the great historic turning point (Philosophy of History, 448). With Socrates, Hegel claims, two opposed rights came into collision: the individual consciousness and the universal law of the state. Prior to Socrates, morality for the ancients was present but it was not present Socratically. That is, the good was present as a universal, without its having had the form of the conviction of the individual in his consciousness (407). Morality was present as an immediate absolute, directing the lives of citizens without their having reflected upon it and deliberated about it for themselves. The law of the state, Hegel claims, had authority as the law of the gods, and thus had a universal validity that was recognized by all (408).

In Hegel’s view the coming of Socrates signals a shift in the relationship between the individual and morality. The immediate now had to justify itself to the individual consciousness. Hegel thus not only ascribes to Socrates the habit of asking questions about what one should do but also about the actions that the state has prescribed. With Socrates, consciousness is turned back within itself and demands that the law should establish itself before consciousness, internal to it, not merely outside it (408-410). Hegel attributes to Socrates a reflective questioning that is skeptical, which moves the individual away from unreflective obedience and into reflective inquiry about the ethical standards of one’s community.

Generally, Hegel finds in Socrates a skepticism that renders ordinary or immediate knowledge confused and insecure, in need of reflective certainty which only consciousness can bring (370). Though he attributes to the sophists the same general skeptical comportment, in Socrates Hegel locates human subjectivity at a higher level. With Socrates and onward we have the world raising itself to the level of conscious thought and becoming object for thought. The question as to what Nature is gives way to the question about what Truth is, and the question about the relationship of self-conscious thought to real essence becomes the predominant philosophical issue (450-1).

ii. Kierkegaard

Kierkegaard’s most well recognized views on Socrates are from his dissertation, The Concept of Irony With Continual Reference to Socrates. There, he argues that Socrates is not the ethical figure that the history of philosophy has thought him to be, but rather an ironist in all that he does. Socrates does not just speak ironically but is ironic. Indeed, while most people have found Aristophanes’ portrayal of Socrates an obvious exaggeration and caricature, Kierkegaard goes so far as to claim that he came very close to the truth in his depiction of Socrates. He rejects Hegel’s picture of Socrates ushering in a new era of philosophical reflection and instead argues that the limits of Socratic irony testified to the need for religious faith. As opposed to the Hegelian view that Socratic irony was an instrument in the service of the development of self-consciousness, Kierkegaard claims that irony was Socrates’ position or comportment, and that he did not have any more than this to give.

Later in his writing career Kierkegaard comes to think that he has neglected Socrates’ significance as an ethical and religious figure. In his final essay entitled My Task, Kierkegaard claims that his mission is a Socratic one; that is, in his task to reinvigorate a Christianity that remained the cultural norm but had, in Kierkegaard’s eyes, nearly ceased altogether to be practiced authentically, Kierkegaard conceives of himself as a kind of Christian Socrates, rousing Christians from their complacency to a conception of Christian faith as the highest, most passionate expression of individual subjectivity. Kierkegaard therefore sees himself as a sort of Christian gadfly. The Socratic call to become aware of one’s own ignorance finds its parallel in the Kierkegaardian call to recognize one’s own failing to truly live as a Christian. The Socratic claim to ignorance—while Socrates is closer to knowledge than his contemporaries—is replaced by the Kierkegaard’s claim that he is not a Christian—though certainly more so than his own contemporaries.

iii. Nietzsche

Nietzsche’s most famous account of Socrates is his scathing portrayal in The Birth of Tragedy, in which Socrates and rational thinking lead to the emergence of an age of decadence in Athens. The delicate balance in Greek culture between the Apollonian—order, calmness, self-control, restraint—and the Dionysian—chaos, revelry, self-forgetfulness, indulgence— initially represented on stage in the tragedies of Aeschylus and Sophocles, gave way to the rationalism of Euripides. Euripides, Nietzsche argues, was only a mask for the newborn demon called Socrates (section 12). Tragedy—and Greek culture more generally—was corrupted by “aesthetic Socratism”, whose supreme law, Nietzsche argues, was that ‘to be beautiful everything must be intelligible’. Whereas the former sort of tragedy absorbed the spectator in the activities and sufferings of its chief characters, the emergence of Socrates heralded the onset of a new kind of tragedy in which this identification is obstructed by the spectators having to figure out the meaning and presuppositions of the characters’ suffering.

Nietzsche continues his attack on Socrates later in his career in Twilight of the Idols. Socrates here represents the lowest class of people (section 3), and his irony consists in his being an exaggeration at the same time as he conceals himself (4). He is the inventor of dialectic (5) which he wields mercilessly because, being an ugly plebeian, he had no other means of expressing himself (6) and therefore employed question and answer to render his opponent powerless (7). Socrates turned dialectic into a new kind of contest (8), and because his instincts had turned against each other and were in anarchy (9), he established the rule of reason as a counter-tyrant in order not to perish (10). Socrates’ decadence here consists in his having to fight his instincts (11). He was thus profoundly anti-life, so much so that he wanted to die (12).

Nonetheless, while Nietzsche accuses Socrates of decadence, he nevertheless recognizes him as a powerful individual, which perhaps accounts for why we at times find in Nietzsche a hesitant admiration of Socrates. He calls Socrates one of the very greatest instinctive forces (The Birth of Tragedy, section 13), labels him as a “free spirit” (Human, All Too Human I, 433) praises him as the first “philosopher of life” in his 17^th lecture on the Preplatonics, and anoints him a ‘virtuoso of life’ in his notebooks from 1875. Additionally, contra Twilight of the Idols, in Thus Spoke Zarathustra, Nietzsche speaks of a death in which one’s virtue still shines, and some commentators have seen in this a celebration of the way in which Socrates died.

iv. Heidegger

Heidegger finds in Socrates a kinship with his own view that the truth of philosophy lies in a certain way of seeing things, and thus is identical with a particular kind of method. He attributes to Socrates the view that the truth of some subject matter shows itself not in some definition that is the object or end of a process of inquiry, but in the very process of inquiry itself. Heidegger characterizes the Socratic method as a kind of productive negation: by refuting that which stands in front of it—in Socrates’ case, an interlocutor’s definition—it discloses the positive in the very process of questioning. Socrates is not interested in articulating propositions about piety but rather concerned with persisting in a questioning relation to it that preserves its irreducible sameness. Behind multiple examples of pious action is Piety, and yet Piety is not something that can be spoken of. It is that which discloses itself through the process of silent interrogation.

It is precisely in his emphasis on silence that Heidegger diverges from Socrates. Where Socrates insisted on the give and take of question and answer, Heideggerian questioning is not necessarily an inquiry into the views of others but rather an openness to the truth that one maintains without the need to speak. To remain in dialogue with a given phenomenon is not the same thing as conversing about it, and true dialogue is always silent.

v. Gadamer

As Heidegger’s student, Gadamer shares his fundamental view that truth and method cannot be divorced in philosophy. At the same time, his hermeneutics leads him to argue for the importance of dialectic as conversation. Gadamer claims that whereas philosophical dialectic presents the whole truth by superceding all its partial propositions, hermeneutics too has the task of revealing a totality of meaning in all its relations. The distinguishing characteristic of Gadamer’s hermeneutical dialectic is that it recognizes radical finitude: we are always already in an open-ended dialogical situation. Conversation with the interlocutor is thus not a distraction that leads us away from seeing the truth but rather is the site of truth. It is for this reason that Gadamer claims Plato communicated his philosophy only in dialogues: it was more than just homage to Socrates, but was a reflection of his view that the word find its confirmation in another and in the agreement of another.

Gadamer also sees in the Socratic method an ethical way of being. That is, he does not just think that Socrates converses about ethics but that repeated Socratic conversation is itself indicative of an ethical comportment. On this account, Socrates knows the good not because he can give some final definition of it but rather because of his readiness to give an account of it. The problem of not living an examined life is not that we might live without knowing what is ethical, but because without asking questions as Socrates does, we will not be ethical.

5. References and Further Reading

Ahbel-Rappe, Sara, and Rachana Kamtekar (eds.), A Companion to Socrates (Oxford: Blackwell, 2006).
Arrowsmith, William, Lattimore, Richmond, and Parker, Douglass (trans.), Four Plays by Aristophanes: The Clouds, The Birds, Lysistrata, The Frogs (New York: Meridian, 1994).
Barnes, Jonathan, Complete Works of Aristotle vols. 1 & 2 (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1984).
Benson, Hugh H. (ed.), Essays on the Philosophy of Socrates (New York: Oxford University Press, 1992).
Brickhouse, Thomas C. & Smith, Nicholas D., Plato’s Socrates (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1994).
Burkert, Walter, Greek Religion (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1985).
Cooper, John M., Plato: Collected Works (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1997).
Guthrie, W.K.C., Socrates (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1971).
Kahn, Charles H., Plato and the Socratic Dialogue (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996).
Kraut, Richard (ed.), The Cambridge Companion to Plato (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1992).
Morrison, Donald R., The Cambridge Companion to Socrates (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2012).
Rudebusch, George, Socrates (Malden, MA: Wiley-Blackwell, 2009).
Santas, Gerasimos, Socrates: Philosophy in Plato’s Early Dialogues (London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1979).
Taylor, C.C.W, 1998, Socrates (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998).
Vlastos, Gregory, Socrates, Ironist and Moral Philosopher (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991).
Xenophon: Memorabilia. Oeconomicus. Symposium. Apologia. (Loeb Classical Library, Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1923).

Author Information

James M. Ambury
Email: jamesambury@kings.edu
King’s College
U. S. A.

John Locke (1632—1704)

John Locke was among the most famous philosophers and political theorists of the 17^th century. He is often regarded as the founder of a school of thought known as British Empiricism, and he made foundational contributions to modern theories of limited, liberal government. He also was influential in the areas of theology, religious toleration, and educational theory. In his most important work, the Essay Concerning Human Understanding, Locke set out to offer an analysis of the human mind and its acquisition of knowledge. He offered an empiricist theory according to which we acquire ideas through our experience of the world. The mind is then able to examine, compare, and combine these ideas in numerous different ways. Knowledge consists of a special kind of relationship between different ideas. Locke’s emphasis on the philosophical examination of the human mind as a preliminary to the philosophical investigation of the world and its contents represented a new approach to philosophy, one which quickly gained a number of converts, especially in Great Britain. In addition to this broader project, the Essay contains a series of more focused discussions on important, and widely divergent, philosophical themes. In politics, Locke is best known as a proponent of limited government. He uses a theory of natural rights to argue that governments have obligations to their citizens, have only limited powers over their citizens, and can ultimately be overthrown by citizens under certain circumstances. He also provided powerful arguments in favor of religious toleration. This article attempts to give a broad overview of all key areas of Locke’s thought.

Life and Works
The Main Project of the Essay
Special Topics in the Essay
Political Philosophy
Theology
Education
Locke’s Influence
References and Further Reading
1. Locke’s Works
2. Recommended Reading

1. Life and Works

John Locke was born in 1632 in Wrington, a small village in southwestern England. His father, also named John, was a legal clerk and served with the Parliamentary forces in the English Civil War. His family was well-to-do, but not of particularly high social or economic standing. Locke spent his childhood in the West Country and as a teenager was sent to Westminster School in London.

Locke was successful at Westminster and earned a place at Christ Church, Oxford. He was to remain in Oxford from 1652 until 1667. Although he had little appreciation for the traditional scholastic philosophy he learned there, Locke was successful as a student and after completing his undergraduate degree he held a series of administrative and academic posts in the college. Some of Locke’s duties included instruction of undergraduates. One of his earliest substantive works, the Essays on the Law of Nature, was developed in the course of his teaching duties. Much of Locke’s intellectual effort and energy during his time at Oxford, especially during his later years there, was devoted to the study of medicine and natural philosophy (what we would now call science). Locke read widely in these fields, participated in various experiments, and became acquainted with Robert Boyle and many other notable natural philosophers. He also undertook the normal course of education and training to become a physician.

Locke left Oxford for London in 1667 where he became attached to the family of Anthony Ashley Cooper (then Lord Ashley, later the Earl of Shaftesbury). Locke may have played a number of roles in the household, mostly likely serving as tutor to Ashley’s son. In London, Locke continued to pursue his interests in medicine and natural philosophy. He formed a close working relationship with Thomas Sydenham, who later became one the most famous physicians of the age. He made a number of contacts within the newly formed Royal Society and became a member in 1668. He also acted as the personal physician to Lord Ashley. Indeed, on one occasion Locke participated in a very delicate surgical operation which Ashley credited with saving his life. Ashley was one of the most prominent English politicians at the time. Through his patronage Locke was able to hold a series of governmental posts. Most of his work related to policies in England’s American and Caribbean colonies. Most importantly, this was the period in Locke’s life when he began the project which would culminate in his most famous work, the Essay Concerning Human Understanding. The two earliest drafts of that work date from 1671. He was to continue work on this project intermittentlyfor nearly twenty years.

Locke travelled in France for several years starting in 1675. When he returned to England it was only to be for a few years. The political scene had changed greatly while Locke was away. Shaftesbury (as Ashley was now known) was out of favor and Locke’s association with him had become a liability. It was around this time that Locke composed his most famous political work, the Two Treatises Concerning Government. Although the Two Treatises would not be published until 1689 they show that he had already solidified his views on the nature and proper form of government. Following Shaftesbury’s death Locke fled to the Netherlands to escape political persecution. While there Locke travelled a great deal (sometimes for his own safety) and worked on two projects. First, he continued work on the Essay. Second, he wrote a work entitled Epistola de Tolerantia, which was published anonymously in 1689. Locke’s experiences in England, France, and the Netherlands convinced him that governments should be much more tolerant of religious diversity than was common at the time.

Following the Glorious Revolution of 1688-1689 Locke was able to return to England. He published both the Essay and the Two Treatises (the second anonymously) shortly after his return. He initially stayed in London but soon moved to the home of Francis and Damaris Masham in the small village of Oates, Essex. Damaris Masham, who was the daughter of a notable philosopher named Ralph Cudworth, had become acquainted with Locke several years before. The two formed a very close friendship which lasted until Locke’s death. During this period Locke kept busy working on politics, toleration, philosophy, economics, and educational theory.

Locke engaged in a number of controversies during his life, including a notable one with Jonas Proast over toleration. But Locke’s most famous and philosophically important controversy was with Edward Stillingfleet, the Bishop of Worcester. Stillingfleet, in addition to being a powerful political and theological figure, was an astute and forceful critic. The two men debated a number of the positions in the Essay in a series of published letters.

In his later years Locke devoted much of his attention to theology. His major work in this field was The Reasonableness of Christianity, published (again anonymously) in 1695. This work was controversial because Locke argued that many beliefs traditionally believed to be mandatory for Christians were unnecessary. Locke argued for a highly ecumenical form of Christianity. Closer to the time of his death Locke wrote a work on the Pauline Epistles. The work was unfinished, but published posthumously. A short work on miracles also dates from this time and was published posthumously.

Locke suffered from health problems for most of his adult life. In particular, he had respiratory ailments which were exacerbated by his visits to London where the air quality was very poor. His health took a turn for the worse in 1704 and he became increasingly debilitated. He died on 28 October 1704 while Damaris Masham was reading him the Psalms. He was buried at High Laver, near Oates. He wrote his own epitaph which was both humble and forthright.

2. The Main Project of the Essay

According to Locke’s own account the motivation for writing the Essay came to him while debating an unrelated topic with friends. He reports that they were able to make little headway on this topic and that they very quickly met with a number of confusions and difficulties. Locke realized that to make progress on this topic it was first necessary to examine something more fundamental: the human understanding. It was “necessary to examine our own Abilities, and see, what Objects our Understandings were, or were not fitted to deal with.” (Epistle, 7).

Locke’s insight was that before we can analyze the world and our access to it we have to know something about ourselves. We need to know how we acquire knowledge. We also need to know which areas of inquiry we are well suited to and which are epistemically closed to us, that is, which areas are such that we could not know them even in principle. We further need to know what knowledge consists in. In keeping with these questions, at the very outset of the Essay Locke writes that it is his “Purpose enquire into the Original, Certainty, and Extent of humane Knowledge; together, with the Grounds and Degrees of Belief, Opinion, and Assent.” (1.1.2, 42). Locke thinks that it is only once we understand our cognitive capabilities that we can suitably direct our researches into the world. This may have been what Locke had in mind when he claimed that part of his ambition in the Essay was to be an “Under-Laborer” who cleared the ground and laid the foundations for the work of famous scientists like Robert Boyle and Isaac Newton.

The Essay is divided into four books with each book contributing to Locke’s overall goal of examining the human mind with respect to its contents and operations. In Book I Locke rules out one possible origin of our knowledge. He argues that our knowledge cannot have been innate. This sets up Book II in which Locke argues that all of our ideas come from experience. In this book he seeks to give an account of how even ideas like God, infinity, and space could have been acquired through our perceptual access to the world and our mental operations. Book III is something of a digression as Locke turns his attention to language and the role it plays in our theorizing. Locke’s main goal here is cautionary, he thinks language is often an obstacle to understanding and he offers some recommendations to avoid confusion. Finally, Book IV discusses knowledge, belief, and opinion. Locke argues that knowledge consists of special kinds of relations between ideas and that we should regulate our beliefs accordingly.

a. Ideas

The first chapter of the Essay contains an apology for the frequent use of the word “idea” in the book. According to Locke, ideas are the fundamental units of mental content and so play an integral role in his explanation of the human mind and his account of our knowledge. Locke was not the first philosopher to give ideas a central role; Descartes, for example, had relied heavily on them in explaining the human mind. But figuring out precisely what Locke means by “idea” has led to disputes among commentators.

One place to begin is with Locke’s own definition. He claims that by “idea” he means “whatsoever is the Object of the Understanding when a Man thinks…whatever is meant by Phantasm, Notion, Species, or whatever it is, which the Mind can be employ’d about in thinking.” (1.1.8, 47). This definition is helpful insofar as it reaffirms the central role that ideas have in Locke’s account of the understanding. Ideas are the sole entities upon which our minds work. Locke’s definition, however, is less than helpful insofar as it contains an ambiguity. On one reading, ideas are mental objects. The thought is that when an agent perceives an external world object like an apple there is some thing in her mind which represents that apple. So when an agent considers an apple what she is really doing is thinking about the idea of that apple. On a different reading, ideas are mental actions. The thought here is that when an agent perceives an apple she is really perceiving the apple in a direct, unmediated way. The idea is the mental act of making perceptual contact with the external world object. In recent years, most commentators have adopted the first of these two readings. But this debate will be important in the discussion of knowledge below.

b. The Critique of Nativism

The first of the Essay’s four books is devoted to a critique of nativism, the doctrine that some ideas are innate in the human mind, rather than received in experience. It is unclear precisely who Locke’s targets in this book are, though Locke does cite Herbert of Cherbury and other likely candidates include René Descartes, the Cambridge Platonists, and a number of lesser known Anglican theologians. Finding specific targets, however, might not be that important given that much of what Locke seeks to do in Book I is motivate and make plausible the alternative account of idea acquisition that he offers in Book II.

The nativist view which Locke attacks in Book I holds that human beings have mental content which is innate in the mind. This means that there are certain ideas (units of mental content) which were neither acquired via experience nor constructed by the mind out of ideas received in experience. The most popular version of this position holds that there are certain ideas which God planted in all minds at the moment of their creation.

Locke attacks both the view that we have any innate principles (for example, the whole is greater than the part, do unto others as you would have done unto you, etc.) as well as the view that there are any innate singular ideas (for example, God, identity, substance, and so forth). The main thrust of Locke’s argument lies in pointing out that none of the mental content alleged to be innate is universally shared by all humans. He notes that children and the mentally disabled, for example, do not have in their minds an allegedly innate complex thought like “equals taken from equals leave equals”. He also uses evidence from travel literature to point out that many non-Europeans deny what were taken to be innate moral maxims and that some groups even lack the idea of a God. Locke takes the fact that not all humans have these ideas as evidence that they were not implanted by God in humans minds, and that they are therefore acquired rather than innate.

There is one misunderstanding which it is important to avoid when considering Locke’s anti-nativism. The misunderstanding is, in part, suggested by Locke’s claim that the mind is like a tabula rasa (a blank slate) prior to sense experience. This makes it sound as though the mind is nothing prior to the advent of ideas. In fact, Locke’s position is much more nuanced. He makes it clear that the mind has any number of inherent capacities, predispositions, and inclinations prior to receiving any ideas from sensation. His anti-nativist point is just that none of these is triggered or exercised until the mind receives ideas from sensation.

c. Idea Acquisition

In Book II Locke offers his alternative theory of how the human mind comes to be furnished with the ideas it has. Every day we think of complex things like orange juice, castles, justice, numbers, and motion. Locke’s claim is that the ultimate origin of all of these ideas lies in experience: “Experience: In that, all our Knowledge is founded; and from that it ultimately derives itself. Our Observation employ’d either about external, sensible Objects; or about the internal Operations of our Minds, perceived and reflected on by ourselves, is that, which supplies our Understandings with all the material of thinking. These two are the Fountains of Knowledge, from whence all the Ideas we have, or can naturally have, do spring.” (2.1.2, 104).

In the above passage Locke allows for two distinct types of experience. Outer experience, or sensation, provides us with ideas from the traditional five senses. Sight gives us ideas of colors, hearing gives us ideas of sounds, and so on. Thus, my idea of a particular shade of green is a product of seeing a fern. And my idea of a particular tone is the product of my being in the vicinity of a piano while it was being played. Inner experience, or reflection, is slightly more complicated. Locke thinks that the human mind is incredibly active; it is constantly performing what he calls operations. For example, I often remember past birthday parties, imagine that I was on vacation, desire a slice of pizza, or doubt that England will win the World Cup. Locke believes that we are able to notice or experience our mind performing these actions and when we do we receive ideas of reflection. These are ideas such as memory, imagination, desire, doubt, judgment, and choice.

Locke’s view is that experience (sensation and reflection) issues us with simple ideas. These are the minimal units of mental content; each simple idea is “in itself uncompounded, [and] contains in it nothing but one uniform Appearance, or Conception in the mind, and is not distinguishable into different Ideas.” (2.2.1, 119). But many of my ideas are not simple ideas. My idea of a glass of orange juice or my idea of the New York subway system, for example, could not be classed a simple ideas. Locke calls ideas like these complex ideas. His view is that complex ideas are the product of combining our simple ideas together in various ways. For example, my complex idea of a glass of orange juice consists of various simple ideas (the color orange, the feeling of coolness, a certain sweet taste, a certain acidic taste, and so forth) combined together into one object. Thus, Locke believes our ideas are compositional. Simple ideas combine to form complex ideas. And these complex ideas can be combined to form even more complex ideas.

We are now in a position to understand the character of Locke’s empiricism. He is committed to the view that all of our ideas, everything we can possibly think of, can be broken down into simple ideas received in experience. The bulk of Book II is devoted to making this empiricism plausible. Locke does this both by undertaking an examination of the various abilities that the human mind has (memory, abstraction, volition, and so forth) and by offering an account of how even abstruse ideas like space, infinity, God, and causation could be constructed using only the simple ideas received in experience.

Our complex ideas are classified into three different groups: substances, modes, and relations. Ideas of substances are ideas of things which are thought to exist independently. Ordinary objects like desks, sheep, and mountains fall into this group. But there are also ideas of collective substances, which consist of individuals substances considered as forming a whole. A group of individual buildings might be considered a town. And a group of individual men and women might be considered together as an army. In addition to describing the way we think about individual substances, Locke also has an interesting discussion of substance-in-general. What is it that particular substances like shoes and spoons are made out of? We could suggest that they are made out of leather and metal. But the question could be repeated, what are leather and metal made of? We might respond that they are made of matter. But even here, Locke thinks we can ask what matter is made of. What gives rise to the properties of matter? Locke claims that we don’t have a very clear idea here. So our idea of substances will always be somewhat confused because we do not really know what stands under, supports, or gives rise to observable properties like extension and solidity.

Ideas of modes are ideas of things which are dependent on substances in some way. In general, this taxonomic category can be somewhat tricky. It does not seem to have a clear parallel in contemporary metaphysics, and it is sometimes thought to be a mere catch-all category for things which are neither substances nor relations. But it is helpful to think of modes as being like features of substances; modes are “such complex Ideas, which however compounded, contain not in them the supposition of subsisting by themselves, but are considered as Dependences on, or Affections of Substances.” (2.12.4, 165). Modes come in two types: simple and mixed. Simple modes are constructed by combining a large number of a single type of simple ideas together. For example, Locke believes there is a simple idea of unity. Our complex idea of the number seven, for example, is a simple mode and is constructed by concatenating seven simple ideas of unity together. Locke uses this category to explain how we think about a number of topics relating to number, space, time, pleasure and pain, and cognition. Mixed modes, on the other hand, involve combining together simple ideas of more than one kind. A great many ideas fall into this category. But the most important ones are moral ideas. Our ideas of theft, murder, promising, duty, and the like all count as mixed modes.

Ideas of relations are ideas that involve more than one substance. My idea of a husband, for example, is more than the idea of an individual man. It also must include the idea of another substance, namely the idea of that man’s spouse. Locke is keen to point out that much more of our thought involves relations than we might previously have thought. For example, when I think about Elizabeth II as the Queen of England my thinking actually involves relations, because I cannot truly think of Elizabeth as a queen without conceiving of her as having a certain relationship of sovereignty to some subjects (individual substances like David Beckham and J.K. Rowling). Locke then goes on to explore the role that relations have in our thinking about causation, space, time, morality, and (very famously) identity.

Throughout his discussion of the different kinds of complex ideas Locke is keen to emphasize that all of our ideas can ultimately be broken down into simple ideas received in sensation and reflection. Put differently, Locke is keenly aware that the success of his empiricist theory of mind depends on its ability to account for all the contents of our minds. Whether or not Locke is successful is a matter of dispute. On some occasions the analysis he gives of how a very complex idea could be constructed using only simple ideas is vague and requires the reader to fill in some gaps. And commentators have also suggested that some of the simple ideas Locke invokes, for example the simple ideas of power and unity, do not seem to be obvious components of our phenomenological experience.

Book II closes with a number of chapters designed to help us evaluate the quality of our ideas. Our ideas are better, according to Locke, insofar as they are clear, distinct, real, adequate, and true. Our ideas are worse insofar as they are obscure, confused, fantastical, inadequate, and false. Clarity and obscurity are explained via an analogy to vision. Clear ideas, like clear images, are crisp and fresh, not faded or diminished in the way that obscure ideas (or images) are. Distinction and confusion have to do with the individuation of ideas. Ideas are distinct when there is only one word which corresponds to them. Confused ideas are ones to which more than one word can correctly apply or ones that lack a clear and consistent correlation to one particular word. To use one of Locke’s examples, an idea of a leopard as a beast with spots would be confused. It is not distinct because the word “lynx” could apply to that idea just as easily as the word “leopard.” Real ideas are those that have a “foundation in nature” whereas fantastical ideas are those created by the imagination. For example, our idea of a horse would be a real idea and our idea of a unicorn would be fantastical. Adequacy and inadequacy have to do with how well ideas match the patterns according to which they were made. Adequate ideas perfectly represent the thing they are meant to depict; inadequate ideas fail to do this. Ideas are true when the mind understands them in a way that is correct according to linguistic practices and the way the world is structured. They are false when the mind misunderstands them along these lines.

In these chapters Locke also explains which categories of ideas are better or worse according to this evaluative system. Simple ideas do very well. Because objects directly produce them in the mind they tend to be clear, distinct, and so forth. Ideas of modes and relations also tend to do very well, but for a different reason. Locke thinks that the archetypes of these ideas are in the mind rather than in the world. As such, it is easy for these ideas to be good because the mind has a clear sense of what the ideas should be like as it constructs them. By contrast, ideas of substances tend to fare very poorly. The archetypes for these ideas are external world objects. Because our perceptual access to these objects is limited in a number of ways and because these objects are so intricate, ideas of substances tend to be confused, inadequate, false, and so forth.

d. Language

Book III of the Essay is concerned with language. Locke admits that this topic is something of a digression. He did not originally plan for language to take up an entire book of the Essay. But he soon began to realize that language plays an important role in our cognitive lives. Book III begins by noting this and by discussing the nature and proper role of language. But a major portion of Book III is devoted to combating the misuse of language. Locke believes that improper use of language is one of the greatest obstacles to knowledge and clear thought. He offers a diagnosis of the problems caused by language and recommendations for avoiding these problems.

Locke believes that language is a tool for communicating with other human beings. Specifically, Locke thinks that we want to communicate about our ideas, the contents of our minds. From here it is a short step to the view that: “Words in their primary or immediate Signification, stand for nothing, but the Ideas in the Mind of him that uses them.” (3.2.2, 405). When an agent utters the word “gold” she is referring to her idea of a shiny, yellowish, malleable substance of great value. When she utters the word “carrot” she is referring to her idea of a long, skinny, orange vegetable which grows underground. Locke is, of course, aware that the names we choose for these ideas are arbitrary and merely a matter of social convention.

Although the primary use of words is to refer to ideas in the mind of the speaker, Locke also allows that words make what he calls “secret reference” to two other things. First, humans also want their words to refer to the corresponding ideas in the minds of other humans. When Smith says “carrot” within earshot of Jones her hope is that Jones also has an idea of the long, skinny vegetable and that saying “carrot” will bring that idea into Jones’ mind. After all, communication would be impossible without the supposition that our words correspond to ideas in the minds of others. Second, humans suppose that their words stand for objects in the world. When Smith says “carrot” she wants to refer to more than just her idea, she also wants to refer to the long skinny objects themselves. But Locke is suspicious of these two other ways of understanding signification. He thinks the latter one, in particular, is illegitimate.

After discussing these basic features of language and reference Locke goes on to discuss specific cases of the relationship between ideas and words: words used for simple ideas, words used for modes, words used for substances, the way in which a single word can refer to a multiplicity of ideas, and so forth. There is also an interesting chapter on “particles.” These are words which do not refer to an idea but instead refer to a certain connection which holds between ideas. For example, if I say “Secretariat is brown” the word “Secretariat” refers to my idea of a certain racehorse, and “brown” refers to my idea of a certain color, but the word “is” does something different. That word is a particle and indicates that I am expressing something about the relationship between my ideas of Secretariat and brown and suggesting that they are connected in a certain way. Other particles includes words like “and”, “but”, “hence”, and so forth.

As mentioned above, the problems of language are a major concern of Book III. Locke thinks that language can lead to confusion and misunderstanding for a number of reasons. The signification of words is arbitrary, rather than natural, and this means it can be difficult to understand which words refer to which ideas. Many of our words stand for ideas which are complex, hard to acquire, or both. So many people will struggle to use those words appropriately. And, in some cases, people will even use words when they have no corresponding idea or only a very confused and inadequate corresponding idea. Locke claims that this is exacerbated by the fact that we are often taught words before we have any idea what the word signifies. A child, for example, might be taught the word “government” at a young age, but it will take her years to form a clear idea of what governments are and how they operate. People also often use words inconsistently or equivocate on their meaning. Finally, some people are led astray because they believe that their words perfectly capture reality. Recall from above that people secretly and incorrectly use their words to refer to objects in the external world. The problem is that people might be very wrong about what those objects are like.

Locke thinks that a result of all this is that people are seriously misusing language and that many debates and discussions in important fields like science, politics, and philosophy are confused or consist of merely verbal disputes. Locke provides a number of examples of language causing problems: Cartesians using “body” and “extension” interchangeably, even though the two ideas are distinct; physiologists who agree on all the facts yet have a long dispute because they have different understandings of the word “liquor”; Scholastic philosophers using the term “prime matter” when they are unable to actually frame an idea of such a thing, and so forth.

The remedies that Locke recommends for fixing these problems created by language are somewhat predictable. But Locke is quick to point out that while they sound like easy fixes they are actually quite difficult to implement. The first and most important step is to only use words when we have clear ideas attached to them. (Again, this sounds easy, but many of us might actually struggle to come up with a clear idea corresponding to even everyday terms like “glory” or “fascist”.) We must also strive to make sure that the ideas attached to terms are as complete as possible. We must strive to ensure that we use words consistently and do not equivocate; every time we utter a word we should use it to signify one and the same idea. Finally, we should communicate our definitions of words to others.

e. The Account of Knowledge

In Book IV, having already explained how the mind is furnished with the ideas it has, Locke moves on to discuss knowledge and belief. A good place to start is with a quote from the beginning of Book IV: “Knowledge then seems to me to be nothing but the perception of the connexion and agreement, or disagreement and repugnancy of any of our Ideas. Where this Perception is, there is Knowledge, and where it is not, there, though we may fancy, guess, or believe, yet we always come short of Knowledge.” (4.2.2, 525). Locke spends the first part of Book IV clarifying and exploring this conception of knowledge. The second part focuses on how we should apportion belief in cases where we lack knowledge.

What does Locke mean by the “connection and agreement” and the “disagreement and repugnancy” of our ideas? Some examples might help. Bring to mind your idea of white and your idea of black. Locke thinks that upon doing this you will immediately perceive that they are different, they “disagree”. It is when you perceive this disagreement that you know the fact that white is not black. Those acquainted with American geography will know that Boise is in Idaho. On Locke’s account of knowledge, this means that they are able to perceive a certain connection that obtains between their idea of Idaho and their idea of Boise. Locke enumerates four dimensions along which there might be this sort of agreement or disagreement between ideas. First, we can perceive when two ideas are identical or non-identical. For example, knowing that sweetness is not bitterness consists in perceiving that the idea of sweetness is not identical to the idea of bitterness. Second, we can perceive relations that obtain between ideas. For example, knowing that 7 is greater than 3 consists in perceiving that there is a size relation of bigger and smaller between the two ideas. Third, we can perceive when our idea of a certain feature accompanies our idea of a certain thing. If I know that ice is cold this is because I perceive that my idea of cold always accompanies my idea of ice. Fourthly, we can perceive when existence agrees with any idea. I can have knowledge of this fourth kind when, for example, I perform the cogito and recognize the special relation between my idea of myself and my idea of existence. Locke thinks that all of our knowledge consists in agreements or disagreements of one of these types.

After detailing the types of relations between ideas which constitute knowledge Locke continues on to discuss three “degrees” of knowledge in 4.2. These degrees seem to consist in different ways of knowing something. The first degree Locke calls intuitive knowledge. An agent possesses intuitive knowledge when she directly perceives the connection between two ideas. This is the best kind of knowledge, as Locke says “Such kind of Truths, the Mind perceives at the first sight of the Ideas together, by bare Intuition, without the intervention of any other Idea; and this kind of knowledge is the clearest, and most certain, that humane Frailty is capable of.” (4.2.1, 531). The second degree of knowledge is called demonstrative. Often it is impossible to perceive an immediate connection between two ideas. For example, most of us are unable to tell that the three interior angles of a triangle are equal to two right angles simply by looking at them. But most of us, with the assistance of a mathematics teacher, can be made to see that they are equal by means of a geometric proof or demonstration. This is the model for demonstrative knowledge. Even if one is unable to directly perceive a relation between idea-X and idea-Y one might perceive a relation indirectly by means of idea-A and idea-B. This will be possible if the agent has intuitive knowledge of a connection between X and A, between A and B, and then between B and Y. Demonstrative knowledge consists, therefore, in a string of relations each of which is known intuitively.

The third degree of knowledge is called sensitive knowledge and has been the source of considerable debate and confusion among Locke commentators. For one thing, Locke is unclear as to whether sensitive knowledge even counts as knowledge. He writes that intuitive and demonstrative knowledge are, properly speaking, the only forms of knowledge, but that “There is, indeed, another Perception of the Mind…which going beyond bare probability, and yet not reaching perfectly to either of the foregoing degrees of certainty, passes under the name of Knowledge.” (4.2.14, 537). Sensitive knowledge has to do with the relationship between our ideas and the objects in the external world that produce them. Locke claims that we can be certain that when we perceive something, an orange, for example, there is an object in the external world which is responsible for these sensations. Part of Locke’s claim is that there is a serious qualitative difference between biting into an orange and remembering biting into an orange. There is something in the phenomenological experience of the former which assures us of a corresponding object in the external world.

Locke spends a fair amount of time in Book IV responding to worries that he is a skeptic or that his account of knowledge, with its emphasis on ideas, fails to be responsive to the external world. The general worry for Locke is fairly simple. By claiming that ideas are the only things humans have epistemic access to, and by claiming that knowledge relates only to our ideas, Locke seems to rule out the claim that we can ever know about the external world. Lockean agents are trapped behind a “veil of ideas.” Thus we cannot have any assurance that our ideas provide us with reliable information about the external world. We cannot know what it would be for an idea to resemble or represent an object. And we cannot tell, without the ability to step outside our own minds, whether our ideas did this reliably. This criticism has historically been thought to endanger Locke’s entire project. Gilbert Ryle’s memorable assessment is that “nearly every youthful student of philosophy both can and does in his second essay refute Locke’s entire Theory of Knowledge.” Recent scholarship has been much more charitable to Locke. But the central problem is still a pressing one.

Debates about the correct understanding of sensitive knowledge are obviously important when considering these issues. At first blush, the relation involved in sensitive knowledge seems to be a relation between an idea and a physical object in the world. But, if this reading is correct, then it becomes difficult to understand the many passages in which Locke insists that knowledge is a relation that holds only between ideas. Also relevant are debates about how to correctly understand Lockean ideas. Recall from above that although many understand ideas as mental objects, some understand them as mental acts. While most of the text seems to favor the first interpretation, it seems that the second interpretation has a significant advantage when responding to these skeptical worries. The reason is that the connection between ideas and external world objects is built right into the definition of an idea. An idea just is a perception of an external world object.

However the debates discussed in the previous paragraph are resolved, there is a consensus among commentators that Locke believes the scope of human understanding is very narrow. Humans are not capable of very much knowledge. Locke discusses this is 4.3, a chapter entitled “Extent of Humane Knowledge.” The fact that our knowledge is so limited should come as no surprise. We have already discussed the ways in which our ideas of substances are problematic. And we have just seen that we have no real understanding of the connection between our ideas and the objects that produce them.

The good news, however, is that while our knowledge might not be very extensive, it is sufficient for our needs. Locke’s memorable nautical metaphor holds that: “’Tis of great use to the Sailor to know the length of his Line, though he cannot with it fathom all the depths of the Ocean. ‘Tis well he knows, that it is long enough to reach the bottom, at such Places, as are necessary to direct his Voyage, and caution him against running upon Shoales, that may ruin him. Our Business here is not to know all things, but those which concern our Conduct.” (1.1.6, 46). Locke thinks we have enough knowledge to live comfortable lives on Earth, to realize that there is a God, to understand morality and behave appropriately, and to gain salvation. Our knowledge of morality, in particular, is very good. Locke even suggests that we might develop a demonstrable system of morality similar to Euclid’s demonstrable system of geometry. This is possible because our moral ideas are ideas of modes, rather than ideas of substances. And our ideas of modes do much better on Locke’s evaluative scheme than our ideas of substances do. Finally, while the limits to our knowledge might be disappointing, Locke notes that recognizing these limits is important and useful insofar as it will help us to better organize our intellectual inquiry. We will be saved from investigating questions which we could never know the answers to and can focus our efforts on areas where progress is possible.

One benefit of Locke’s somewhat bleak assessment of the scope of our knowledge was that it caused him to focus on an area which was underappreciated by many of his contemporaries. This was the arena of judgment or opinion, belief states which fall short of knowledge. Given that we have so little knowledge (that we can be certain of so little) the realm of probability becomes very important. Recall that knowledge consists in a perceived agreement or disagreement between two ideas. Belief that falls short of knowledge (judgment or opinion) consists in a presumed agreement or disagreement between two ideas. Consider an example: I am not entirely sure who the Prime Minister of Canada is, but I am somewhat confident it is Stephen Harper. Locke’s claim is that in judging that the Canadian PM is Stephen Harper I am acting as though a relation holds between the two ideas. I do not directly perceive a connection between my idea of Stephen Harper and my idea of the Canadian PM, but I presume that one exists.

After offering this account of what judgment is, Locke offers an analysis of how and why we form the opinions we do and offers some recommendations for forming our opinions responsibly. This includes a diagnosis of the errors people make in judging, a discussion of the different degrees of assent, and an interesting discussion of the epistemic value of testimony.

3. Special Topics in the Essay

As discussed above, the main project of the Essay is an examination of the human understanding and an analysis of knowledge. But the Essay is a rather expansive work and contains discussion of many other topics of philosophical interest. Some of these will be discussed below. A word of warning, however, is required before proceeding. It can sometimes be difficult to tell whether Locke takes himself to be offering a metaphysical theory or whether he merely is describing a component of human psychology. For example, we might question whether his account of personal identity is meant to give necessary and sufficient conditions for a metaphysical account of personhood or whether it is merely designed to tell us what sorts of identity attributions we do and should make and why. We may further question whether, when discussing primary and secondary qualities, Locke is offering a theory about how perception really works or whether this discussion is a mere digression used to illustrate a point about the nature of our ideas. So while many of these topics have received a great deal of attention, their precise relationship to the main project of the Essay can be difficult to locate.

a. Primary and Secondary Qualities

Book 2, Chapter 8 of the Essay contains an extended discussion of the distinction between primary and secondary qualities. Locke was hardly original in making this distinction. By the time the Essay was published, it had been made by many others and was even somewhat commonplace. That said, Locke’s formulation of the distinction and his analysis of the related issues has been tremendously influential and has provided the framework for much of the subsequent discussion on the topic.

Locke defines a quality as a power that a body has to produce ideas in us. So a simple object like a baked potato which can produce ideas of brownness, heat, ovular shape, solidity, and determinate size must have a series of corresponding qualities. There must be something in the potato which gives us the idea of brown, something in the potato which gives us the idea of ovular shape, and so on. The primary/secondary quality distinction claims that some of these qualities are very different from others.

Locke motivates the distinction between two types of qualities by discussing how a body could produce an idea in us. The theory of perception endorsed by Locke is highly mechanical. All perception occurs as a result of motion and collision. If I smell the baked potato, there must be small material particles which are flying off of the potato and bumping into nerves in my nose, the motion in the nose-nerves causes a chain reaction along my nervous system until eventually there is some motion in my brain and I experience the idea of a certain smell. If I see the baked potato, there must be small material particles flying off the potato and bumping into my retina. That bumping causes a similar chain reaction which ends in my experience of a certain roundish shape.

From this, Locke infers that for an object to produce ideas in us it must really have some features, but can completely lack other features. This mechanical theory of perception requires that objects producing ideas in us have shape, extension, mobility, and solidity. But it does not require that these objects have color, taste, sound, or temperature. So the primary qualities are qualities actually possessed by bodies. These are features that a body cannot be without. The secondary qualities, by contrast, are not really had by bodies. They are just ways of talking about the ideas that can be produced in us by bodies in virtue of their primary qualities. So when we claim that the baked potato is solid, this means that solidity is one of its fundamental features. But when I claim that it smells a certain earthy kind of way, this just means that its fundamental features are capable of producing the idea of the earthy smell in my mind.

These claims lead to Locke’s claims about resemblance: “From whence I think it is easie to draw this Observation, That the Ideas of primary Qualities of Bodies, are Resemblances of them, and their Patterns do really exist in the Bodies themselves; but the Ideas, produced in us by these Secondary Qualities, have no resemblance of them at all.” (2.8.14, 137). Insofar as my idea of the potato is of something solid, extended, mobile, and possessing a certain shape my idea accurately captures something about the real nature of the potato. But insofar as my idea of the potato is of something with a particular smell, temperature, and taste my ideas do not accurately capture mind-independent facts about the potato.

b. Mechanism

Around the time of the Essay the mechanical philosophy was emerging as the predominant theory about the physical world. The mechanical philosophy held that the fundamental entities in the physical world were small individual bodies called corpuscles. Each corpuscle was solid, extended, and had a certain shape. These corpuscles could combine together to form ordinary objects like rocks, tables, and plants. The mechanical philosophy argued that all features of bodies and all natural phenomena could be explained by appeal to these corpuscles and their basic properties (in particular, size, shape, and motion).

Locke was exposed to the mechanical philosophy while at Oxford and became acquainted with the writings of its most prominent advocates. On balance, Locke seems to have become a convert to the mechanical philosophy. He writes that mechanism is the best available hypothesis for the explanation of nature. We have already seen some of the explanatory work done by mechanism in the Essay. The distinction between primary and secondary qualities was a hallmark of the mechanical philosophy and neatly dovetailed with mechanist accounts of perception. Locke reaffirms his commitment to this account of perception at a number of other points in the Essay. And when discussing material objects Locke is very often happy to allow that they are composed of material corpuscles. What is peculiar, however, is that while the Essay does seem to have a number of passages in which Locke supports mechanical explanations and speaks highly of mechanism, it also contains some highly critical remarks about mechanism and discussions of the limits of the mechanical philosophy.

Locke’s critiques of mechanism can be divided into two strands. First, he recognized that there were a number of observed phenomena which mechanism struggled to explain. Mechanism did offer neat explanations of some observed phenomena. For example, the fact that objects could be seen but not smelled through glass could be explained by positing that the corpuscles which interacted with our retinas were smaller than the ones which interacted with our nostrils. So the sight corpuscles could pass through the spaces between the glass corpuscles, but the smell corpuscles would be turned away. But other phenomena were harder to explain. Magnetism and various chemical and biological processes (like fermentation) were less susceptible to these sorts of explanations. And universal gravitation, which Locke took Newton to have proved the existence of in the Principia, was particularly hard to explain. Locke suggests that God may have “superadded” various non-mechanical powers to material bodies and that this could account for gravitation. (Indeed, at several points he even suggests that God may have superadded the power of thought to matter and that humans might be purely material beings.)

Locke’s second set of critiques pertain to theoretical problems in the mechanical philosophy. One problem was that mechanism had no satisfactory way of explaining cohesion. Why do corpuscles sometimes stick together? If things like tables and chairs are just collections of small corpuscles then they should be very easy to break apart, the same way I can easily separate one group of marbles from another. Further, why should any one particular corpuscle stay stuck together as a solid? What accounts for its cohesion? Again, mechanism seems hard-pressed to offer an answer. Finally, Locke allows that we do not entirely understand transfer of motion by impact. When one corpuscle collides with another we actually do not have a very satisfying explanation for why the second moves away under the force of the impact.

Locke presses these critiques with some skill and in a serious manner. Still, ultimately he is guardedly optimistic about mechanism. This somewhat mixed attitude on Locke’s part has led commentators to debate questions about his exact attitude toward the mechanical philosophy and his motivations for discussing it.

c. Volition and Agency

In Book 2, Chapter 21 of the Essay Locke explores the topic of the will. One of the things which separates people from rocks and billiard balls is our ability to make decisions and control our actions. We feel that we are free in certain respects and that we have the power to choose certain thoughts and actions. Locke calls this power the will. But there are tricky questions about what this power consists in and about what it takes to freely (or voluntarily) choose something. 2.21 contains a delicate and sustained discussion of these tricky questions.

Locke first begins with questions of freedom and then proceeds to a discussion of the will. On Locke’s analysis, we are free to do those things which we both will to do and are physically capable of doing. For example, if I wish to jump into a lake and have no physical maladies which prevent it, then I am free to jump into the lake. By contrast, if I do not wish to jump into the lake, but a friend pushes me in, I did not act freely when I entered the water. Or, if I wish to jump into the lake, but have a spinal injury and cannot move my body, then I do not act freely when I stay on the shore. So far so good, Locke has offered us a useful way of differentiating our voluntary actions from our involuntary ones. But there is still a pressing question about freedom and the will: that of whether the will is itself free. When I am deciding whether or not to jump into the water, is the will determined by outside factors to choose one or the other? Or can it, so to speak, make up its own mind and choose either option?

Locke’s initial position in the chapter is that the will is determined. But in later sections he offers a qualification of sorts. In normal circumstances, the will is determined by what Locke calls uneasiness: “What is it that determines the Will in regard to our Actions? … some (and for the most part the most pressing) uneasiness a Man is at present under. That is that which successively determines the Will, and sets us upon those Actions, we perform.” (2.21.31, 250-1). The uneasiness is caused by the absence of something that is perceived as good. The perception of the thing as good gives rise to a desire for that thing. Suppose I choose to eat a slice of pizza. Locke would say I must have made this choice because the absence of the pizza was troubling me somehow (I was feeling hunger pains, or longing for something savory) and this discomfort gave rise to a desire for food. That desire in turn determined my will to choose to eat pizza.

Locke’s qualification to this account of the will being determined by uneasiness has to do with what he calls suspension. Beginning with the second edition of the Essay, Locke began to argue that the most pressing desire for the most part determines the will, but not always: “For the mind having in most cases, as is evident in Experience, a power to suspend the execution and satisfaction of any of its desires, and so all, one after another, is at liberty to consider the objects of them; examine them on all sides, and weigh them with others.” (2.21.47, 263). So even if, at this moment, my desire for pizza is the strongest desire, Locke thinks I can pause before I decide to eat the pizza and consider the decision. I can consider other items in my desire set: my desire to lose weight, or to leave the pizza for my friend, or to keep a vegan diet. Careful consideration of these other possibilities might have the effect of changing my desire set. If I really focus on how important it is to stay fit and healthy by eating nutritious foods then my desire to leave the pizza might become stronger than my desire to eat it and my will may be determined to choose to not eat the pizza. But of course we can always ask whether a person has a choice whether or not to suspend judgment or whether the suspension of judgment is itself determined by the mind’s strongest desire. On this point Locke is somewhat vague. While most interpreters think our desires determine when judgment is suspended, some others disagree and argue that suspension of judgment offers Lockean agents a robust form of free will.

d. Personhood and Personal Identity

Locke was one of the first philosophers to give serious attention to the question of personal identity. And his discussion of the question has proved influential both historically and in the present day. The discussion occurs in the midst of Locke’ larger discussion of the identity conditions for various entities in Book II, Chapter 27. At heart, the question is simple, what makes me the same person as the person who did certain things in the past and that will do certain things in the future? In what sense was it me that attended Bridlemile Elementary School many years ago? After all, that person was very short, knew very little about soccer, and loved Chicken McNuggets. I, on the other hand, am average height, know tons of soccer trivia, and get rather queasy at the thought of eating chicken, especially in nugget form. Nevertheless, it is true that I am identical to the boy who attended Bridlemile.

In Locke’s time, the topic of personal identity was important for religious reasons. Christian doctrine held that there was an afterlife in which virtuous people would be rewarded in heaven and sinful people would be punished in hell. This scheme provided motivation for individuals to behave morally. But, for this to work, it was important that the person who is rewarded or punished is the same person as the one who lived virtuously or lived sinfully. And this had to be true even though the person being rewarded or punished had died, had somehow continued to exist in an afterlife, and had somehow managed to be reunited with a body. So it was important to get the issue of personal identity right.

Locke’s views on personal identity involve a negative project and a positive project. The negative project involves arguing against the view that personal identity consists in or requires the continued existence of a particular substance. And the positive project involves defending the view that personal identity consists in continuity of consciousness. We can begin with this positive view. Locke defines a person as “a thinking intelligent Being, that has reason and reflection, and can consider itself as itself, the same thinking thing in different times and places; which it does only by that consciousness, which is inseparable from thinking, and as it seems to me essential to it.” (2.27.9, 335). Locke suggests here that part of what makes a person the same through time is their ability to recognize past experiences as belonging to them. For me, part of what differentiates one little boy who attended Bridlemile Elementary from all the other children who went there is my realization that I share in his consciousness. Put differently, my access to his lived experience at Bridlemile is very different from my access to the lived experiences of others there: it is first-personal and immediate. I recognize his experiences there as part of a string of experiences that make up my life and join up to my current self and current experiences in a unified way. That is what makes him the same person as me.

Locke believes that this account of personal identity as continuity of consciousness obviates the need for an account of personal identity given in terms of substances. A traditional view held that there was a metaphysical entity, the soul, which guaranteed personal identity through time; wherever there was the same soul, the same person would be there as well. Locke offers a number of thought experiments to cast doubt on this belief and show that his account is superior. For example, if a soul was wiped clean of all its previous experiences and given new ones (as might be the case if reincarnation were true), the same soul would not justify the claim that all of those who had had it were the same person. Or, we could imagine two souls who had their conscious experiences completely swapped. In this case, we would want to say that the person went with the conscious experiences and did not remain with the soul.

Locke’s account of personal identity seems to be a deliberate attempt to move away from some of the metaphysical alternatives and to offer an account which would be acceptable to individuals from a number of different theological backgrounds. Of course, a number of serious challenges have been raised for Locke’s account.. Most of these focus on the crucial role seemingly played by memory. And the precise details of Locke’s positive proposal in 2.27 have been hard to pin down. Nevertheless, many contemporary philosophers believe that there is an important kernel of truth in Locke’s analysis.

e. Real and Nominal Essences

Locke’s distinction between the real essence of a substance and the nominal essence of a substance is one of the most fascinating components of the Essay. Scholastic philosophers had held that the main goal of metaphysics and science was to learn about the essences of things: the key metaphysical components of things which explained all of their interesting features. Locke thought this project was misguided. That sort of knowledge, knowledge of the real essences of beings, was unavailable to human beings. This led Locke to suggest an alternative way to understand and investigate nature; he recommends focusing on the nominal essences of things.

When Locke introduces the term real essence he uses it to refer to the “real constitution of any Thing, which is the foundation of all those Properties, that are combined in, and are constantly found to co-exist with [an object]” (3.6.6, 442). For the Scholastics this real essence would be an object’s substantial form. For proponents of the mechanical philosophy it would be the number and arrangement of the material corpuscles which composed the body. Locke sometimes endorses this latter understanding of real essence. But he insists that these real essences are entirely unknown and undiscoverable by us. The nominal essences, by contrast, are known and are the best way we have to understand individual substances. Nominal essences are just collections of all the observed features an individual thing has. So the nominal essence of a piece of gold would include the ideas of yellowness, a certain weight, malleability, dissolvability in certain chemicals, and so on.

Locke offers us a helpful analogy to illustrate the difference between real and nominal essences. He suggests that our position with respect to ordinary objects is like the position of someone looking at a very complicated clock. The gears, wheels, weights, and pendulum that produce the motions of the hands on the clock face (the clock’s real essence) are unknown to the person. They are hidden behind the casing. He or she can only know about the observable features like the clock’s shape, the movement of the hands, and the chiming of the hours (the clock’s nominal essence). Similarly, when I look at an object like a dandelion, I am only able to observe its nominal essence (the yellow color, the bitter smell, and so forth). I have no clear idea what produces these features of the dandelion or how they are produced.

Locke’s views on real and nominal essences have important consequences for his views about the division of objects into groups and sorts. Why do we consider some things to be zebras and other things to be rabbits? Locke’s view is that we group according to nominal essence, not according to (unknown) real essence. But this has the consequence that our groupings might fail to adequately reflect whatever real distinctions there might be in nature. So Locke is not a realist about species or types. Instead, he is a conventionalist. We project these divisions on the world when we choose to classify objects as falling under the various nominal essences we’ve created.

f. Religious Epistemology

The epistemology of religion (claims about our understanding of God and our duties with respect to him) were tremendously contentious during Locke’s lifetime. The English Civil War, fought during Locke’s youth, was in large part a disagreement over the right way to understand the Christian religion and the requirements of religious faith. Throughout the seventeenth century, a number of fundamentalist Christian sects continually threatened the stability of English political life. And the status of Catholic and Jewish people in England was a vexed one.

So the stakes were very high when, in 4.18, Locke discussed the nature of faith and reason and their respective domains. He defines reason as an attempt to discover certainty or probability through the use of our natural faculties in the investigation of the world. Faith, by contrast, is certainty or probability attained through a communication believed to have come, originally, from God. So when Smith eats a potato chip and comes to believe it is salty, she believes this according to reason. But when Smith believes that Joshua made the sun stand still in the sky because she read it in the Bible (which she takes to be divine revelation), she believes according to faith.

Although it initially sounds as though Locke has carved out quite separate roles for faith and reason, it must be noted that these definitions make faith subordinate to reason in a subtle way. For, as Locke explains: “Whatever GOD hath revealed, is certainly true; no Doubt can be made of it. This is the proper Object of Faith: But whether it be a divine Revelation, or no, Reason must judge; which can never permit the Mind to reject a greater Evidence to embrace what is less evident, nor allow it to entertain Probability in opposition to Knowledge and Certainty.” (4.18.10, 695). First, Locke thinks that if any proposition, even one which purports to be divinely revealed, clashes with the clear evidence of reason then it should not be believed. So, even if it seems like God is telling us that 1+1=3, Locke claims we should go on believing that 1+1=2 and we should deny that the 1+1=3 revelation was genuine. Second, Locke thinks that to determine whether or not something is divinely revealed we have to exercise our reason. How can we tell whether the Bible contains God’s direct revelation conveyed through the inspired Biblical authors or whether it is instead the work of mere humans? Only reason can help us settle that question. Locke thinks that those who ignore the importance of reason in determining what is and is not a matter of faith are guilty of “enthusiasm.” And in a chapter added to later editions of the Essay Locke sternly warns his readers against the serious dangers posed by this intellectual vice.

In all of this Locke emerges as a strong moderate. He himself was deeply religious and took religious faith to be important. But he also felt that there were serious limits to what could be justified through appeals to faith. The issues discussed in this section will be very important below where Locke’s views on the importance of religious toleration are discussed.

4. Political Philosophy

Locke lived during a very eventful time in English politics. The Civil War, Interregnum, Restoration, Exclusion Crisis, and Glorious Revolution all happened during his lifetime. For much of his life Locke held administrative positions in government and paid very careful attention to contemporary debates in political theory. So it is perhaps unsurprising that he wrote a number of works on political issues. In this field, Locke is best known for his arguments in favor of religious toleration and limited government. Today these ideas are commonplace and widely accepted. But in Locke’s time they were highly innovative, even radical.

a. The Two Treatises

Locke’s Two Treatises of Government were published in 1689. It was originally thought that they were intended to defend the Glorious Revolution and William’s seizure of the throne. We now know, however, that they were in fact composed much earlier. Nonetheless, they do lay out a view of government amenable to many of William’s supporters.

The First Treatise is now of primarily historical interest. It takes the form of a detailed critique of a work called Patriacha by Robert Filmer. Filmer had argued, in a rather unsophisticated way, in favor of divine right monarchy. On his view, the power of kings ultimately originated in the dominion which God gave to Adam and which had passed down in an unbroken chain through the ages. Locke disputes this picture on a number of historical grounds. Perhaps more importantly, Locke also distinguishes between a number of different types of dominion or governing power which Filmer had run together.

After clearing some ground in the First Treatise, Locke offers a positive view of the nature of government in the much better known Second Treatise. Part of Locke’s strategy in this work was to offer a different account of the origins of government. While Filmer had suggested that humans had always been subject to political power, Locke argues for the opposite. According to him, humans were initially in a state of nature. The state of nature was apolitical in the sense that there were no governments and each individual retained all of his or her natural rights. People possessed these natural rights (including the right to attempt to preserve one’s life, to seize unclaimed valuables, and so forth) because they were given by God to all of his people.

The state of nature was inherently unstable. Individuals would be under constant threat of physical harm. And they would be unable to pursue any goals that required stability and widespread cooperation with other humans. Locke’s claim is that government arose in this context. Individuals, seeing the benefits which could be gained, decided to relinquish some of their rights to a central authority while retaining other rights. This took the form of a contract. In agreement for relinquishing certain rights, individuals would receive protection from physical harm, security for their possessions, and the ability to interact and cooperate with other humans in a stable environment.

So, according to this view, governments were instituted by the citizens of those governments. This has a number of very important consequences. On this view, rulers have an obligation to be responsive to the needs and desires of these citizens. Further, in establishing a government the citizens had relinquished some, but not all of their original rights. So no ruler could claim absolute power over all elements of a citizen’s life. This carved out important room for certain individual rights or liberties. Finally, and perhaps most importantly, a government which failed to adequately protect the rights and interests of its citizens or a government which attempted to overstep its authority would be failing to perform the task for which it was created. As such, the citizens would be entitled to revolt and replace the existing government with one which would suitably carry out the duties of ensuring peace and civil order while respecting individual rights.

So Locke was able to use the account of natural rights and a government created through contract to accomplish a number of important tasks. He could use it to show why individuals retain certain rights even when they are subject to a government. He could use it to show why despotic governments which attempted to unduly infringe on the rights of their citizens were bad. And he could use it to show that citizens had a right to revolt in instances where governments failed in certain ways. These are powerful ideas which remain important even today.

For more. see the article Political Philosophy.

b. Property

Locke’s Second Treatise on government contains an influential account of the nature of private property. According to Locke, God gave humans the world and its contents to have in common. The world was to provide humans with what was necessary for the continuation and enjoyment of life. But Locke also believed it was possible for individuals to appropriate individual parts of the world and justly hold them for their own exclusive use. Put differently, Locke believed that we have a right to acquire private property.

Locke’s claim is that we acquire property by mixing our labor with some natural resource. For example, if I discover some grapes growing on a vine, through my labor in picking and collecting these grapes I acquire an ownership right over them. If I find an empty field and then use my labor to plow the field then plant and raise crops, I will be the proper owner of those crops. If I chop down trees in an unclaimed forest and use the wood to fashion a table, then that table will be mine. Locke places two important limitations on the way in which property can be acquired by mixing one’s labor with natural resources. First, there is what has come to be known as the Waste Proviso. One must not take so much property that some of it goes to waste. I should not appropriate gallons and gallons of grapes if I am only able to eat a few and the rest end up rotting. If the goods of the Earth were given to us by God, it would be inappropriate to allow some of this gift to go to waste. Second, there is the Enough-And-As-Good Proviso. This says that in appropriating resources I am required to leave enough and as good for others to appropriate. If the world was left to us in common by God, it would be wrong of me to appropriate more than my fair share and fail to leave sufficient resources for others.

After currency is introduced and after governments are established the nature of property obviously changes a great deal. Using metal, which can be made into coins and which does not perish the way foodstuffs and other goods do, individuals are able to accumulate much more wealth than would be possible otherwise. So the proviso concerning waste seems to drop away. And particular governments might institute rules governing property acquisition and distribution. Locke was aware of this and devoted a great deal of thought to the nature of property and the proper distribution of property within a commonwealth. His writings on economics, monetary policy, charity, and social welfare systems are evidence of this. But Locke’s views on property inside of a commonwealth have received far less attention than his views on the original acquisition of property in the state of nature.

c. Toleration

Locke had been systematically thinking about issues relating to religious toleration since his early years in London and even though he only published his Epistola de Tolerantia (A Letter Concerning Toleration) in 1689 he had finished writing it several years before. The question of whether or not a state should attempt to prescribe one particular religion within the state, what means states might use to do so, and what the correct attitude should be toward those who resist conversion to the official state religion had been central to European politics ever since the Protestant Reformation. Locke’s time in England, France, and the Netherlands had given him experiences of three very different approaches to these questions. These experiences had convinced him that, for the most part, individuals should be allowed to practice their religion without interference from the state. Indeed, part of the impetus for the publication of Locke’s Letter Concerning Toleration came from Louis XIV’s revocation of the Edict of Nantes, which took away the already limited rights of Protestants in France and exposed them to state persecution.

It is possible to see Locke’s arguments in favor of toleration as relating both to the epistemological views of the Essay and the political views of the Two Treatises. Relating to Locke’s epistemological views, recall from above that Locke thought the scope of human knowledge was extremely restricted. We might not be particularly good at determining what the correct religion is. There is no reason to think that those holding political power will be any better at discovering the true religion than anyone else, so they should not attempt to enforce their views on others. Instead, each individual should be allowed to pursue true beliefs as best as they are able. Little harm results from allowing others to have their own religious beliefs. Indeed, it might be beneficial to allow a plurality of beliefs because one group might end up with the correct beliefs and win others over to their side.

Relating to Locke’s political views, as expressed in the Two Treatises, Locke endorses toleration on the grounds that the enforcement of religious conformity is outside the proper scope of government. People consent to governments for the purpose of establishing social order and the rule of law. Governments should refrain from enforcing religious conformity because doing so is unnecessary and irrelevant for these ends. Indeed, attempting to enforce conformity may positively harm these ends as it will likely lead to resistance from members of prohibited religions. Locke also suggests that governments should tolerate the religious beliefs of individual citizens because enforcing religious belief is actually impossible. Acceptance of a certain religion is an inward act, a function of one’s beliefs. But governments are designed to control people’s actions. So governments are, in many ways, ill-equipped to enforce the adoption of a particular religion because individual people have an almost perfect control of their own thoughts.

While Locke’s views on toleration were very progressive for the time and while his views do have an affinity with our contemporary consensus on the value of religious toleration it is important to recognize that Locke did place some severe limits on toleration. He did not think that we should tolerate the intolerant, those who would seek to forcibly impose their religious views on others. Similarly, any religious group who posed a threat to political stability or public safety should not be tolerated. Importantly, Locke included Roman Catholics in this group. On his view, Catholics had a fundamental allegiance to the Pope, a foreign prince who did not recognize the sovereignty of English law. This made Catholics a threat to civil government and peace. Finally, Locke also believed that atheists should not be tolerated. Because they did not believe they would be rewarded or punished for their actions in an afterlife, Locke did not think they could be trusted to behave morally or maintain their contractual obligations.

5. Theology

We have already seen that in the Essay Locke developed an account of belief according to faith and belief according to reason. Recall that an agent believes according to reason when she discovers something through the use of her natural faculties and she believes according to faith when she takes something as truth because she understands it to be a message from God. Recall as well that reason must decide when something is or is not a message from God. The goal of Locke’s The Reasonableness of Christianity is to show that it is reasonable to be a Christian. Locke argues that we do have sufficient reason to think that the central truths of Christianity were communicated to us by God through his messenger, Jesus of Nazareth.

For Locke’s project to succeed he needed to show that Jesus provided his original followers with sufficient evidence that he was a legitimate messenger from God. Given that numerous individuals in history had purported to be the recipients of divine revelation, there must be something special which set Jesus apart. Locke offers two considerations in this regard. The first is that Jesus fulfilled a number of historical predictions concerning the coming of a Messiah. The second is that Jesus performed a number of miracles which attest that he had a special relationship to God. Locke also claims that we have sufficient reason to believe that these miracles actually occurred on the basis of testimony from those who witnessed them first-hand and a reliable chain of reporting from Jesus’ time into our own. This argument leads Locke into a discussion of the types and value of testimony which many philosophers have found to be interesting in its own right.

One striking feature of The Reasonableness of Christianity is the requirement for salvation that Locke endorses. Disputes about which precise beliefs were necessary for salvation and eternal life in Heaven were at the core of much religious disagreement in Locke’s time. Different denominations and sects claimed that they, and often only they, had the correct beliefs. Locke, by contrast, argued that to be a true Christian and worthy of salvation an individual only need to believe one simple truth: that Jesus is the Messiah. Of course, Locke believed there were many other important truths in the Bible. But he thought these other truths, especially those contained in the Epistles rather than the Gospels, could be difficult to interpret and could lead to disputes and disagreement. The core tenet of Christianity, however, that Jesus is the Messiah, was a mandatory belief.

In making the requirements for Christian faith and salvation so minimal Locke was part of a growing faction in the Church of England. These individuals, often known as latitudinarians, were deliberately attempting to construct a more irenic Christianity with the goal of avoiding the conflict and controversy that previous internecine fights had produced. So Locke was hardly alone in attempting to find a set of core Christian commitments which were free of sectarian theological baggage. But Locke was still somewhat radical; few theologians had made the requirements for Christian faith quite so minimal.

6. Education

Locke was regarded by many in his time as an expert on educational matters. He taught many students at Oxford and also served as a private tutor. Locke’s correspondence shows that he was constantly asked to recommend tutors and offer pedagogical advice. Locke’s expertise led to his most important work on the subject: Some Thoughts Concerning Education. The work had its origins in a series of letters Locke wrote to Edward Clarke offering advice on the education of Clarke’s children and was first published in 1693.

Locke’s views on education were, for the time, quite forward-looking. Classical languages, usually learned through tedious exercises involving rote memorization, and corporeal punishment were two predominant features of the seventeenth century English educational system. Locke saw little use for either. Instead, he emphasized the importance of teaching practical knowledge. He recognized that children learn best when they are engaged with the subject matter. Locke also foreshadowed some contemporary pedagogical views by suggesting that children should be allowed some self-direction in their course of study and should have the ability to pursue their interests.

Locke believed it was important to take great care in educating the young. He recognized that habits and prejudices formed in youth could be very hard to break in later life. Thus, much of Some Thoughts Concerning Education focuses on morality and the best ways to inculcate virtue and industry. Locke rejected authoritarian approaches. Instead, he favored methods that would help children to understand the difference between right and wrong and to cultivate a moral sense of their own.

7. Locke’s Influence

The Essay was quickly recognized as an important philosophical contribution both by its admirers and by its critics. Before long it had been incorporated into the curriculum at Oxford and Cambridge and its translation into both Latin and French garnered it an audience on the Continent as well. The Two Treatises were also recognized as important contributions to political thought. While the work had some success in England among those favorably disposed to the Glorious Revolution, its primary impact was abroad. During the American Revolution (and to a lesser extent, during the French Revolution) Locke’s views were often appealed to by those seeking to establish more representative forms of government.

Related to this last point, Locke came to be seen, alongside his friend Newton, as an embodiment of Enlightenment values and ideals. Newtonian science would lay bare the workings of nature and lead to important technological advances. Lockean philosophy would lay bare the workings of men’s minds and lead to important reforms in law and government. Voltaire played an instrumental role in shaping this legacy for Locke and worked hard to publicize Locke’s views on reason, toleration, and limited government. Locke also came to be seen as an inspiration for the Deist movement. Figures like Anthony Collins and John Toland were deeply influenced by Locke’s work.

Locke is often recognized as the founder of British Empiricism and it is true that Locke laid the foundation for much of English-language philosophy in the 18^th and early 19^th centuries. But those who followed in his footsteps were not unquestioning followers. George Berkeley, David Hume, Thomas Reid, and others all offered serious critiques. In recent decades, readers have attempted to offer more charitable reconstructions of Locke’s philosophy. Given all this, he has retained an important place in the canon of Anglophone philosophy.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Locke’s Works

Laslett, P. [ed.] 1988. Two Treatises of Government. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Locke, J. 1823. The Works of John Locke. London: Printed for T. Tegg (10 volumes).
Locke, J. The Clarendon Edition of the Works of John Locke, Oxford University Press, 2015. This edition includes the following volumes:
Nidditch, P. [ed.] 1975. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding.
Nidditch, P. and G.A.J. Rogers [eds.] 1990. Drafts for the Essay Concerning Human Understanding.
Yolton, J.W. and J.S. Yolton. [eds.] 1989. Some Thoughts Concerning Education.
Higgins-Biddle, J.C. [ed.] 1999. The Reasonableness of Christianity.
Milton, J.R. and P. Milton. [eds.] 2006. An Essay Concerning Toleration.
de Beer, E.S. [ed.] 1976-1989. The Correspondence of John Locke. (8 volumes).
von Leyden, W. [ed.] 1954. Essays on the Law of Nature. Oxford: Clarendon Press.

b. Recommended Reading

The following are recommendations for further reading on Locke. Each work has a brief statement indicating the contents

Anstey, P. 2011. John Locke & Natural Philosophy. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
A thorough examination of Locke’s scientific and medical thinking.
Ayers, M. 1993. Locke: Epistemology and Ontology. New York: Routledge.
A classic in Locke studies. Explores philosophical topics in the Essay and discusses Locke’s project as a whole. One volume on epistemology and one on metaphysics.
Chappell, V. 1994. The Cambridge Companion to Locke. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
A series of essays focusing on all aspects of Locke’s thought.
LoLordo, A. 2012. Locke’s Moral Man. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
An exploration and discussion of themes at the intersection of Locke’s moral and political thought. Focuses particularly on agency, personhood, and rationality.
Lowe, E.J. 2005. Locke. New York: Routledge.
An introductory overview of Locke’s philosophical and political thought.
Mackie, J.L. 1976. Problems from Locke. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Uses Locke’s work to raise and discuss a number of philosophical issues and puzzles.
Newman, L. 2007. The Cambridge Companion to Locke’s Essay Concerning Human Understanding. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
A series of essays focusing on specific issues in Locke’s Essay.
Pyle, A.J. 2013. Locke. London: Polity.
An excellent and brief introduction to Locke’s thought and historical context. A very good place to start for beginners.
Rickless, S. 2014. Locke. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
An introductory overview of Locke’s philosophical and political thought.
Stuart, M. 2013. Locke’s Metaphysics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
An in-depth treatment of metaphysical issues and problems in the Essay.
Waldron, J. 2002. God, Locke, and Equality: Christian Foundation of Locke’s Political Thought. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
An examination of some key issues in Locke’s political thought.
Woolhouse, R. 2009. Locke: A Biography. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
The best and most recent biography of Locke’s life.

Author Information

Patrick J. Connolly
Email: pac317@lehigh.edu
Lehigh University
U. S. A.

Act and Rule Utilitarianism

Utilitarianism is one of the best known and most influential moral theories. Like other forms of consequentialism, its core idea is that whether actions are morally right or wrong depends on their effects. More specifically, the only effects of actions that are relevant are the good and bad results that they produce. A key point in this article concerns the distinction between individual actions and types of actions. Act utilitarians focus on the effects of individual actions (such as John Wilkes Booth’s assassination of Abraham Lincoln) while rule utilitarians focus on the effects of types of actions (such as killing or stealing).

Utilitarians believe that the purpose of morality is to make life better by increasing the amount of good things (such as pleasure and happiness) in the world and decreasing the amount of bad things (such as pain and unhappiness). They reject moral codes or systems that consist of commands or taboos that are based on customs, traditions, or orders given by leaders or supernatural beings. Instead, utilitarians think that what makes a morality be true or justifiable is its positive contribution to human (and perhaps non-human) beings.

The most important classical utilitarians are Jeremy Bentham (1748-1832) and John Stuart Mill (1806-1873). Bentham and Mill were both important theorists and social reformers. Their theory has had a major impact both on philosophical work in moral theory and on approaches to economic, political, and social policy. Although utilitarianism has always had many critics, there are many 21^st century thinkers that support it.

The task of determining whether utilitarianism is the correct moral theory is complicated because there are different versions of the theory, and its supporters disagree about which version is correct. This article focuses on perhaps the most important dividing line among utilitarians, the clash between act utilitarianism and rule utilitarianism. After a brief overall explanation of utilitarianism, the article explains both act utilitarianism and rule utilitarianism, the main differences between them, and some of the key arguments for and against each view.

Utilitarianism: Overall View
How Act Utilitarianism and Rule Utilitarianism Differ
Act Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons
Rule Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons
1. Arguments for Rule Utilitarianism
  1. Why Rule Utilitarianism Maximizes Utility
  2. Rule Utilitarianism Avoids the Criticisms of Act Utilitarianism
2. Arguments against Rule Utilitarianism
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Utilitarianism: Overall View

Utilitarianism is a philosophical view or theory about how we should evaluate a wide range of things that involve choices that people face. Among the things that can be evaluated are actions, laws, policies, character traits, and moral codes. Utilitarianism is a form of consequentialism because it rests on the idea that it is the consequences or results of actions, laws, policies, etc. that determine whether they are good or bad, right or wrong. In general, whatever is being evaluated, we ought to choose the one that will produce the best overall results. In the language of utilitarians, we should choose the option that “maximizes utility,” i.e. that action or policy that produces the largest amount of good.

Utilitarianism appears to be a simple theory because it consists of only one evaluative principle: Do what produces the best consequences. In fact, however, the theory is complex because we cannot understand that single principle unless we know (at least) three things: a) what things are good and bad; b) whose good (i.e. which individuals or groups) we should aim to maximize; and c) whether actions, policies, etc. are made right or wrong by their actual consequences (the results that our actions actually produce) or by their foreseeable consequences (the results that we predict will occur based on the evidence that we have).

a. What is Good?

Jeremy Bentham answered this question by adopting the view called hedonism. According to hedonism, the only thing that is good in itself is pleasure (or happiness). Hedonists do not deny that many different kinds of things can be good, including food, friends, freedom, and many other things, but hedonists see these as “instrumental” goods that are valuable only because they play a causal role in producing pleasure or happiness. Pleasure and happiness, however, are “intrinsic” goods, meaning that they are good in themselves and not because they produce some further valuable thing. Likewise, on the negative side, a lack of food, friends, or freedom is instrumentally bad because it produces pain, suffering, and unhappiness; but pain, suffering and unhappiness are intrinsically bad, i.e. bad in themselves and not because they produce some further bad thing.

Many thinkers have rejected hedonism because pleasure and pain are sensations that we feel, claiming that many important goods are not types of feelings. Being healthy or honest or having knowledge, for example, are thought by some people to be intrinsic goods that are not types of feelings. (People who think there are many such goods are called pluralists or“objective list” theorists.) Other thinkers see desires or preferences as the basis of value; whatever a person desires is valuable to that person. If desires conflict, then the things most strongly preferred are identified as good.

In this article, the term “well-being” will generally be used to identify what utilitarians see as good or valuable in itself. All utilitarians agree that things are valuable because they tend to produce well-being or diminish ill-being, but this idea is understood differently by hedonists, objective list theorists, and preference/desire theorists. This debate will not be further discussed in this article.

b. Whose Well-being?

Utilitarian reasoning can be used for many different purposes. It can be used both for moral reasoning and for any type of rational decision-making. In addition to applying in different contexts, it can also be used for deliberations about the interests of different persons and groups.

i. Individual Self-interest

(See egoism.) When individuals are deciding what to do for themselves alone, they consider only their own utility. For example, if you are choosing ice cream for yourself, the utilitarian view is that you should choose the flavor that will give you the most pleasure. If you enjoy chocolate but hate vanilla, you should choose chocolate for the pleasure it will bring and avoid vanilla because it will bring displeasure. In addition, if you enjoy both chocolate and strawberry, you should predict which flavor will bring you more pleasure and choose whichever one will do that.

In this case, because utilitarian reasoning is being applied to a decision about which action is best for an individual person, it focuses only on how the various possible choices will affect this single person’s interest and does not consider the interests of other people.

ii. Groups

People often need to judge what is best not only for themselves or other individuals but alsowhat is best for groups, such as friends, families, religious groups, one’s country, etc. Because Bentham and other utilitarians were interested in political groups and public policies, they often focused on discovering which actions and policies would maximize the well-being of the relevant group. Their method for determining the well-being of a group involved adding up the benefits and losses that members of the group would experience as a result of adopting one action or policy. The well-being of the group is simply the sum total of the interests of the all of its members.

To illustrate this method, suppose that you are buying ice cream for a party that ten people will attend. Your only flavor options are chocolate and vanilla, and some of the people attending like chocolate while others like vanilla. As a utilitarian, you should choose the flavor that will result in the most pleasure for the group as a whole. If seven like chocolate and three like vanilla and if all of them get the same amount of pleasure from the flavor they like, then you should choose chocolate. This will yield what Bentham, in a famous phrase, called “the greatest happiness for the greatest number.”

An important point in this case is that you should choose chocolate even if you are one of the three people who enjoy vanilla more than chocolate. The utilitarian method requires you to count everyone’s interests equally. You may not weigh some people’s interests—including your own—more heavily than others. Similarly, if a government is choosing a policy, it should give equal consideration to the well-being of all members of the society.

iii. Everyone Affected

While there are circumstances in which the utilitarian analysis focuses on the interests of specific individuals or groups, the utilitarian moral theory requires that moral judgments be based on what Peter Singer calls the “equal consideration of interests.” Utilitarianism moral theory then, includes the important idea that when we calculate the utility of actions, laws, or policies, we must do so from an impartial perspective and not from a “partialist” perspective that favors ourselves, our friends, or others we especially care about. Bentham is often cited as the source of a famous utilitarian axiom: “every man to count for one, nobody for more than one.”

If this impartial perspective is seen as necessary for a utilitarian morality, then both self-interest and partiality to specific groups will be rejected as deviations from utilitarian morality. For example, so-called “ethical egoism,” which says that morality requires people to promote their own interest, would be rejected either as a false morality or as not a morality at all. While a utilitarian method for determining what people’s interests are may show that it is rational for people to maximize their own well-being or the well-being of groups that they favor, utilitarian morality would reject this as a criterion for determining what is morally right or wrong.

c. Actual Consequences or Foreseeable Consequences?

Utilitarians disagree about whether judgments of right and wrong should be based on the actual consequences of actions or their foreseeable consequences. This issue arises when the actual effects of actions differ from what we expected. J. J. C. Smart (49) explains this difference by imagining the action of a person who, in 1938,saves someone from drowning. While we generally regard saving a drowning person as the right thing to do and praise people for such actions, in Smart’s imagined example, the person saved from drowning turns out to be Adolf Hitler. Had Hitler drowned, millions of other people might have been saved from suffering and death between 1938 and 1945. If utilitarianism evaluates the rescuer’s action based on its actual consequences, then the rescuer did the wrong thing. If, however, utilitarians judge the rescuer’s action by its foreseeable consequences (i.e. the ones the rescuer could reasonably predict), then the rescuer—who could not predict the negative effects of saving the person from drowning—did the right thing.

One reason for adopting foreseeable consequence utilitarianism is that it seems unfair to say that the rescuer acted wrongly because the rescuer could not foresee the future bad effects of saving the drowning person. In response, actual consequence utilitarians reply that there is a difference between evaluating an action and evaluating the person who did the action. In their view, while the rescuer’s action was wrong, it would be a mistake to blame or criticize the rescuer because the bad results of his act were unforeseeable. They stress the difference between evaluating actions and evaluating the people who perform them.

Foreseeable consequence utilitarians accept the distinction between evaluating actions and evaluating the people who carry them out, but they see no reason to make the moral rightness or wrongness of actions depend on facts that might be unknowable. For them, what is right or wrong for a person to do depends on what is knowable by a person at a time. For this reason, they claim that the person who rescued Hitler did the right thing, even though the actual consequences were unfortunate.

Another way to describe the actual vs. foreseeable consequence dispute is to contrast two thoughts. One (the actual consequence view) says that to act rightly is to do whatever produces the best consequences. The second view says that a person acts rightly by doing the action that has the highest level of “expected utility.” The expected utility is a combination of the good (or bad) effects that one predicts will result from an action and the probability of those effects occurring. In the case of the rescuer, the expected positive utility is high because the probability that saving a drowning person will lead to the deaths of millions of other people is extremely low, and thus can be ignored in deliberations about whether to save the drowning person.

What this shows is that actual consequence and foreseeable consequence utilitarians have different views about the nature of utilitarian theory. Foreseeable consequence utilitarians understand the theory as a decision-making procedure while actual consequence utilitarians understand it as a criterion of right and wrong. Foreseeable consequence utilitarians claim that the action with the highest expected utility is both the best thing to do based on current evidence and the right action. Actual consequence utilitarians might agree that the option with the highest expected utility is the best thing to do but they claim that it could still turn out to be the wrong action. This would occur if unforeseen bad consequences reveal that the option chosen did not have the best results and thus was the wrong thing to do.

2. How Act Utilitarianism and Rule Utilitarianism Differ

Both act utilitarians and rule utilitarians agree that our overall aim in evaluating actions should be to create the best results possible, but they differ about how to do that.

Act utilitarians believe that whenever we are deciding what to do, we should perform the action that will create the greatest net utility. In their view, the principle of utility—do whatever will produce the best overall results—should be applied on a case by case basis. The right action in any situation is the one that yields more utility (i.e. creates more well-being) than other available actions.

Rule utilitarians adopt a two part view that stresses the importance of moral rules. According to rule utilitarians, a) a specific action is morally justified if it conforms to a justified moral rule; and b) a moral rule is justified if its inclusion into our moral code would create more utility than other possible rules (or no rule at all). According to this perspective, we should judge the morality of individual actions by reference to general moral rules, and we should judge particular moral rules by seeing whether their acceptance into our moral code would produce more well-being than other possible rules.

The key difference between act and rule utilitarianism is that act utilitarians apply the utilitarian principle directly to the evaluation of individual actions while rule utilitarians apply the utilitarian principle directly to the evaluation of rules and then evaluate individual actions by seeing if they obey or disobey those rules whose acceptance will produce the most utility.

The contrast between act and rule utilitarianism, though previously noted by some philosophers, was not sharply drawn until the late 1950s when Richard Brandt introduced this terminology. (Other terms that have been used to make this contrast are “direct” and “extreme” for act utilitarianism, and “indirect” and “restricted” for rule utilitarianism.) Because the contrast had not been sharply drawn, earlier utilitarians like Bentham and Mill sometimes apply the principle of utility to actions and sometimes apply it to the choice of rules for evaluating actions. This has led to scholarly debates about whether the classical utilitarians supported act utilitarians or rule utilitarians or some combination of these views. One indication that Mill accepted rule utilitarianism is his claim that direct appeal to the principle of utility is made only when “secondary principles” (i.e. rules) conflict with one another. In such cases, the “maximize utility” principle is used to resolve the conflict and determine the right action to take. [Mill, Utilitarianism, Chapter 2]

3. Act Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons

Act utilitarianism is often seen as the most natural interpretation of the utilitarian ideal. If our aim is always to produce the best results, it seems plausible to think that in each case of deciding what is the right thing to do, we should consider the available options (i.e. what actions could be performed), predict their outcomes, and approve of the action that will produce the most good.

a. Arguments for Act Utilitarianism

i. Why Act utilitarianism Maximizes Utility

If every action that we carry out yields more utility than any other action available to us, then the total utility of all our actions will be the highest possible level of utility that we could bring about. In other words, we can maximize the overall utility that is within our power to bring about by maximizing the utility of each individual action that we perform. If we sometimes choose actions that produce less utility than is possible, the total utility of our actions will be less than the amount of goodness that we could have produced. For that reason, act utilitarians argue, we should apply the utilitarian principle to individual acts and not to classes of similar actions.

ii. Why Act Utilitarianism is Better than Traditional, Rule-based Moralities

Traditional moral codes often consist of sets of rules regarding types of actions. The Ten Commandments, for example, focus on types of actions, telling us not to kill, steal, bear false witness, commit adultery, or covet the things that belong to others. Although the Biblical sources permit exceptions to these rules (such as killing in self-defense and punishing people for their sins), the form of the commandments is absolute. They tell us “thou shalt not do x” rather than saying “thou shalt not do x except in circumstances a, b, or c.”

In fact, both customary and philosophical moral codes often seem to consist of absolute rules. The philosopher Immanuel Kant is famous for the view that lying is always wrong, even in cases where one might save a life by lying. According to Kant, if A is trying to murder B and A asks you where B is, it would be wrong for you to lie to A, even if lying would save B’s life (Kant).

Act utilitarians reject rigid rule-based moralities that identify whole classes of actions as right or wrong. They argue that it is a mistake to treat whole classes of actions as right or wrong because the effects of actions differ when they are done in different contexts and morality must focus on the likely effects of individual actions. It is these effects that determine whether they are right or wrong in specific cases. Act utilitarians acknowledge that it may be useful to have moral rules that are “rules of thumb”—i.e., rules that describe what is generally right or wrong, but they insist that whenever people can do more good by violating a rule rather than obeying it, they should violate the rule. They see no reason to obey a rule when more well-being can be achieved by violating it.

iii. Why Act Utilitarianism Makes Moral Judgments Objectively True

One advantage of act utilitarianism is that it shows how moral questions can have objectively true answers. Often, people believe that morality is subjective and depends only on people’s desires or sincere beliefs. Act utilitarianism, however, provides a method for showing which moral beliefs are true and which are false.

Once we embrace the act utilitarian perspective, then every decision about how we should act will depend on the actual or foreseeable consequences of the available options. If we can predict the amount of utility/good results that will be produced by various possible actions, then we can know which ones are right or wrong.

Although some people doubt that we can measure amounts of well-being, we in fact do this all the time. If two people are suffering and we have enough medication for only one, we can often tell that one person is experiencing mild discomfort while the other is in severe pain. Based on this judgment, we will be confident that we can do more good by giving the medication to the person suffering extreme pain. Although this case is very simple, it shows that we can have objectively true answers to questions about what actions are morally right or wrong.

Jeremy Bentham provided a model for this type of decision making in his description of a “hedonic calculus,” which was meant to show what factors should be used to determine amounts of pleasure and happiness, pain and suffering. Using this information, Bentham thought, would allow for making correct judgments both in individual cases and in choices about government actions and policies.

b. Arguments against Act Utilitarianism

i. The “Wrong Answers” Objection

The most common argument against act utilitarianism is that it gives the wrong answers to moral questions. Critics say that it permits various actions that everyone knows are morally wrong. The following cases are among the commonly cited examples:

If a judge can prevent riots that will cause many deaths only by convicting an innocent person of a crime and imposing a severe punishment on that person, act utilitarianism implies that the judge should convict and punish the innocent person. (See Rawls and also Punishment.)
If a doctor can save five people from death by killing one healthy person and using that person’s organs for life-saving transplants, then act utilitarianism implies that the doctor should kill the one person to save five.
If a person makes a promise but breaking the promise will allow that person to perform an action that creates just slightly more well-being than keeping the promise will, then act utilitarianism implies that the promise should be broken. (See Ross)

The general form of each of these arguments is the same. In each case, act utilitarianism implies that a certain act is morally permissible or required. Yet, each of the judgments that flow from act utilitarianism conflicts with widespread, deeply held moral beliefs. Because act utilitarianism approves of actions that most people see as obviously morally wrong, we can know that it is a false moral theory.

ii. The “Undermining Trust” Objection

Although act utilitarians criticize traditional moral rules for being too rigid, critics charge that utilitarians ignore the fact that this alleged rigidity is the basis for trust between people. If, in cases like the ones described above, judges, doctors, and promise-makers are committed to doing whatever maximizes well-being, then no one will be able to trust that judges will act according to the law, that doctors will not use the organs of one patient to benefit others, and that promise-makers will keep their promises. More generally, if everyone believed that morality permitted lying, promise-breaking, cheating, and violating the law whenever doing so led to good results, then no one could trust other people to obey these rules. As a result, in an act utilitarian society, we could not believe what others say, could not rely on them to keep promises, and in general could not count on people to act in accord with important moral rules. As a result, people’s behavior would lack the kind of predictability and consistency that are required to sustain trust and social stability.

iii. Partiality and the “Too Demanding” Objection

Critics also attack utilitarianism’s commitment to impartiality and the equal consideration of interests. An implication of this commitment is that whenever people want to buy something for themselves or for a friend or family member, they must first determine whether they could create more well-being by donating their money to help unknown strangers who are seriously ill or impoverished. If more good can be done by helping strangers than by purchasing things for oneself or people one personally cares about, then act utilitarianism requires us to use the money to help strangers in need. Why? Because act utilitarianism requires impartiality and the equal consideration of all people’s needs and interests.

Almost everyone, however, believes that we have special moral duties to people who are near and dear to us. As a result, most people would reject the notion that morality requires us to treat people we love and care about no differently from people who are perfect strangers as absurd.

This issue is not merely a hypothetical case. In a famous article, Peter Singer defends the view that people living in affluent countries should not purchase luxury items for themselves when the world is full of impoverished people. According to Singer, a person should keep donating money to people in dire need until the donor reaches the point where giving to others generates more harm to the donor than the good that is generated for the recipients.

Critics claim that the argument for using our money to help impoverished strangers rather than benefiting ourselves and people we care about only proves one thing—that act utilitarianism is false. There are two reasons that show why it is false. First, it fails to recognize the moral legitimacy of giving special preferences to ourselves and people that we know and care about. Second, since pretty much everyone is strongly motivated to act on behalf of themselves and people they care about, a morality that forbids this and requires equal consideration of strangers is much too demanding. It asks more than can reasonably be expected of people.

c. Possible Responses to Criticisms of Act Utilitarianism

There are two ways in which act utilitarians can defend their view against these criticisms. First, they can argue that critics misinterpret act utilitarianism and mistakenly claim that it is committed to supporting the wrong answer to various moral questions. This reply agrees that the “wrong answers” are genuinely wrong, but it denies that the “wrong answers” maximize utility. Because they do not maximize utility, these wrong answers would not be supported by act utilitarians and therefore, do nothing to weaken their theory.

Second, act utilitarians can take a different approach by agreeing with the critics that act utilitarianism supports the views that critics label “wrong answers.” Act utilitarians may reply that all this shows is that the views supported by act utilitarianism conflict with common sense morality. Unless critics can prove that common sense moral beliefs are correct the criticisms have no force. Act utilitarians claim that their theory provides good reasons to reject many ordinary moral claims and to replace them with moral views that are based on the effects of actions.

People who are convinced by the criticisms of act utilitarianism may decide to reject utilitarianism entirely and adopt a different type of moral theory. This judgment, however, would be sound only if act utilitarianism were the only type of utilitarian theory. If there are other versions of utilitarianism that do not have act utilitarianism’s flaws, then one may accept the criticisms of act utilitarianism without forsaking utilitarianism entirely. This is what defenders of rule utilitarianism claim. They argue that rule utilitarianism retains the virtues of a utilitarian moral theory but without the flaws of the act utilitarian version.

4. Rule Utilitarianism: Pros and Cons

Unlike act utilitarians, who try to maximize overall utility by applying the utilitarian principle to individual acts, rule utilitarians believe that we can maximize utility only by setting up a moral code that contains rules. The correct moral rules are those whose inclusion in our moral code will produce better results (more well-being) than other possible rules. Once we determine what these rules are, we can then judge individual actions by seeing if they conform to these rules. The principle of utility, then, is used to evaluate rules and is not applied directly to individual actions. Once the rules are determined, compliance with these rules provides the standard for evaluating individual actions.

a. Arguments for Rule Utilitarianism

i. Why Rule Utilitarianism Maximizes Utility

Rule utilitarianism sounds paradoxical. It says that we can produce more beneficial results by following rules than by always performing individual actions whose results are as beneficial as possible. This suggests that we should not always perform individual actions that maximize utility. How could this be something that a utilitarian would support?

In spite of this paradox, rule utilitarianism possesses its own appeal, and its focus on moral rules can sound quite plausible. The rule utilitarian approach to morality can be illustrated by considering the rules of the road. If we are devising a code for drivers, we can adopt either open-ended rules like “drive safely” or specific rules like “stop at red lights,” “do not travel more than 30 miles per hour in residential areas,” “do not drive when drunk,” etc. The rule “drive safely”, like the act utilitarian principle, is a very general rule that leaves it up to individuals to determine what the best way to drive in each circumstance is. More specific rules that require stopping at lights, forbid going faster than 30 miles per hour, or prohibit driving while drunk do not give drivers the discretion to judge what is best to do. They simply tell drivers what to do or not do while driving.

The reason why a more rigid rule-based system leads to greater overall utility is that people are notoriously bad at judging what is the best thing to do when they are driving a car. Having specific rules maximizes utility by limiting drivers’ discretionary judgments and thereby decreasing the ways in which drivers may endanger themselves and others.

A rule utilitarian can illustrate this by considering the difference between stop signs and yield signs. Stop signs forbid drivers to go through an intersection without stopping, even if the driver sees that there are no cars approaching and thus no danger in not stopping. A yield sign permits drivers to go through without stopping unless they judge that approaching cars make it dangerous to drive through the intersection. The key difference between these signs is the amount of discretion that they give to the driver.

The stop sign is like the rule utilitarian approach. It tells drivers to stop and does not allow them to calculate whether it would be better to stop or not. The yield sign is like act utilitarianism. It permits drivers to decide whether there is a need to stop. Act utilitarians see the stop sign as too rigid because it requires drivers to stop even when nothing bad will be prevented. The result, they say, is a loss of utility each time a driver stops at a stop sign when there is no danger from oncoming cars.

Rule utilitarians will reply that they would reject the stop sign method a) if people could be counted on to drive carefully and b) if traffic accidents only caused limited amounts of harm. But, they say, neither of these is true. Because people often drive too fast and are inattentive while driving (because they are, for example, talking, texting, listening to music, or tired), we cannot count on people to make good utilitarian judgments about how to drive safely. In addition, the costs (i.e. the disutility) of accidents can be very high. Accident victims (including drivers) may be killed, injured, or disabled for life. For these reasons, rule utilitarians support the use of stop signs and other non-discretionary rules under some circumstances. Overall these rules generate greater utility because they prevent more disutility (from accidents) than they create (from “unnecessary” stops).

Rule utilitarians generalize from this type of case and claim that our knowledge of human behavior shows that there are many cases in which general rules or practices are more likely to promote good effects than simply telling people to do whatever they think is best in each individual case.

This does not mean that rule utilitarians always support rigid rules without exceptions. Some rules can identify types of situations in which the prohibition is over-ridden. In emergency medical situations, for example, a driver may justifiably go through a red light or stop sign based on the driver’s own assessment that a) this can be done safely and b) the situation is one in which even a short delay might cause dire harms. So the correct rule need not be “never go through a stop sign” but rather can be something like “never go through a stop sign except in cases that have properties a and b.” In addition, there will remain many things about driving or other behavior that can be left to people’s discretion. The rules of the road do not tell drivers when to drive or what their destination should be for example.

Overall then, rule utilitarian can allow departures from rules and will leave many choices up to individuals. In such cases, people may act in the manner that looks like the approach supported by act utilitarians. Nonetheless, these discretionary actions are permitted because having a rule in these cases does not maximize utility or because the best rule may impose some constraints on how people act while still permitting a lot of discretion in deciding what to do.

ii. Rule Utilitarianism Avoids the Criticisms of Act Utilitarianism

As discussed earlier, critics of act utilitarianism raise three strong objections against it. According to these critics, act utilitarianism a) approves of actions that are clearly wrong; b) undermines trust among people, and c) is too demanding because it requires people to make excessive levels of sacrifice. Rule utilitarians tend to agree with these criticisms of act utilitarianism and try to explain why rule utilitarianism is not open to any of these objections.

1. Judges, Doctors, and Promise-makers

Critics of act utilitarianism claim that it allows judges to sentence innocent people to severe punishments when doing so will maximize utility, allows doctors to kill healthy patients if by doing so, they can use the organs of one person to save more lives, and allows people to break promises if that will create slightly more benefits than keeping the promise.

Rule utilitarians say that they can avoid all these charges because they do not evaluate individual actions separately but instead support rules whose acceptance maximizes utility. To see the difference that their focus on rules makes, consider which rule would maximize utility: a) a rule that allows medical doctors to kill healthy patients so that they can use their organs for transplants that will save a larger number of patients who would die without these organs; or b) a rule that forbids doctors to remove the organs of healthy patients in order to benefit other patients.

Although more good may be done by killing the healthy patient in an individual case, it is unlikely that more overall good will be done by having a rule that allows this practice. If a rule were adopted that allows doctors to kill healthy patients when this will save more lives, the result would be that many people would not go to doctors at all. A rule utilitarian evaluation will take account of the fact that the benefits of medical treatment would be greatly diminished because people would no longer trust doctors. People who seek medical treatment must have a high degree of trust in doctors. If they had to worry that doctors might use their organs to help other patients, they would not, for example, allow doctors to anesthetize them for surgery because the resulting loss of consciousness would make them completely vulnerable and unable to defend themselves. Thus, the rule that allows doctors to kill one patient to save five would not maximize utility.

The same reasoning applies equally to the case of the judge. In order to have a criminal justice system that protects people from being harmed by others, we authorize judges and other officials to impose serious punishments on people who are convicted of crimes. The purpose of this is to provide overall security to people in their jurisdiction, but this requires that criminal justice officials only have the authority to impose arrest and imprisonment on people who are actually believed to be guilty. They do not have the authority to do whatever they think will lead to the best results in particular cases. Whatever they do must be constrained by rules that limit their power. Act utilitarians may sometimes support the intentional punishment of innocent people, but rule utilitarians will understand the risks involved and will oppose a practice that allows it.

Rule utilitarians offer a similar analysis of the promise keeping case. They explain that in general, we want people to keep their promises even in some cases in which doing so may lead to less utility than breaking the promise. The reason for this is that the practice of promise-keeping is a very valuable. It enables people to have a wide range of cooperative relationships by generating confidence that other people will do what they promise to do. If we knew that people would fail to keep promises whenever some option arises that leads to more utility, then we could not trust people who make promises to us to carry them through. We would always have to worry that some better option (one that act utilitarians would favor) might emerge, leading to the breaking of the person’s promise to us.

In each of these cases then, rule utilitarians can agree with the critics of act utilitarianism that it is wrong for doctors, judges, and promise-makers to do case by case evaluations of whether they should harm their patients, convict and punish innocent people, and break promises. The rule utilitarian approach stresses the value of general rules and practices, and shows why compliance with rules often maximizes overall utility even if in some individual cases, it requires doing what produces less utility.

2. Maintaining vs. Undermining Trust

Rule utilitarians see the social impact of a rule-based morality as one of the key virtues of their theory. The three cases just discussed show why act utilitarianism undermines trust but rule utilitarianism does not. Fundamentally, in the cases of doctors, judges, and promise-keepers, it is trust that is at stake. Being able to trust other people is extremely important to our well-being. Part of trusting people involves being able to predict what they will and won’t do. Because act utilitarians are committed to a case by case evaluation method, the adoption of their view would make people’s actions much less predictable. As a result, people would be less likely to see other people as reliable and trustworthy. Rule utilitarianism does not have this problem because it is committed to rules, and these rules generate positive “expectation effects” that give us a basis for knowing how other people are likely to behave.

While rule utilitarians do not deny that there are people who are not trustworthy, they can claim that their moral code generally condemns violations of trust as wrongful acts. The problem with act utilitarians is that they support a moral view that has the effect of undermining trust and that sacrifices the good effects of a moral code that supports and encourages trustworthiness.

3. Impartiality and the Problem of Over-Demandingness

Rule utilitarians believe that their view is also immune to the criticism that act utilitarianism is too demanding. In addition, while the act utilitarian commitment to impartiality undermines the moral relevance of personal relations, rule utilitarians claim that their view is not open to this criticism. They claim that rule utilitarianism allows for partiality toward ourselves and others with whom we share personal relationships. Moreover, they say, rule utilitarianism can recognize justifiable partiality to some people without rejecting the commitment to impartiality that is central to the utilitarian tradition.

How can rule utilitarianism do this? How can it be an impartial moral theory while also allowing partiality in people’s treatment of their friends, family, and others with whom they have a special connection?

In his defense of rule utilitarianism, Brad Hooker distinguishes two different contexts in which partiality and impartiality play a role. One involves the justification of moral rules and the other concerns the application of moral rules. Justifications of moral rules, he claims, must be strictly impartial. When we ask whether a rule should be adopted, it is essential to consider the impact of the rule on all people and to weigh the interests of everyone equally.

The second context concerns the content of the rules and how they are applied in actual cases. Rule utilitarians argue that a rule utilitarian moral code will allow partiality to play a role in determining what morality requires, forbids, or allows us to do. As an example, consider a moral rule parents have a special duty to care for their own children. (See Parental Rights and Obligations.) This is a partialist rule because it not only allows but actually requires parents to devote more time, energy, and other resources to their own children than to others. While it does not forbid devoting resources to other people’s children, it allows people to give to their own. While the content of this rule is not impartial, rule utilitarians believe it can be impartially justified. Partiality toward children can be justified for several reasons. Caring for children is a demanding activity. Children need the special attention of adults to develop physically, emotionally, and cognitively. Because children’s needs vary, knowledge of particular children’s needs is necessary to benefit them. For these reasons, it is plausible to believe that children’s well-being can best be promoted by a division of labor that requires particular parents (or other caretakers) to focus primarily on caring for specific children rather than trying to take care of all children. It is not possible for absentee parents or strangers to provide individual children with all that they need. Therefore, we can maximize the overall well-being of children as a class by designating certain people as the caretakers for specific children. For these reasons, partiality toward specific children can be impartially justified.

Similar “division of labor” arguments can be used to provide impartial justifications of other partialist rules and practices. Teachers, for example have special duties to students in their own classes and have no duty to educate all students. Similarly, public officials can and should be partial to people in the jurisdiction in which they work. If the overall aim is to maximize the well-being of all people in all cities, for example, then we are likely to get better results by having individuals who know and understand particular cities focus on them while other people focus on other cities.

Based on examples like these, rule utilitarians claim that their view, unlike act utilitarianism, avoids the problems raised about demandingness and partiality. Being committed to impartialist justifications of moral rules does not commit them to rejecting moral rules that allow or require people to give specific others priority.

While rule utilitarians can defend partiality, their commitment to maximizing overall utility also allows them to justify limits on the degree of partiality that is morally permissible. At a minimum, rule utilitarians will support a rule that forbids parents to harm other people’s children in order to advance the interests of their own children. (It would be wrong, for example, for a parent to injure children who are running in a school race in order to increase the chances that their own children will win.) Moreover, though this is more controversial, rule utilitarians may support a rule that says that if parents are financially well-off and if their own children’s needs are fully met, these parents may have a moral duty to contribute some resources for children who are deprived of essential resources.

The key point is that while rule utilitarianism permits partiality toward some people, it can also generate rules that limit the ways in which people may act partially and it might even support a positive duty for well off people to provide assistance to strangers when the needs and interests of people to whom we are partial are fully met, when they have surplus resources that could be used to assist strangers in dire conditions, and when there are ways to channel these resources effectively to people in dire need.

b. Arguments against Rule Utilitarianism

i. The “Rule Worship” Objection

Act utilitarians criticize rule utilitarians for irrationally supporting rule-based actions in cases where more good could be done by violating the rule than obeying it. They see this as a form of “rule worship,” an irrational deference to rules that has no utilitarian justification (J. J. C. Smart).

Act utilitarians say that they recognize that rules can have value. For example, rules can provide a basis for acting when there is no time to deliberate. In addition, rules can define a default position, a justification for doing (or refraining from) a type of action as long as there is no reason for not doing it. But when people know that more good can be done by violating the rule then the default position should be over-ridden.

ii. The “Collapses into Act Utilitarianism” Objection

While the “rule worship” objection assumes that rule utilitarianism is different from act utilitarianism, some critics deny that this is the case. In their view, whatever defects act utilitarianism may have, rule utilitarianism will have the same defects. According to this criticism, although rule utilitarianism looks different from act utilitarianism, a careful examination shows that it collapses into or, as David Lyons claimed, is extensionally equivalent to act utilitarianism.

To understand this criticism, it is worth focusing on a distinction between rule utilitarianism and other non-utilitarian theories. Consider Kant’s claim that lying is always morally wrong, even when lying would save a person’s life. Many people see this view as too rigid and claim that it fails to take into account the circumstances in which a lie is being told. A more plausible rule would say “do not lie except in special circumstances that justify lying.” But what are these special circumstances? For a utilitarian, it is natural to say that the correct rule is “do not lie except when lying will generate more good than telling the truth.”

Suppose that a rule utilitarian adopts this approach and advocates a moral code that consists of a list of rules of this form. The rules would say something like “do x except when not doing x maximizes utility” and “do not do x except when doing x maximizes utility.” While this may sound plausible, it is easy to see that this version of rule utilitarianism is in fact identical with act utilitarianism. Whatever action x is, the moral requirement and the moral prohibition expressed in these rules collapses into the act utilitarian rules “do x only when not doing x maximizes utility” or “do not do x except when doing x maximizes utility.” These rules say exactly the same thing as the open-ended act utilitarian rule “Do whatever action maximizes utility.”

If rule utilitarianism is to be distinct from act utilitarianism, its supporters must find a way to formulate rules that allow exceptions to a general requirement or prohibition while not collapsing into act utilitarianism. One way to do this is to identify specific conditions under which violating a general moral requirement would be justified. Instead of saying that we can violate a general rule whenever doing so will maximize utility, the rule utilitarian code might say things like “Do not lie except to prevent severe harms to people who are not unjustifiably threatening others with severe harm.” This type of rule would prohibit lying generally, but it would permit lying to a murderer to prevent harm to the intended victims even if the lie would lead to harm to the murderer. In cases of lesser harms or deceitful acts that will benefit the liar, lying would still be prohibited, even if lying might maximize overall utility.

Rule utilitarians claim that this sort of rule is not open to the “collapses into act utilitarianism” objection. It also suggests, however, that rule utilitarians face difficult challenges in formulating utility-based rules that have a reasonable degree of flexibility built into them but are not so flexible that they collapse into act utilitarianism. In addition, although the rules that make up a moral code should be flexible enough to account for the complexities of life, they cannot be so complex that they are too difficult for people to learn and understand.

iii. Wrong Answers and Crude Concepts

Although rule utilitarians try to avoid the weaknesses attributed to act utilitarianism, critics argue that they cannot avoid these weaknesses because they do not take seriously many of our central moral concepts. As a result, they cannot support the right answers to crucial moral problems. Three prominent concepts in moral thought that critics cite are justice, rights, and desert. These moral ideas are often invoked in reasoning about morality, but critics claim that neither rule nor act utilitarianism acknowledge their importance. Instead, they focus only on the amounts of utility that actions or rules generate.

In considering the case, for example, of punishing innocent people, the best that rule utilitarians can do is to say that a rule that permits this would lead to worse results overall than a rule that permitted it. This prediction, however, is precarious. While it may be true, it may also be false, and if it is false, then utilitarians must acknowledge that intentionally punishing an innocent person could sometimes be morally justified.

Against this, critics may appeal to common sense morality to support the view that there are no circumstances in which punishing the innocent can be justified because the innocent person is a) being treated unjustly, b) has a right not to be punished for something that he or she is not guilty of, and c) does not deserve to be punished for a crime that he or she did not commit.

In responding, rule utilitarians may begin, first, with the view that they do not reject concepts like justice, rights, and desert. Instead, they accept and use these concepts but interpret them from the perspective of maximizing utility. To speak of justice, rights, and desert is to speak of rules of individual treatment that are very important, and what makes them important is their contribution to promoting overall well-being. Moreover, even people who accept these concepts as basic still need to determine whether it is always wrong to treat someone unjustly, violate their rights, or treat them in ways that they don’t deserve.

Critics object to utilitarianism by claiming that the theory justifies treating people unjustly, violating their rights, etc. This criticism only stands up if it is always wrong and thus never morally justified to treat people in these ways. Utilitarians argue that moral common sense is less absolutist than their critics acknowledge. In the case of punishment, for example, while we hope that our system of criminal justice gives people fair trials and conscientiously attempts to separate the innocent from the guilty, we know that the system is not perfect. As a result, people who are innocent are sometimes prosecuted, convicted, and punished for crimes they did not do.

This is the problem of wrongful convictions, which poses a difficult challenge to critics of utilitarianism. If we know that our system of criminal justice punishes some people unjustly and in ways they don’t deserve, we are faced with a dilemma. Either we can shut down the system and punish no one, or we can maintain the system even though we know that it will result in some innocent people being unjustly punished in ways that they do not deserve. Most people will support continuing to punish people in spite of the fact that it involves punishing some people unjustly. According to rule utilitarians, this can only be justified if a rule that permits punishments (after a fair trial, etc.) yields more overall utility than a rule that rejects punishment because it treats some people unfairly. To end the practice of punishment entirely—because it inevitably causes some injustice—is likely to result in worse consequences because it deprives society of a central means of protecting people’s well-being, including what are regarded as their rights. In the end, utilitarians say, it is justice and rights that give way when rules that approve of violations in some cases yield the greatest amount of utility.

5. Conclusion

The debate between act utilitarianism and rule utilitarianism highlights many important issues about how we should make moral judgments. Act utilitarianism stresses the specific context and the many individual features of the situations that pose moral problems, and it presents a single method for dealing with these individual cases. Rule utilitarianism stresses the recurrent features of human life and the ways in which similar needs and problems arise over and over again. From this perspective, we need rules that deal with types or classes of actions: killing, stealing, lying, cheating, taking care of our friends or family, punishing people for crimes, aiding people in need, etc. Both of these perspectives, however, agree that the main determinant of what is right or wrong is the relationship between what we do or what form our moral code takes and what is the impact of our moral perspective on the level of people’s well-being.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Classic Works

Jeremy Bentham. An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation, available in many editions, 1789.
- See Book I, chapter 1 for Bentham’s statement of what utilitarianism is; chapter IV for his method of measuring amounts of pleasure/utility; chapter V for his list of types of pleasures and pains, and chapter XIII for his application of utilitarianism to questions about criminal punishment.
John Stuart Mill. Utilitarianism, available in many editions and online, 1861.
- See especially chapter II, in which Mill tries both to clarify and defend utilitarianism. Passages at the end of chapter suggest that Mill was a rule utilitarian. In chapter V, Mill tries to show that utilitarianism is compatible with justice.
Henry Sidgwick. The Methods of Ethics, Seventh Edition, available in many editions, 1907.
- Sidgwick is known for his careful, extended analysis of utilitarian moral theory and competing views.
G. E. Moore. Principia Ethica, 1903.
- Moore criticizes aspects of Mill’s views but support a non-hedonistic form of utilitarianism.
G. E. Moore. Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1912.
- Mostly focused on utilitarianism, this book contains a combination of act and rule utilitarian ideas.

b. More Recent Utilitarians

J. J. C. Smart. “An Outline of a System of Utilitarian Ethics” in J. J. C. Smart and Bernard Williams, Utilitarianism: For and Against. Cambridge University Press, 1973.
- Smart’s discussion combines an overview of moral theory and a defense of act utilitarianism. It is followed by Bernard Williams’, “A Critique of Utilitarianism,” a source of many important criticisms of utilitarianism.
Richard Brandt. Ethical Theory. Prentice Hall, 1959. Chapter 15.
- Brandt, who coined the terms “act” and “rule” utilitarianism, explains and criticizes act utilitarianism and tentatively proposes a version of rule utilitarianism.
Richard Brandt. Morality, Utilitarianism, and Rights. Cambridge University Press, 1992.
- Brandt developed and defended rule utilitarianism in many papers. This book contains several of them as well as works in which he applies rule utilitarian thinking to issues like rights and the ethics of war.
R. M. Hare. Moral Thinking. Oxford University Press, 1981.
- An interesting development of a form of rule utilitarianism by an influential moral theorist.
John C. Harsanyi. “Morality and the Theory of Rational Behavior.” in Social Research 44.4 (1977): 623-656. (Reprinted in Amartya Sen and Bernard Williams, eds., Utilitarianism and Beyond, Cambridge University Press, 1982).
- Harsanyi, a Nobel Prize economist, defends rule utilitarianism, connecting it to a preference theory of value and a theory of rational action.
John Rawls. “Two Concepts of Rules.” In Philosophical Review LXIV (1955), 3-32.
- Before becoming an influential critic of utilitarianism, Rawls wrote this defense of rule utilitarianism.
Brad Hooker. Ideal Code, Real World: A Rule-consequentialist Theory of Morality. Oxford University Press, 2000.
- In this 21^st century defense of rule utilitarianism, Hooker places it in the context of more recent developments in philosophy.
Peter Singer. Writings on an Ethical Life. HarperCollins, 2000.
- Singer, a prolific, widely read thinker, mostly applies a utilitarian perspective to controversial moral issues (for example, euthanasia, the treatment of non-human animals, and global poverty) rather than discussing utilitarian moral theory. This volume contains selections from his books and articles.
Peter Singer. “Famine, Affluence, and Morality” in Philosophy and Public Affairs 1 (1972), 229-43. Reprinted in Peter Singer. Writings on an Ethical Life. Harper Collins, 2000.
- This widely reprinted article, though it does not focus on utilitarianism, uses utilitarian reasoning and has sparked decades of debate about moral demandingness and moral impartiality.
Robert Goodin. Utilitarianism as a Public Philosophy. Cambridge University Press, 1995.
- In a series of essays, Goodin argues that utilitarianism is the best philosophy for public decision-making even if it fails as an ethic for personal aspects of life.
Derek Parfit. On What Matters. Oxford University Press, 1991.
- In a long, complex work, Parfit stresses the importance of Henry Sidgwick as a moral philosopher and argues that rule utilitarianism and Kantian deontology can be understood in a way that makes them compatible with one another.

c. Overviews

Tim Mulgan. Understanding Utilitarianism. Acumen, 2007.
- This is a very clear description of utilitarianism, including explanations of arguments both for and against. Chapter 2 discusses Bentham, Mill, and Sidgwick while chapter 6 focuses on act and rule utilitarianism.
Julia Driver, “The History of Utilitarianism,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
- This article gives a good historical account of important figures in the development of utilitarianism.
Walter Sinnott-Armstrong, “Consequentialism,” Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
- This very useful overview is relevant to utilitarianism and other forms of consequentialism.
William Shaw. Contemporary Ethics: Taking Account of Utilitarianism. Blackwell, 1999.
- Shaw provides a clear, comprehensive discussion of utilitarianism and its critics as well as defending utilitarianism.
John Troyer. The Classical Utilitarians: Bentham and Mill. Hackett, 2003.
- Troyer’s introduction to this book of selections from Mill and Bentham is clear and informative.
Ben Eggleston and Dale Miller, eds. The Cambridge Companion to Utilitarianism. Cambridge University Press, 2014.
- This collection contains sixteen essays on utilitarianism, including essays on historical figures as well as discussion of 21^st century issues, including both act and rule utilitarianism.

d. J. S. Mill and Utilitarian Moral Theory

J. O. Urmson. “The Interpretation of the Moral Philosophy of J. S. Mill,” in Philosophical Quarterly (1953) 3, 33-9.
- This article generated renewed interest in both Mill’s moral theory and rule utilitarianism.
Roger Crisp. Routledge Philosophy Guidebook to Mill on Utilitarianism. Routledge, 1997.
A clear discussion of Mill’s Utilitarianism with chapters on key topics as well as on Mill’s On Liberty and The Subjection of Women.
Henry. R. West, ed. The Blackwell Guide to Mill’s Utilitarianism. Blackwell, 2006.
- This contains the complete text of Mill’s Utilitarianism preceded by three essays on the background to Mill’s utilitarianism and followed by five interpretative essays and four focusing on contemporary issues.
Henry R. West. An Introduction to Mill’s Utilitarian Ethics. Cambridge University Press, 2004.
- A clear discussion of Mill; Chapter 4 argues that Mill is neither an act nor a rule utilitarian. Chapter 6 focuses on utilitarianism and justice.
Dale Miller. J. S. Mill. Polity Press, 2010.
- Miller, in Chapter 6, argues that Mill was a rule utilitarian.
Stephen Nathanson. “John Stuart Mill on Economic Justice and the Alleviation of Poverty,” in Journal of Social Philosophy, XLIII, no. 2.
- Drawing on Mill’s Principles of Political Economy, Nathanson claims that Mill was a rule utilitarian and provides an interpretation of Mill’s views on economic justice.
Wendy Donner, “Mill’s Utilitarianism” in John Skorupski, ed. The Cambridge Companion to Mill. Cambridge University Press, 1998, 255–92.
- A discussion of Mill’s views and some recent interpretations of them.
David Lyons. Rights, Welfare, and Mill’s Moral Theory. Oxford, 1994.
- In this series of papers, Lyons defends Mill’s view of morality against some critics, differentiates Mill’s views from both act and rule utilitarianism, and criticizes Mill’s attempt to show that utilitarianism can account for justice.

e. Critics of Utilitarianism

David Lyons. Forms and Limits of Utilitarianism. Oxford, 1965.
- Lyons argues that at least some versions of rule utilitarianism collapse into act utilitarianism.
David Lyons. “The Moral Opacity of Utilitarianism” in Brad Hooker, Elinor Mason, and Dale Miller, eds. Morality, Rules, and Consequences. Rowman and Littlefield, 2000.
- In a challenging essay, Lyons raises doubts about whether there is any coherent version of utilitarianism.
Judith Jarvis Thomson. “The Trolley Problem.” Yale Law Journal 94 (1985), 1395-1415. Reprinted in Judith Jarvis Thomson. Rights, Restitution and Risk. Edited by William Parent. Harvard University Press, 1986; Chapter 7.
- An influential rights-based discussion in which Jarvis Thomson uses hypothetical cases to show, among other things, that utilitarianism cannot explain why some actions that cause killings are permissible and others not.
Bernard Williams, “A Critique of Utilitarianism,” In J. J. C. Smart and Bernard Williams, Utilitarianism: For and Against. Cambridge University Press, 1973.
- Williams’ contribution to this debate contains arguments and examples that have played an important role in debates about utilitarianism and moral theory.

f. Collections of Essays

Michael D. Bayles, ed. Contemporary Utilitarianism. Garden City: Doubleday, 1968.
- Ten essays that debate act vs. rule utilitarianism as well as whether a form of utilitarianism is correct.
Samuel Gorovitz, ed. John Stuart Mill: Utilitarianism, With Critical Essays. Indianapolis: The Bobbs-Merrill Company, 1971.
- This includes Mill’s Utlitarianism plus a rich array of twenty-eight (pre-1970) articles interpreting, defending, and criticizing utilitarianism.
Brad Hooker, Elinor Mason, and Dale Miller, eds. Morality, Rules, and Consequences. Rowman and Littlefield, 2000.
- Thirteen essays on utilitarianism, many focused on issues concerning rule utilitarianism.
Samuel Scheffler. Consequentialism and Its Critics. Oxford, 1988.
- This contains a dozen influential articles, mostly by prominent critics of utilitarianism and other forms of consequentialism.
Amartya Sen, and Bernard Williams, eds. Utilitarianism and Beyond. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1982.
- This contains fourteen articles, including essays defending utilitarianism by R. M. Hare and John Harsanyi, As the title suggests, however, most of the articles are critical of utilitarianism.

Author Information

Stephen Nathanson
Email: s.nathanson@neu.edu
Northeastern University
U. S. A.

Immanuel Kant

kant2 At the foundation of Kant’s system is the doctrine of “transcendental idealism,” which emphasizes a distinction between what we can experience (the natural, observable world) and what we cannot (“supersensible” objects such as God and the soul). Kant argued that we can only have knowledge of things we can experience. Accordingly, in answer to the question, “What can I know?” Kant replies that we can know the natural, observable world, but we cannot, however, have answers to many of the deepest questions of metaphysics.

Kant’s ethics are organized around the notion of a “categorical imperative,” which is a universal ethical principle stating that one should always respect the humanity in others, and that one should only act in accordance with rules that could hold for everyone. Kant argued that the moral law is a truth of reason, and hence that all rational creatures are bound by the same moral law. Thus in answer to the question, “What should I do?” Kant replies that we should act rationally, in accordance with a universal moral law.

Kant also argued that his ethical theory requires belief in free will, God, and the immortality of the soul. Although we cannot have knowledge of these things, reflection on the moral law leads to a justified belief in them, which amounts to a kind rational faith. Thus in answer to the question, “What may I hope?” Kant replies that we may hope that our souls are immortal and that there really is a God who designed the world in accordance with principles of justice.

In addition to these three focal points, Kant also made lasting contributions to nearly all areas of philosophy. His aesthetic theory remains influential among art critics. His theory of knowledge is required reading for many branches of analytic philosophy. The cosmopolitanism behind his political theory colors discourse about globalization and international relations. And some of his scientific contributions are even considered intellectual precursors to several ideas in contemporary cosmology.

This article presents an overview of these and other of Kant’s most important philosophical contributions. It follows standard procedures for citing Kant’s works. Passages from Critique of Pure Reason are cited by reference to page numbers in both the 1781 and 1787 editions. Thus “(A805/B833)” refers to page 805 in the 1781 edition and 833 in the 1787 edition. References to the rest of Kant’s works refer to the volume and page number of the official Deutsche Akademie editions of Kant’s works. Thus “(5:162)” refers to volume 5, page 162 of those editions.

Life
Metaphysics and Epistemology
Philosophy of Mathematics
Natural Science
1. Physics
2. Other Scientific Contributions
Moral Theory
Political Theory and Theory of Human History
Theory of Art and Beauty
Pragmatic Anthropology
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Literature
2. Secondary Literature

1. Life

Kant was born in 1724 in the Prussian city of Königsberg (now Kaliningrad in Russia). His parents – Johann Georg and Anna Regina – were pietists. Although they raised Kant in this tradition (an austere offshoot of Lutheranism that emphasized humility and divine grace), he does not appear ever to have been very sympathetic to this kind of religious devotion. As a youth, he attended the Collegium Fridericianum in Königsberg, after which he attended the University of Königsberg. Although he initially focused his studies on the classics, philosophy soon caught and held his attention. The rationalism of Gottfried Leibniz (1646-1716) and Christian Wolff (1679-1754) was most influential on him during these early years, but Kant was also introduced to Isaac Newton’s (1642-1727) writings during this time.

His mother had died in 1737, and after his father’s death in 1746 Kant left the University to work as a private tutor for several families in the countryside around the city. He returned to the University in 1754 to teach as a Privatdozent, which meant that he was paid directly by individual students, rather than by the University. He supported himself in this way until 1770. Kant published many essays and other short works during this period. He made minor scientific contributions in astronomy, physics, and earth science, and wrote philosophical treatises engaging with the Leibnizian-Wolffian traditions of the day (many of these are discussed below). Kant’s primary professional goal during this period was to eventually attain the position of Professor of Logic and Metaphysics at Königsberg. He finally succeeded in 1770 (at the age of 46) when he completed his second dissertation (the first had been published in 1755), which is now referred to as the Inaugural Dissertation.

Commentators divide Kant’s career into the “pre-critical” period before 1770 and the “critical” period after. After the publication of the Inaugural Dissertation, Kant published hardly anything for more than a decade (this period is referred to as his “silent decade”). However, this was anything but a fallow period for Kant. After discovering and being shaken by the radical skepticism of Hume’s empiricism in the early 1770s, Kant undertook a massive project to respond to Hume. He realized that this response would require a complete reorientation of the most fundamental approaches to metaphysics and epistemology. Although it took much longer than initially planned, his project came to fruition in 1781 with the publication of the first edition of Critique of Pure Reason

The 1780s would be the most productive years of Kant’s career. In addition to writing the Prolegomena to Any Future Metaphysics (1783) as a sort of introduction to the Critique, Kant wrote important works in ethics (Groundwork for the Metaphysics of Morals, 1785, and Critique of Practical Reason, 1788), he applied his theoretical philosophy to Newtonian physical theory (Metaphysical Foundations of Natural Science, 1786), and he substantially revised the Critique of Pure Reason in 1787. Kant capped the decade with the publication of the third and final critique, Critique of the Power of Judgment (1790).

Although the products of the 1780s are the works for which Kant is best known, he continued to publish philosophical writings through the 1790s as well. Of note during this period are Religion within the Bounds of Mere Reason (1793), Towards Perpetual Peace (1795), Metaphysics of Morals (1797), and Anthropology from a Pragmatic Point of View (1798). The Religion was attended with some controversy, and Kant was ultimately led to promise the King of Prussia (Friedrich Wilhelm II) not to publish anything else on religion. (Kant considered the promise null and void after the king died in 1797.) During his final years, he devoted himself to completing the critical project with one final bridge to physical science. Unfortunately, the encroaching dementia of Kant’s final years prevented him from completing this book (partial drafts are published under the title Opus Postumum).

Kant never married and there are many stories that paint him as a quirky but dour eccentric. These stories do not do him justice. He was beloved by his friends and colleagues. He was consistently generous to all those around him, including his servants. He was universally considered a lively and engaging dinner guest and (later in life) host. And he was a devoted and popular teacher throughout the five decades he spent in the classroom. Although he had hoped for a small, private ceremony, when he died in 1804, age 79, his funeral was attended by the thousands who wished to pay their respects to “the sage of Königsberg.”

2. Metaphysics and Epistemology

The most important element of Kant’s mature metaphysics and epistemology is his doctrine of transcendental idealism, which received its fullest discussion in Critique of Pure Reason (1781/87). Transcendental idealism is the thesis that the empirical world that we experience (the “phenomenal” world of “appearances”) is to be distinguished from the world of things as they are in themselves. The most significant aspect of this distinction is that while the empirical world exists in space and time, things in themselves are neither spatial nor temporal. Transcendental idealism has wide-ranging consequences. On the positive side, Kant takes transcendental idealism to entail an “empirical realism,” according to which humans have direct epistemic access to the natural, physical world and can even have a priori cognition of basic features of all possible experienceable objects. On the negative side, Kant argues that we cannot have knowledge of things in themselves. Further, since traditional metaphysics deals with things in themselves, answers to the questions of traditional metaphysics (for example, regarding God or free will) can never be answered by human minds.

This section addresses the development of Kant’s metaphysics and epistemology and then summarizes the most important arguments and conclusions of Kant’s theory.

a. Pre-Critical Thought

Critique of Pure Reason, the book that would alter the course of western philosophy, was written by a man already far into his career. Unlike the later “critical period” Kant, the philosophical output of the early Kant was fully enmeshed in the German rationalist tradition, which was dominated at the time by the writings of Gottfried Leibniz (1646-1716) and Christian Wolff (1679-1754). Nevertheless, many of Kant’s concerns during the pre-critical period anticipate important aspects of his mature thought.

Kant’s first purely philosophical work was the New Elucidation of the First Principles of Metaphysical Cognition (1755). The first parts of this long essay present criticisms and revisions of the Wolffian understanding of the basic principles of metaphysics, especially the Principles of Identity (whatever is, is, and whatever is not, is not), of Contradiction (nothing can both be and not be), and of Sufficient Reason (nothing is true without a reason why it is true). In the final part, Kant defends two original principles of metaphysics. According to the “Principle of Succession,” all change in objects requires the mutual interaction of a plurality of substances. This principle is a metaphysical analogue of Newton’s principle of action and reaction, and it anticipates Kant’s argument in the Third Analogy of Experience from Critique of Pure Reason (see 2f below). According to the “Principle of Coexistence,” multiple substances can only be said to coexist within the same world if the unity of that world is grounded in the intellect of God. Although Kant would later claim that we can never have metaphysical cognition of this sort of relation between God and the world (not least of all because we can’t even know that God exists), he would nonetheless continue to be occupied with the question of how multiple distinct substances can constitute a single, unified world.

In the Physical Monadology (1756), Kant attempts to provide a metaphysical account of the basic constitution of material substance in terms of “monads.” Leibniz and Wolff had held that monads are the simple, atomic substances that constitute matter. Kant follows Wolff in rejecting Leibniz’s claim that monads are mindlike and that they do not interact with each other. The novel aspect of Kant’s account lies in his claim that each monad possesses a degree of both attractive and repulsive force, and that monads fill determinate volumes of space because of the interactions between these monads as they compress each other through their opposed repulsive forces. Thirty years later, in the Metaphysical Foundations of Natural Science (1786), Kant would develop the theory that matter must be understood in terms of interacting attractive and repulsive forces. The primary difference between the later view and the earlier is that Kant no longer appeals to monads, or simple substances at all (transcendental idealism rules out the possibility of simplest substances as constituents of matter; see 2gii below).

The final publication of Kant’s pre-critical period was On the Form and Principles of the Sensible and the Intelligible World, also referred to as the Inaugural Dissertation (1770), since it marked Kant’s appointment as Königsberg’s Professor of Logic and Metaphysics. Although Kant had not yet had the final crucial insights that would lead to the development of transcendental idealism, many of the important elements of his mature metaphysics are prefigured here. Two aspects of the Inaugural Dissertation are especially worth noting. First, in a break from his predecessors, Kant distinguishes two fundamental faculties of the mind: sensibility, which represents the world through singular “intuitions,” and understanding, which represents the world through general “concepts.” In the Inaugural Dissertation, Kant argues that sensibility represents the sensible world of “phenomena” while the understanding represents an intelligible world of “noumena.” The critical period Kant will deny that we can have any determinate knowledge of noumena, and that knowledge of phenomena requires the cooperation of sensibility and understanding together. Second, in describing the “form” of the sensible world, Kant argues that space and time are “not something objective and real,” but are rather “subjective and ideal” (2:403). The claim that space and time pertain to things only as they appear, not as they are in themselves, will be one of the central theses of Kant’s mature transcendental idealism.

b. Dogmatic Slumber, Synthetic A Priori Knowledge, and the Copernican Shift

Although the early Kant showed a complete willingness to dissent from many important aspects of the Wolffian orthodoxy of the time, Kant continued to take for granted the basic rationalist assumption that metaphysical cognition was possible. In a retrospective remark from the Prolegomena to Any Future Metaphysics (1783), Kant says that his faith in this rationalist assumption was shaken by David Hume (1711-1776), whose skepticism regarding the possibility of knowledge of causal necessary connections awoke Kant from his “dogmatic slumber” (4:260). Hume argued that we can never have knowledge of necessary connections between causes and effects because such knowledge can neither be given through the senses, nor derived a priori as conceptual truths. Kant realized that Hume’s problem was a serious one because his skepticism about knowledge of the necessity of the connection between cause and effect generalized to all metaphysical knowledge pertaining to necessity, not just causation specifically. For instance, there is the question why mathematical truths necessarily hold true in the natural world, or the question whether we can know that a being (God) exists necessarily.

The solution to Hume’s skepticism, which would form the basis of the critical philosophy, was twofold. The first part of Kant’s solution was to agree with Hume that metaphysical knowledge (such as knowledge of causation) is neither given through the senses, nor is it known a priori through conceptual analysis. Kant argued, however, that there is a third kind of knowledge which is a priori, yet which is not known simply by analyzing concepts. He referred to this as “synthetic a priori knowledge.” Where analytic judgments are justified by the semantic relations between the concepts they mention (for example, “all bachelors are unmarried”), synthetic judgments are justified by their conformity to the given object that they describe (for example, “this ball right here is red”). The puzzle posed by the notion of synthetic a priori knowledge is that it would require that an object be presented to the mind, but not be given in sensory experience.

The second part of Kant’s solution is to explain how synthetic a priori knowledge could be possible. He describes his key insight on this matter as a “Copernican” shift in his thinking about the epistemic relation between the mind and the world. Copernicus had realized that it only appeared as though the sun and stars revolved around us, and that we could have knowledge of the way the solar system really was if we took into account the fact that the sky looks the way it does because we perceivers are moving. Analogously, Kant realized that we must reject the belief that the way things appear corresponds to the way things are in themselves. Furthermore, he argued that the objects of knowledge can only ever be things as they appear, not as they are in themselves. Appealing to this new approach to metaphysics and epistemology, Kant argued that we must investigate the most basic structures of experience (that is, the structures of the way things appear to us), because the basic structures of experience will coincide with the basic structures of any objects that could possibly be experienced. In other words, if it is only possible to have experience of an object if the object conforms to the conditions of experience, then knowing the conditions of experience will give us knowledge – synthetic a priori knowledge in fact – of every possible object of experience. Kant overcomes Hume’s skepticism by showing that we can have synthetic a priori knowledge of objects in general when we take as the object of our investigation the very form of a possible object of experience. Critique of Pure Reason is an attempt to work through all of the important details of this basic philosophical strategy.

c. The Cognitive Faculties and Their Representations

Kant’s theory of the mind is organized around an account of the mind’s powers, its “cognitive faculties.” One of Kant’s central claims is that the cognitive capacities of the mind depend on two basic and fundamentally distinct faculties. First, there is “sensibility.” Sensibility is a passive faculty because its job is to receive representations through the affection of objects on the senses. Through sensibility, objects are “given” to the mind. Second, there is “understanding,” which is an active faculty whose job is to “think” (that is, apply concepts to) the objects given through sensibility.

The most basic type of representation of sensibility is what Kant calls an “intuition.” An intuition is a representation that refers directly to a singular individual object. There are two types of intuitions. Pure intuitions are a priori representations of space and time themselves (see 2d1 below). Empirical intuitions are a posteriori representations that refer to specific empirical objects in the world. In addition to possessing a spatiotemporal “form,” empirical intuitions also involve sensation, which Kant calls the “matter” of intuition (and of experience generally). (Without sensations, the mind could never have thoughts about real things, only possible ones.) We have empirical intuitions both of objects in the physical world (“outer intuitions”) and objects in our own minds (“inner intuitions”).

The most basic type of representation of understanding is the “concept.” Unlike an intuition, a concept is a representation that refers generally to indefinitely many objects. (For instance, the concept ‘cat’ on its own could refer to any and all cats, but not to any one in particular.) Concepts refer to their objects only indirectly because they depend on intuitions for reference to particular objects. As with intuitions, there are two basic types of concepts. Pure concepts are a priori representations and they characterize the most basic logical structure of the mind. Kant calls these concepts “categories.” Empirical concepts are a posteriori representations, and they are formed on the basis of sensory experience with the world. Concepts are combined by the understanding into “judgments,” which are the smallest units of knowledge. I can only have full cognition of an object in the world once I have, first, had an empirical intuition of the object, second, conceptualized this object in some way, and third, formed my conceptualization of the intuited object into a judgment. This means that both sensibility and understanding must work in cooperation for knowledge to be possible. As Kant expresses it, “Thoughts without content are empty, intuitions without concepts are blind” (A51/B75).

There are two other important cognitive faculties that must be mentioned. The first is transcendental “imagination,” which mediates between sensibility and understanding. Kant calls this faculty “blind” because we do not have introspective access to its operations. Kant says that we can at least know that it is responsible for forming intuitions in such a way that it is possible for the understanding to apply concepts to them. The other is “reason,” which operates in a way similar to the understanding, but which operates independently of the senses. While understanding combines the data of the senses into judgments, reason combines understanding’s judgments together into one coherent, unified, systematic whole. Reason is not satisfied with mere disconnected bits of knowledge. Reason wants all knowledge to form a system of knowledge. Reason is also the faculty responsible for the “illusions” of transcendent metaphysics (see 2g below).

d. Transcendental Idealism

Transcendental idealism is a theory about the relation between the mind and its objects. Three fundamental theses make up this theory: first, there is a distinction between appearances (things as they appear) and things as they are in themselves. Second, space and time are a priori, subjective conditions on the possibility of experience, and hence they pertain only to appearances, not to things in themselves. Third, we can have determinate cognition of only of things that can be experienced, hence only of appearances, not things in themselves.

A quick remark on the term “transcendental idealism” is in order. Kant typically uses the term “transcendental” when he wants to emphasize that something is a condition on the possibility of experience. So for instance, the chapter titled “Transcendental Analytic of Concepts” deals with the concepts without which cognition of an object would be impossible. Kant uses the term “idealism” to indicate that the objects of experience are mind-dependent (although the precise sense of this mind-dependence is controversial; see 2d2 below). Hence, transcendental idealism is the theory that it is a condition on the possibility of experience that the objects of experience be in some sense mind-dependent.

i. The Ideality of Space and Time

Kant argues that space and time are a priori, subjective conditions on the possibility of experience, that is, that they are transcendentally ideal. Kant grounds the distinction between appearances and things in themselves on the realization that, as subjective conditions on experience, space and time could only characterize things as they appear, not as they are in themselves. Further, the claim that we can only know appearances (not things in themselves) is a consequence of the claims that we can only know objects that conform to the conditions of experience, and that only spatiotemporal appearances conform to these conditions. Given the systematic importance of this radical claim, what were Kant’s arguments for it? What follows are some of Kant’s most important arguments for the thesis.

One argument has to do with the relation between sensations and space. Kant argues that sensations on their own are not spatial, but that they (or arguably the objects they correspond to) are represented in space, “outside and next to one another” (A23/B34). Hence, the ability to sense objects in space presupposes the a priori representation of space, which entails that space is merely ideal, hence not a property of things in themselves.

Another argument that Kant makes repeatedly during the critical period can be called the “argument from geometry.” Its two premises are, first, that the truths of geometry are necessary truths, and thus a priori truths, and second, that the truths of geometry are synthetic (because these truths cannot be derived from an analysis of the meanings of geometrical concepts). If geometry, which is the study of the structure of space, is synthetic a priori, then its object – space – must be a mere a priori representation and not something that pertains to things in themselves. (Kant’s theory of mathematical cognition is discussed further in 3b below.)

Many commentators have found these arguments less than satisfying because they depend on the questionable assumption that if the representations of space and time are a priori they thereby cannot be properties of things in themselves. “Why can’t it be both?” many want to ask. A stronger argument appears in Kant’s discussion of the First and Second Antinomies of Pure Reason (discussed below, 2g2). There Kant argues that if space and time were things in themselves or even properties of things in themselves, then one could prove that space and time both are and are not infinitely large, and that matter in space both is and is not infinitely divisible. In other words, the assumption that space and time are transcendentally real instead of transcendentally ideal leads to a contradiction, and thus space and time must be transcendentally ideal.

ii. Appearances and Things in Themselves

How Kant’s distinction between appearances and things in themselves should be understood is one of the most controversial topics in the literature. It is a question of central importance because how one understands this distinction determines how one will understand the entire nature of Kantian idealism. The following briefly summarizes the main interpretive options, but it does not take a stand on which is correct.

According to “two-world” interpretations, the distinction between appearances and things in themselves is to be understood in metaphysical and ontological terms. Appearances (and hence the entire physical world that we experience) comprise one set of entities, and things in themselves are an ontologically distinct set of entities. Although things in themselves may somehow cause us to have experience of appearances, the appearances we experience are not things in themselves.

According to “one-world” or “two-aspect” interpretations, the distinction between appearances and things in themselves is to be understood in epistemological terms. Appearances are ontologically the very same things as things in themselves, and the phrase “in themselves” simply means “not considered in terms of their epistemic relation to human perceivers.”

A common objection against two-world interpretations is that they may make Kant’s theory too similar to Berkeley’s immaterialist idealism (an association from which Kant vehemently tried to distance himself), and they seem to ignore Kant’s frequent characterization of the appearance/thing in itself distinction in terms of different epistemic standpoints. And a common objection against one-world interpretations is that they may trivialize some of the otherwise revolutionary aspects of Kant’s theory, and they seem to ignore Kant’s frequent characterization of the appearance/thing in itself distinction in seemingly metaphysical terms. There have been attempts at interpretations that are intermediate between these two options. For instance, some have argued that Kant only acknowledges one world, but that the appearance/thing in itself distinction is nevertheless metaphysical, not merely epistemological.

e. The Deduction of the Categories

After establishing the ideality of space and time and the distinction between appearances and things in themselves, Kant goes on to show how it is possible to have a priori cognition of the necessary features of appearances. Cognizing appearances requires more than mere knowledge of their sensible form (space and time); it also requires that we be able to apply certain concepts (for example, the concept of causation) to appearances. Kant identifies the most basic concepts that we can use to think about objects as the “pure concepts of understanding,” or the “categories.”

There are twelve categories in total, and they fall into four groups of three:

The task of the chapter titled “Transcendental Deduction of the Categories” is to show that these categories can and must be applied in some way to any object that could possibly be an object of experience. The argument of the Transcendental Deduction is one of the most important moments in the Critique, but it is also one of the most difficult, complex, and controversial arguments in the book. Hence, it will not be possible to reconstruct the argument in any detail here. Instead, Kant’s most important claims and moves in the Deduction are described.

Kant’s argument turns on conceptions of self-consciousness (or what he calls “apperception”) as a condition on the possibility of experiencing the world as a unified whole. Kant takes it to be uncontroversial that we can be aware of our representations as our representations. It is not just that I can have the thoughts ‘P’ or ‘Q’; I am also always able to ascribe these thoughts to myself: ‘I think P’ and ‘I think Q’. Further, we are also able to recognize that it is the same I that does the thinking in both cases. Thus, we can recognize that ‘I think both P and Q’. In general, all of our experience is unified because it can be ascribed to the one and same I, and so this unity of experience depends on the unity of the self-conscious I. Kant next asks what conditions must obtain in order for this unity of self-consciousness to be possible. His answer is that we must be able to differentiate between the I that does the thinking and the object that we think about. That is, we must be able to distinguish between subjective and objective elements in our experience. If we could not make such a distinction, then all experience would just be so many disconnected mental happenings: everything would be subjective and there would be no “unity of apperception” that stands over and against the various objects represented by the I. So next Kant needs to explain how we are able to differentiate between the subjective and objective elements of experience. His answer is that a representation is objective when the subject is necessitated in representing the object in a certain way, that is, when it is not up to the free associative powers of my imagination to determine how I represent it. For instance, whether I think a painting is attractive or whether it calls to mind an instance from childhood depends on the associative activity of my own imagination; but the size of the canvas and the chemical composition of the pigments is not up to me: insofar as I represent these as objective features of the painting, I am necessitated in representing them in a certain way. In order for a representational content to be necessitated in this way, according to Kant, is for it to be subject to a “rule.” The relevant rules that Kant has in mind are the conditions something must satisfy in order for it to be represented as an object at all. And these conditions are precisely the concepts laid down in the schema of the categories, which are the concepts of an “object in general.” Hence, if I am to have experience at all, I must conceptualize objects in terms of the a priori categories.

Kant’s argument in the Deduction is a “transcendental argument”: Kant begins with a premise accepted by everyone, but then asks what conditions must have been met in order for this premise to be true. Kant assumed that we have a unified experience of the many objects populating the world. This unified experience depends on the unity of apperception. The unity of apperception enables the subject to distinguish between subjective and objective elements in experience. This ability, in turn, depends on representing objects in accordance with rules, and the rules in question are the categories. Hence, the only way we can explain the fact that we have experience at all is by appeal to the fact that the categories apply to the objects of experience.

It is worth emphasizing how truly radical the conclusion of the Transcendental Deduction is. Kant takes himself to have shown that all of nature is subject to the rules laid down by the categories. But these categories are a priori: they originate in the mind. This means that the order and regularity we encounter in the natural world is made possible by the mind’s own construction of nature and its order. Thus the conclusion of the Transcendental Deduction parallels the conclusion of the Transcendental Aesthetic: where the latter had shown that the forms of sensibility (space and time) originate in the mind and are imposed on the world, the former shows that the forms of understanding (the categories) also originate in the mind and are imposed on the world.

f. Theory of Experience

The Transcendental Deduction showed that it is necessary for us to make use of the categories in experience, but also that we are justified in making use of them. In the following series of chapters (together labeled the Analytic of Principles) Kant attempts to leverage the results of the Deduction and prove that there are transcendentally necessary laws that every possible object of experience must obey. He refers to these as “principles of pure understanding.” These principles are synthetic a priori in the sense defined above (see 2b), and they are transcendental conditions on the possibility of experience.

The first two principles correspond to the categories of quantity and quality. First, Kant argues that every object of experience must have a determinate spatial shape and size and a determinate temporal duration (except mental objects, which have no spatial determinations). Second, Kant argues that every object of experience must contain a “matter” that fills out the object’s extensive magnitude. This matter must be describable as an “intensive magnitude.” Extensive magnitudes are represented through the intuition of the object (the form of the representation) and intensive magnitudes are represented by the sensations that fill out the intuition (the matter of the representation).

The next three principles are discussed in an important, lengthy chapter called the Analogies of Experience. They derive from the relational categories: substance, causality, and community. According to the First Analogy, experience will always involve objects that must be represented as substances. “Substance” here is to be understood in terms of an object that persists permanently as a “substratum” and which is the bearer of impermanent “accidents.” According to the Second Analogy, every event must have a cause. One event is said to be the cause of another when the second event follows the first in accordance with a rule. And according to the Third Analogy (which presupposes the first two), all substances stand in relations of reciprocal interaction with each other. That is, any two pieces of material substance will effect some degree of causal influence on each other, even if they are far apart.

The principles of the Analogies of Experience are important metaphysical principles, and if Kant’s arguments for them are successful, they mark significant advances in the metaphysical investigation of nature. The First Analogy is a form of the principle of the conservation of matter: it shows that matter can never be created or annihilated by natural means, it can only be altered. The Second Analogy is a version of the principle of sufficient reason applied to experience (causes being sufficient reasons for their effects), and it represents Kant’s refutation of Hume’s skepticism regarding causation. Hume had argued that we can never have knowledge of necessary connections between events; rather, we can only perceive certain types of events to be constantly conjoined with other types of events. In arguing that events follow each other in accordance with rules, Kant has shown how we can have knowledge of necessary connections between events above and beyond their mere constant conjunction. Lastly, Kant probably intended the Third Analogy to establish a transcendental, a priori basis for something like Newton’s law of universal gravitation, which says that no matter how far apart two objects are they will exert some degree of gravitational influence on each other.

The Postulates of Empirical Thinking in General contains the final set of principles of pure understanding and they derive from the modal categories (possibility, actuality, necessity). The Postulates define the different ways to represent the modal status of objects, that is, what it is for an object of experience to be possible, actual, or necessary.

The most important passage from the Postulates chapter is the Refutation of Idealism, which is a refutation of external world skepticism that Kant added to the 1787 edition of the Critique. Kant had been annoyed by reviews of the first edition that unfavorably compared his transcendental idealism with Berkeley’s immaterialist idealism. In the Refutation, Kant argues that his system entails not just that an external (that is, spatial) world is possible (which Berkeley denied), but that we can know it is real (which Descartes and others questioned). Kant’s argumentative strategy in the Refutation is ingenious but controversial. Where the skeptics assume that we have knowledge of the states of our own minds, but say that we cannot be certain that an external world corresponds to these states, Kant turns the tables and argues that we would not have knowledge of the states of our own minds (specifically, the temporal order in which our ideas occur) if we were not simultaneously aware of permanent substances in space, outside of the mind. The precise structure of Kant’s argument, as well as the question how successful it is, continues to be a matter of heated debate in the literature.

g. Critique of Transcendent Metaphysics

One of the most important upshots of Kant’s theory of experience is that it is possible to have knowledge of the world because the world as we experience it conforms to the conditions on the possibility of experience. Accordingly, Kant holds that there can be knowledge of an object only if it is possible for that object to be given in an experience. This aspect of the epistemological condition of the human subject entails that there are important areas of inquiry about which we would like to have knowledge, but cannot. Most importantly, Kant argued that transcendent metaphysics, that is, philosophical inquiry into “supersensible” objects that are not a part of the empirical world, marks a philosophical dead end. (Note: There is a subtle but important difference between the terms “transcendental” and “transcendent” for Kant. “Transcendental” describes conditions on the possibility of experience. “Transcendent” describes unknowable objects in the “noumenal” realm of things in themselves.)

Kant calls the basic concepts of metaphysical inquiry “ideas.” Unlike concepts of the understanding, which correspond to possible objects that can be given in experience, ideas are concepts of reason, and they do not correspond to possible objects of experience. The three most important ideas with which Kant is concerned in the Transcendental Dialectic are the soul, the world (considered as a totality), and God. The peculiar thing about these ideas of reason is that reason is led by its very structure to posit objects corresponding to these ideas. It cannot help but do this because reason’s job is to unify cognitions into a systematic whole, and it finds that it needs these ideas of the soul, the world, and God, in order to complete this systematic unification. Kant refers to reason’s inescapable tendency to posit unexperienceable and hence unknowable objects corresponding to these ideas as “transcendental illusion.”

Kant presents his analysis of transcendental illusion and his critique of transcendent metaphysics in the series of chapters titled “Transcendental Dialectic,” which takes up the majority of the second half of Critique of Pure Reason. This section summarizes Kant’s most important arguments from the Dialectic.

i. The Soul (Paralogisms of Pure Reason)

Kant addresses the metaphysics of the soul – an inquiry he refers to as “rational psychology” – in the Paralogisms of Pure Reason. Rational psychology, as Kant describes it, is the attempt to prove metaphysical theses about the nature of the soul through an analysis of the simple proposition, “I think.” Many of Kant’s rationalist predecessors and contemporaries had thought that reflection on the notion of the “I” in the proposition “I think” would reveal that the I is necessarily a substance (which would mean that the I is a soul), an indivisible unity (which some would use to prove the immortality of the soul), self-identical (which is relevant to questions regarding personal identity), and distinct from the external world (which can lead to external-world skepticism). Kant argues that such reasoning is the result of transcendental illusion.

Transcendental illusion in rational psychology arises when the mere thought of the I in the proposition “I think” is mistaken for a cognition of the I as an object. (A cognition involves both intuition and concept, while a mere thought involves only concept.) For instance, consider the question whether we can cognize the I as a substance (that is, as a soul). On the one hand, something is cognized as a substance when it is represented only as the subject of predication and is never itself the predicate of some other subject. The I of “I think” is always represented as subject (the I’s various thoughts are its predicates). On the other hand, something can only be cognized as a substance when it is given as a persistent object in an intuition (see 2f above), and there can be no intuition of the I itself. Hence although we cannot help but think of the I as a substantial soul, we can never have cognition of the I as a substance, and hence knowledge of the existence and nature of the soul is impossible.

ii. The World (Antinomies of Pure Reason)

The Antinomies of Pure Reason deal with “rational cosmology,” that is, with metaphysical inquiry into the nature of the cosmos considered as a totality. An “antinomy” is a conflict of reason with itself. Antinomies arise when reason seems to be able to prove two opposed and mutually contradictory propositions with apparent certainty. Kant discusses four antinomies in the first Critique (he uncovers other antinomies in later writings as well). The First Antinomy shows that reason seems to be able to prove that the universe is both finite and infinite in space and time. The Second Antinomy shows that reason seems to be able to prove that matter both is and is not infinitely divisible into ever smaller parts. The Third Antinomy shows that reason seems to be able to prove that free will cannot be a causally efficacious part of the world (because all of nature is deterministic) and yet that it must be such a cause. And the Fourth Antinomy shows that reason seems to be able to prove that there is and there is not a necessary being (which some would identify with God).

In all four cases, Kant attempts to resolve these conflicts of reason with itself by appeal to transcendental idealism. The claim that space and time are not features of things in themselves is used to resolve the First and Second Antinomies. Since the empirical world in space and time is identified with appearances, and since the world as a totality can never itself be given as a single appearance, there is no determinate fact of the matter regarding the size of the universe: It is neither determinately finite nor determinately infinite; rather, it is indefinitely large. Similarly, matter has neither simplest atoms (or “monads”) nor is it infinitely divided; rather, it is indefinitely divisible.

The distinction between appearances and things in themselves is used to resolve the Third and Fourth Antinomies. Although every empirical event experienced within the realm of appearance has a deterministic natural cause, it is at least logically possible that freedom can be a causally efficacious power at the level of things in themselves. And although every empirical object experienced within the realm of appearance is a contingently existing entity, it is logically possible that there is a necessary being outside the realm of appearance which grounds the existence of the contingent beings within the realm of appearance. It must be kept in mind that Kant has not claimed to demonstrate the existence of a transcendent free will or a transcendent necessary being: Kant denies the possibility of knowledge of things in themselves. Instead, Kant only takes himself to have shown that the existence of such entities is logically possible. In his moral theory, however, Kant will offer an argument for the actuality of freedom (see 5c below).

iii. God (Ideal of Pure Reason)

The Ideal of Pure Reason addresses the idea of God and argues that it is impossible to prove the existence of God. The argumentation in the Ideal of Pure Reason was anticipated in Kant’s The Only Possible Argument in Support of the Existence of God (1763), making this aspect of Kant’s mature thought one of the most significant remnants of the pre-critical period.

Kant identifies the idea of God with the idea of an ens realissimum, or “most real being.” This most real being is also considered by reason to be a necessary being, that is, something which exists necessarily instead of merely contingently. Reason is led to posit the idea of such a being when it reflects on its conceptions of finite beings with limited reality and infers that the reality of finite beings must derive from and depend on the reality of the most infinitely perfect being. Of course, the fact that reason necessarily thinks of a most real, necessary being does not entail that such a being exists. Kant argues that there are only three possible arguments for the existence of such a being, and that none is successful.

According to the ontological argument for the existence of God (versions of which were proposed by St. Anselm (1033-1109) and Descartes (1596-1650), among others), God is the only being whose essence entails its existence. Kant famously objects that this argument mistakenly treats existence as a “real predicate.” According to Kant, when I make an assertion of the form “x is necessarily F,” all I can mean is that “if x exists, then x must be F.” Thus when proponents of the ontological argument claim that the idea of God entails that “God necessarily exists,” all they can mean is that “if God exists, then God exists,” which is an empty tautology.

Kant also offers lengthy criticisms of the cosmological argument (the existence of contingent beings entails the existence of a necessary being) and the physico-theological argument, which is also referred to as the “argument from design” (the order and purposiveness in the empirical world can only be explained by a divine creator). Kant argues that both of these implicitly depend on the argumentation of the ontological argument pertaining to necessary existence, and since it fails, they fail as well.

Although Kant argues in the Transcendental Dialectic that we cannot have cognition of the soul, of freedom of the will, nor of God, in his ethical writings he will complicate this story and argue that we are justified in believing in these things (see 5c below).

3. Philosophy of Mathematics

The distinction between analytic and synthetic judgments (see 2b above) is necessary for understanding Kant’s theory of mathematics. Recall that an analytic judgment is one where the truth of the judgment depends only on the relation between the concepts used in the judgment. The truth of a synthetic judgment, by contrast, requires that an object be “given” in sensibility and that the concepts used in the judgment be combined in the object. In these terms, most of Kant’s predecessors took mathematical truths to be analytic truths. Kant, by contrast argued that mathematical knowledge is synthetic. It may seem surprising that one’s knowledge of mathematical truths depends on an object being given in sensibility, for we surely don’t arrive at mathematical knowledge by empirical means. Recall, however, that a judgment can be both synthetic yet a priori. Like the judgments of the necessary structures of experience, mathematics is also synthetic a priori according to Kant.

To make this point, Kant considers the proposition ‘7+5=12’. Surely, this proposition is a priori: I can know its truth without doing empirical experiments to see what happens when I put seven things next to five other things. More to the point, ‘7+5=12’ must be a priori because it is a necessary truth, and empirical judgments are always merely contingent according to Kant. Yet at the same time, the judgment is not analytic because, “The concept of twelve is by no means already thought merely by my thinking of that unification of seven and five, and no matter how long I analyze my concept of such a possible sum I will still not find twelve in it” (B15).

If mathematical knowledge is synthetic, then it depends on objects being given in sensibility. And if it is a priori, then these objects must be non-empirical objects. What sort of objects does Kant have in mind here? The answer lies in Kant’s theory of the pure forms of intuition (space and time). Recall that an intuition is a singular, immediate representation of an individual object (see 2c above). Empirical intuitions represent sensible objects through sensation, but pure intuitions are a priori representations of space and time as such. These pure intuitions of space and time provide the objects of mathematics through what Kant calls a “construction” of concepts in pure intuition. As he puts it, “to construct a concept means to exhibit a priori the intuition corresponding to it” (A713/B741). A mathematical concept (for example, ‘triangle’) can be thought of as a rule for how to make an object that corresponds to that concept. Thus if ‘triangle’ is defined as ‘three-sided, two-dimensional shape’, then I construct a triangle in pure intuition when I imagine three lines coming together to form a two-dimensional figure. These pure constructions in intuition can be used to arrive at (synthetic, a priori) mathematical knowledge. Consider the proposition, ‘The angles of a triangle sum to 180 degrees’. When I construct a triangle in intuition in accordance with the rule ‘three-sided, two-dimensional shape’, then the constructed triangle will in fact have angles that sum to 180 degrees. And this will be true irrespective of what particular triangle I constructed (isosceles, scalene, and so forth.). Kant holds that all mathematical knowledge is derived in this fashion: I take a concept, construct it in pure intuition, and then determine what features of the constructed intuition are necessarily true of it.

4. Natural Science

In addition to his work in pure theoretical philosophy, Kant displayed an active interest in the natural sciences throughout his career. Most of his important scientific contributions were in the physical sciences (including not just physics proper, but also earth sciences and cosmology). In Critique of the Power of Judgment (1790) he also presented a lengthy discussion of the philosophical basis of the study of biological entities.

In general, Kant thought that a body of knowledge could only count as a science in the true sense if it could admit of mathematical description and an a priori principle that could be “presented a priori in intuition” (4:471). Hence, Kant was pessimistic about the possibility of empirical psychology ever amounting to a true science. Kant even thought it might be the case that “chemistry can be nothing more than a systematic art or experimental doctrine, but never a proper science” (4:471).

This section focuses primarily on Kant’s physics (4a), but it also lists several of Kant’s other scientific contributions (4b).

a. Physics

Kant’s interest in physical theory began early. His first published work, Thoughts on the True Estimation of Living Forces (1749) was an inquiry into some foundational problems in physics, and it entered into the “vis viva” (“living forces”) debate between Leibniz and the Cartesians regarding how to quantify force in moving objects (for the most part, Kant sided with the Leibnizians). A few years later, Kant wrote the Physical Monadology (1756), which dealt with other foundational questions in physics (see 2a above.)

Kant’s mature physical theory is presented in its fullest form in Metaphysical Foundations of Natural Science (1786). This theory can be understood as an outgrowth and consequence of the transcendental theory of experience articulated in Critique of Pure Reason (see 2f above). Where the Critique had shown the necessary conceptual forms to which all possible objects of experience must conform, the Metaphysical Foundations specifies in greater detail what exactly the physical constitution of these objects must be like. The continuity with the theory of experience from the Critique is implicit in the very structure of the Metaphysical Foundations. Just as Kant’s theory of experience was divided into four sections corresponding to the four groups of categories (quantity, quality, relation, modality), the body of the Metaphysical Foundations is also divided along the same lines.

Like the theory of the Physical Monadology, the Metaphysical Foundations presents a “dynamical” theory of matter according to which material substance is constituted by an interaction between attractive and repulsive forces. The basic idea is that each volume of material substance possesses a brute tendency to expand and push away other volumes of substance (this is repulsive force) and each volume of substance possesses a brute tendency to contract and to attract other volumes of substance (this is attractive force). The repulsive force explains the solidity and impenetrability of bodies while the attractive force explains gravitation (and presumably also phenomena such as magnetic attraction). Further, any given volume of substance will possess these forces to a determinate degree: the matter in a volume can be more or less repulsive and more or less attractive. The ratio of attractive and repulsive force in a substance will determine how dense the body is. In this respect, Kant’s theory marks a sharp break from those of his mechanist predecessors. (Mechanists believed that all physical phenomena could be explained by appeal to the sizes, shapes, and velocities of material bodies.) The Cartesians thought that there is no true difference in density and that the appearance of differences in density could be explained by appeal to porosity in the body. Similarly, the atomists thought that density could be explained by differences in the ratio of atoms to void in any given volume. Thus for both of these theories, any time there was a volume completely filled in with material substance (no pores, no void), there could only be one possible value for mass divided by volume. According to Kant’s theory, by contrast, two volumes of equal size could be completely filled in with matter and yet differ in their quantity of matter (their mass), and hence differ in their density (mass divided by volume). Another consequence of Kant’s theory that puts him at odds with the Cartesians and atomists was his claim that matter is elastic, hence compressible: a completely filled volume of matter could be reduced in volume while the quantity of matter remained unchanged (hence it would become denser). The Cartesians and atomists took this to be impossible.

At the end of his career, Kant worked on a project that was supposed to complete the connection between the transcendental philosophy and physics. Among other things, Kant attempted to give a transcendental, a priori demonstration of the existence of a ubiquitous “ether” that permeates all of space. Although Kant never completed a manuscript for this project (due primarily to the deterioration of his mental faculties at the end of his life), he did leave behind many notes and partial drafts. Many of these notes and drafts have been edited and published under the title Opus Postumum.

b. Other Scientific Contributions

In addition to his major contributions to physics, Kant published various writings addressing different issues in the natural sciences. Early on he showed a great deal of interest in geology and earth science, as evidenced by the titles of some of his shorter essays: The question, Whether the Earth is Ageing, Considered from a Physical Point of View (1754); On the Causes of Earthquakes on the Occasion of the Calamity that Befell the Western Countries of Europe Towards the End of Last Year (1756); Continued Observations on the Earthquakes that Have been Experienced for Some Time (1756); New Notes to Explain the Theory of the Winds, in which, at the Same Time, He Invites Attendance to his Lectures (1756).

In 1755, he wrote the Succinct Exposition of Some Meditations on Fire (which he submitted to the university as a Master’s Thesis). There he argued, against the Cartesian mechanists, that physical phenomena such as fire can only be explained by appeal to elastic (that is, compressible) matter, which anticipated the mature physics of his Metaphysical Foundations (see 4a above).

One of Kant’s most lasting scientific contributions came from his early work in cosmology. In his Universal Natural History and Theory of the Heavens (1755), Kant gave a mechanical explanation of the formation of the solar system and the galaxies in terms of the principles of Newtonian physics. (A shorter version of the argument also appears in The Only Possible Argument in Support of a Demonstration of the Existence of God from 1763.) Kant’s hypothesis was that a single mechanical process could explain why we observe an orbital motion of smaller bodies around larger ones at many different scales in the cosmos (moons around planets, planets around stars, and stars around the center of the galaxy). He proposed that at the beginning of creation, all matter was spread out more or less evenly and randomly in a kind of nebula. Since the various bits of matter all attracted each other through gravitation, bodies would move towards each other within local regions to form larger bodies. The largest of these became stars, and the smaller ones became moons or planets. Because everything was already in motion (due to the gravitational attraction of everything to everything), and because all objects would be pulled towards the center of mass of their local region (for example, the sun at the center of the solar system, or a planet at the center of its own smaller planetary system), the motion of objects within that region would become orbital motions (as described by Newton’s theory of gravity). Although the Universal Natural History was not widely read for most of Kant’s lifetime (due primarily to Kant’s publisher going bankrupt while the printed books remained in a warehouse), in 1796 Pierre-Simon Laplace (1749-1827) proposed a remarkably similar version of the same theory, and this caused renewed interest in Kant’s book. Today the theory is referred to as the “Kant-Laplace Nebular Hypothesis,” and a modified version of this theory is still held today.

Finally, in the second half of Critique of the Power of Judgment (1790), Kant discusses the philosophical foundations of biology by way of an analysis of teleological judgments. While in no way a fully worked out biological theory per se, Kant connects his account of biological cognition in interesting ways to other important aspects of his philosophical system. First, natural organisms are essentially teleological, or “purposive.” This purposiveness is manifested through the organic structure of the organism: its many parts all work together to constitute the whole, and any one part only makes sense in terms of its relation to the healthy functioning of the whole. For instance, the teeth of an animal are designed to chew the kind of food that the animal is equipped to hunt or forage and that it is suited to digest. In this respect, biological entities bear a strong analogy to great works of art. Great works of art are also organic insofar as the parts only make sense in the context of the whole, and art displays a purposiveness similar to that found in nature (see section 7 below). Second, Kant discusses the importance of biology with respect to theological cognition. While he denies that the apparent design behind the purposiveness of organisms can be used as a proof for God’s existence (see 2g3 above), he does think that the purposiveness found in nature provides a sort of hint that there is an intelligible principle behind the observable, natural world, and hence that the ultimate purpose of all of nature is a rational one. In connection with his moral theory and theory of human history (see sections 5 and 6 below), Kant will argue that the teleology of nature can be understood as ultimately directed towards a culmination in a fully rational nature, that is, humanity in its (future) final form.

5. Moral Theory

Kant’s moral theory is organized around the idea that to act morally and to act in accordance with reason are one and the same. In virtue of being a rational agent (that is, in virtue of possessing practical reason, reason which is interested and goal-directed), one is obligated to follow the moral law that practical reason prescribes. To do otherwise is to act irrationally. Because Kant places his emphasis on the duty that comes with being a rational agent who is cognizant of the moral law, Kant’s theory is considered a form of deontology (deon– comes from the Greek for “duty” or “obligation”).

Like his theoretical philosophy, Kant’s practical philosophy is a priori, formal, and universal: the moral law is derived non-empirically from the very structure of practical reason itself (its form), and since all rational agents share the same practical reason, the moral law binds and obligates everyone equally. So what is this moral law that obligates all rational agents universally and a priori? The moral law is determined by what Kant refers to as the Categorical Imperative, which is the general principle that demands that one respect the humanity in oneself and in others, that one not make an exception for oneself when deliberating about how to act, and in general that one only act in accordance with rules that everyone could and should obey.

Although Kant insists that the moral law is equally binding for all rational agents, he also insists that the bindingness of the moral law is self-imposed: we autonomously prescribe the moral law to ourselves. Because Kant thinks that the kind of autonomy in question here is only possible under the presupposition of a transcendentally free basis of moral choice, the constraint that the moral law places on an agent is not only consistent with freedom of the will, it requires it. Hence, one of the most important aspects of Kant’s project is to show that we are justified in presupposing that our morally significant choices are grounded in a transcendental freedom (the very sort of freedom that Kant argued we could not prove through mere “theoretical” or “speculative” reason; see 2gii above).

This section aims to explain the structure and content of Kant’s moral theory (5a-b), and also Kant’s claims that belief in freedom, God, and the immortality of the soul are necessary “postulates” of practical reason (5c). (On the relation between Kant’s moral theory and his aesthetic theory, see 7c below.)

a. The Good Will and Duty

Kant lays out the case for his moral theory in Groundwork for the Metaphysics of Morals (1785), Critique of Practical Reason (also known as the “Second Critique”; 1788), and the Metaphysics of Morals (1797). His arguments from the Groundwork are his most well-known and influential, so the following focuses primarily on them.

Kant begins his argument from the premise that a moral theory must be grounded in an account of what is unconditionally good. If something is merely conditionally good, that is, if its goodness depends on something else, then that other thing will either be merely conditionally good as well, in which case its goodness depends on yet another thing, or it will be unconditionally good. All goodness, then, must ultimately be traceable to something that is unconditionally good. There are many things that we typically think of as good but that are not truly unconditionally good. Beneficial resources such as money or power are often good, but since these things can be used for evil purposes, their goodness is conditional on the use to which they are put. Strength of character is generally a good thing, but again, if someone uses a strong character to successfully carry out evil plans, then the strong character is not good. Even happiness, according to Kant, is not unconditionally good. Although all humans universally desire to be happy, if someone is happy but does not deserve their happiness (because, for instance, their happiness results from stealing from the elderly), then it is not good for the person to be happy. Happiness is only good on the condition that the happiness is deserved.

Kant argues that there is only one thing that can be considered unconditionally good: a good will. A person has a good will insofar as they form their intentions on the basis of a self-conscious respect for the moral law, that is, for the rules regarding what a rational agent ought to do, one’s duty. The value of a good will lies in the principles on the basis of which it forms its intentions; it does not lie in the consequences of the actions that the intentions lead to. This is true even if a good will never leads to any desirable consequences at all: “Even if… this will should wholly lack the capacity to carry out its purpose… then, like a jewel, it would still shine by itself, as something that has its full worth in itself” (4:393). This is in line with Kant’s emphasis on the unconditional goodness of a good will: if a will were evaluated in terms of its consequences, then the goodness of the will would depend on (that is, would be conditioned on) those consequences. (In this respect, Kant’s deontology is in stark opposition to consequentialist moral theories, which base their moral evaluations on the consequences of actions rather than the intentions behind them.)

b. The Categorical Imperative

If a good will is one that forms its intentions on the basis of correct principles of action, then we want to know what sort of principles these are. A principle that commands an action is called an “imperative.” Most imperatives are “hypothetical imperatives,” that is, they are commands that hold only if certain conditions are met. For instance: “if you want to be a successful shopkeeper, then cultivate a reputation for honesty.” Since hypothetical imperatives are conditioned on desires and the intended consequences of actions, they cannot serve as the principles that determine the intentions and volitions of an unconditionally good will. Instead, we require what Kant calls a “categorical imperative.” Where hypothetical imperatives take the form, “if y is desired/intended/sought, do x,” categorical imperatives simply take the form, “do x.” Since a categorical imperative is stripped of all reference to the consequences of an action, it is thereby stripped of all determinate content, and hence it is purely formal. And since it is unconditional, it holds universally. Hence a categorical imperative expresses only the very form of a universally binding law: “nothing is left but the conformity of actions as such with universal law” (4:402). To act morally, then, is to form one’s intentions on the basis of the very idea of a universal principle of action.

This conception of a categorical imperative leads Kant to his first official formulation of the categorical imperative itself: “act only in accordance with that maxim through which you can at the same time will that it become a universal law” (4:421). A maxim is a general rule that can be used to determine particular courses of actions in particular circumstances. For instance, the maxim “I shall lie when it will get me out of trouble” can be used to determine the decision to lie about an adulterous liaison. The categorical imperative offers a decision procedure for determining whether a given course of action is in accordance with the moral law. After determining what maxim one would be basing the action in question on, one then asks whether it would be possible, given the power (in an imagined, hypothetical scenario), to choose that everyone act in accordance with that same maxim. If it is possible to will that everyone act according to that maxim, then the action under consideration is morally permissible. If it is not possible to will that everyone act according to that maxim, the action is morally impermissible. Lying to cover up adultery is thus immoral because one cannot will that everyone act according to the maxim, “I shall lie when it will get me out of trouble.” Note that it is not simply that it would be undesirable for everyone to act according to that maxim. Rather, it would be impossible. Since everyone would know that everyone else was acting according to that maxim, there would never be the presupposition that anyone was telling the truth; the very act of lying, of course, requires such a presupposition on the part of the one being lied to. Hence, the state of affairs where everyone lies to get out of trouble can never arise, so it cannot be willed to be a universal law. It fails the test of the categorical imperative.

The point of Kant’s appeal to the universal law formulation of the categorical imperative is to show that an action is morally permissible only if the maxim on which the action is based could be affirmed as a universal law that everyone obeys without exception. The mark of immorality, then, is that one makes an exception for oneself. That is, one acts in a way that they would not want everyone else to. When someone chooses to lie about an adulterous liaison, one is implicitly thinking, “in general people should tell the truth, but in this case I will be the exception to the rule.”

Kant’s first formulation of the categorical imperative describes it in terms of the very form of universal law itself. This formal account abstracts from any specific content that the moral law might have for living, breathing human beings. Kant offers a second formulation to address the material side of the moral law. Since the moral law has to do with actions, and all actions are by definition teleological (that is, goal-directed), a material formulation of the categorical imperative will require an appeal to the “ends” of human activity. Some ends are merely instrumental, that is, they are sought only because they serve as “means” towards further ends. Kant argues that the moral law must be aimed at an end that is not merely instrumental, but is rather an end in itself. Only rational agents, according to Kant, are ends in themselves. To act morally is thus to respect rational agents as ends in themselves. Accordingly, the categorical imperative can be reformulated as follows: “So act that you use humanity, whether in your own person or in the person of any other, always at the same time as an end, never merely as a means” (4:429). The basic idea here is that it is immoral to treat someone as a thing of merely instrumental value; persons have an intrinsic (non-instrumental) value, and the moral law demands that we respect this intrinsic value. To return to the example of the previous paragraphs, it would be wrong to lie about an adulterous liaison because by withholding the truth one is manipulating the other person to make things easier for oneself; this sort of manipulation, however, amounts to treating the other as a thing (as a mere means to the comfort of not getting in trouble), and not as a person deserving of respect and entitled to the truth.

The notion of a universal law provides the form of the categorical imperative and rational agents as ends in themselves provide the matter. These two sides of the categorical imperative are combined into yet a third formulation, which appeals to the notion of a “kingdom of ends.” A kingdom of ends can be thought of as a sort of perfectly just utopian ideal in which all citizens of this kingdom freely respect the intrinsic worth of the humanity in all others because of an autonomously self-imposed recognition of the bindingness of the universal moral law for all rational agents. The third formulation of the categorical imperative is simply the idea that one should act in whatever way a member of this perfectly just society would act: “act in accordance with the maxims of a member giving universal laws for a merely possible kingdom of ends” (4:439). The idea of a kingdom of ends is an ideal (hence the “merely possible”). Although humanity may never be able to achieve such a perfect state of utopian coexistence, we can at least strive to approximate this state to an ever greater degree.

c. Postulates of Practical Reason

In Critique of Pure Reason, Kant had argued that although we can acknowledge the bare logical possibility that humans possess free will, that there is an immortal soul, and that there is a God, he also argued that we can never have positive knowledge of these things (see 2g above). In his ethical writings, however, Kant complicates this story. He argues that despite the theoretical impossibility of knowledge of these objects, belief in them is nevertheless a precondition for moral action (and for practical cognition generally). Accordingly, freedom, immortality, and God are “postulates of practical reason.” (The following discussion draws primarily on Critique of Practical Reason.)

We will start with freedom. Kant argues that morality and the obligation that comes with it are only possible if humans have free will. This is because the universal laws prescribed by the categorical imperative presuppose autonomy (autos = self; nomos = law). To be autonomous is to be the free ground of one’s own principles, or “laws” of action. Kant argues that if we presuppose that humans are rational and have free will, then his entire moral theory follows directly. The problem, however, lies in justifying the belief that we are free. Kant had argued in the Second Analogy of Experience that every event in the natural world has a “determining ground,” that is, a cause, and so all human actions, as natural events, themselves have deterministic causes (see 2f above). The only room for freedom of the will would lie in the realm of things in themselves, which contains the noumenal correlate of my phenomenal self. Since things in themselves are unknowable, I can never look to them to get evidence that I possess transcendental freedom. Kant gives at least two arguments to justify belief in freedom as a precondition of his moral theory. (There is a great deal of controversy among commentators regarding the exact form of his arguments, as well as their success. It will not be possible to adjudicate those disputes in any detail here. See Section 10 (References and Further Readings) for references to some of these commentaries.)

In the Groundwork, Kant suggests that the presupposition that we are free follows as a consequence of the fact that we have practical reason and that we think of ourselves as practical agents. Any time I face a choice that requires deliberation, I must consider the options before me as really open. If I thought of my course of action as already determined ahead of time, then there would not really be any choice to make. Furthermore, in taking my deliberation to be real, I also think of the possible outcomes of my actions as caused by me. The notion of a causality that originates in the self is the notion of a free will. So the very fact that I do deliberate about what actions I will take means that I am presupposing that my choice is real and hence that I am free. As Kant puts it, all practical agents act “under the idea of freedom” (4:448). It is not obvious that this argument is strong enough for Kant’s purposes. The position seems to be that I must act as though I am free, but acting as though I am free in no way entails that I really am free. At best, it seems that since I act as though I am free, I thereby must act as though morality really does obligate me. This does not establish that the moral law really does obligate me.

In the Second Critique, Kant offers a different argument for the reality of freedom. He argues that it is a brute “fact of reason” (5:31) that the categorical imperative (and so morality generally) obligates us as rational agents. In other words, all rational agents are at least implicitly conscious of the bindingness of the moral law on us. Since morality requires freedom, it follows that if morality is real, then freedom must be real too. Thus this “fact of reason” allows for an inference to the reality of freedom. Although the conclusion of this argument is stronger than the earlier argument, its premise is more controversial. For instance, it is far from obvious that all rational agents are conscious of the moral law. If they were, how come no one discovered this exact moral law before 1785 when Kant wrote the Groundwork? Equally problematic, it is not clear why this “fact of reason” should count as knowledge of the bindingness of the moral law. It may just be that we cannot help but believe that the moral law obligates us, in which case we once again end up merely acting as though we are free and as though the moral law is real.

Again, there is much debate in the literature about the structure and success of Kant’s arguments. It is clear, however, that the success of Kant’s moral project stands or falls with his arguments for freedom of the will, and that the overall strength of this theory is determined to a high degree by the epistemic status of our belief in our own freedom.

Kant’s arguments for immortality and God as postulates of practical reason presuppose that the reality of the moral law and the freedom of the will have been established, and they also depend on the principle that “‘ought’ implies ‘can’”: one cannot be obligated to do something unless the thing in question is doable. For instance, there is no sense in which I am obligated to single-handedly solve global poverty, because it is not within my power to do so. According to Kant, the ultimate aim of a rational moral agent should be to become perfectly moral. We are obligated to strive to become ever more moral. Given the “ought implies can” principle, if we ought to work towards moral perfection, then moral perfection must be possible and we can become perfect. However, Kant holds that moral perfection is something that finite rational agents such as humans can only progress towards, but not actually attain in any finite amount of time, and certainly not within any one human lifetime. Thus the moral law demands an “endless progress” towards “complete conformity of the will with the moral law” (5:122). This endless progress towards perfection can only be demanded of us if our own existence is endless. In short, one’s belief that one should strive towards moral perfection presupposes the belief in the immortality of the soul.

In addition to the “ought implies can” principle, Kant’s argument about belief in God also involves an elaboration of the notion of the “highest good” at which all moral action aims (at least indirectly). According to Kant, the highest good, that is, the most perfect possible state for a community of rational agents, is not only one in which all agents act in complete conformity with the moral law. It is also a state in which these agents are happy. Kant had argued that although everyone naturally desires to be happy, happiness is only good when one deserves to be happy. In the ideal scenario of a morally perfect community of rational agents, everyone deserves to be happy. Since a deserved happiness is a good thing, the highest good will involve a situation in which everyone acts in complete conformity with the moral law and everyone is completely happy because they deserve to be. Now since we are obligated to work towards this highest good, this complete, universal, morally justified happiness must be possible (again, because “ought” implies “can”). This is where a puzzle arises. Although happiness is connected to morality at the conceptual level when one deserves happiness, there is no natural connection between morality and happiness. Our happiness depends on the natural world (for example, whether we are healthy, whether natural disasters affect us), and the natural world operates according to laws that are completely separate from the laws of morality. Accordingly, acting morally is in general no guarantee that nature will make it possible for one to be happy. If anything, behaving morally will often decrease one’s happiness (for doing the right thing often involves doing the uncomfortable, difficult thing). And we all have plenty of empirical evidence from the world we live in that often bad things happen to good people and good things happen to bad people. Thus if the highest good (in which happiness is proportioned to virtue) is possible, then somehow there must be a way for the laws of nature to eventually lead to a situation in which happiness is proportioned to virtue. (Note that since at this point in the argument, Kant takes himself to have established immortality as a postulate of practical reason, this “eventually” may very well be far in the future). Since the laws of nature and the laws of morality are completely separate on their own, the only way that the two could come together such that happiness ends up proportioned to virtue would be if the ultimate cause and ground of nature set up the world in such a way that the laws of nature would eventually lead to the perfect state in question. Therefore, the possibility of the highest good requires the presupposition that the cause of the world is intelligent and powerful enough to set nature up in the right way, and also that it wills in accordance with justice that eventually the laws of nature will indeed lead to a state in which the happiness of rational agents is proportioned to their virtue. This intelligent, powerful, and just cause of the world is what traditionally goes by the name of “God.” Hence God is a postulate of practical reason.

6. Political Theory and Theory of Human History

Kant’s ethical theory emphasized reason, autonomy, and a respect for the humanity of others. These central aspects of his theory of individual moral choice are carried over to his theories of humanity’s history and of ideal political organization. This section covers Kant’s teleological history of the human race (6a), the basic elements of his political theory (6b), and his theory of the possibility of world peace (6c).

a. Human History and the Age of Enlightenment

Kant’s socio-political philosophy must be understood in terms of his understanding of the history of humanity, of its teleology, and in terms of his particular time and place: Europe during the Enlightenment.

In his short essay “Idea for a Universal History with a Cosmopolitan Purpose” (1784), Kant outlines a speculative sketch of humanity’s history organized around his conception of the teleology intrinsic to the species. The natural purpose of humanity is the development of reason. This development is not something that can take place in one individual lifetime, but is instead the ongoing project of humanity across the generations. Nature fosters this goal through both human physiology and human psychology. Humans have no fur, claws, or sharp teeth, and so if we are to be sheltered and fed, we must use our reason to create the tools necessary to satisfy our needs. More importantly, at the cultural level, Kant argues that human society is characterized by an “unsocial sociability”: on the one hand, humans need to live with other humans and we feel incomplete in isolation; but on the other, we frequently disagree with each other and are frustrated when others don’t agree with us on important matters. The frustration brought on by disagreement serves as an incentive to develop our capacity to reason so that we can argue persuasively and convince others to agree with us.

By means of our physiological deficiencies and our unsocial sociability, nature has nudged us, generation by generation, to develop our capacity for reason and slowly to emerge from the hazy fog of pre-history up to the present. This development is not yet complete. Kant takes stock of where we were in his day, in late 18^th c. Prussia) in his short, popular essay: “An Answer to the Question: What is Enlightenment?” (1784). To be enlightened, he argues, is to determine one’s beliefs and actions in accordance with the free use of one’s reason. The process of enlightenment is humanity’s “emergence from its self-incurred immaturity” (8:35), that is, the emergence from an uncritical reliance on the authority of others (for example, parents, monarchs, or priests). This is a slow, on-going process. Kant thought that his own age was an age of enlightenment, but not yet a fully enlightened age.

The goal of humanity is to reach a point where all interpersonal interactions are conducted in accordance with reason, and hence in accordance with the moral law (this is the idea of a kingdom of ends described in 5b above). Kant thinks that there are two significant conditions that must be in place before such an enlightened age can come to be. First, humans must live in a perfectly just society under a perfectly just constitution. Second, the nations of the world must coexist as an international federation in a state of “perpetual peace.” Some aspects of the first condition are discussed in 6b, and of the second in 6c.

b. Political Theory

Kant fullest articulation of his political theory appears in the “Doctrine of Right,” which is the first half of Metaphysics of Morals (1797). In line with his belief that a freedom grounded in rationality is what bestows dignity upon human beings, Kant organizes his theory of justice around the notion of freedom: “Any action is right if it can coexist with everyone’s freedom in accordance with a universal law, or if on its maxim the freedom of choice of each can coexist with everyone’s freedom in accordance with a universal law” (6:230). Implicit in this definition is a theory of equality: everyone should be granted the same degree of freedom. Although a state, through the passing and enforcing of laws, necessarily restricts freedom to some degree, Kant argues that this is necessary for the preservation of equality of human freedom. This is because when the freedoms of all are unchecked (for example, in the state of nature, which is also a condition of anarchy), the strong will overpower the weak and infringe on their freedoms, in which case freedoms will not be distributed equally, contrary to Kant’s basic principle of right. Hence a fair and lawful coercion that restricts freedom is consistent with and required by maximal and equal degrees of freedom for all.

Kant holds that republicanism is the ideal form of government. In a republic, voters elect representatives and these representatives decide on particular laws on behalf of the people. (Kant shows that he was not free of the prejudices of his day, and claims, with little argument, that neither women nor the poor should be full citizens with voting rights.) Representatives are duty-bound to choose these laws from the perspective of the “general will” (a term Kant borrows from Rousseau), rather than from the perspective of the interests of any one individual or group within society. Even though the entire population does not vote on each individual law, a law is said to be just only in case an entire population of rational agents could and would consent to the law. In this respect, Kant’s theory of just law is analogous to his universal law formulation of the categorical imperative: both demand that it be possible in principle for everyone to affirm the rule in question (see 5b above).

Among the freedoms that ought to be respected in a just society (republican or otherwise) are the freedom to pursue happiness in any way one chooses (so long as this pursuit does not infringe the rights of others, of course), freedom of religion, and freedom of speech. These last two are especially important to Kant and he associated them with the ongoing enlightenment of humanity in “What is Enlightenment?” He argues that it “would be a crime against human nature” (8:39) to legislate religious doctrine because doing so would be to deny to humans the very free use of reason that makes them human. Similarly, restrictions on what Kant calls the “public use of one’s reason” are contrary to the most basic teleology of the human species, namely, the development of reason. Kant himself had felt the sting of an infringement on these rights when the government of Friedrich Wilhelm II (the successor to Frederick the Great) prohibited Kant from publishing anything further on matters pertaining to religion.

c. Perpetual Peace

Kant elaborates the cosmopolitan theory first proposed in “Idea for a Universal History” in his Towards Perpetual Peace (1795). The basic idea is that world peace can be achieved only when international relations mirror, in certain respects, the relations between individuals in a just society. Just as people cannot be traded as things, so too states cannot be traded as though they were mere property. Just as individuals must respect others’ rights to free self-determination, so too, “no state shall forcibly interfere in the constitution and government of another state” (8:346). And in general, just as individuals need to arrange themselves into just societies, states, considered as individuals themselves, must arrange themselves into a global federation, a “league of nations” (8:354). Of course, until a state of perpetual peace is reached, wars will be inevitable. Even in times of wars, however, certain laws must be respected. For instance, it is never permissible for hostilities to become so violent as to undermine the possibility of a future peace treaty.

Kant argued that republicanism is especially conducive to peace, and he argued that perpetual peace would require that all states be republics. This is because the people will only consent to a war if they are willing to bear the economic burdens that war brings, and such a cost will only be worthwhile when there is a truly dire threat. If only the will of the monarch is required to go to war, since the monarch will not have to bear the full burden of the war (the cost will be distributed among the subjects), there is much less disincentive against war.

According to Kant, war is the result of an imbalance or disequilibrium in international relations. Although wars are never desirable, they lead to new conditions in international relations, and sometimes these new conditions are more balanced than the previous ones. When they are more balanced, there is less chance of new war occurring. Overall then, although the progression is messy and violent along the way, the slow march towards perpetual peace is a process in which all the states of the world slowly work towards a condition of balance and equilibrium.

7. Theory of Art and Beauty

Kant’s most worked out presentation of his views on aesthetics appears in Critique of the Power of Judgment (1790), also known as the “Third Critique.” As the title implies, Kant’s aesthetic theory is cashed out through an analysis of the operations of the faculty of judgment. That is, Kant explains what it is for something to be beautiful by explaining what goes into the judgment that something is beautiful. This section explains the structure of aesthetic judgments of the beautiful and the sublime (7a), summarizes Kant’s theory of art and the genius behind art (7b), and finally explains the connection between Kant’s aesthetic theory and his moral theory (7c).

a. The Beautiful and the Sublime

Kant holds that there are three different types of aesthetic judgments: judgments of the agreeable, of the beautiful, and of the sublime. The first is not particularly interesting, because it pertains simply to whatever objects happen to cause us (personally) pleasure or pain. There is nothing universal about such judgments. If one person finds botanical gin pleasant and another does not, there is no disagreement, simply different responses to the stimulus. Judgments of the beautiful and the sublime, however, are more interesting and worth spending some time on.

Let us consider judgments of beauty (which Kant calls “judgments of taste”) first. Kant argues that all judgments of taste involve four components, or “moments.” First, judgments of taste involve a subjective yet disinterested enjoyment. We have an appreciation for the object without desiring it. This contrasts judgments of taste from both cognitions, which represent objects as they are rather than how they affect us, and desires, which represent objects in terms of what we want. Second, judgments of taste involve universality. When we judge an object to be beautiful, implicit in the judgment is the belief that everyone should judge the object in the same way. Third, judgments of taste involve the form of purposiveness, or “purposeless purposiveness.” Beautiful objects seem to be “for” something, even though there is nothing determinate that they are for. Fourth, judgments of taste involve necessity. When presented with a beautiful object, I take it that I ought to judge it as beautiful. Taken together, the theory is this: when I judge something as beautiful, I enjoy the object without having any desires with respect to it, I believe that everyone should judge the object to be beautiful, I represent some kind of purposiveness in it, but without applying any concepts that would determine its specific purpose, and I also represent myself as being obligated to judge it to be beautiful. Judgments of beauty are thus quite peculiar. On the one hand, when we say an object is beautiful, it is not the same sort of predication as when I say something is green, is a horse, or fits in a breadbox. Yet it is not for that reason a purely subjective, personal judgment because of the necessity and intersubjective universality involved in such judgments.

A further remark is in order regarding the “form of purposiveness” in judgments of taste. Kant wants to emphasize that no determinate concepts are involved in judgments of taste, but that the “reflective” power of judgment (that is, judgment’s ability to seek to find a suitable concept to fit an object) is nevertheless very active during such judgments. When I encounter an unfamiliar object, my reflective judgment is set in motion and seeks a concept until I figure out what sort of thing the object is. When I encounter a beautiful object, the form of purposiveness in the object also sets my reflecting judgment in motion, but no determinate concept is ever found for the object. Although this might be expected to lead to frustration, Kant instead claims that it provokes a “free play” (5:217) between the imagination and understanding. Kant does not say as much about this “free play” as one would like, but the idea seems to be that since the experience is not constrained by a determinate concept that must be applied to the object, the imagination and understanding are free to give in to a lively interplay of thought and emotion in response to the object. The experience of this free play of the faculties is the part of the aesthetic experience that we take to be enjoyable.

Aside from judgments of taste, there is another important form of aesthetic experience: the experience of the sublime. According to Kant, the experience of the sublime occurs when we face things (whether natural or manmade) that dwarf the imagination and make us feel tiny and insignificant in comparison. When we face something so large that we cannot come up with a concept to adequately capture its magnitude, we experience a feeling akin to vertigo. A good example of this is the “Deep Field” photographs from the Hubble Telescope. We already have trouble comprehending the enormity of the Milky Way, but when we see an image containing thousands of other galaxies of approximately the same size, the mind cannot even hope to comprehend the immensity of what is depicted. Although this sort of experience can be disconcerting, Kant also says that a disinterested pleasure (similar to the pleasure in the beautiful) is experienced when the ideas of reason pertaining to the totality of the cosmos are brought into play. Although the understanding can have no empirical concept of such an indeterminable magnitude, reason has such an idea (in Kant’s technical sense of “idea”; see 2g above), namely, the idea of the world as an indefinitely large totality. This feeling that reason can subsume and capture even the totality of the immeasurable cosmos leads to the peculiar pleasure of the sublime.

b. Theory of Art

Both natural objects and manmade art can be judged to be beautiful. Kant suggests that natural beauties are purest, but works of art are especially interesting because they result from human genius. The following briefly summarizes Kant’s theory of art and genius.

Although art must be manmade and not natural, Kant holds that art is beautiful insofar as it imitates the beauty of nature. Specifically, a beautiful work of art must display the “form of purposiveness” (described above, 7a) that can be encountered in the natural world. What makes great art truly great, though, is that it is the result of genius in the artist. According to Kant, genius is the innate talent possessed by the exceptional, gifted individual that allows that individual to translate an intangible “aesthetic idea” into a tangible work of art. Aesthetic ideas are the counterparts to the ideas of reason (see 2g above): where ideas of reason are concepts for which no sensible intuition is adequate, aesthetic ideas are representations of the imagination for which no concept is adequate (this is in line with Kant’s claim that beauty is not determinately conceptualizable). When a genius is successful at exhibiting an aesthetic idea in a beautiful work of art, the work will provoke the “free play” of the faculties described above (7a).

Kant divides the arts into three groups: the arts of speech (rhetoric and poetry), pictorial arts (sculpture, architecture, and painting), and the art of the play of sensations (music and “the art of colors”) (5:321ff.). These can, of course, be combined together. For instance opera combines music and poetry into song, and combines this with theatre (which Kant considers a form of painting). Kant deems poetry the greatest of the arts because of its ability to stimulate the imagination and understanding and expand the mind through reflection. Music is the most successful if judged in terms of “charm and movement of the mind” (5:328), because it evokes the affect and feeling of human speech, but without being constrained by the determinate concepts of actual words. However, if the question is which art advances culture the most, Kant thinks that painting is better than music.

One consequence of Kant’s theory of art is that the contemporary notion of “conceptual art” is a contradiction in terms: if there is a specific point or message (a determinate concept) that the artist is trying to get across, then the work cannot provoke the indeterminate free play that is necessary for the experience of the beautiful. At best, such works can be interesting or provocative, but not truly beautiful and hence not truly art.

c. Relation to Moral Theory

A final important aspect of Kant’s aesthetic theory is his claim that beauty is a “symbol” of morality (5:351ff.), and aesthetic judgment thereby functions as a sort of “propaedeutic” for moral cognition. This is because certain aspects of judgments of taste (see 7a above) are analogous in important respects to moral judgments. The immediacy and disinterestedness of aesthetic appreciation corresponds to the demand that moral virtue be praised even when it does not lead to tangibly beneficial consequences: it is good in itself. The free play of the faculties involved in appreciation of the beautiful reminds one of the freedom necessary for and presupposed by morality. And the universality and necessity involved in aesthetic judgments correspond to the universality and necessity of the moral law. In short, Kant holds that a cultivated sensitivity to aesthetic pleasures helps prepare the mind for moral cognition. Aesthetic appreciation makes one sensitive to the fact that there are pleasures beyond the merely agreeable just as there are goods beyond the merely instrumental.

8. Pragmatic Anthropology

Together with a course on “physical geography” (a study of the world), Kant taught a class on “pragmatic anthropology” almost every year of his career as a university teacher. Towards the end of his career, Kant allowed his collected lecture notes for his anthropology course to be edited and published as Anthropology from a Pragmatic Point of View (1789). Anthropology, for Kant, is simply the study of human nature. Pragmatic anthropology is useful, practical knowledge that students would need in order to successfully navigate the world and get through life.

The Anthropology is interesting in two very different ways. First, Kant presents detailed discussions of his views on issues related to empirical psychology, moral psychology, and aesthetic taste that fill out and give substance to the highly abstract presentations of his writings in pure theoretical philosophy. For instance, although in the theory of experience from Critique of Pure Reason Kant argues that we need sensory intuitions in order to have empirical cognition of the world, he does not explain in any detail how our specific senses—sight, hearing, touch, taste, smell—contribute to this cognition. The Anthropology fills in a lot of this story. For instance, we learn that sight and hearing are necessary for us to represent objects as public and intersubjectively available. And we learn that touch is necessary for us to represent objects as solid, and hence as substantial. With respect to his moral theory, many of Kant’s ethical writings can give the impression that emotions and sentiments can only work against morality, and that only pure reason can incline one towards the good. In the Anthropology Kant complicates this story, informing us that nature has implanted sentiments of compassion to incline us towards the good, even in the absence of a developed reason. Once reason has been developed, it can promote an “enthusiasm of good resolution” (7:254) through attention to concrete instances of virtuous action, in which case desire can work in cooperation with reason’s moral law, not against it. Kant also supplements his moral theory through pedagogical advice about how to cultivate an inclination towards moral behavior.

The other aspect of the Anthropology (and the student transcripts of his actual lectures) that makes it so interesting is that the wealth and range of examples and discussions gives a much fuller picture of Kant the person than we can get from his more technical writings. The many examples present a picture of a man with wide-ranging opinions on all aspects of the human experience. There are discussions of dreams, humor, boredom, personality-types, facial expressions, pride and greed, gender and race issues, and more. We even get some fashion advice: it is acceptable to wear yellow under a blue coat, but gaudy to wear blue under a yellow coat. There has been a great deal of renewed interest in Kant’s anthropological writings and many commentators have been appealing to these often neglected texts as a helpful resource that provides contextualization of Kant’s more widely studied theoretical output.

9. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Literature

The best scholarly, English translations of Kant’s work are published by Cambridge University Press as the Cambridge Editions of the Works of Immanuel Kant. The following are from that collection and contain some of Kant’s most important and influential writings.

Critique of Pure Reason, trans. Paul Guyer and Allen Wood. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
Practical Philosophy, ed. Mary Gregor. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996. (Contains most of Kant’s ethical writings, including Groundwork for the Metaphysics of Morals, Critique of Practical Reason, and Metaphysics of Morals.)
Critique of the Power of Judgment, trans. Paul Guyer and Eric Matthews. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2000.
Theoretical Philosophy 1755-1770, ed. David Walford. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2002. (Contains most of Kant’s “pre-critical” writings in theoretical philosophy.)
Theoretical Philosophy after 1781, eds. Henry Allison and Peter Heath. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2002 (Contains Kant’s mature writings in theoretical philosophy, including Prolegomena to Any Future Metaphysics and Metaphysical Foundations of Natural Science.)
History, Anthropology, and Education, eds. Günter Zöller and Robert Louden. . Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007. (Contains, among other writings, Anthropology from a Pragmatic Point of View.)

b. Secondary Literature

Ernst Cassirer (Kant’s Life and Thought, tr. by James Haden. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1983 (originally written in 1916)) and Manfred Kuehn (Kant: A Biography. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2002) both offer intellectual biographies that situate the development of Kant’s thought within the context of his life and times.
For comprehensive discussions of the metaphysics and epistemology of Critique of Pure Reason, see Paul Guyer (Kant and the Claims of Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1987), Henry Allison (Kant’s Transcendental Idealism: An Interpretation and Defense, Second Edition. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2004), and Graham Bird (The Revolutionary Kant: A Commentary on the Critique of Pure Reason. Chicago: Open Court Press, 2006).
For treatments of Kant’s ethical theory, see Allen Wood (Kant’s Ethical Thought. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999), Christine Korsgaard (Creating the Kingdom of Ends. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996), and Onora O’Neill (Constructions of Reason: Explorations of Kant’s Practical Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1990).
For analyses of Kant’s aesthetic theory (as well as other issues from the Third Critique), see Rachel Zuckert (Kant on Beauty and Biology: An Interpretation of the ‘Critique of Judgment’. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010), Paul Guyer (Kant and the Claims of Taste. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997), and Henry Allison (Kant’s Theory of Taste: A Reading of the Critique of Aesthetic Judgment. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001).
For studies of Kant’s anthropology and theory of human nature, see Patrick Frierson (What is the Human Being? London: Routledge, 2013) and Alix Cohen (Kant and the Human Sciences: Biology, Anthropology and History. London: Palgrave Macmillan, 2009).

Author Information

Tim Jankowiak
Email: timjankowiak@gmail.com
Towson University
U. S. A.

The Meaning of Life: Early Continental and Analytic Perspectives

The question of the meaning of life is one that interests philosophers and non-philosophers alike. The question itself is notoriously ambiguous and possibly vague. In asking about the meaning of life, one may be asking about the essence of life, about life’s purpose, about whether and how anything matters, or a host of other things.

Not everyone is plagued by questions about life’s meaning, but some are. The circumstances in which one does ask about life’s meaning include those in which: one is well off but bothered by either a sense of dissatisfaction or the prospect of bad things to come; one is young at heart and has a sense of wonder; one is perplexed by the discordant plurality of things and wants to find some unity in all the diversity; or one has lost faith in old values and narratives and wants to know how to live in order to have a meaningful life.

We may read our ancestors in such a way that warrants the claim that the meaning of life has been a human concern from the beginning. But it was only early in the nineteenth century that writers began to write directly about “the meaning of life.” The most significant writers were: Schopenhauer, Kierkegaard, Nietzsche, and Tolstoy. Schopenhauer ended up saying that the meaning of life is to deny it; Kierkegaard, that the meaning of life is to obey God passionately; Nietzsche, that the meaning of life is the will to power; and Tolstoy, that the meaning of life lies in a kind of irrational knowledge called “faith.”

In the twentieth century, in the Continental tradition, Heidegger held that the meaning of life is to live authentically or (alternatively) to be a guardian of the earth. Sartre espoused the view that life is meaningless but urged us nonetheless to make a free choice that would give our lives meaning and responsibility. Camus also thought that life is absurd and meaningless. The best way to cope with this fact, he held, is to live life with passion, using everything up, and with an attitude of revolt, defiance, or scorn.

In the Anglo-American tradition, William James held that life is meaningful and worth living because of a spiritual order in which we should believe, or else that it is meaningful when there is a marriage of ideals with pluck, will, and the manly virtues; Bertrand Russell argued that to live a meaningful life one must abandon private and petty interests and instead cultivate an interest in the eternal; Moritz Schlick argued that the meaning of life is to be found in play; and A. J. Ayer asserted that the question of the meaning of life is itself meaningless.

All of these set the table for a veritable feast of philosophical writing on the meaning of life that began in the 1950s with Kurt Baier’s essay “The Meaning of Life,” followed in 1970 by Richard Taylor’s influential essay on the same topic, followed shortly by Thomas Nagel’s important 1971 essay on “The Absurd.” See “Meaning of Life: The Analytic Perspective” for more on the course of the debate in analytic philosophy about the meaning of life.

Background
Nineteenth Century Philosophers
Early Twentieth Century Continental Philosophers
1. Heidegger
2. Sartre
3. Camus
Early Twentieth Century Analytic, American, and English-Language Philosophers
1. James
2. Russell
3. Schlick
4. Tagore
5. Ayer
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Background

a. The Origin of the English Expression “the Meaning of Life”

The English term “meaning” dates back to the fourteenth century C.E. Its origins, according to the Oxford English Dictionary (OED), lie in the Middle English word “meenyng” (also spelled “menaynge,” “meneyng,” and “mennyng”).

In its earliest occurrences, in English original compositions as well as in English translations of earlier works, meaning is most often what, on the one hand, sentences, utterances, and stories, and, on the other hand, dreams, visions, signs, omens, and rituals have or might have. One asks about the meaning of some puzzling utterance, or of the writing on the wall, or of the vision that appeared to somebody in the night, or of the ritual performed on a hallowed occasion. Meaning is often conceived of as something non-obvious and somewhat secretive, discernible only by a seer granted with special powers.

It is much later that life is spoken of as something that might, or might not, have meaning in this sense. Such speech would have to wait upon the development of the concept of life as something like a word, a linguistic utterance, a narrative, a story, a gesture, a puzzling episode, a sign, a dream, a vision, or a surface phenomenon that points to some deep inner essence, to which it would be proper to inquire into its meaning, or to apply epithets like “meaningful” or “meaningless.” One of the earliest instances of the occurrence of the concept “life” as such a thing, as signifying something that might or might not have something like meaning, appears in Shakespeare’s Macbeth (c. 1605), where Macbeth characterizes life as “a tale told by an idiot, full of sound and fury, signifying nothing.” But notice that even here the words “meaning” and “life” are not linked.

The OED‘s definition of “meaning” in something like our sense is “The significance, purpose, underlying truth, etc., of something.” Further elaboration of early uses of the word gives us, “That which is indicated or expressed by a (supposed) symbol or symbolic action; spec. a message, warning, idea, etc., supposed to be symbolized by a dream, vision, omen, etc.” A bit later, in one of its senses, meaning takes on the sense in which it is the “signification; intention; cause, purpose; motive, justification,” . . . “[o]f an action, condition, etc.” Finally we get the sense that most nearly concerns us here: “Something which gives one a sense of purpose, value, etc., esp. of a metaphysical or spiritual kind; the (perceived) purpose of existence or of a person’s life. Freq. in the meaning of life.” (All this is from the OED.)

The first English use of the expression “the meaning of life” appeared in 1834 in Thomas Carlyle’s (1795-1881) Sartor Resartus II. ix, where Teufelsdrockh observes, “our Life is compassed round with Necessity; yet is the meaning of Life itself no other than Freedom.” The usage shortly caught on, and over the next century and a half the phrase “the meaning of life” became common. The adjective “meaningful” did not appear until 1852, the noun “meaningfulness” until 1904.

b. Questions about the Meaning of Life

The most familiar form of the question(s) about the meaning of life is simply, “What is the meaning of life?” Although the form of the question is one, when it is asked, any one (or more) of several different senses may be intended. Here are some of the more common of them.

(1) In some cases, what the seeker seeks is the kernel, the inner reality, the core, or the essence, underlying some phenomenon. Thus one might ask what his essence, his true self is, and then feel that he has found the meaning of his life if he discovers that true self.

(2) In other cases, the question is about the point, aim, object, purpose, end, or goal of life, typically one’s own. Here, in some cases, the question is about some pre-existing purpose that the questioner might (or might not) discover; in other cases, the question might be about some end or purpose the agent might invent or create and give her life. The latter questioner, when she is successful, may believe that her life has a meaning because she herself has given it one.

(3) In yet other cases, the question of the meaning of life is that of whether our lives, and anything we do within them, matter, or have any sort of importance. If one can show that they matter, and in virtue of what they do, one will have provided a substantive answer to the question of the meaning of life. A common, but not universal, assumption on this score is that our lives have significance and importance only if they issue in some lasting achievement the ravages of time will not destroy.

(4) In still other cases, what bothers the questioner is the discord, plurality, and chaotic nature of his apparent empirical life as it is actually lived. He can make no sense of it; there is no rhyme or reason to it. The drive here, one might well think, is to see one’s life as intelligible, as something that makes sense. The discovery or invention of some kind of unity in his life would amount to an answer to his question, “What is the meaning of life?”

(5) Yet another thing the question about the meaning of life can be is a request for a narrative or picture, a way of seeing life (perhaps a metaphorical one) that enables one to make sense of it and achieve a sense of meaning while living it. And so we get “Life is a bowl of cherries” and various and sundry religious narratives.

(6) Sometimes what the questioner is really wondering is whether it makes sense to go on and his question is “Is life worth living?” He may actually be contemplating suicide. His predicament has to do with meaning if he is assuming that it makes sense to continue living only if (his) life has a suitable meaning, something which, at the moment, he can’t see it as having.

(7) Finally, the question of the meaning of life can be the question of how one should live in order to have a meaningful life, or, if such a life is impossible, then what the best way to live meaninglessly is.

The seven questions just distinguished may be, but need not be, discrete and self-contained. A given seeker may very well be interested in several of them at once and see them as intimately connected. For example, a person may be interested in his core or essence because he thinks that knowledge of that may reveal the goal or purpose of his life, a purpose that makes his life seem important and intelligible, and gives him a reason for going on, as well as insight into how he must live in order to have a meaningful life. It is commonly the case that several of the questions press themselves on the seeker all at the same time.

One or more of these questions were of concern to the philosophers discussed below. Some were concerned with nearly all of them. Distinct from all the above are second-order, analytic, conceptual questions of the sort that dominate current philosophical discussion of the issue in analytic circles. These questions are not so much about the meaning of life as about the meaning of “the meaning of life” and its component concepts (“meaning,” “life”), or related ones (“meaningfulness,” “meaninglessness,” “vanity,” “absurdity,” and so forth).

c. The Broader Historical Background

Although nineteenth century thinkers were the first in the West to put the question precisely in the form “What is the meaning of life?” concern with questions in what may be called “the meaning-of-life family,” that is, ultimate questions about life, the world, existence, and its purpose may be found, in the East and the West alike, almost as far back as we can trace human thought about anything. Thus Gilgamesh (c. 2000 B.C.E.) asked why he must die; the composers of The Rig Veda (c. 1200 B.C.E.) wondered where everything came from; Job (c. 500 B.C.E.) asked why he must suffer; the ancient Taoists (Laozi c. 500 B.C.E. and Zhuangzi c. 300 B.C.E.) asked what the origin or principle of everything is, and how one must live to be in accord with it; ancient Upanishadic seekers (500-300 B.C.E.) were much vexed with the nature of the true self and its end or goal; the Buddha (c. 500 B.C.E.), before he became the Buddha, sought an understanding of life that would enable one to overcome suffering; the author of The Bhagavad Gita (c. 200 B.C.E.) was concerned, as other Indian thinkers tended to be, with the identity and nature of the true self, and also with the question of how to live; the ancient Greeks of the classical period (c. 430-320 B.C.E.) talked about the goal or end of life and how to reach it; Epicurus (341-270 B.C.E.) followed suit and developed his own unique take on these matters; Qoheleth, the author of Ecclesiastes (c. 200 B.C.E.), was struck by the vanity or futility of everything and wondered how to deal with it; Greek and Roman Hellenistic philosophers (c. 300 B.C.E. – 250 C.E.)—Epicurean, Stoic, Cynic, Skeptic, and Neo-Platonist—wondered about the good and how to achieve it; Marcus Aurelius (121-180 C.E.) mused on his cosmic insignificance.

The Christian-dominated medieval period did not produce thinkers who asked in any radical way about the meaning of life, because everyone already had a perfectly good answer, the one provided by the Christian story. Still, even in medieval times, there was room for at least three questions in the meaning-of-life family. First, there was occasion for the questions when things ran counter to the Christian story, or to what one expected. Thus Boethius (480-525) was perplexed by the deep questions when, after a life of honor, piety, and power, he fell into disgrace, had everything stripped from him unaccountably and unjustly, and found himself faced with imprisonment that lead eventually to his execution. Second, though the great Christian philosopher-theologians thought they knew the meaning of life in outline, they still asked and answered questions about the details of the final or highest good of man. Thomas Aquinas (1224-1274), for example, who accepted with unblinking assurance the general answer supplied by Christianity, found himself wondering about the exact nature of the summum bonum (the highest good) and about how to square the Christian view of it with that of Aristotle. Third, other Christian believers, medieval ones as well as present-day ones with medieval outlooks, committed to an overall view of what is going on, may be vexed by the question of what God intends for them specifically and may worry about their “calling,” the particular purpose, role, or plan God has especially for them. Hence we find confirmed believers worried deeply about the question, “What is the meaning of my life?”

In any event, since the early modern period, there has been a resurgence of interest in fundamental meaning-of-life questions. Writers as diverse as Shakespeare (1564-1616), Pascal (1623-1662), Dr. Johnson (1709-84), Kant (1724-1804), and Hegel (1770-1831) have asked, in different forms, questions about life’s ultimate point, goal, or purpose, and they are just a few of the many religious, philosophical, and literary figures who have raised and (sometimes) answered ultimate questions in the meaning-of-life family prior to Schopenhauer’s work early in the nineteenth century. There have been philosophers too since Schopenhauer’s time who have addressed the big questions, but not explicitly in terms of “the meaning of life.” This article will confine itself largely to those philosophers who have explicitly put their concerns in those terms.

The standard explanation of the rise of questions about life’s meaning in the early modern period points to three or four distinct but related things: (1) the scientific revolution; (2) the Protestant Reformation; (3) voyages and travels of exploration and discovery, in which were encountered peoples with very different outlooks on the nature of the universe and the meaning of life; and (4), as a result of all of these, the evaporation of a widely held, firmly believed Christian conception of the nature of things.

2. Nineteenth Century Philosophers

Let us turn now to the story of what philosophers from Schopenhauer in the early 1800s to Ayer and Camus in the 1940s have had to say about the meaning of life.

a. Schopenhauer

The first Western philosopher to link the ideas of life and meaning, and to ask expressly “What is the meaning of life?” was the great German pessimist Arthur Schopenhauer (1788-1860). At least he was the first to ask the question and get it noticed by other philosophers. Schopenhauer, a contemporary of Carlyle, wrote in German, in which “the meaning of life” is “der Sinn des Lebens.” Profoundly influencing the thought of both Nietzsche and Tolstoy, Schopenhauer’s work may be regarded as the springboard that launched modern Western philosophical inquiry into the problem of the meaning of life. Here is the passage in which Schopenhauer explicitly asked the question:

Since a man does not alter, and his moral character remains absolutely the same all through his life; since he must play out the part which he has received, without the least deviation from the character; since neither experience, nor philosophy, nor religion can effect any improvement in him, the question arises, What is the meaning of life at all? (1860b) [emphasis added]

The circumstances under which concern with the problem of the meaning of life were, in Schopenhauer’s case, not merely academic but real and personal. Well off financially, but struggling with personal misery and a sense of loneliness and isolation, he felt driven to find some understanding of himself and of the world around him that seemed so bleak and senseless.

Schopenhauer’s philosophy begins with a metaphysical structure he inherited from Kant and more or less simply decrees. There is a difference between the thing-in-itself and the phenomenal world of appearances. The thing-in-itself is the will to live, or, more simply, the will. It is the fundamental power and reality that underlies all things. The world we know and live in, with its stupendous abundance of things and forms, is merely the phenomena of the will, the objectification of it, its mirror, something not entirely real, or not real at all. (There is also a pure, will-less subject of knowledge whose metaphysical status is unclear: sometimes it seems to be in the very realm of the will, the realm of true reality, of things-in-themselves; at other times it seems to be something like the first creation and objectification of the will.)

The will itself just wills. It is pretty nasty, perhaps demonic. It is a blind striving, craving, and grasping, aiming at nothing in the end, except to go on willing and aggrandizing itself. It has in itself an inner contradiction, manifest in the constant struggle and strife between the billions of individual objectifications of itself in the phenomenal world. I am one such objectification; you are another. My true self, my inner essence, is the will; the same is true of you: my essence and yours are one and the same. When we fight (as we usually do), the will is engaged in a battle with itself.

The phenomenal world is an awful place. It is full of misery, pain, suffering. Little happiness is found anywhere. The twin poles of human life are pain (want, desire, stress) and boredom. Almost everyone lives a life that, from without, is meaningless and insignificant and, from within, dull and senseless.

But what is the meaning of life? The question is appropriate because life as we know it is something like Macbeth’s tale told by an idiot, a “farce.” If the question is about life’s inner essence, Schopenhauer’s answer is simply “the will-to-live.” The meaning of life is the will.

Another way of taking the question “What is the meaning of life?” is to construe it as a question about the goal, point, aim, end, or purpose of life. When Schopenhauer explicitly asks the question (in On Human Nature), it is this sense of it he appears to have in mind. His answer is depressing. The point or purpose of life is to suffer. We are being punished for the crime of being born, punished for who we are, namely, the nasty thoroughly egoistic will. The meaning of life in this sense, then, is to suffer, to be punished for our sin.

Schopenhauer suggests a number of ways of thinking about our phenomenal, experienced life. All of them are pretty bleak. He recommends that we look upon our life: as an unprofitable episode interrupting the blessed calm of nothingness; as on the whole a disappointment, nay, a cheat; as Hell, in which on the one hand men are the tormented souls and on the other the tormenting devils; as a place of atonement, a sort of penal colony; as some kind of mistake; and as a process of disillusionment. Any or all of these could be taken as answers to the question “What is the meaning of life?” (or to the question “What is life?”)

If we ask what we should do, how we can give our lives worth and meaning, Schopenhauer does have an answer. “Salvation” lies in the total denial of the will. Knowledge of the will and its horrific phenomena can and should function as a quieter of the will, bringing it to a state in which it stops willing and effectively abolishes itself. Thinking in this vein, a Schopenhauerian might say that the meaning of life is to deny, quiet, and eventually abolish the will to live that is essentially oneself.

One naturally wants to know whether this is not just suicide—whether the cessation of willing simply means that one passes into a state of nothingness. Schopenhauer’s answer is “No.” The state of the will-less individual after death seems to be nothing to us; but our present state would seem to be nothing to him. His state is wonderful and blessed, but what it is like is inconceivable to us.

In our current state, when one denies the will in herself, she does not literally commit suicide. Suicide doesn’t work because it is itself a powerful act of willing. Instead, she practices self-denial and asceticism, cultivates detachment, stops wanting and pursuing the things most people go for; and although there is still some struggle with the dying will in her, on the whole her life becomes full of peace and joy. The will is quieted and eventually abolishes itself in the individual. Very few people are capable of doing this heroic thing, Schopenhauer says, but he himself does not claim to be one of these people.

For all the darkness of his philosophy, the moral for all of us—even those of us who are not prepared to totally deny the will—which Schopenhauer derives in the end is very much in the Christian/Buddhist vein. We should not be competitive or grasping or villainous, but rather we should show compassion and kindness to everyone, since everyone is always having a bad day in this hell we are all living in, and what we all need above all are love, compassion, help, and consideration. The fundamental principle of morality, which you should follow, is: Don’t hurt anyone; help everyone you can. Following this principle, one can achieve, short of complete denial of the will, a kind of half-way salvation.

Another of Schopenhauer’s points about meaning in life should be mentioned. It is that the meaningfulness of one’s life depends not on one’s outer circumstances but rather on the way one looks at life. People look at life differently, and so the meaningfulness of her life varies considerably from person to person. To one person life is barren, dull, and superficial; to another rich, interesting, and full of meaning.

b. Kierkegaard

A major nineteenth century European philosopher who continued the tradition of thought on the meaning of life was the Danish philosopher Soren Kierkegaard (1813-1855). Kierkegaard was not an academic. The sources of his interest in problems of meaning seem to have been his not having to work for a living, his personal demons, his Nordic gloom, his congenital tendencies toward guilt, depression, anxiety, and dread, his awareness of increasing doubt all around him of the teachings of his inherited Christianity, and his agonizing failure to live up to his own Christian ideals, primarily because of his embodiment and its concomitant proclivity for the things of the flesh, especially sensuousness and sex. Out of all that emerged what appears to be a severe case of self-loathing, which in turn prompted serious inquiry into the meaning of (his) life.

It is difficult to determine what Kierkegaard’s own views were on just about everything because he constantly used humor, satire, paradox, and irony, and even more because he spoke in different voices and wrote from different perspectives under different pseudonyms.

Nonetheless, the standard view is that Kierkegaard was fundamentally a Christian. He claimed that one’s life can be meaningful and worth living only if one believes genuinely and passionately in the Christian God.

And then there is the leap. Christian belief goes beyond rational evidence, and even conflicts with it. One must make a leap from knowledge to Christian faith—the only thing in which one can find true meaning—a leap over the confines of common sense and reason. One is to accept Christian faith even if (or just because?) it is absurd. For it is the only adequate source of the kind of meaning a human being has to have to keep on going with a sense that life is worthwhile.

Another way to describe Kierkegaard’s overall philosophy is to characterize it in terms of his three stages or levels of life. One should make an ascent from the lowest stage, the aesthetic (sensuous, even sensual), through the higher ethical stage, and on to the highest stage of all, the religious, which somehow baptizes and incorporates the two lower stages into itself. Only one who has reached the religious stage can have a truly meaningful life and thus a life worth living.

Whatever Kierkegaard’s own view was, we can make the following observations about things Kierkegaard (or one or other of his pseudonymous authors) said about the meaning of life.

(1) One thing is that life can seem meaningless. In the early work, Either/Or (1843), we find this passage: “How empty and meaningless life is.” Elsewhere in Either/Or we get similar thoughts and questions, for instance, “What, if anything, is the meaning of this life?” and “My life is utterly meaningless.” Perhaps, though, the idea is that, though life is often meaningless, it need not be so, and, when it is, it is because of some kind of failure of the liver (of the life, not the organ).

(2) A second interesting idea in Kierkegaard is that meaning has something to do with unity. In a meaningful life all the diverse aspects of it come together to form some kind of coherent whole. One pursues some one goal, to which everything in one’s life is subordinated.

(3) A third point, an important one, is that, though meaning is a good thing, it is possible for there to be too much meaning in one’s life, or in its parts. Kierkegaard observes:

No part of life ought to have so much meaning for a person that he cannot forget it any moment he wants to; on the other hand, every single part of life ought to have so much meaning for a person that he can remember it at any moment. (Either/Or)

To have one’s life full of meaning to the brim, to regard life and everything one does in it as infinitely significant, brings with it so much pressure and stress that one’s life becomes unbearable.

To me [says Kierkegaard] it seems . . . that to be known in time by God makes life enormously strenuous. Everywhere where he is present each half hour is of infinite importance. Yet to live like that for sixty years is unsupportable. It is difficult enough putting up even with the three years’ hard study for an examination, and those are still not as strenuous as half an hour like this. (Concluding Unscientific Postscript)

(4) A fourth idea about meaning in Kierkegaard is the idea that one can give one’s life meaning, or that one can acquire meaning in life, by doing something like devoting oneself to something. Of Antigone he says, “her life acquires meaning for her in its devotion to showing him [her father, after his death] the last honors daily, almost hourly, by her unbroken silence.” (Either/Or)

(5) Meaning does not come from abstract, objective knowledge of any kind, whether philosophical, or scientific, or historical, or even theological. It comes from some kind of faith, a faith that is passionately acquired and lived daily.

(6) One twentieth century approach to the problem of the meaning of life is to see, accept, and bask more or less happily in the absurdity of life. Kierkegaard anticipated this approach prophetically in his characterization of the “humorist.” Kierkegaard writes: “Weary of time and its endless succession, the humorist runs away and finds humorous relief in stating the absurd.” (Concluding Unscientific Postscript)

(7) Kierkegaard’s humorist also at one point expresses a view which is surprisingly rare, namely, the view that one’s life may have a meaning, but one doesn’t know what it is. Kierkegaard writes: “[L]et a humorist say what he has in mind and he will speak, for example, as follows: What is the meaning of life? Yes, good question. How should I know?” (Concluding Unscientific Postscript)

(8) Although Kierkegaard himself was a Christian who viewed meaning as ultimately grounded in religious faith, in one’s personal relation to a supernatural God, yet, paradoxically perhaps, and certainly in an admirable spirit of non-exclusivity, he said:

It is possible both to enjoy life and to give it meaning and substance outside Christianity, just as the most famous poets and artists, the most eminent of thinkers, even men of piety, have lived outside Christianity (Concluding Unscientific Postscript).

(9) One finds in Kierkegaard the idea that life has meaning only insofar as it is related in some way to the Infinite. Nothing finite can supply the meaning of life.

On the whole, if for no other reason, Kierkegaard’s work is valuable because of its suggestiveness. Under one pseudonym or another, Kierkegaard made many important points which were taken up, or unfortunately overlooked, by subsequent philosophers concerned with the meaning of life.

c. Nietzsche

Friedrich Nietzsche (1844-1900) cut his philosophical teeth on Schopenhauer and devoted himself in his later works—from 1883 up to the onset of insanity in January 1889—to struggle with, among other things, the meaning of life.

Nietzsche’s grand project was the revaluation of all values. Part of this project was that of giving to life a new meaning. Nietzsche’s interest in the matter was not merely academic. Coming up with new values and giving life a new meaning was a project that involved a total transformation of Nietzsche’s own self, early versions of which he became dissatisfied with. One thing Nietzsche wanted to do was to produce an affirmative philosophy of life to replace Schopenhauer’s pessimistic, life-denying philosophy.

Nietzsche rejected Schopenhauer’s picture of life as suffering, or punishment for one’s sin, together with its ethic of compassion toward the poor and the sick. Such a picture belonged to a weak, sick, decadent, nay-saying mode of being in decline. Nietzsche himself wanted to produce a positive, healthy, life-affirming philosophy, one suitable for life in the ascendant.

Sometimes, particularly early in his writings, Nietzsche seemed to think some end or other is required to make things meaningful. At times, both early and late, Nietzsche spoke as though the very concept of the meaning of something is the concept of its end, object, or goal.

In other places, however, Nietzsche spoke as if the meaning of life lies in freedom from, not in the achievement of, ends. Perhaps this should be construed as the rejection of given ends to be discovered, not in the rejection of all ends, particularly those one creates. Moritz Schlick—whose thought we will consider in more detail later—claimed that Nietzsche saw that life has no meaning so long as it stands wholly under the domination of purposes. In Nietzsche’s Zarathustra, “Sir Hazard,” expressing Nietzsche’s own considered view, says, “I have saved them from the slavery of ends.” (Klemke, 3^rd ed., 63).

Nietzsche sometimes spoke as if life, before he came into it, or before he revaluated all values, had no meaning: “Sombre is human life, and as yet without meaning: a buffoon may be fateful to it” (Thus Spake Zarathustra, 1883). There is no meaning “out there” to be discovered, no meaning in the essences of things, apart from human will, desire, perspective. In fact, apart from perspective, there is no world out there at all, no “thing-in-itself,” no “facts-in-themselves.” But a psychologically strong person can do without things in themselves and meaning (already there) to be discovered in them. That is because he can organize a small part of the world himself and thus create meaning. In The Will to Power, Nietzsche speaks of “the creative strength to create meaning,” and he says:

It is a measure of the degree of strength of will to what extent one can do without meaning in things, to what extent one can endure to live in a meaningless world because one organizes a small portion of it oneself. (The Will to Power)

Whatever the meaning of life is, or is to be, it is terrestrial, not celestial. Meaning must not be placed in some fabricated “true world” but in this very earth in which we live and have our being. And the meaning of life is to be created, not discovered.

Still, somehow, man is not the meaning and measure of all things, though he has posited himself as such.

All the values by means of which we have tried so far to render the world estimable for ourselves and which then proved inapplicable and therefore devaluated the world—all these values are, psychologically considered, the results of certain perspectives of utility, designed to maintain and increase human constructs of domination—and they have been falsely projected into the essence of things. What we find here is still the hyperbolic naiveté of man: positing himself as the meaning and measure of the value of things. (The Will to Power)

The mistake lies in projecting our own values onto reality, in thinking that our meaning and values are present in things as such. But our meaning does not lie in “things-in-themselves.” It is created by us. If we then give things out there such and such a meaning, we should recognize that it is not a meaning we have found in the things themselves, but rather one that we have given them.

We can still ask, What is the meaning of life? What is the meaning we shall give to life? Nietzsche gives two different answers. One is that the meaning of life is the Übermensch (sometimes translated as ‘Superman’), Nietzsche’s post-human creator of meaning, affirmer of life, and bearer of values.

I want to teach men the sense of their existence, which is the Superman, the lightning out of the dark cloud—man. (Thus Spake Zarathustra)

The Superman is the meaning of the earth. Let your will say: The Superman SHALL BE the meaning of the earth! (Thus Spake Zarathustra)

The other answer is that the meaning of life is the will to power.

All meaning is will to power. (The Will to Power)

On the surface these two answers are different. But perhaps they are consistent. Perhaps what the will to power generates is the Superman, or what the Superman represents is the will to power. Again, perhaps the will to power is the meaning of life in the sense of its kernel or essence, while the Superman is its meaning in the sense of its end or goal.

Nietzsche’s view has some aspects or consequences that should be noted. One consequence of Nietzsche’s view is that the meaning of life is absent in the old and the sick. He acknowledged the fact. Another consequence (or perhaps component) of Nietzsche’s view is that nihilism, the denial of all value, is a transitional stage, not the finale. Yet another consequence is that the meaning of life is not about the predominance of pleasure over pain. Concern with that evidences only nihilism. Finally, it may be conjectured that Nietzsche would probably regard with scorn those of us in the current debate among academic philosophers about the meaning of life. He would consider us “minute” philosophers:

The study of the minute philosophers is only interesting for the recognition that they have reached those stages in the great edifice of philosophy where learned disquisitions for and against, where hair-splitting objections and counter-objections are the rule: and for that reason they evade the demand of every great philosophy to speak sub specie aeternitatis. (Nietzsche, 1874)

d. Tolstoy

One of the next thinkers in the Western intellectual tradition to ask seriously the question, “What is the meaning of life?” was the great Russian novelist and moralist Count Leo Tolstoy (1828-1910). He asked the question and offered part of an answer in A Confession, written in Russian in 1879, circulated in 1882, and translated and published in 1884. Tolstoy’s reflections on the question stimulated a great deal of subsequent debate on the issue.

Although characters in his earlier works, such as War and Peace, sometimes talked about the meaning of life and felt the problem deeply, Tolstoy himself raised serious questions about it only as part of a psychological crisis he underwent in the mid to late 1870s. Despite having everything anyone could ever want—wealth, fame, status, love, physical strength, and so forth—Tolstoy found himself severely disturbed. His symptoms were depression, psychological paralysis, obsession with suicide, and the continual recurrence in his head of the question of the meaning of life.

Tolstoy put his question about the meaning of life in several different ways. Here are some of them, listed in order of their occurrence in his Confession:

What is it for? What does it lead to? Why? What then? What for? But what does it matter to me? What of it? Why go on making any effort? How go on living? What will come of what I am doing today or shall do tomorrow? What will come of my whole life? Why should I live, why wish for anything, or do anything? Is there any meaning in my life that the inevitable death awaiting me does not destroy? What am I, with my desires? Why do I live? What must I do? What is the meaning of my life? Why do I exist?

Several of these seem to be quite different questions, but Tolstoy regarded them all as the same question put in different ways.

Tolstoy said explicitly that his question was not about the composition, origin, and fate of the universe, nor again about the question, “What is the life of the whole?” That question, Tolstoy said, is unanswerable for a single man, and it is “stupidity” to think an individual must first answer the question about the meaning of the universe or the whole of humanity before he can answer the question of the meaning of his own life.

Tolstoy came to think that he should not expect to find the answers to his questions in philosophy. The legitimate task of philosophy is merely to ask the question and perhaps refine and clarify it, not to answer it, which it cannot do.

This view of philosophy as incapable of providing answers to the questions of life must have been one Tolstoy came to some way into his crisis. At another point, apparently earlier, Tolstoy did try to find answers in philosophy (as well as in the mathematical, physical, biological, and social sciences). The philosophers he studied were Socrates, the Buddha, “Solomon” (the author of Ecclesiastes), and Schopenhauer.

All of these he interpreted as providing a negative answer. The gist of Socrates’ thought is that the true philosopher seeks death, because the life of the body, with all its ailments and desires, is an impediment to what he is really all about, namely, the quest for truth. The individual life of the physically discrete individual is pretty meaningless, something one would rather do without. The Buddha, as Tolstoy read him, teaches that life is the greatest of evils and works as hard as he can to free himself from it. “Solomon” teaches that it’s all “vanity.” And Schopenhauer, as Tolstoy understood him, wishes for, and advocates, annihilation.

In a nutshell, Tolstoy’s problem was this: since I will suffer, die, be forgotten, and make no difference (leave no trace) in the long run, how does my life, or anything I do, have any meaning? It was a problem he felt deeply. He had to have an answer to go on living. Tolstoy’s concern with the issue was not merely theoretical.

The solution to the problem that Tolstoy eventually came to was one he thought had been known all along by the unlearned peasants. The solution lies in a kind of irrational knowledge called “faith.” Faith is faith in God, and lived faith involves some kind of relation to the Infinite. Meaning is found in the appropriate relationship to God, the Infinite. Tolstoy’s solution bears obvious resemblances to Kierkegaard’s and is very much in the same spirit.

Tolstoy spent the rest of his life working out the details of, or variations on, this solution. The progress of his thought can be traced in What I Believe and On Life, as well as in his late short fiction (The Death of Ivan Ilych, Father Sergius, and so forth). To the end Tolstoy held that faith in God, work, service to others, unselfishness, and love are essential parts of a meaningful life. He taught that the things ordinarily pursued by many—wealth, status, power, fame—contribute nothing to the meaningfulness of life.

e. Some Common Aspects of the Lives of Schopenhauer, Kierkegaard, Nietzsche, and Tolstoy

Schopenhauer, Kierkegaard, Nietzsche, and Tolstoy all had lives which rendered them virtual breeding grounds for problems with the meaning of life. (1) All of them were well off and did not have to work for a living; there is no evidence that any of them ever felt a real threat of, say, homelessness or starvation. Nietzsche was the one that wasn’t exactly wealthy, but in his case his early retirement (in his late twenties) provided him with a pension for life sufficient to meet his material needs and free him up for a life of thought and writing. (2) All of them suffered from psychological illness of one sort or another—at the very least, a sense of gloom or melancholy, and in some cases a sense of worthlessness and a preoccupation with suicide, or feelings of dread and anxiety, or the encroachment of outright madness. (3) All of them grew up in religious environments, the tenets of which they lost faith in when they reached adulthood, and the lack of which they struggled with throughout their lives (eventually regaining, in the cases of Kierkegaard and Tolstoy, some portion of what they had lost). (4) None of them was a professional academician, except for Nietzsche in his youth.

From these four, and from our own experiences of life, we have inherited, to the extent that we have it, our preoccupation with the meaning of life.

3. Early Twentieth Century Continental Philosophers

In the early twentieth century questions about the meaning of life continued to be of interest to leading European or “Continental” philosophers.

a. Heidegger

The great German philosophy professor Martin Heidegger (1889-1976) was certainly concerned with the meaning of life. He presented two different outlooks, which we may call “early Heidegger” and “later Heidegger.”

For early Heidegger (that is, the Heidegger of Being and Time, 1927), the question of the meaning of life is the question how we can live an “authentic” life, one that is our life, not just the life for us that has been fixed by the community we live in. His answer is that to live a meaningful life is to live a life of authenticity. To live a life authenticity is to live a life that one oneself chooses, not the life that is prescribed for one by one’s social situation. To live a life of authenticity, one must have a plan, something that unifies one’s life into an organic whole. This is one’s own plan. So a meaningful life is one of focused authenticity. “Authenticity is Heidegger’s accounted of what it is to live a meaningful life.”

Living authentically, it turns out, is a matter of living in a way that is true to your heritage. “Being true to heritage is being true to your own, deepest self.” In the end, the content of authenticity is not something you freely choose ex nihilo, but rather something you discover in the conjunction of heritage and facticity.

Early Heidegger’s thought seems to be a kind of pantheism, and it is possible that Heidegger subscribed to some such view all his life.

Later Heidegger proposes a somewhat different view. In this philosophy of his, we are given the task, in which our meaning lies, of being “guardians of the world.” The world is a holy place. To understand and appreciate that fact is to exhibit not just a certain intellectual and practical stance toward the world, but to live with an attitude of respect and reverence toward the world, toward the natural world especially. Later Heidegger saw exploitation of the natural world, as in mining and highway-building, as deplorable, as contrary to the very meaning of life. The meaning of life is guardianship of the world.

b. Sartre

The French philosopher Jean-Paul Sartre (1905-1980) changed his views over the course of his life. In his work Being and Nothingness (1943), advocated an outlook from which life is absurd. We more or less seriously pursue goals which, from a detached standpoint, we can see don’t really matter. But we continue to act as though they do, and hence our lives are absurd. The Sartrean project is to overcome this detached standpoint, or to incorporate it into our lives.

The problem is other people. They insist on their own reality. They tend to get in the way of our pursuit of our own goals.

Later on, Sartre espoused a somewhat different view. On this new view, “our fundamental goal in life is to overcome our ‘contingency’,” to become the foundation of our own being. The main obstacle (again) is other people who, on the one hand, pursue their own (different) goals and, on the other, propose a real (military) threat to one’s way of life and one’s homeland.

In his 1944 play, No Exit, there is the famous line: “Hell is other people.” Other people do not cooperate with my projects, and I do not cooperate with theirs. The result is war, in something like Schopenhauer’s sense. People are always at war, or at least at odds, with each other.

In both his early and his later thought, Sartre ends up being pretty pessimistic and depressing. Life is meaningless. We can, by our free choice, give life some meaning or other. But the decision to do so is itself a matter of ungrounded free choice, which is such that it doesn’t matter whether that decision or some other one is made.

c. Camus

Albert Camus (1913-1960), a Frenchman born in Algeria, was one of the leading existentialists (though he himself disowned the label) and one of the more influential writers of the first half of the twentieth century. He was familiar with the work of Nietzsche, and greatly influenced by it.

On our theme, Camus’s starting point was the perception of the absurd. Human life, he felt, was absurd, meaningless, and senseless. The way in which it is, or the reason it is, lies in an inevitable clash between the needs and aspirations of human beings and the cold, meaningless world.

This clash has at least four facets. First, we seek—demand, even—a rational understanding of things, some way of seeing the world as familiar to us. But the world does not cooperate: to us, it is ultimately unintelligible. Second, we long for some kind of unity underlying and organizing the manifest diversity we find all around us. But again, the world is heedless of our longings. The world that presents itself to our senses is nothing but disjointed plurality. Third, we long for a higher reality (a God, for example), something transcendent, some cosmic meaning of everything. But no such meaning can be discerned. Fourth, we strive for continued life, or at least to achieve something permanent in the end. But our efforts are pointless, everything will come to nothing, and all that lies ahead is death and oblivion.

Our situation is like that of the mythical Greek of old, Sisyphus. We are condemned, as it were, to pushing a rock up a hill, over and over only to see it roll back down again, every time, when it reaches the top. Pointless labor is Sisyphus’ lot, and ours too.

The pointlessness and absurdity of life raise the question of suicide. Should we kill ourselves? Camus’s answer is that, no, we should not. Suicide is escapist. To kill yourself is to give in, to lose. If we were prisoners of war—which is something like what we are—our captor and tormentor would want us to do exactly that—confess that things are too much for us and kill ourselves. That would be his ultimate victory, which would bring him a chuckle, or perhaps even a hearty guffaw.

How then should we live? The first thing to do is to insist that life is better if there is no meaning. That would really irritate our tormentor. Second, we should cultivate a mindset of honesty and lucidity. We should not indulge in denial, or evasion, or imaginings of an eventual escape into an afterlife where everything will be put right. We should acknowledge that life is awful—but then, perhaps, add “and I love it” or “all is well.” Third, we should take up an attitude of revolt, defiance, and scorn. Camus observes, “There is no fate that cannot be surmounted by scorn.” Surely such an attitude would vex our hypothetical tormentor beyond measure. Fourth, we should live for now, stop worrying about the future, stop striving to achieve future goals. Nothing is going to come of anything we do in the long run anyway. Fifth, we should “use everything up”: work hard, play hard, approach everything with zest and passion, expend energy to the human limit. This amounts to a kind of perverse “Yes!” to life. Finally, we may ask why anyone would want to live like this? Is it something that would appeal only to the French? What are the advantages of such an attitude toward life?

Camus has answers to these queries, three in fact. First, living as he recommends is a way of salvaging our dignity, and it is a way to which a certain majesty adheres. Second, surprisingly perhaps, such a way of living brings with it a “curious joy.” Third, it is the way of freedom. Camus’s scornful existentialism is the best conception we have of a truly free human being, one who does not allow himself to be shaped and determined by the mindless, meaningless world that surrounds him.

4. Early Twentieth Century Analytic, American, and English-Language Philosophers

Anglo-American philosophers in the very late eighteenth and early twentieth centuries continued to be interested in problems of the meaning of life as well.

a. James

The American pragmatist philosopher William James (1842-1910), a Harvard professor, wrote a couple of interesting essays on our theme in the late 1890s. Both essays were written as addresses to be delivered to live audiences. They demand some discussion and consideration.

In “Is Life Worth Living?” (1895), James reveals deep, probably first-person, familiarity, with the existential source of concern with the issues of the meaning and worthwhileness of life. He calls it the “profounder bass-note of life” and suggests that it is to be found, or heard, somewhere in all of us: “In the deepest heart of all of us there is a corner in which the ultimate mystery of things works sadly.” (1895: 32)

Some people are so naturally optimistic and in love with life that they are constitutionally incapable of being much bothered by the bass-note and pay it little attention. James’s example of such a person is Walt Whitman; and one thinks of the English. James finds no fault—intellectual, moral, or otherwise—with such people. It is rare good fortune to be blessed with such a temperament. If everyone were, the question of the worthwhileness of life would never arise.

But for every Whitman, there is a suicide, and a thinker of the dreary constitution of the poet James Thomson, author of “The City of Dreadful Night.”

In his address, James imagines himself in discussion with a would-be suicide whom he tries to persuade to take up his burden and see life through to its natural end. James acknowledges that some of these suicides—perhaps the majority of them—are too far gone to have anything said to them, for instance, those whose suicidal impulses are due to insanity or sudden fits of frenzy. It is to the class of reflective would-be suicides—those disposed to kill themselves because of their thinking, reading, and brooding on the darker side of life—that James directs his remarks. It is these he wants to cheer up (or comfort) and keep alive.

James speaks of two stages of recovery from suicidal illness. The first stage includes three elements, three palliatives, for the suicidal condition. First, there is the thought, “You can end it whenever you will.” This strikes one as a strange thought to recommend to one contemplating suicide. But James thinks the thought can be a comfort. It means there’s no particular guilt or stigma attached to suicide. It means one won’t have to put up with this miserable world forever; one can opt out whenever one wants. It may delay the act by encouraging the thought, “Why kill myself today when I can always do it tomorrow?” Second, James points out, there is in human beings a natural sense of curiosity. It is worth hanging around a while longer in order to see the headlines of tomorrow’s newspaper. Third, there is a certain fighting instinct in human beings. James thinks the normal man has a reason to go on, even if the whole thing is worthless and meaningless, as long as there is some injustice to be put right, some villain to be put down, or some evil to overcome in the little corner of the universe he inhabits. The three things just mentioned all lie in the first stage of recovery, one that is partial and inferior to what lies in the second stage.

The second stage is one of full recovery. It is the religious stage. It gives one assurance of a fully worthwhile and meaningful life.

James’s injunction is to believe—to believe in a supernatural, spiritual order of things which overcomes and makes right the deficiencies of the natural order as we know it. We do not have rational or evidential proof that such a supernatural order exists. But Kant proved that natural science cannot prove that such an order does not exist. To make one’s life worthwhile and meaningful, all one has to do is to posit faith in such an order, to believe that there is a spiritual realm in which all the wrongs of the natural order are righted. In that case, one will view the natural order as an inadequate representation of the spiritual, or as a veil through which the true and wonderful nature of the spiritual is hidden or obscured.

One need have little conception of what the spiritual realm is like. The content of the belief in it can be quite minimal. All one needs to affirm is that there is such a realm and that its reality makes life worthwhile. James draws on two of the tenets of his pragmatism to support such an approach to the meaning and worthwhileness of life. One is the right to believe what we need to believe, even though it goes beyond belief warranted by empirical and rational evidence. His classic case for the right of such belief is in his essay, “The Will to Believe.”

Another tenet of pragmatism on which James draws is the idea that belief is a matter of action. To believe something is not so much to have a certain mental state as to act in a certain way. Whatever is in one’s mind, to act as though life is worthwhile and has meaning is to believe that it does

In “What Makes a Life Significant” (1899), James expressly addressed the question of the significance or meaning of life. What he said in this essay was rather different from what he had said in the previous one. The essay was in part a response to the deification of the uneducated, hard-working peasants in Tolstoy’s Confession. James admired Tolstoy a great deal but felt he went a bit overboard in his praise of peasant life and in his tendency to identify it as the very locus of meaning. James held that the lives of Tolstoy’s peasants were full of one ingredient necessary for a meaningful life—toil, struggle, pluck, will, suffering, manly virtues—but that they lacked the other necessary ingredient for a fully meaningful life, namely, what James called “ideals.”

Toward the end of the essay, James gives his own view. He states it in two or three different ways, the sense of which seems to be the same. “[I]deal visions” must be backed “with what the laborers have, the sterner stuff of manly virtue.”

[T]o redeem life from insignificance, [c]ulture and refinement all alone are not enough. . . . Ideal aspirations are not enough, when uncombined with pluck and will. . . . There must be some sort of fusion, some chemical combination among these principles, for a life objectively and thoroughly significant to result. (1899: 877)

The solid meaning of life is always the same eternal thing,—the marriage, namely, of some unhabitual ideal, however special, with some fidelity, courage, and endurance; with some man’s or woman’s pains.—And, whatever or wherever life may be, there will always be the chance for that marriage to take place. (1899: 878)

James is rather vague about what the “ideals” are, or even what they are like. In at least some cases they have something to do with culture and refinement, but it seems that they can and will vary from person to person, and may reside in some form in the uncultured and unrefined. In any event, it is noteworthy that James does not bring up the subject of religion. There is no suggestion that belief in God or a spiritual world is necessary for a fully meaningful life. An ideal wedded to manly virtue is enough.

b. Russell

The British philosopher Bertrand Russell (1872-1970) is often portrayed as one of those early twentieth century analytic philosophers who had no patience for big questions, such as that of the meaning of life. The portrayal is often reinforced by the famous story of Russell and the cab-driver, to whom Russell had nothing to say about the meaning of life.

It is true that Russell sometimes expressed a dismissive attitude toward the question: to Hugh Moorhead he said, “Unless you assume a God, the question (of life’s meaning) is meaningless” (Metz 2013b: 23), and to the taxi-driver he had indeed nothing to say about the meaning of life. But elsewhere he seems to have taken the question very seriously.

In “A Free Man’s Worship,” he begins with a fairly gloomy, despairing picture of the world science reveals to us, the only world there is, really. It is purposeless, void of meaning. The causes that produced us had no prevision of the end they were achieving. We ourselves, and everything precious to us, are the outcome of the accidental collocations of atoms. There is no life for the individual beyond the grave. The existence of our very species, along with all its achievements, will eventually be extinguished in the death of the solar system and “buried beneath the debris of a universe in ruins.”

But the thing for us to do is to maintain our ideals against the hostile universe. That universe knows the value of raw power, and not much else. Let us not worship it, as did Nietzsche. In exalting the will to power, Nietzsche was failing to maintain the highest human ideals in the face of the cruel world; he was, in a sense, giving in, capitulating, prostrately submitting to evil, sacrificing his best to Moloch.

Let us be clear-sighted and honest. Let us recognize that the facts are often bad, that in the world we know there are many things that would have been better otherwise, that our ideals are not in fact realized in the world.

But, again, in our minds and hearts, even though the whole business may be futile, let us tenaciously cling to our ideals, loving truth and beauty. Let us renounce power. Let us worship only the God created by our own love of the good. Let us live constantly in the vision of the good.

One trap we must guard against falling into is that which (Russell would think) Camus fell into some decades later. We should not cultivate and live in a spirit of fiery revolt, of fierce hatred of the senseless universe. Why not? Because indignation is still a kind of bondage, for it compels our thoughts to be occupied with the evil world. Give up the indignation so that your thoughts can be free. From freedom of thought comes art, philosophy, and the vision of beauty.

To achieve this we must develop a kind of detachment from our own personal happiness, must learn to free ourselves from the burden of concern for petty things and personal goods.

To abandon the struggle for private happiness, to expel all eagerness of temporary desire, to burn with passion for eternal things–this is emancipation, and this is the free man’s worship. (Russell 1903: 61)

In The Conquest of Happiness Russell makes a couple of remarks about the meaning of life that are worthy of note. The first is this:

The habit of looking to the future and thinking that the whole meaning of the present lies in what it will bring forth is a pernicious one. There can be no value in the whole unless there is value in the parts. Life is not to be conceived on the analogy of a melodrama in which the hero and heroine go through incredible misfortunes for which they are compensated by a happy ending. (1930: 29)

The second is odd but interesting, perhaps not the kind of thought that would occur to most people:

the human heart as modern civilisation has made it is more prone to hatred than to friendship. And it is prone to hatred because it is dissatisfied, because it feels deeply, perhaps even unconsciously, that it has somehow missed the meaning of life, that perhaps others, but not we ourselves, have secured the good things which nature offers man’s enjoyment. (1930: 75)

The thought seems to be that people hate each other because they think others have achieved (or know?) the meaning of life and they don’t. If that is true, one should be careful not to let on that he knows the meaning of life, even if he does.

Several writers have advocated focus and have thought of a life organized by one big project or goal as the paradigm case of a meaningful one. Russell rejects the idea.

All our affections are at the mercy of death, which may strike down those whom we love at any moment. It is therefore necessary that our lives should not have that narrow intensity which puts the whole meaning and purpose of our life at the mercy of accident. For all these reasons the man who pursues happiness wisely will aim at the possession of a number of subsidiary interests in addition to those central ones upon which his life is built. (1930: 177)

Finally, in “The Place of Science in a Liberal Education,” Russell makes the now familiar point that the meaning of life must come not from without but from within.

The search for an outside meaning that can compel an inner response must always be disappointed: all “meaning” must be at bottom related to our primary desires, and when they are extinct no miracle can restore to the world the value which they reflected upon it. (Mysticism and Logic, ch. 2, “The Place of Science in a Liberal Education”)

That is not to say that the meaning of life is created or chosen as opposed to discovered. For our primary desires are something largely given, something (if we are lucky) we simply find in ourselves.

c. Schlick

Moritz Schlick (1882-1936) was one of the central figures of the logical positivist movement. Thinkers in the movement are commonly said to have been dismissive of such “metaphysical” questions as that of the meaning of life. Yet Schlick for one was in no way dismissive. He described himself as a seeker of the meaning of life and wrote an extremely interesting essay on the topic in 1927.

Schlick’s contribution to the debate is (to some) one of the most appealing writings in the whole of the literature. Schlick was aware of Schopenhauer’s musings and was concerned to escape his dire conclusions. Schlick found his answer in (his interpretation of) Nietzsche’s Thus Spake Zarathustra. The answer is that life can be meaningful only if it is freed from its subjugation to ends and purposes. The suggestion is radical: a life has meaning only if it does not have some end or purpose to which everything is subordinated.

Schlick argued that the meaning of life is to be found not in work but in play. Work, in the philosophical sense, is always something done not for its own sake but for the sake of something else, some end or purpose that is to be achieved. Most often that end is the survival and perpetuation of life—that is, more work functioning only to perpetuate the life of the species. But it is absurd to take the meaning of life to lie in the continued survival of the species, or in the work required to make that survival possible. The meaning of life must lie in the content of existence, not in bare existence as such.

What then is the meaning of life? One candidate that suggests itself is feelings of pleasure and happiness. But Schlick rejects that candidate, partly on the grounds that pleasure is likely only to lead to the satiety and boredom which Schopenhauer so vividly made us aware of. Schlick also rejects the ideal of happiness as the meaning of life by way of the observation that man is essentially an active creature for which a life of idle pleasure is by no means suitable. What Schlick ends up saying is that the meaning of life is to be found in play, that is, in activity engaged in for its own glorious sake and not for the furtherance of some further end or goal. Doing something only in order to produce some further end or goal is work, and work cannot be the meaning of life. Of course, work is necessary for human existence and thriving, but it is meaningful only if it can—and it can be—turned into play, something one would do with delight even if nothing came of it in the end.

Schlick backs off from saying that the meaning of life is play. Instead, he says that the meaning of life is youth, since youth is the period of life in which play predominates. A nice consequence of this position is the fact that a life cut short in its infancy or youth is a meaningful life. If you are killed when you are ten years old, it is likely that you lived a life full of meaning.

One other aspect of Schlick’s view should be mentioned. It is that youth is not literally a matter of how long one has lived on this earth. If an old fellow turns his work into play, if he performs it primarily for the sake of the sheer joy of doing it, then he is young in the sense that matters. The key to a fully meaningful life would be to stay forever young.

d. Tagore

The Bengali Indian poet, short-story writer, novelist, dramatist, artist, sage, and philosopher Rabindranath Tagore (1861-1941), often credited with a major role in the cross-fertilization of East and West, won the Nobel Prize in literature in 1919. He wrote in English (sometimes). He knew the works of Einstein, Yeats, Wordsworth, and a host of other Western thinkers. In 1930 he delivered the Hibbert Lectures at Oxford, published the next year as The Religion of Man (1931), a remarkable volume containing much reflection on the meaning of life. This article will limit itself to consideration of a couple of points in that book.

Tagore is interesting because his interest in the question of the meaning of life did not arise out of anything like the circumstances which seemed to create the interest in so many Western thinkers. Tagore was not well-off and bored, he did not suffer from depression and existential angst, he did not worry about the importance of his personal life in the vast scheme of things, he was not a professional academic philosopher.

Tagore’s tendency was to view the question of the meaning of life as the question, “What is man?” or “What am I?” His answer seems to have been that the true human is the universal self, or the true Man represented by the life of the species, or even by the life of all beings.

If he had a problem, it lay in the chaotic, hodgepodge nature of this everyday life. Not exactly seeking for a solution to the predicament, one came to him on an ordinary day on which he was just living his everyday life in east India. He gives a gripping and poetic account of it in chapter six of The Religion of Man. He writes:

Suddenly I became conscious of a stirring of soul within me. My world of experience in a moment seemed to become lighted, and the facts that were detached and dim found a great unity of meaning. The feeling which I had was like that which a man, groping through a fog without knowing his destination, might fee when he suddenly discovers that he stands before his own house. (Tagore 1931, 95)

One thing that is noteworthy in this is that Tagore felt he had seen the meaning of life, not when he realized that his life really mattered, or added up to something sub specie aeternitatus, nor when he came up with a view of things that rid him of his angst and depression, but rather when he found that his life was part of a great unity of meaning. He saw meaning when everything, including his individual life, was one unified whole.

A second feature of Tagore’s conception of the meaning of life is the role he gives to detachment. The detachment that is relevant seems to be something like non-attachment to the petty concerns of one’s own individual life. It is not a lack of concern for anything and everything. It is lack of concern for how one’s own individual, personal life fares. The appropriately detached person places his interest in how Man as the eternal being, or beings of any sort ultimately fare. (There is an admirable concern for all life, not just human life in the thought of Tagore.) The appropriately detached man loses concern for his personal triumphs and failures and cultivates an enlivening interest in the life of the whole, with which, instead of his personal life, he identifies himself. The result is a vast increase in the sense of meaningfulness in his own life.

e. Ayer

A very different approach to the problem of the meaning of life was taken by the prominent logical positivist English philosopher A. J. Ayer (1910-1989).

Ayer argued, in an important 1947 paper, that “there is no sense in asking what is the ultimate purpose of our existence, or what is the real meaning of life” (Ayer 1947: 201). His argument is that there is no reason to believe in anything like a God who created us and intended us for a specific purpose. And even if there were such a God, his purposes could not give life meaning unless we agreed with them and accepted them. Thus the meaning of life always comes back to what we as individuals purpose, value, and aim at. There is no meaning out there to be discovered.

Ayer insists that the meaninglessness of life is nothing to cry about. One’s life has whatever meaning one gives it. It just doesn’t make sense to ask about the meaning of life because there is not, and could not be, such a thing. The question “What is the meaning of life?” is illogical and unanswerable. But a person can give his life a meaning, and if he does, it will be meaningful to him. It will come down to the value judgments the person makes. And these are a matter of personal choice and preference. There is no sense in saying that one person’s value judgments are true and another’s false. Give your life a meaning, and that’s the meaning it will have.

5. Conclusion

The dismissal of the question about the meaning of life which was characteristic of Ayer and his generation, and Camus’s idea that meaninglessness doesn’t matter, may be what ironically sparked the recent interest in the question. The natural philosophical response is that surely the question of the meaning of life is meaningful and important: in light of the remarks of Ayer, Camus, and their ilk, how is that so? A sense that the meaning of life must be a philosophical problem that matters has motivated work on the question of what the question of the meaning of life is all about, if we do not take Ayer’s dismissive attitude and Camus’s stance toward it. The work of Richard Taylor, Robert Nozick, Thomas Nagel, Joel Feinberg, Harry Frankfurt, Susan Wolf, Thaddeus Metz, Joshua Seachris, Julian Young, John Cottingham, David Benatar, and Garrett Thomson (among others) are attempts to answer this question.

The preceding survey brings us up to around 1950, just before a veritable explosion of works on the meaning of life took place in philosophy, especially in the Anglo-analytic tradition. Those interested in this explosion should begin by consulting the excellent overviews in Thaddeus Metz’s article in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Metz 2013) and Joshua Seachris’s article in The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Seachris 2012).

6. References and Further Reading

Ayer, A. J. “The Claims of Philosophy.” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life, 3rd Ed.. E. D. Klemke (ed.). New York: Oxford University Press, 2008: 199-202. (Originally published in 1947)
Baier, K. “The Meaning of Life.” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life. E. D. Klemke (ed.). New York: Oxford University Press, 1981: 81-117. (Originally published in 1947.)
Camus, A. “The Myth of Sisyphus.” J. O’Brien (tr.). Reprinted in part in Ways of Wisdom: Readings on the Good Life, Steve Smith (ed.). Lanham, MD: University Press of America, 1983: 244-255. (Originally published in French in 1943.)
Carlyle, T. 1834. Fraser’s Magazine. available online at Project Gutenberg.
Heidegger, M. Being and Time. J. Macquarrie and J. Robinson (trs.). Oxford: Blackwell, 1973. (Originally published in German in 1927.)
James, W. “Is Life Worth Living?.” in The Will to Believe and Other Essays in Popular Philosophy, New York: Dover Publications, 1956: 32-62. (Originally published in 1895.)
James, W. “What Makes a Life Significant?.” in On Some of Life’s Ideals. New York: Henry Holt and Company, 1899: 49–94. Reprinted in William James: Writings 1878-1899. New York: The Library of America, 1992: 861-80.
Kierkegaard, S. Concluding Unscientific Postscript. (Available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally published in Danish in 1846.)
Kierkegaard, S. Either/Or: A Fragment of Life. (Available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally published in Danish in 1843.)
Klemke, E. D. (ed.). The Meaning of Life. New York: Oxford University Press, 1981.
Klemke, E. D. (ed.). The Meaning of Life. 2nd Ed. New York: Oxford University Press, 2000.
Klemke, E. D. & Cahn, S. (eds.). The Meaning of Life: A Reader, 3rd Ed. New York: Oxford University Press, 2008.
Metz, T. “The Meaning of Life.” The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2013 Edition). Edward N. Zalta (ed.).
Nagel, T. “The Absurd,” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life. E. D. Klemke (ed.). New York: Oxford University Press, 1981: 151-161. (Originally published in 1971.)
Nietzsche, F. Ecce Homo. (available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally written in German in 1888-1889.)
Nietzsche, F. On the Genealogy of Morals. Ian Johnston (tr.). 2009.
Nietzsche, F. Thus Spake Zarathustra. (available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally written in German in 1883-1885.)
Nietzsche, F. Twilight of the Idols. (available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally written in German in 1888-1899.)
Nietzsche, F. The Will to Power. (available free online and in several print editions.) (Originally published in German in 1901-1911.)
The Oxford English Dictionary. Oxford: Oxford University Press: 2014.
Russell, B. “A Free Man’s Worship.” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life. E. D. Klemke (ed.). New York: Oxford University Press, 1981: 55-62. (Originally published in 1903.)
Russell, B. The Conquest of Happiness. London: Liveright, 1930.
Sartre, J. P. Being and Nothingness. H. E. Barnes (tr.). New York: Philosophical Library, 1956. (Originally published in French in 1943.)
Sartre, J. P. “Existentialism and Humanism.” B. Frechtman (tr.). 1956. Reprinted in Ways of Wisdom. S. Smith (ed.). Lanham, MD: University Press of America, 1983: 234-43.
Schlick, M. 1927. “On the Meaning of Life.” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life: A Reader, 3rd Ed., E. D. Klemke & S. Cahn (eds.). P. Heath (tr.). New York: Oxford University Press, 2008: 62-71. (Originally published in 1927.)
Schopenhauer, A. 1840. On the Basis of Morality. (available free online and in several editions)
Schopenhauer, A. “On the Suffering of the World.” in Essays and Aphorisms. R. J. Hollingdale (tr.). New York: Penguin Books, 1970: 41-50. (Originally published in German in 1851.)
Schopenhauer, A. “On the Vanity of Existence.” in Essays and Aphorisms. R. J. Hollingdale (tr.). New York: Penguin Books, 1970: 51-54. (Originally published in German in 1851.)
Schopenhauer, A. “On Affirmation and Denial of the Will to Live.” in Essays and Aphorism., R. J. Hollingdale (tr.). New York: Penguin Books, 1970: 61-65. (Originally published in German in 1851.)
Schopenhauer, A. “On Suicide.” in Essays and Aphorisms. R. J. Hollingdale (tr.). New York: Penguin Books, 1970: 77-79. (Originally published in German in 1851.)
Schopenhauer, A. The Essays of Arthur Schopenhauer: The Wisdom of Life. T. B. Saunders (tr.). 1860. rpr. in The Project Gutenberg EBook of The Essays of Arthur Schopenhauer, 2004.
Schopenhauer, A. The Essays of Arthur Schopenhauer: On Human Nature. T. B. Saunders (tr.). 1860. Reprinted in The Project Gutenberg EBook of The Essays of Arthur Schopenhauer, 2004,
Schopenhauer, A. The World as Will and Representation. 2 Vols. E. F. J. Payne (tr.). 1969. New York: Dover Publications. (Vol. 1 first appeared in 1818, Vol. 2 in 1844, in German.)
Schopenhauer, A. Essays and Aphorisms, R. J. Hollingdale (tr.). 1970. New York: Penguin Books. (Originally published in German in 1851.)
Seachris, J., 2012, “Meaning of Life: The Analytic Perspective,” The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy,
Smith, S., (ed.), 1983, Ways of Wisdom: Readings on the Good Life, Lanham, MD: University Press of America.
Tagore, R., 1961, The Religion of Man, London: George Allen & Unwin Co., Reprinted Boston: Beacon Press. (Originally published in 1930.)
Taylor, R., 1970, “The Meaning of Life,” Reprinted in The Meaning of Life, E. D. Klemke (ed.), New York: Oxford University Press, 1981: 141-150.
Tolstoy, L., 2005, A Confession, Aylmer Maude (tr.), Reprinted Mineola, NY: Dover Publications. (Originally published in 1884.)
Young, J. 2014, The Death of God and the Meaning of Life, 2nd ed., New York & London: Routledge.

Author Information

Wendell O’Brien
Email: w.obrien@moreheadstate.edu
Morehead State University
U. S. A.

Philosophy of Mental Illness

The Philosophy of Mental Illness is an interdisciplinary field of study that combines views and methods from the philosophy of mind, psychology, neuroscience, and moral philosophy in order to analyze the nature of mental illness. Philosophers of mental illness are concerned with examining the ontological, epistemological, and normative issues arising from varying conceptions of mental illness.

Central questions within the philosophy of mental illness include: whether the concept of a mental illness can be given a scientifically adequate, value-free, specification; whether mental illnesses should be understood as a form of distinctly mental dysfunction, and whether mental illnesses are best identified as discrete mental entities with clear inclusion/exclusion criteria or as points along a continuum between the normal and the ill. Philosophers critical of the concept of mental illness argue that it is not possible to give a value-neutral specification of mental illnesses. They argue that that our concept of mental illnesses is often used to disguise the ways in which mental illness categories enforce pre-existing norms and power relations. Questions remain about the relationship between the role that values play within the concept of mental illness and how those values relate to concepts of illness more generally. Philosophers who consider themselves a part of the neurodiversity movement claim that our concept of mental illness should be revised to reflect the diverse forms of cognition that humans are capable of without stigmatizing individuals that are statistically non-normal.

There are also epistemological issues concerning the relationship between mental illness and diagnosis. Historically, the central issue centers on how nosologies (or classification-schemas) of mental illness, especially the Diagnostic and Statistical Manual of Mental Disorders (the DSM), relate mental dysfunctions with observable symptoms. Mental dysfunction, on the DSM system, is identified via the presence or absence of a set of symptoms from a checklist. Those critical of the use of behavioral symptoms to diagnose mental disorders argue that symptoms are useless without a theoretically adequate conception of what it means for a mental mechanism to function poorly. A minimal constraint on a diagnostic system is that it must be able to distinguish a person with a genuine mental illness from a person suffering from a problem with living. Critics argue that the DSM, as currently constituted, cannot do this.

Lastly, there are a host of questions surrounding the relationship between mental illness and normativity. If mental illness undermines rational agency, then there are questions about the degree to which the mentally ill are capable of autonomous decision-making. This bears on questions regarding the degree of moral and legal responsibility that the mentally ill can be assigned. Further questions about agency arise over bioethical questions about the standing of the demands made on healthcare professionals by the mentally ill. For example, individuals with Body Integrity Identity Disorder (BIID) request that surgeons amputate their healthy limbs in order to restore a balance between their internal self-representation and their external body image. Bioethicists are divided over whether the requests of patients with BIID are genuinely autonomous and deserving of assent.

Conceptions of Mental Illness
Criticisms of the Bio-psycho-social Model
Neurodiversity
1. Motivation
2. Autism, Psychopathy
Responsibility and Autonomy
1. Psychopathy
2. Body Integrity Identity Disorder and Gender Dysphoria
References and Further Reading

1. Conceptions of Mental Illness

a. Alienism and Freud

Although there are many conceptions of madness found throughout the ancient world (demon possession, divine revelation or punishment, and so forth), the conception of a distinctly mental form of illness did not fully begin to crystallize, at least in the West, until the latter half of the nineteenth-century with the creation and rise of mental asylums. Individuals who were housed in asylums were thought to be psychotic or insane. Psychotic inmates were seen as distinctly different from the non-psychotic population and this justified the creation of special purpose institutions for the containment of psychotic individuals. Psychotics were construed as suffering from distinct and localizable organic brain disorders and were treated by medical professionals known as Alienists (Elliott 2004, 471). Writing at the time, German psychiatrist Emil Kraepelin’s nosology divided psychoses into one of two types: mood disorders and demtia praexcox (Kraepelin 1896a, 1896b). All other forms of distress were though to fall outside of the province of the asylum and of medical treatment.

Non-psychotic individuals who were unhappy with their lives, who felt intense anxiety, or who might vacillate between periods of high and low-motivation were not thought to have psychotic problem. These individuals were not treated or seen by alienists but instead sought help from their family, friends, or clergy (Horwitz 2001, 40). Non-psychotic dysphoria (unhappiness) was, in this context, understood not as a distinctly medical problem but instead in a variety of other forms: a typically social problem with living, a character flaw, or simply as a different way of life. The solution for the unhappiness that many individuals suffered was not found within the asylum but instead from the family, god, or other social institutions. There was, at this time, a clear distinction between medical problems resulting in psychosis and social problems that caused suffering.

Sigmund Freud grew up in the alienist tradition and received his medical degree in 1881. Freud’s theory of the mental and of mental illness would revolutionize western understanding of psychology and would become the dominant paradigm in the psychological sciences until the middle of the twentieth-century. Where the alienists saw mental illnesses as manifestations of rather discrete brain dysfunctions, Freud would come to understand the distinction between normal persons and the mentally ill as arising from a conflict in psychological mechanisms that were a part of the normal human repertoire (Freud 1915/1977; Ghaemi 2003, 4). Where the alienist understood non-psychotic unhappiness as a problem to be solved by individuals and their support networks, Freud understood problems in living as the domain of the psychotherapist. Paul Roazen famously quotes Freud as claiming that “[t]he optimum conditions for (psychoanalysis) exist where it is not needed—that is, among the healthy” (Roazen 1992, 160).

Crucial to Freud’s reorientation of mental disorder was his view of the relationship between observable behavioral symptoms and underlying psychological disorder. Unlike Kraepelin, who understood psychotic behavioral symptoms as closely tied to specific underlying brain dysfunction, Freud did not believe that behavioral symptoms could be tied to unique disorders. The underlying source of human psychological suffering, as Freud understood it, stemmed from universal childhood experiences that if poorly resolved or understood, could manifest in adulthood as neurosis. Freud saw repression, for example, as a normal part of development from child to adult. An individual could fail to properly apply repressive techniques. If this occurs then poorly repressed trauma can manifest itself in a myriad of ways from obsessive cleaning, chronic gambling, melancholia, and so forth. (Freud 1915/1989; Horwitz 2001, 43). Simply noting melancholia in a patient would not be enough for a psychoanalyst to understand the source of repressive dysfunction.

Because a client troubled by chronic gambling and another client troubled by hysteria could, in principle, be suffering from the same underlying repressive dysfunction, any diagnostic manual based on Freud’s conception of mental disorders would not hold symptoms as fundamentally important to the diagnostic process. Instead, Freud claimed that the only way to truly understand a patient’s underlying psychological dysfunction is to acquire detailed information about a person, including his or her dreams, in order to uncover repressed sexual urges (Freud 1905/1997).

The first two editions of the DSM were largely based on Freud’s underlying theory of repression and mental disorder. This nosology would dominate western thinking about the mentally ill until the 1960s.

b. DSM I – II

When the first edition of the Diagnostic and Statistical Manual of Mental Disorders was published in 1952, psychodynamic theorists dominated the clinical and academic landscape. Nearly 2/3 of the chairs of psychology departments in American universities were chaired by psychoanalysts and the emerging DSM strongly reflects their theoretical assumptions (Strand 2011, 277). By this point, psychiatry was seen as an extension of medical practice. This required the creation of a nosology, a catalogue of disorders for clinical practice (Graham 2010, 5).

The first-edition of the DSM represented a revolutionary change in the conception and treatment of mental illness. Given the expansive notion of mental illness proposed by Freud and his students, the first two editions of the DSM conclude that many individuals that, prior to this point, were not seen as mentally ill, would benefit from therapy. Because symptoms were only weakly correlated with underlying illness on the psychodynamic view, only repeated, and intensive, conversations with a qualified analyst could help a person get to the root cause of his problems (Horwitz 2002, 45; Grob 1991, 425). The first-edition of the DSM devotes a significant proportion of its 145 pages to a classification of mental illness concepts and terms (American Psychiatric Association 1952, 73-119). Unlike future editions of the manual, illnesses are not identified in terms of a series of symptoms but instead in terms of the underlying psychological conflict responsible. For example, the manual defines Psychoneurotic Disorder as:

[T]hose disturbances in which “anxiety” is a chief characteristic, directly felt or expressed, or automatically controlled by such defenses as depression, conversion, dissociation, displacement, phobia formation, or repetitive thoughts and acts…a psychoneurotic reaction may be defined as one in which the personality, in its struggle for adjustment to internal and external stresses, utilizes the mechanisms listed above to handle the anxiety created (American Psychiatric Association 1952, 12-13).

Yet, The presence of anxiety is not sufficient to diagnose psychoneurotic disorder. Anxiety must result from an underlying conflict between the personality and other stressors. It is the role of the analyst , in this context, to discover whether this underlying conflict is present. This cannot be done by merely observing symptoms; only psychodynamic therapy can discover the true cause of a patient’s anxiety (Grob 1991, 423).

Dissent against this system of classification and diagnosis arose from many groups both external to psychiatry and internal to the psychiatric discipline; these criticisms solidified in the 1960s. The emerging “anti-psychiatry” movement would come to challenge the assumptions that had grounded psychiatric practice in the first half of the 20^th century. Conceptions of mental illness, the underlying assumptions behind the process of diagnosis, and even the status of psychiatry as a science were all subject to sustained critiques. Several of the most vocal critics of psychiatry were themselves clinical psychiatrists: R.D. Laing, David Rosenhan, and Thomas Szasz. The latter’s critique of psychiatric practice and the conceptions of mental illness are outlined in detail below in section 2(b).

Rosenahn conducted a pair of famous studies that would radically undermine the scientific legitimacy of clinical diagnosis, especially in the eyes of the public. In his initial study, Rosenhan, along with seven other volunteers, attempted to have themselves admitted several mental health institutions (Rosenhan 1973, 179-180). Rosenhan instructed his collaborators to claim that they heard a voice which said only two words: “thud” and “hollow.” For all other questions, Rosenhan instructed his subjects to answer honestly. The words ‘thud’ and ‘hollow’ were chosen specifically because they did not correspond to a known pattern of neurosis in the DSM II. Rosenhan, and all of his confederates, were admitted to mental institutions; all but one of Rosenhan’s subjects were admitted under a diagnosis of schizophrenia (Rosenhan 1973, 180). Once admitted, subjects took as long as 52 days before they were released, despite the fact that they did not play-act any symptoms of any mental illness. Rosenhan noted that once he and his confederates had been admitted, everyday behavior began to be interpreted as a sign of their underlying mental illness. Subjects who were taking notes for later use, for example, were noted as engaging in unusual “writing behavior;” subjects speaking with a psychiatrist about their childhood and family were construed as having telltale neurotic early-childhood issues (Rosenhan 1973, 183). Since these subjects were not otherwise in distress, Rosenhan claimed that the diagnostic process was not representing an underlying ‘mental illness’ in any of the pseudopatients but instead that the diagnostic process was unscientific and unfalsifiable.

Once Rosenhan publicized the results of his initial study, several institutions challenged his results by re-asserting the validity of the diagnostic process. They claimed that their institutions would not have fallen for Rosenhan’s ruse and challenged him to send pseudopatients to them for analysis. Rosenhan agreed and, despite the fact that no psuedopatients were actually sent, these institutions suspected at least 41 of their new patients (more than 20% of new patients over a three month period) of being pseudopatients sent by Rosenhan (Rosenhan 1973, 181). Again it seemed as if the diagnostic process was incapable of accurately separating the mentally ill from the healthy. In part resulting from critiques of the diagnostic process like Rosenhan’s studies, the diagnostic model of psychiatry would be radically altered. Beginning as early as 1974, the American Psychiatric Association would assign a taskforce to prepare for the publication of the next edition of the DSM. The DSM III that would result from this process, published in 1980, would represent a rejection of the psychodynamic assumptions built into the previous versions of the manual and provide a framework for all future editions of tDSM.

c. The Bio-psycho-social Model DSM III – 5

The most recent edition of the Diagnostic and Statistical Manual of Mental Disorders, the DSM 5, was published in 2013. This edition does not substantially modify the conception of mental disorder that has been offered by the manual since its third edition, first published in 1980. In comparison with the first edition of the DSM, the DSM 5 includes diagnostic criteria for more than 400 individual disorders. The conception of mental disorders used in the DSM 5 presents them as biological, psychological, or social dysfunctions in an individual; this model has, unsurprisingly come to be called the Bio-psycho-social model. It represents the current consensus view of mental disorder among psychological researchers and clinical practitioners. Psychologists disagree about whether to understand this definition conjunctively or disjunctively (Ghaemi 2007, 8). The Biopsychosocial model states:

A mental disorder is a syndrome characterized by clinically significant disturbance in an individual’s cognition, emotion regulation, or behavior that reflects a dysfunction in the psychological, biological, or developmental processes underlying mental functioning. Mental disorders are usually associated with significant distress or disability in social, occupational, or other important activities. An expectable or culturally approved response to a common stressor or loss, such as the death of a loved one, is not a mental disorder. Socially deviant behavior (e.g., political, religious, or sexual) and conflicts that are primarily between the individual and society are not mental disorders unless the deviance or conflict results from a dysfunction in the individual, as described above (American Psychiatric Association 2013, 20).

From this characterization we can extract four criteria that serve to a genuine mental disorder from other sorts of issues (problems in living, character flaws, and so forth). In order for a disturbance to be classified as a mental disorder it must:

Be a clinically significant disturbance in cognition, emotion regulation, or behavior
Reflect a dysfunction in biological, psychological, or developmental processes
Usually cause distress or disability
Not reflect a culturally approved response to a situation or event
Not result purely from a problem between an individual and her society

All of the criteria, with the exception of the ‘distress’ criterion, are individually necessary and jointly sufficient for the classification of a patient’s symptoms as stemming from a mental disorder. Prior to the seventh printing of the DSM II, homosexuality had been included as a mental disorder. The revisions to the text that took place between the DSM II and the DSM III were meant to make clear that homosexuality (“an interest in sexual relations or contact with members of the same sex”), does not satisfy the criteria for a mental disorder so long as it is not accompanied by clinically significant dysphoria (American Psychiatric Association 1973, 2). However, an individual who feels dysphoria as a result of their homosexuality can be diagnosed with an Unspecific Sexual Dysfunction in the DSM 5 (American Psychiatric Association 2013, 450).

The third, ‘distress,’ criterion is neither necessary nor sufficient to qualify a mental disturbance as a disorder. This can be seen by examining the process for the diagnosis of the ‘cluster B’ personality disorders (histrionic, anti-social, borderline, and narcissistic personality disorders). Subjects with cluster B disorders often do not suffer as a result of their condition. Indeed, those with Antisocial Personality Disorder, for example, may not see themselves as disordered and may even approve of their condition. This has led some individuals with personality disorders to align with the emerging Neurodiversity movement (see section 3 below). The patterns of behavior manifested by those with cluster B personality disorders are, nonetheless, understood as reflecting clinically significant disturbances in cognition, emotion regulation, and behavior. They form a distinct class of mental disorders in the DSM (American Psychiatric Association 2013, 645-684). Some philosophers have argued that the cluster B personality disorders should not be understood as mental disorders but instead that they are better understood as distinctly moral disorders. Louis Charland argues for this conclusion. He claims that, unlike the cluster A and C personality disorders, the only treatment for the cluster B disorders is distinctly moral improvement; because this fact about the treatment of cluster B personality disorders uniquely distinguishes them from all other mental disorders in the DSM. Thus Charland concludes that they reflect moral (as opposed to value-neutral) dysfunction (Charland 2004a, 67).

Since the publication of the DSM III, mental disorders have been defined as being caused by a clinically significant dysfunction of a mental mechanism. Because the definition of mental illness invokes the concept of dysfunction, it is often subject to critique (see the following section). Although the general definition of mental disorder used by the DSM invokes the concept of dysfunction, the diagnostic criteria for particular mental illnesses do not. It is instructive to provide an example of how particular disorders are defined within the manual. Anorexia Nervosa, for example, is defined by the presence of three clusters of behavioral symptoms (American Psychiatric Association 2013, 338-339):

A: Restriction of energy intake relative to requirements, leading to a significantly low body weight in the context of age, sex, developmental trajectory, and physical health.

B: Intense fear of gaining weight or of becoming fat, or persistent behavior that interferes with weight gain, even though at a significantly low weight

C: Disturbance in the way in which one’s body weight or shape is experienced, undue influence of body weight or shape on self-evaluation, or persistent lack of recognition of the seriousness of the current low body weight

Importantly, this characterization of Anorexia Nervosa presents the disorder as a distinct, specifiable, condition that is present in the person and that the underlying dysfunction is uniquely picked out by the presence of the behavioral symptoms identified as A and C; “B” symptoms are seen as common but not essential to diagnosis (American Psychiatric Association 2013, 340). Given the underlying conception of mental disorder offered by the authors of the DSM, Anorexia Nervosa cannot simply be the result of a conflict between the individual and society. It also must not result from an individual accurately trying to adopt social norms about beauty or appearance or diet. It must instead result from a combination of biological, psychological, and/or social dysfunctions however, the diagnostic criteria do not indicate what this underlying dysfunction consists in nor does it offer any evidence that the symptoms associated with the disorder are caused by the same underlying dysfunction.

Stemming in part for reasons of this sort, both the general bio-psycho-social model of mental disorder and the uses of the model to characterize particular disorders, like Anorexia Nervosa, have been subject to repeated criticism by philosophers.

2. Criticisms of the Bio-psycho-social Model

The definition of mental disorder that stems from the bio-psycho-social model has been subject to several criticisms. Philosophical critiques of the definition of disorder have ranged from calling for revision and specification of the concept of disorder to abandonment of the concept altogether. Many of the 400+ disorders that appear in the DSM have also been criticized. In some cases, these critiques are internal: the disorders do not appear to match the criteria of mental disorder offered in the DSM itself; in other cases, as with some critics of schizophrenia, the aim is to undermine both the existence of the disorder and the conception of mental disorder that results in its inclusion (Bentall 1990).

Many members of the antipsychiatry movement described in section 1b were responsible for setting the stage for the criticisms of the bio-psycho-social model. Although in part political, this movement saw the rise of several alternative conceptualizations of human function and dysfunction that have come to challenge the DSM’s conception of a mental disorder. Chief among these were Thomas Szasz’s influential arguments that mental illness is a ‘myth’ and the rise of ‘positive psychology’ as a viable alternative psychological ideology.

a. Mental Illness as Dysfunction

Nassir Ghaemi has criticized the current conception of mental disorder as resting on an unscientific political compromise between factions within clinical and research psychologists and to stave off the looming threat of neurobiological eliminitivism (see section 2b). Ghaemi argues that many psychologists view the Bio-psycho-social conception of mental illness disjunctively and focus predominantly on their preferred method for understanding a disorder depending on their own assumptions of dysfunction (Ghaemi 2003, 10). Although this compromise presents the appearance of consensus, Ghaemi argues that it is an illusion. He advocates for a form of integrationism about mental disorder that has become popular in some circles (Ghaemi 2003, 291; Kandel 1998, 458). A true integration of biology and psychology requires solving the currently unresolved issue over consciousness and how consciousness is realized by the brain. Because this question does not appear to be resolvable in the near-term, integrationists of Ghaemi’s stripe have offered a placeholder for a replacement to the Bio-psycho-social model instead of a true alternative to current models.

Philosophers have also criticized the DSM conception of mental disorder for its lack of a unified theory of dysfunction. The current DSM requires that mental disorders reflect a dysfunction of biological, psychological, or social mechanisms though the text itself is silent on what it would mean for a mechanism to be dysfunctional and does not provide any evidence that the symptoms used for clinical diagnosis of a disorder are caused by a single underlying dysfunction.

Philosophers have appealed to at least three distinct senses of dysfunction to craft a unified theory of mental disorder: etiological, propensity, and normative dysfunction. Etiological function (and dysfunction) is construed in evolutionary terms. A mechanism is functioning, in the etiological sense, if it evolved to serve a specific purpose and if it is, currently, serving its evolved purpose. In order to discover the function of a mental mechanism, it is necessary to discover its evolved function. Dysfunction can then be construed relative to this purpose (Wakefield 1999, 374; Boorse 1997, 12). A mechanism is dysfunctional if it is not fulfilling its evolutionary purpose. Depression, for example, may, in some cases, represent a dysfunction of a mechanism evolved for affective regulation. However, evolutionary psychological theories of mental function are still in their early stages. Furthermore, some philosophers want to allow for the possibility that many of our mental mechanisms may not have evolved to serve the functions to which we currently put them to use.

A propensity function is not constrained by past selective pressures but instead defines function and dysfunction based upon current and future selective success. Male aggression, for example, may have been adaptive in our ancestral environment and hence may represent a case of proper functioning on the etiological theory. On the propensity view, however, male aggression may not be adaptive for life in modern societies even if it was fitness-enhancing in our ancestral environments. Male aggression might therefore, on a propensity account of function and dysfunction, represent a dysfunctional mechanism and hence a mental disorder (Woolfolk 1999, 663). As with the evolutionary view, propensity function conceptions of mental dysfunction have the advantage of appealing to descriptive evidence in order to determine whether or not a specific pattern of behavior is fitness-enhancing in its current context (Boorse 1975, 52). However, crafting a theory of function and dysfunction in terms of present-day fitness appears to allow some conditions to count as mental disorders that we may be averse to label mental illnesses. One major issue with appealing to propensity function is that it appears to resurrect defunct mental illness. Drapetomania, the mental illness that was applied to runaway slaves in the nineteenth century, would appear to satisfy the definition of a propensity dysfunction. Dysphoria caused by the conditions of slavery and a strong desire to abandon one’s current condition are arguably not fitness-enhancing, in a strictly evolutionary sense, and therefore appear to satisfy the criteria for a propensity dysfunction (Woolfolk 1999, 664).

Purely normative accounts of dysfunction have not garnered much favor within the psychological or philosophical disciplines. On a purely normative account of dysfunction, a person is said to be mentally ill based upon whether or not the behavior fits within the context of a larger normative network. Whether we choose to call a person mentally ill or merely ‘bad’ may depend on whether or not we believe agents like this should be held morally responsible and the concept of responsibility may not be reducible to non-normative elements (Edwards 2009, 78). On such conceptions, it is impossible to avoid invoking evaluative concepts when describing what a mental illness is or why a particular set of behaviors is best understood as an illness (Fulford 2001, 81).

George Graham argues for what he calls an unmediated defense of realism about mental illness; Graham’s defense in unmediated in the sense that he does not believe that it must be shown that mental illnesses are natural kinds or result from brain-disorders in order to qualify as legitimate classification-independent kinds (Graham 2014, 133-134). Instead, he argues that “the very idea of a mental disorder or illness is the notion of a type of impairment or incapacity in the rational or reasons-responsive operation of one or more basic psychological faculties or capacities in persons” (Graham 2014, 135-136; see also Graham 2013a and 2013b). These capacities could be described or analyzed at various levels of implementation according to Graham though their malfunction is understood in normative terms.

Perhaps the most influential theory of dysfunction within the philosophical literature is offered by Jerome Wakefield. Wakefield’s conception of mental disorder attempts to bridge the gap between purely objective conceptions of disorder and subjective or normative views. On Wakefield’s view, a mental disorder arises only when a ‘harmful dysfunction’ is present. This combines two different types of concepts: a concept of dysfunction and a concept of harm. Wakefield’s conception of dysfunction is etiological. A mechanism is dysfunctional if it fails to perform the purpose that it evolved to perform. Etiological function is objective in the sense that etiological functions are pan-cultural: they are not dependent on cultural conceptions of function or value. They are, instead, a set of universally shared facts about human nature. The ‘harmfulness’ criterion, on the other hand, is sensitive to cultural context. (Wakefield 1992, 381; Wakefield 1999, 380). As Wakefield understands it, a person is harmed by a disorder if the disorder causes a “deprivation of benefit to a person as judged by the standards of the person’s culture” (Wakefield 1992, 384). In order to be diagnosed with a mental illness, it must be true that an agent’s behavior is caused by a malfunction of an evolutionary mental mechanism and, furthermore, it must also be true that this dysfunction, in the context of that individual’s culture, deprives her of a benefit.

Wakefield, and others like him, argue that it is crucial to distinguish between mental disorders and other sources of distress (Horwitz 1999). The crucial factor in determining proper treatment for a person’s dysphoria, these philosophers argue, is a proper identification of the cause of his or her distress. Mental disorders are caused by harmful mental dysfunctions. Other sources of distress are better understood as problems in living. Many types of unhappiness that are typically diagnosed as depression, on this view, are better understood not as stemming from depression but instead by an examination of the larger social factors that may be causing unhappiness. Because the DSM’s conception of mental disorder is cause-insensitive and identifies depression only via symptoms, it fails to distinguish between these two forms of unhappiness. The danger, these philosophers argue, is that mental disorders are construed as being problems that reside within an agent and that treatments are therefore focused only on, usually pharmaceutically aided, symptom relief. If distress has an underlying social cause, if it is a problem in living, then treatment unhappiness should have a radically different focus. For example, the symptoms described by Betty Friedan as caused by “the problem that has no name” fit relatively easily within the rubric of depression (Friedan 1963, 17). However, Wakefieldian views would resist this diagnosis. The underlying cause of the distress Freidan describes is social and the best treatment of this form of distress is social change. Sadness that is caused by patriarchal or misogynist cultures does not represent a malfunction in the evolved mechanisms in a person (it may represent just the opposite). On the DSM model, treatment may merely mask these depressive symptoms pharmacologically and would only serve to maintain the unjust social situations that give rise to it. The best understanding for “the problem that has no name” is to identify it as a problem in living stemming from misogynist assumptions about the roles available to women in a culture. Wakefield’s view is realist in the sense that its conception of mental dysfunction is independent of our acts of classification (Graham 2014, 125). Because function is grounded on etiology, there is a culturally-independent fact-of-the-matter regarding the presence or absence of a dysfunction in a person.

Wakefield’s harmfulness criterion allows for different cultures to come to different conclusions about which evolutionary dysfunctions will rightfully count as a mental disorder. On Wakefield’s view, homosexuality may represent a genuine evolutionary dysfunction (in the sense that exclusive homosexual behavior threatens the propagation of genes into future generations) but homosexuality is not harmful in a contemporary broadly Western cultural-context. Because it is not harmful in this cultural-context, it is a mistake to think of homosexuality as a disorder. This leaves open the possibility that the harmfulness criterion would allow homosexuality to be a legitimate mental disorder in other cultural-contexts.

Other critics have assailed Wakefield’s appeal to etiological dysfunction. Aside from the general epistemological problem that results from identifying the evolutionary function of psychological mechanisms, there are two problems that arise with an appeal to etiological dysfunction. First, some have argued that depression is an evolved response and hence could not be construed as a mental disorder on Wakefield’s view (Bentall 1992, 96; Woolfolk 1999, 660). Second, some have argued that many of our mental mechanisms may not have arisen as a result of evolutionary selection pressures. They may be evolutionary “spandrels” in Stephen Gould’s sense. The white color of bones necessarily results from the composition of bone but is itself not a property explicitly selected in an evolutionary sense. A spandrel cannot dysfunction in Wakefield’s terms because it lacks an evolutionary cause for its existence. Although spandrels can confer adaptive advantages, they are importantly not themselves traits that are selected for. If any of our mental mechanisms are spandrels then Wakefield’s view cannot explain disorders arising from their use (Gould and Lewontin 1979, 581; Woolfolk 1999, 664, Zachar 2014, 120). Famously, some philosophers have argued that complex human abilities, like our capacity for language may themselves be evolutionary spandrels (Chomsky 1988; Lilienfeld and Marino 1995, 413). Furthermore, recent critics have suggested that too much of the recent work on mental illness has focused exclusively on elucidating the concept of illness or dysfunction and have neglected to consider how advances within the philosophy of mind and the cognitive sciences might change our conception of the ‘mental’ component of mental illness (Brülde and Radovic 2006, 99).

Philosophers who are critical of attempts to define a distinctly mental conception of disorder have been motivated, in part due to the arguments above, to move in two different directions. Some have proposed that we replace the concept of mental disorder with a strictly neurological conception of dysfunction. Doing so, they argue, would place disorders on a clearer and more scientific footing.

b. Neurobiological Eliminitivism

The transition from the DSM II to DSM III brought with it the adoption of the biomedical model for diagnosis. Unlike the psychodynamic model, which saw symptoms as providing little insight into the underlying cause of distress, the biomedical model afforded symptoms pride of place in diagnosis. For much of the 20^th century, the biomedical model of diagnosis understood the symptoms that a patient brought to her clinician as providing insight into the underlying disorder(s) that caused her patient to consult the clinician in the first place.

Psychology, as a therapeutic discipline, adopted this model of diagnosis and, in the process, began to categorized patient symptoms into discrete groupings, each caused by a specific mental disorder. However, some philosophers have noted that the biomedical model itself has changed rapidly in the 21^st century and that this has created a dilemma for clinical psychological models of diagnosis. Patient reports, in current biomedical models of diagnosis, have lost their pride of place as the key markers for diagnosis. In their place clinicians turn to laboratory test results to determine the true illness responsible for a patient’s suffering. One motivation for this change, within general clinical practice, is that symptoms underdetermine diagnosis. Adopting this new biomedical model for mental illnesses, however, has been seen by some as presenting an eliminitivist threat to mental disorders (Broome and Bortolotti 2009, 27).

Eliminative materialism arose in the 20^th century in order to challenge to views about the mind that assign mental states explanatory/causal roles. The views targeted by the eliminitivist were grounded in common-sense or “folk” ideas about everyday mental states like beliefs and desires. These views situated mental states as entities belonging to proper scientific explanation. Eliminitivists argued that folk psychological theories of the mind would fare no better than our folk biological or physical theories and that the folk mental states should be eliminated from scientific explanations (Churchland 1981). Mature cognitive and neuro-sciences do not need to make reference to folk psychological states like beliefs and desires in order to explain human behavior; furthermore, the neural architecture of the brain itself does not appear to house discrete localizable states like beliefs and desires that are assumed by folk psychology (Ramsey, Stich and Garon 1990). Folk psychological theories tell us that the best explanation of human behavior (including mental illness) should be given in terms of dysfunctional mental states (delusions, compulsive desires, etc.). The eliminitivist, on the other hand, undermines this view by claiming that nothing in the brain corresponds to these folk-psychological states and that we are better off without appealing to them.

Eliminitive materialism has arisen as a challenge to the DSM construal of mental disorders in the form of cognitive neuropsychology. “This process may start as a process of reduction (from the disorder behaviorally defined to its neurobiological bases), but in the end psychiatry as we know it will not just be given solid scientific foundations by being reduced to neurobiology; it will disappear altogether” (Broome and Bortolotti 2009, 27). Just as biomedical diagnosis has shifted away from patient report toward more direct assessments using bio-physiological metrics, the eliminitivist argues that the same process should occur with mental disorders. Neurological dysfunction should supplant folk psychological discussions of mental dysfunction. In much the same way as Alzheimer’s disease is understood as a neurological brain disorder; the eliminitivist claims that a mature cognitive neuroscience will replace contemporary classifications of mental disorders with neurological dysfunction (Roberson and Mucke 2006, 781).

Philosophers who resist the eliminitivist reduction of the mental to the neurological argue that at least some types of mental disorders cannot be understood without appealing to mental states. Plausible candidates for this type of disorder include delusions (Broome and Bortolotti 2009, 30), personality disorders (Charland 2004a 70) and various sexual disorders (Soble 2004, 56; Goldman 2002, 40). Personality disorders, especially those falling under the category of ‘Cluster-B’ disorders, appear to require that individuals have acquired bad characters in order to accurately explain why the behavior stemming from the illness is disordered. If normative competence necessarily makes reference to belief-forming mechanisms (having knowledge about moral concepts, recognition of the agency of other persons, etc.) then Cluster-B personality disorders cannot be fully reduced to their neurobiological underpinnings without a meaningful loss of the disordered element of the disorder (Pickard 2011, 182).

On a related note, philosophers have attempted to resist the purely mechanistic neuro-scientific explanations of psychology. Jeffrey Poland and Barbara Von Eckardt argue that the DSM’s bio-psycho-social model relies on a mechanistic model of mental illness but that purely mechanistic models fail to explain the representational aspects of a mental illness; in their words “[a]ny such account will extend well beyond what one would naturally assume to be the mechanism of (or the breakdown of the mechanism of) the cognition or behavior in question” (Von Eckardt and Poland 2004 982). Peter Zachar argues for a view he calls the Imperfect Community Model. This model is based on a rejection of essentialism grounded in pragmatism; Zachar argues that mental illnesses are united as a class despite lacking any necessary and sufficient conditions to define them; mental disorders bear a prototypical or family resemblance to one another, however, that suggests a rough unity to the concept (Zachar 2014, 121-8).

c. The Role of Value

There are related questions that arise about the nature and role of value and mental illness. The first has to do with whether mental illness is a value-neutral concept. Nosologies of mental illness attempt to create value-neutral definitions of the disorders they contain. In the ideal, the concepts picked out by manuals like the DSM are supposed to reflect an underlying universal human reality. The mental disorders contained therein are, with only minor exception, not meant to represent culturally relative normative value judgments onto the domain of the mental.

The DSM includes a “cultural formulation” section meant to distinguish culturally specific, explicitly normative disorders from the supposed pan-cultural, value-neutral disorders that make up the bulk of the manual (American Psychiatric Association 2013, 749). In part this approach stems from the idea that psychologists adhering to the bio-psycho-social model of mental disorders view their project as being on par with nosologies of non-mental disorders. There are two questions worth raising here. The first is whether or not this “likeness argument” has any merit, the second is whether or not the biomedical illness concept is, itself, value-neutral (Pickering 2003, 244). A heart attack, for example, is a disorder, on this model, no matter the time or location of the infarction. Heart attacks are, in this sense, natural kinds and proper objects for scientific study. A heart attack represents a particular form of cardiovascular dysfunction that is agnostic about the cultural or moral values of a particular community. Despite the fact that heart attacks may not present the same symptoms across different sufferers (some may grab their left arms, some may scream, some may fall to the ground, etc), what unites these heterogeneous seeming symptoms is an underlying causal story that explains them (Boyd 1991, 127). Mental disorders are thought to operate on the same principle. On the one hand, the view that psychological symptoms are united by a common cause may result from pre-theoretical assumptions about mental states (Murphy 2014 111-121). Critics of the bio-psycho-social model argue that values are an essential component of the concept of mental illness. If values are an ineliminable part of the concept of mental illness, we should be led to ask what kinds of values are invoked by the concept

Michel Foucault was an early critic of mental illness and mental health institutions. In his Madness and Civilization: A History of Insanity in the Age of Reason, Foucault argued that asylums, being institutions where ‘the mad’ were separated from the rest of society, emerged historically by the application of models of rationality that privileged individuals already in power. This model served to exclude many members of society from the circle of rational agency. Asylums functioned as a place for society to house these undesirable persons and to reinforce pre-existing power relations; cures, when available, represented conformity to existing power structures (Foucault 1961/1988). Foucault’s critique of mental disorder inspired a generation of psychologists, many of which see themselves as part of a new counter-movement from within the discipline: the Positive Psychology movement. The constructivist and value-laden interpretation of the DSM’s bio-psycho-social model of mental disorder has led some within this movement to call for the abandonment of the model. There is an intrinsic problem, they argue, with viewing individuals as, primarily, vehicles of dysfunction. Those within the positive psychology movement argue that a new, openly value-laden, conception of human beings should supplant the manual: “[t]he illness ideology’s conception of “mental disorder” and the various specific DSM categories of mental disorders are not reflections and mappings of psychological facts about people. Instead, they are social artifacts that serve the same sociocultural goals as our constructions of race, gender, social class, and sexual orientation—that of maintaining and expanding the power of certain individuals and institutions and maintaining social order as defined by those in power” (Maddux 2001, 15).

Hybrid views, like those of Jerome Wakefield, which attempt to delineate a value-neutral and a value-laden component to the concept of mental illness have also been subject to criticism for the role they assign value. Richard Bentall, for example, has argued that the supposedly objective components of these theories contain value-laden assumptions. Bentall argues that happiness satisfies the objective criteria for mental dysfunction (happiness is a rare mental state, it impairs judgment and decision making, and its neural correlates are at least partially well-understood); however, happiness is not viewed as a dysfunction (and consequently is not categorized as a mental illness) because we value the state for its own sake (Bentall 1999, 97). This view is echoed by constructivists about mental illness.

Constructivists about mental illness can hold a variety of positions about where the concept of social construction operates with regards to mental illness. At the least radical level, constructivists can hold that cultures impose models of ideal agency that are used to label sets of human behaviors as instances of ordered and disordered agency; behavioral syndromes, on this view, can be more or less pan-cultural though each culture develops a theory of ideal agency that renders some of these syndromes ‘illnesses’ while other cultures may group the syndromes differently according to different values (Sam and Moreira 2012). A more thorough-going constructivism understands these packages or syndromes of behavior as themselves objects of constructivism; for example, the set of behaviors currently associated with depression would not be seen as a natural (categorization-independent) grouping of properties. Instead, the set of behaviors we call ‘depressive’ exist only because they have been grouped together by clinicians (for any number of reasons) (Church 2001, 396-397). This form of constructivism claims that the only way to explain why a set of behaviors, feelings, thoughts, and so forth, are grouped into a syndrome is that clinicians have created this grouping. Unlike the set of behaviors characteristic of a heart attack, for which we have a readily available causal story that unifies them, mental illnesses lack a clinician-independent explanation for their grouping. On this view, syndromes are akin to what Ian Hacking has called “interactive kinds” (Hacking 1995, Hacking 1999). For Hacking, while natural kinds represent judgment-independent groupings in the world, an interactive kind “when known, by people or those around them, and put to work in institutions, change the ways in which individuals experience themselves—and may even lead people to evolve their feelings and behaviors in part because they are so classified” (Hacking 1999, 103). To think of mental illnesses, like multiple personality disorder (now Dissociative Identity Disorder), as an interactive kind is to say that multiple personality disorder is not a basic fact about human neurology discoverable by the neuroscientist; instead, once the concept of multiple personality disorder is identified, once a set of behaviors has come to be seen as a manifestation of the condition and clinicians have been trained to identify and treat it, then individuals will begin to understand themselves in terms of the new concept and behave accordingly. Some have argued that many paraphilias and personality disorders are best understood on the interactive kind model (Soble 2004, 60; Charland 2004a, 70).

Critics will note that the natural kind -the socially constructed kind- distinction does note exhaust the alternatives. According to Nick Haslam, the natural kind distinction is tacitly invoked by realists of mental illness; this distinction, however, masks several possible alternative accounts of mental illness that allow for intermediate, less essentialist, even pluralist views (Haslam 2014, 13-20; see also Murphy 2014, 109).

d. Szasz’s Myth of Mental Illness

Perhaps the best-known critic of mental illness to arise out of the anti-psychiatry movement of the 1960’s is Thomas Szasz. He published The Myth of Mental Illness in 1961 initiating a wide-ranging discussion of how best to understand the concept of a mental illness and its relation to physical illnesses. Szasz’s work was (and continues to be) the subject of significant discussion and debate. Szasz’s main claim is that the psychiatric field, and its concomitant conception of a mental illness, rests “on a serious, albeit simple, error: it rests on mistaking or confusing what is real with what is simulation; literal meaning with metaphorical meaning; medicine with morals…mental illness is a metaphorical disease” (Szasz 1974/1962, x). Mental illness should be understood as a metaphorical disease, according to Szasz, because it results from clinicians making a kind of category mistake. It involves the use of concepts derived from one disciplinary body, medicine and the natural sciences, and applying them to a realm where they do not rightfully apply: human agency (Cresswell, 24).

According to Szasz, the proper world-view of the natural sciences is to construe its objects of study as law-like and deterministic. All knowledge in this domain is thought to be reducible to, and explainable in terms of, physicalism. Medicine, being a branch of science, understands medical illness on this model. A malfunctioning heart-valve has characteristic physical discontinuity with a functional one, it has typical effects on the function of the valve, and these effects are identifiable independent of patient symptoms. The treatment for medical illnesses relies on a thoroughly physicalist picture of the workings of the human body. Szasz believed that adopting the concept of a physical illness into the realm of mental illness is fundamentally incompatible with our concept of human agency. This results from two lines of argument. The first is that mental illnesses, unlike physical ones, are not typically reducible to biophysical causes (Szasz 1979, 22). If biological dysfunction cannot be used as a basis for delimiting mental illness then the only option left is to appeal to non-normative behavior. Szasz’s second concern is similar to the worries of neurobiological elimintivism mentioned in section 2(b). Szasz argues that the eliminitivist’s picture of human agency is, at best, incomplete. The root of the problem stems from the fact that Szasz believes that we must view agents as necessarily free, capable of choice, and as responsible; “in behavioral science the logic of physicalism is patently false: it neglects the differences between persons and things and the effects of language on each” (Szasz 1974, 187). Szasz’s argument here is sometimes construed as an appeal to dualism. The physical world is deterministic but the mental world must necessarily be free. Because the bio-psycho-social model uses concepts derived from natural sciences in a realm where they do not rightfully apply (that is, human agency) mental illness, as a concept derived from the natural sciences, is a myth resulting from this category mistake. To say that mental illness is a myth, however, is not meant as a denigration of individuals who suffer. It is, instead, meant to more accurately categorize their suffering as resulting from a failure to conform to social, legal, or ethical norms (Pickard 2009, 85).

Szasz’s critics have responded along several lines. Some do not take issue with his underlying understanding of the illness concept but disagree with his claim that it is not applicable to mental phenomena. Mental illnesses, according to these critics, have been (or will soon be) reducible to neurological or neurochemical dysfunction. They argue that advances in neuroscience give us reason for thinking that the prospect for finding the neurological or neurochemical correlates for at least some of our mental illnesses categories is high (Bentall 2004, 307). Other critics have argued instead in the other direction and attacked Szasz’s construal of physical illness. Szasz’s arguments have been taken, by some, to imply that physical illness itself is a deeply evaluated category reflective of value-judgments in much the same way mental illness is meant to on Szasz’s account (Fulford 2004; Kendell 2004). Still others have aimed to preserve Szasz’s primary claim that the overarching category of ‘mental illness’ will prove to be a non-natural interactive-kind, reflective of our values and practices, while simultaneously maintaining that “particular kinds of mental illnesses may yet constitute valid scientific kinds” (Pickard 2009, 88).

3. Neurodiversity

Human cognitive and physical functions range widely across the species. Although most individuals fall within a statistically normal range in terms of their abilities in all of these arenas, statistical normalcy has long been criticized as a normative marker (Daniels 2007, 37-46). Advocates for what has come to be known as the ‘neurodiversity movement’ have begun, in part stemming from the criticisms of psychiatry and the DSM begun in the 1960’s, to push for widespread acceptance of the forms of cognition beyond the “neuro-normal” that individuals operate with (Hererra 2013, 11). Members of the neurodiversity movement understand it as “associated with the struggle for the civil rights of all those diagnosed with neurological or neurodevelopmental disorders (Fenton and Krahn, 2007, 1). Forms of cognition currently seen as dysfunctional, ill, or disordered are better understood as representing diverse ways of seeing and understanding the space of reasons. Proponents of neurodiversity claim that agents on the autism spectrum, those with personality disorders, attention deficit and hyperactivity disorder, dyslexia, and perhaps even those with psychopathic traits should not suffer from the stigma associated with the illness label. Individuals to whom these label apply often demonstrate profound capabilities (artistic, mathematic, and scientific) that are inseparable from the condition underlying their illness-label (Glannon 2007, 3; Ghaemi 2011). Pluralism about forms of human agency should be encouraged once we fully understand the problematic ways in which norms have come to influence illness categories.

a. Motivation

Applying the label “mentally ill” or “disordered” can have long-term negative effects not only by affecting how individuals to whom we apply the label view themselves (Charland 2004b, 338-340; Rosenhan 1973, 256) but also by affecting how others view and treat them (Didlake and Fordham 2013, 101). Often, the decision to create a new mentally ill class is decided without the consultation of the groups involved. Homosexuality, for example, had been labeled a mental disorder in the first two editions of the DSM until social and political movements, largely headed by homosexuals themselves, caused the American Psychiatric Association to re-assess its stance (Bayer and Spitzer 1982, 32). The effects that being labeled mentally ill or disordered have on persons are wide-ranging and durable enough to warrant caution; those in the neurodiversity movement argue, from various perspectives, that clinicians continue to mistake diverse forms of cognition (variations from the neuro-normal) with mental illness because of the assumption, which advocates argue is mistaken, that deviation from statistically-normal neural-development and function constitutes disorder. Advocates for neurodiversity typically argue along two lines. The first is to argue that our current concepts of mental dysfunction are in need of revision because they contain one or more of the problems described in section 2 of this entry. This line of argument focuses especially on issues over the role of power and value in the construction of mental illness categories. The second line of argument is “firmly grounded in motivations of an egalitarian nature that seek to re-weight the interests of minorities so that they receive just consideration with the analogous interests of those currently privileged by extant social institutions” (Fenton and Krahn 2007, 1). Any resulting account of neurodiversity must aim to preserve useful categories of illness or mental disorder (if only for the purposes of treatment).

Perhaps the most forceful arguments from the neurodiversity perspective target the status of autism as a form of mental disorder. Much controversy has followed the APA’s decision to fold the diagnosis of Asperger’s syndrome into the more general category of Autism Spectrum Disorder.

b. Autism, Psychopathy

Autism Spectrum Disorder is the diagnosis applied to a wide-ranging number of individuals who have demonstrated persistent difficulty with social understanding and communication and whose symptoms emerge quite early in development. For example, the DSM-5 lists “[i]mpairment of the ability to change communication to match context or the needs of the listener,” “[d]ifficulties following rules for conversation and storytelling,” and “[d]ifficulties understanding what is not explicitly stated (e.g., making inferences) and nonliteral or ambiguous meanings of language” as diagnostic for ASD (American Psychiatric Association 2013, 50-51). Advocates for neurodiversity argue that it is unjust to attempt to force those with ASD to modify their behavior in order to more closely match neurotypical behavior especially as a form of treatment for a disease or disorder. For example, efforts to “change the diets of people with ASD, force them to inhale oxytocin, and expose children to countless hours of floor time or social stories to try to make persons with ASD more like neurotypicals” fail to realize that these attempts at changing individual cognition imposes a narrow conception of proper functioning as a form of treatment. Furthermore, treatments whose aim is to reduce ASD symptoms, some argue, resemble arguments made by those wishing to eradicate other minority-cultures defined by functioning (that is, deaf-communities) (Barnbaum 2013, 134). Some individuals with ASD argue that they constitute their own unique culture that deserves respect (Glannon 2007, 2). Advocates for neurodiversity argue that conceptions of mental illness that include ASD assume that deviation from neurotypical function is evidence of mental dysfunction rather than a sign of the forms of neurodiversity present in any human population. Autistic flourishing must be understood as being different from (though not a degenerate form of) neurotypical flourishing. Equally important within the call to neurodiversity is the project to identify and articulate the ways that social institutions are built around and advantage persons of “neurotypical” function over others (Nadesan 2005, 30). Given the proper account of functional agency, many individuals with ASD should be seen as functional and not disordered or mentally ill. Although not as common, similar arguments are sometimes advanced for other mental disorders including psychopathy.

Psychopathy is a controversial construct. As currently understood, it is a spectrum-disorder and is diagnosed using the revised version of what is known as the “Psychopathy Checklist” (PCL-R). Importantly, psychopathy does not appear in any version of the DSM as a distinct disorder. In its place, the DSM offers Antisocial Personality Disorder (ASPD). ASPD is intended as an equivalent diagnosis, though there is significant evidence that ASPD and Psychopathy are distinct (Gurley 2009, 289; Ramirez 2013, 221-223). Psychopathy, discussed in more detail in section 4a, is characterized by an inability to feel empathic distress (to find the suffering of others painful) along with a pronounced difficulty in understanding the differences between norms that are purely conventional versus other types of norms (Dolan and Fullam 2010, 995). Beyond these symptoms, however, psychopathy is characterizable as a distinct form of agency that raises concern about neurodiversity. Some psychopaths are ‘successful’ in the sense that they avoid incarceration while satisfying PCL-R diagnostic criteria. Psychopaths of this sort are much more likely to be found in corporate and other institutional settings (academia and legal, medical, or corporate professions) (Babiak 2010, 174). In these contexts, some have argued that psychopathic personality traits should be seen as virtues (Anton 2013, 123-125). A more contextual understanding of psychopathy as a distinct way of relating to reasons, persons, and situations may lead us to appreciate the distinct contributions persons with these traits can make. Psychopathy, especially the effects that psychopathy has on emotional and moral competence, has raised challenges to traditional theories of moral responsibility.

4. Responsibility and Autonomy

Accounts of mental illness are closely tied to accounts of agency and responsibility. It is not unusual, following an especially horrific crime, for public discourse to include questions about a suspect’s mental health history and whether a suspect’s alleged mental illness should excuse them from responsibility. Eric Harris, one of the teens responsible for the Columbine High School massacre, was called a psychopath by psychologist Robert Hare (Cullen); media commentators noted that Adam Lanza, the man responsible for killing 26 at Sandy Hook Elementary School in Connecticut had been diagnosed with autism and raised questions about the role this may have played (Lysiak and Hutchinson). One reason why discussions like these happen so quickly after a crime likely has to do with the relationship between mental illness and the effects that mental illness are thought to have on responsibility. One view on the matter states that “[t]o diagnose someone as mentally ill is to declare that the person is entitled to adopt the sick role and that we should respond as though the person is a passive victim of the condition. Thus, the distinguishing features of dysfunction that we should look for are not a universally consistent set of exclusive qualities, but things that provide the grounds for the normative claim made by applying the label ‘mental illness’” (Edwards 2009, 80). A more careful analysis of the relationship between mental illness and theories of moral responsibility indicates that several factors are often thought to matter when it comes to holding a person with a mental illness responsible for what s/he has done.

a. Psychopathy

Philosophical theories of moral responsibility often make a distinction between two different aspects of responsibility: attributability and accountability (Watson 1996, 228). Attributability refers to all of the capacities that someone must have in order to be responsible. One minimal condition may be that an action is attributable to a person if it stems from her agency in the right sort of way. Accidental muscle spasms, for example, are not typically attributable to an agent.

If we are dealing with an agent that has satisfied these attributability conditions, we can ask further questions about how we should treat this person after she has acted. This is a question about accountability. Some philosophers have claimed that there are many different forms of accountability, each requiring its own justification (Fischer and Tognazzini 2012, 390). It is one thing to make sure that I intentionally made the rude comment at dinner, it is another to decide what should be done to me as a result. The former is a question about attributability, the latter is a question about accountability.

Emotional capacities form an important component of many theories of moral responsibility (Fischer and Ravizza 1999; Strawson 1962; Wallace 1994; Brink and Nelkin 2013). Reactive attitude theories give moral emotions a central location within a conception of attributability and accountability. The term ‘reactive attitude’ was originally coined by Peter Strawson as a way to refer to the emotional responses that operate in the context of responding (that is, reacting) to what people do (Strawson, 1962). Resentment, indignation, disgust, guilt, hatred, love, and shame (and potentially many others) are reactive attitudes. For Strawson, and philosophers who have followed him, to respond to a person’s action with one of these reactive attitudes is to simultaneously hold him accountable. A theory of moral attributability could be derived, in principle, via an examination of the conditions under which we believe it to be appropriate to respond to someone with a reactive attitude.

Reactive attitudes focus on the quality of their target’s will. What this means is that our reactive emotions are sensitive to facts about an agent’s intentions, desires, her receptivity to reason, and so forth. Philosophers refer to this as the Quality of Will Thesis. Reactive attitude theorists explain excuses and an exemption from responsibility by analyzing how an agent’s will affects our attitudes. Legitimate excuses, for example, lead us to believe that we should extinguish our reactive response to a person. Excuses, in effect, show us that we were wrong about the quality of a target’s will (Wallace 1994, 136-147). If you push me and I fall, I might resent you; however, if I realize that you pushed me in order to save me from oncoming traffic, my attitude will be modified. My resentment will have been extinguished and the pushing has been excused. Excuses inform us that we were mistaken about what action was done. Excuses are singular events, they do not cast doubt on a person’s agency, their attributability, but instead inform us that we were wrong about what intention/purpose we attributed to them. Agents that appear to be universally excused are more traditionally said to be exempt from responsibility.

An exemption occurs when we are led to question whether a person meets our attributability requirements. Imagine again that I am knocked over except this time I learn that the person who pushed me suffers from significant and persistent psychotic delusions. She believed, in that moment, that I was a member of the reptilian illuminati and pushing me would get the grey aliens to repossess her hated neighbor’s house. Unlike a case involving excuse, a person whose agency is hampered by delusions as severe as these is not a proper target for our reactive attitudes at all (Strawson, 1962; Broome and Bartolotti, 2009, 30). Agency as abnormal as this is better seen as exempt from judgments of attributability or accountability. Exempt agents are not true sources of their actions because exempt agents lack the ability to regulate their behavior in an intelligibly rational way (Wallace 1994, 166-180). It would not be appropriate to resent these agents.

The logic of excuses and exemptions has been thought to show that responsible agency requires that a responsible agent have epistemic access to moral reasons along with the ability to understand how these reasons fit together (Fischer and Ravizza 1997). Furthermore, some have proposed that an agent must have the opportunity to avoid wrongdoing (Shoemaker 2011, 6). Psychopaths seem to be rational and mentally ill at the same time; because of these features, they create difficulty for many theories of responsibility.

Perhaps the most notable diagnostic feature shared by psychopaths is an inability to feel empathic distress. You feel empathic distress when you are pained by the perception of others in pain. The processes that ground empathic distress are not thought to be under conscious control. Psychopaths do not respond as most people do when exposed to signs of others in pain (Patrick, Bradley and Lang 1993) Although the degree to which someone can have the capacity for empathic distress varies, psychopaths are significantly different from non-psychopaths (Flor et.al., 2002).

Furthermore psychopaths have significant difficulty distinguishing between different types of norms. Psychologists have noted that most people are readily able to note the difference between a violation of moral norms from violations of conventional norms (Dolan and Fullam 2010). Normal persons tend to characterize moral norms as serious, harm-based, not dependent on authority, and generalizable beyond their present context; conventional norms are characterized as dependent on authority and contextual (Turiel 1977). Children began to mark the distinction between moral and conventional norms at around two years of age (Turiel 1977). Psychopaths, on the other hand, fail to consistently or clearly note the differences between them. Most psychopaths tend to treat all norms as norms of convention. Non-psychopaths note a difference between punching someone (a paradigmatic moral norm violation) and failing to respond in the third-person to a formal invitation (a violation of a conventional norm). Although there is significant controversy about how much we can infer from the psychopath’s inability to mark the ‘moral / conventional’ distinction, the inability, along with their previously noted empathic deficit, has led some philosophers to argue that psychopaths cause problems for traditional theories of moral responsibility(Turiel 1977).

Reactive attitude theorists have argued that psychopaths should be exempt or excused from moral responsibility on both epistemic and fairness grounds. Given their difficulty distinguishing between moral and conventional norms, many reactive attitude theorists conclude that psychopaths are not properly sensitive to moral reasons and cannot be fairly held accountable (Fischer and Ravizza 1998; Wallace 1994; Russell 2004). It would be unfair to hold someone morally responsible if they cannot understand moral reasons; it is therefore inappropriate to express reactive attitudes at psychopaths (Fischer and Ravizza 1998, 78-79). However, some have argued that psychopathic agency can ground accountability ascriptions.

David Shoemaker, for example, has argued that: “[a]s long as [the psychopath] has sufﬁcient cognitive development to come to an abstract understanding of what the laws are and what the penalties are for violating them, it seems clear that he could arrive at the conclusion that [criminal] actions are not worth pursuing for purely prudential reasons, say. And with this capacity in place, he is eligible for criminal responsibility” (Shoemaker 2011, 119). Although Shoemaker’s claim about legal responsibility has struck many as correct, the larger debate is over whether psychopaths are morally responsible for their choices given what we know about psychopathic agency.

If moral responsibility requires the capacity to understand moral reasons as distinctly moral and if, as many philosophers have supposed, this capacity is grounded on the ability to empathize with others, then psychopaths cannot understand moral reasons and should be excused. This puts pressure on Shoemaker’s characterization of psychopathic responsibility. If a psychopath’s understanding of moral reasons can be gauged by, for example, their poor ability to distinguishing moral norms from conventional norms then this also appears to be evidence for their lack of receptivity to moral reasons. Some philosophers have excused psychopaths for just this reason: “[c]ertain psychopaths…are not capable of recognizing…that there are moral reasons…this sort of individual is not appropriately receptive to reasons, on our account, and thus is not a morally responsible agent” (Fischer and Ravizza 1998, 79). Others, like Patricia Greenspan, have argued that psychopaths do have a form of moral disability, stemming from their emotional impairments, but that this form of disability should serve to mitigate, not extinguish, their responsibility (Greenspan 2003, 437).

Some philosophers note the consequences of psychopathic moral receptivity on the quality of will thesis. If reactive attitudes are sensitive to the quality of an agent’s will, then psychopaths cannot express immoral wills if they do not understand morality. If psychopaths cannot act on a will that merits reactive accountability then they lack attributability altogether. Jay Wallace has argued that “[w]hat makes it appropriate to exempt the psychopath from accountability…is the fact that psychopathy…disables an agent’s capacities for reflective self control” (Wallace 1994, 178).

Others argue that psychopaths may be held accountable by appealing to non-moral reactive attitudes like hatred, disgust or contempt. These attitudes, they claim, can be targeted at the quality of a psychopath’s will even if it is granted that they cannot act on immoral wills (Talbert 2012, 100). This is true even if the psychopath cannot appreciate that we have moral reasons for caring about our status as agents. Insofar as the psychopath can make judgments like these, then, in the words of Patricia Greenspan, “[the psychopath] is a fair target of resentment for any harm attributable to his intention to the extent that the reaction is appropriate to his nature and deeds. He need not be “ultimately” responsible in the sense that implies freedom to escape blame” (Greenspan 2003, 427). Because psychopaths are incapable of understanding moral reasons it is unfair to hold them morally responsible but there are forms of accountability and reactive address that are outside the moral sphere that may remain appropriate to direct at them.

Shame, in particular, appears to be a normatively significant reactive attitude that psychopaths have access (Ramirez 2013, 232). Shame grounds a family of retributive forms of accountability and has been though to serve as another way to hold psychopaths accountable even if it can be established that psychopaths are not capable of feeling or understanding moral reactive attitudes. If psychopaths are susceptible to shame then they can be fairly held accountable on shame-based grounds.

It is fair to hold psychopaths accountable in these non-moral (shame-based) ways based if they are able to feel the emotion being levied against them and can express a quality of will that these attitudes are sensitive to. More importantly, although psychopaths do not understand the distinctiveness and weight of moral reasons, their judgments can still express condemnable attitudes about those reasons. Greenspan notes that all of us have “blind spots” about certain narrow classes of reasons and we stand to those reasons in the same relation that psychopaths stand to moral reasons; these blind spots don’t excuse us from accountability (Greenspan 2003, 435).

b. Body Integrity Identity Disorder and Gender Dysphoria

Conceptions of mental illness, and mentally impaired agency, factor prominently over questions regarding the best way to treat a disorder. In 1997, Robert Smith, a surgeon at the Falkirk and District Royal Infirmary in Scotland, amputated one of this patient’s limbs at this patient’s request. The limb itself was healthy. There did not exist any medical justification for the amputation. In 1999, Smith amputated another patient’s healthy limb, again at the request of the patient, and was scheduled to perform a third amputation (on a third patient) before the hospital’s board of directors forbade him from amputating any more healthy limbs. Smith’s patients came to him with a set of symptoms that do not correspond to any particular disorder in the DSM. Smith’s patients were not under the delusion that their limbs did not belong to them; they did not see their limbs as disfigured or disgusting. Instead, his patients claimed that, from a young age, they had not thought of the limb as part of their authentic selves. They were, the patients claimed, never meant to be born with the limb and were seeking surgery to allow their inner representation of their bodily identity to match their external body presentation. The only way to do this was to amputate their healthy limb.

Patients who seek to radically alter their body via repeated surgeries or extreme dieting are ordinarily (barring other symptoms) diagnosed with Body Dysmorphic Disorder (BDD). BDD, however, requires that patients seek to modify their bodies because they find a specific part of their body disgusting or revolting or flawed. Patients with BDD also tend to engage in obsessive behaviors related to the body-part’s appearance (grooming, ‘mirror checking,’ etc) (APA 2013, 248). Smith’s patients, although they claimed to experience significant dysphoria because of their condition, did not do so because they found their limbs revolting or disfigured. They identified themselves as having a different condition: Body Integrity Identity Disorder. Like psychopathy, BIID is not a disorder cataloged in the DSM. Although BIID is not a DSM disorder, the APA does recognize that it appears distinct from BDD. “Body Integrity Identity disorder (apotemnophilia)…involves a desire to have a limb amputated to correct an experience of mismatch between a person’s sense of body identity and his or her actual anatomy. However, the concern does not focus on the limb’s appearance, as it would be in body dysmorphic disorder” (APA 2013, 246-247). Vilayanur Ramachandran and Paul McGeoch claim that they have discovered several of the neural correlates of BIID and these appear distinct from BDD; specifically, they claim that the disorder arises in part from a dysfunction of the right parietal lobe (Ramachandran and McGeoch 2007, 252).

Apart from the conceptual question over whether BDD and BIID are underlying manifestations of the same mental illness, individuals who claim to suffer from BIID raise significant ethical questions over the nature of mental illness, autonomy, and surgical treatments for dysphoria. Patients with BIID request that surgeons recognize and grant their request for surgical intervention to cure psychological suffering. Although the case of BIID has not received widespread philosophical attention, several different approaches have been advanced with regards to BIID patient requests for amputation. The purpose of these amputations is, they claim, to correct what they see as a mismatch between their inner and outer selves. Some philosophers have raised doubts about the ability of BIID patients to act on genuinely autonomous decisions (Mueller 2009, 35). One worry about challenging the autonomy of otherwise rational agents is that, in other domains, we appear to allow individuals significant freedom to modify their bodies for many reasons (aesthetic, political, self-expression, and so forth) without thereby questioning their status as autonomous agents (Bridy 2004). The right to bodily autonomy is typically construed as one of the guiding values in biomedical decision-making. Furthermore, BIID sufferers who have their requests for amputation denied often resort to self-harm. Many will harm their limbs to the point where amputation becomes medically necessary. Some have argued that it is morally permissible to grant BIID requests for amputation on the basis of harm-prevention (Bayne and Levy 2005, 78). Others have expressed concern over the use of surgical treatments for mental illnesses (if it is granted that BIID is a mental illness), given that the surgery persons with BIID are requesting involve the permanent removal of a capacity typically thought to important (Johnston and Elliot 2002, 430).

Given that BIID patients appear to have a locatable dysfunction in their temporal lobes (an area where internal body representations are thought to be located), some philosophers have argued that surgical treatments are unjustified if a non-surgical solution can be found. That is, if BIID results from the suffering that is caused by a mismatch between a patient’s internal representation of herself and her outer presentation, then if it possible to change the inner representation, and thereby evade surgery, and thus we have an obligation to ought to do so (Johnston and Elliot 2002, 432). This approach, however, forces us to confront philosophical responses to other conditions that involve mismatches between a person’s inner representation of their bodies and their external bodily presentation. In particular, patients with BIID argue that their condition is analogous to the suffering faced by those with gender dysphoria. These individuals often seek sexual reassignment surgery to alleviate their perceived embodiment mismatch (Bayne and Levy 2005, 80). Individuals who are suffering as a result of their assigned sex/gender and who exhibit a strong desire to alter their sex and gender characteristics can be diagnosed with Gender Dysphoria (APA 2013, 451-459). Unlike other patients desiring surgical body modification (for self-expression, to meet unrealistic gender ideals, and so forth), individuals with BIID or Gender Dysphoria both report that their desires for surgical alteration of their body presentation originate at a young age. Both groups seek to have their request for surgical alteration respected by those around them as a recognition of their autonomy and of the value that gender (or bodily integrity) play in the formation of an authentic self (Lombardi 2001, 870).

The discussion of BIID, its status as a mental disorder, and the ethics of granting a person’s request for amputation are all relatively new and hotly debated topics within the Philosophy of Mental Illness and Bioethics generally. This debate is, however, connected to a larger, better established, questions concerning patient autonomy and what it means for an agent to make autonomous choices. At the moment there does not exist a clear-consensus on the status of BIID as disorder or a received view on how to treat BIID requests for amputation.

5. References and Further Reading

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Author Information

Erick Ramirez
Email: ejramirez@scu.edu
Santa Clara University
U. S. A.

Roy Wood Sellars (1880—1973)

Roy Wood Sellars was one of a generation of systematic philosophers in America the likes of which has not been seen before or since. He was born in Seaforth, Ontario in Canada, and spent most of his career at the University of Michigan where he continued working well into his 90s. He was a fiercely independent thinker who resisted the fashions of the day in order to follow his own instincts. He believed that the philosopher should be well-grounded both in the history of philosophy and in the sciences, and that the philosopher should engage philosophically with the major moral, social, and political issues of the day. His central aims were to combine and harmonize the insights of science and common sense, to update religion with the scientific advances of the day, and to promote a science-grounded system of progressive humanistic values. Over the course of his long life, Sellars wrote and published prolifically. He is the author of 15 books, over 100 articles, 14 book reviews and several miscellaneous works. He is best known for his pioneering formulations of critical realism (roughly, the view that, first, human beings normally perceive independent objects with their sensations but do not perceive sensations, and, second, human beings must interpret their sensations), evolutionary naturalism (a naturalistic version of emergent evolution), the “double knowledge” and mind-brain identity theory (the view that human beings possess two modes of knowledge of a single material reality), and a defence of religious humanism (the view that religion must be reinterpreted in terms of its role in improving humanity’s “this-worldly” existence). He is the primary author of the Humanist Manifesto I of 1933. Finally, he is the father of Wilfrid Sellars, a highly influential philosopher in his own right, many of whose views, allowing for the different vernacular and emphasis of the two periods, are continuous with his father’s views.

Biography
Critical Realism
Evolutionary Naturalism
Organicism
Value Theory
Socialism
The Humanist Manifesto
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Roy Wood Sellars (July 9, 1880-Sept. 5, 1973), was born in Seaforth, Ontario, the second son of Ford Wylis and Mary Stalker Sellars. (Warren 2007, 211 lists Sellars’ birth year as 1883, but this is an aberration. Most sources, including Warren elsewhere, all give the 1880 date. See Warren 1970, xi-xxv; 1973, 19-22; 1975, Ch. 1; Frankena 1973-74.) His ancestors had migrated from the Glasgow region in Scotland to Nova Scotia and later moved to Ontario. In Ontario, the Sellars’ clan married into the prestigious Wood family, which included a distinguished Captain from the War of 1812 (David Wood) and the acting commissioner of the North West Mounted Police and Commissioner of the Canadian Yukon Territory (Zachary Taylor Wood). This made him a relative to the 12^th president of the United States (Zachary Taylor). Sellars also took great pride in the fact that one of his ancestors, Lord Stanley, appears in Bosworth Field in Shakespeare’s Richard III.

Roy’s father, Ford, had been a schoolteacher and a school principal until health considerations forced him to abandon that profession. Thereafter, Ford studied at the Medical School at the University of Michigan and became a physician in 1882. After graduating from medical school, the Sellars family settled in Pinnebog, Michigan. As this was a small town, Roy’s youthful companions were farm boys. In his youth, Roy pursued swimming, baseball, and hockey, and retained an interest in sports all his life. His father’s library was the only one in the neighbourhood, and though young Roy knew little about philosophy, he read Emerson and Carlyle and had numerous discussions with his father about medicine. In this small rural community, Roy’s intellectual gifts quickly set him apart and he was sent to the Ferris Institute in Big Rapids, Michigan to prepare for a university career.

Roy entered the University of Michigan in 1899, where he did his own cooking and washed dishes for his lodgings. Due to his small-town, rural background, the insecure young boy felt unprepared for a university program but he resolved to “make a go of it” and, upon his graduation, was voted one of the top two scholars in the class. He studied widely in both the arts and the sciences, including rhetoric and calculus. Sellars received his B.A. in 1903 from the University of Michigan and went on to Hartford Theological Seminary, where he studied New Testament Greek, Hebrew, and Arabic (and read the Koran in the original). He acquired a critical historically and culturally grounded approach to religion and a sympathy for social liberalism and humanism that remained with him throughout his life. In 1904 Professor R.M. Wenley of the Department of Philosophy at Michigan recommended Sellars for a fellowship at the University of Wisconsin, where he studied for a time before returning to the University of Michigan as Professor Wenley’s replacement while the latter was on sabbatical leave. Apart from a brief stint at University of Chicago in the summer of 1906 and a year studying in Europe (either 1908-09 or 1909-10 – sources differ on this), Sellars remained at the University of Michigan for the remainder of his approximately 40-year career, first as an instructor and doctoral student (he earned the Ph.D. in 1908 or 09 – again, sources differ), and then as a member of the permanent faculty.

During his year in Europe Sellars studied at the Sorbonne and discussed the possibility of a naturalistic formulation of emergent evolution with Henri Bergson. Bergson in turn referred him to the scientist and vitalist Hans Driesch. Sellars went on to study with Driesch and the neo-Kantian Wilhelm Windelband at Heidelberg. The precise details of Driesch’s influence on Sellars are not known but it seems likely that he directed Sellars to the study of physiology. After returning to Michigan from his European adventures, Sellars developed a new course in the philosophy of science in which he used James Ward’s Naturalism and Agnosticism, as well as texts by Huxley, Mach, Poincaré, and Pearson. Many of his students at this time came from the physical and biological sciences. Sellars remained scientifically-oriented throughout his life, a trait which he passed to his son Wilfrid. Even when Sellars was inspired by Bergson’s romantic or mystical theory of creative evolution, he sought (much like Popper) to recast it in more “naturalistic” terms acceptable to the sciences. Sellars’ naturalistic bent put him at odds with his most ardent supporter, Professor Wenley. Although Wenley regarded him as his best student, he could not accept Sellars’ naturalism, and did not approve of the publication of Sellars’ thesis by the University.

Sellars enjoyed considerable teaching success. His course, “The Principles and Problems of Philosophy,” was favorably remembered by many alumni who found it a “liberating” experience, “like taking a cold bath” (Frankena, 1973-74, 230). Several of the students in his political philosophy course, in which he discussed democracy, communism, socialism, and fascism, remarked that though they had expected him to be a propagandist, the course turned out to be a good scholarly treatment of the issues with no discernible bias. Sellars had earlier taught a course in elementary logic and eventually published a textbook based on that course. It was a chance reading of that textbook by Charles Stevenson that led him to the study of philosophy and later become one of Sellars’ colleagues (Frankena, 1973-74, 230).

Sellars married his cousin Helen Maud Stalker, an intelligent and accomplished woman, in 1911. He wrote the Preface to Helen’s translation (from the French) of Celestine Bougle’s Evolution of Values. Helen provided Sellars with much support and they remained close until her death in 1962. In 1912 and 1913, respectively, their two children, Wilfrid and Cecily, were born. Cecily become a state-employed psychologist in North Dakota, but was killed in an automobile accident in 1954, an event which impacted Sellars’ scholarly work for decades. Twenty years later, well into his 90’s, he was still working on papers that had been in progress at the time of her death. Wilfrid Sellars went on to become a highly influential philosopher in the latter half of the 20^th century who, like his father, emphasized a firm grounding in the history of philosophy, fluency in the sciences, and a systematic approach to philosophical problems. It is noteworthy that his son Wilfrid developed a sophisticated version of scientific realism that builds on his father’s critical realism. In fact, Wilfrid’s views are often similar in substance to his father’s even if they differ in language and style.

Sellars believed in a fruitful, reciprocal relationship between epistemology and ontology, but saw epistemology as philosophically basic. His most vehement criticism of other philosophers was often that they were weak in epistemology, but he also considered himself a proud ontologist. Sellars also had a strong interest in ethics, social philosophy, and political philosophy.Indeed, Sellars belonged to a genre of philosophers, which includes his son Wilfrid, that is rare today, who believed that a philosopher must be knowledgeable in virtually all areas of philosophy. Sellars made contributions to epistemology, metaphysics, ethics, the philosophy of science, social and political philosophy, and the history of philosophy. He could discourse in an intelligent and informed a way about Heidegger, Sartre, and Bergson just as he could about Russell, Carnap, or Einstein. He was as at home in a discussion about ethics or social and political philosophy as he was in logic or scientific method.

Sellars was an independent thinker who resisted the fashions of the day in order to pursue his own philosophical direction.He formulated what may have been the most viable form of realism in his era. He offered a course, titled “Main Concepts of Science,” that may have been the very first course offered anywhere in the philosophy of science. He formulated evolutionary naturalism, the view that life and mind are emergent products of naturalistically conceived evolution (i.e., without invoking the supernatural element in Alexander or Bergson’s élan vital). He (1923b; 1938a) pioneered the identity theory of the “brain-mind,” which he called the “double knowledge emergence approach” to mind-brain identity. Although his basic views changed little over his career, he was constantly reformulating, developing, and clarifying them. In his later years he watched as many of his views became commonplace, without being recognized for his role in their genesis.

Perhaps because of his fierce independence, Sellars often found himself out of the mainstream. Until 1930, philosophy was dominated by idealism and pragmatism, religion by theism, and social theory by capitalism, while Sellars was a realist, an atheist, and a socialist. Later, analytical philosophy came into dominance and fundamentalism resurged in religion, neither of which appealed to him. Socialism did eventually enjoy a resurgence, but it was Marxist and totalitarian while Sellars was committed to a more moderate and gradual reform of social institutions based on rational persuasion. Sellars was also critical of the American philosophy in his day. He (1970a, vii; see also Warren, 1975, 28) once remarked that, amongst philosophers, it is “almost always a Sellars against the world”. He often felt that he was better understood by psychologists and biologists than by philosophers and that he was better understood in Europe than in America (Warren 1975, 25).

Nonetheless, Sellars was a respected member of the philosophical community in America and it is safe to say that he inspired a personal affection from many of his colleagues that is unusual. He served as Vice-President of the Eastern Division of the APA in 1918 and President of the Western Division in 1923. He was an energetic correspondent and carried on friendly discussions with Samuel Alexander, C. Judson Herrick, Lloyd Morgan, and Marvin Farber. He also corresponded with F.H. Bradley, Bernard Bosanquet, C.A. Strong, and Donald Williams, and he debated with D.C. Macintosh, H.N. Wieman, and Sydney Hook. In 1954 the journal Philosophy and Phenomenological Research devoted an entire issue to Sellars’ philosophy, and in 1964 Andrew Reck listed Sellars as one of the 10 most notable philosophers in recent American philosophy. At the University of Michigan the Roy Wood Sellars Chair was created in his honor and Bucknell University honored him by establishing the Roy Wood Sellars Lecture Series. The first Roy Wood Sellars Lectures were given by Warren and the second by Wilfrid Sellars with Roy Sellars in attendance. In 1970 Notre Dame University honored Roy in his 90^th year with a symposium on his philosophy, including presentations by Andrew Reck, Wilfrid Sellars, and C.F. Delany.Although Roybelonged to a generation of America’s greatest systematic philosophers, Frankena (1973-4, 231) observes that, with hindsight, Sellars may have been one of the most important of them. However, the fact that his son Wilfrid has developed a powerful formulation of his father’s views may be the greatest testament to Roy Wood Sellars’ lasting achievement.

2. Critical Realism

Much of Sellars’ philosophical work is an attempt to replace outdated mythopoetical views about knowledge, religion, values, and so forth, by up-to-date scientifically grounded views. Science, he holds, “builds” on common sense, but since it develops new concepts based on new instruments and the application of mathematics to experience, the philosopher’s job is to harmonize the common sense and scientific frameworks (1932a, v; 1973, 160-161).

In his first book, Critical Realism , he attempts to justify common sense realism, which is also the view of philosophers when they are not in a reflective mood (1916a, 6)—the view that people perceive real external objects, not just intermediaries of some kind. He also aims to clarify the relation of common sense realism to scientific knowledge: “We start from independent things; and not from percepts” (1916a, 3). Sellars also argues against the main theories of perception of his day: idealism, representationalism, pragmatism, and positivism, all of which he saw as undermining common sense realism. Other versions of critical realism were espoused by Santanaya and Lovejoy.

The defence of common sense realism, he (1941b; 1959c) holds, requires a robust defence of the correspondence theory of truth.The basic error in those mistaken views of perception is the failure to distinguish between the content and object of perception (1922a, 70 n 4).Since the content of perception is fixed by aspects of the organism, those mistaken theories wrongly infer that the object of perception is not independent of the perceiver.

Sellars’ critical realism requires real substances (as opposed to ideas, universals, impressions, and so forth) as objects of perception. He (1929c; 1970a, 32; 1973, 182, 346-348, 353) rejects “the historical desiccation of the category of substance,” that is, the whittling down of the Ancient and Medieval robust notion of substance to Locke’s “I know not what”. While representationalism, idealism, pragmatism, and positivism tend to volatize the object of perception into ideas, sensations, or a mere placeholder for properties, Sellars holds the normal objects of perception are real full-bodied independent substances.

Although Sellars’ critical (or “referential”) realism is “built up from” common-sense realism, it is not identical with common sense since the latter has not faced the problems arising from discrepancies in perception (See his 1922c; 1924b; 1927b; 1927c; 1937a; 1938b; 1939b; 1959b; 1961a; 1962; 1963; 1970, 6-8, 13, 15-16, 17-27, 33-35, 161; see also Warren, 1975, 35, 37). Despite his defense of common sense realism,Sellars rejects the “naïve realism” that identifies the immediate datum of knowledge with objects in the world. He distinguishes between the common sense realism of the ordinary person and the crude philosophical understanding embodied in naïve realism, the view that in perception one actually “intuits” the object (1963; see also Warren, 1975, 36-7). In opposition to that naïve view, he holds that in perception one interprets one’s sensations. The interpretation of sensations is not a purely intellectual process: “A gull does not in the Lockean way apprehend his sensation …. [It] looks through his sensation at the fish in the water. It is a one-step sensi-motor process” (See his 1970a, 118; 1973, 49-50, 161; 1975; and Warren, 1975, 38-45!).

Sellars holds that the biological basis of knowledge consists in the organism’s adjustment to its external environment, where both the internal adjustment of the organism and external factors must be taken into account. He sees his version of critical realism as a “mediate realism” that attempts to do justice both to the contribution of the perceiving organism and the claims of objective knowledge. That is, he aims to do justice to both the real and the “ideal” sides of cognition. It is absolutely crucial, he (1922a, 76-77) stresses, to distinguish between the causal conditions of perception and the referential act of perceiving. Perception is the interpretation of sense mediated by factors both internal and external to the perceiving subject. These internal factors are not to be confused with the mechanism or processes that underlie perception (that is, the account of the internal mechanism or processes is not an account of the content of perception). By taking account of both the internal and external factors, he seeks to avoid the evils of both naïve realism and the non-realist view that the objects of perception are not independent of mind.

The attempt of simultaneous justice to both the subjective contribution of the organism and the claims of objective knowledge is no easy matter. Various critical realists could not always agree how best to formulate the view (See Ramsperger, 1967). For example, Sellars (1970a, 5) rejects the sort of critical realism espoused by Santayana that erects a barrier of essences between the perceiver and the external object. Perhaps his basic point is that human beings perceive independent objects with their sensations, but do not perceive sensations, essences, or other mental or ideal intermediaries themselves (Warren, 1975, 38, 42). Sellars (1970a, 114-5) stresses that the fact that the object is present to consciousness does not mean that it must be present within consciousness.

Although Sellars’ sometimes wrote as if his version of critical realism is definitive,few agree that it is unproblematic. Since he acknowledges the subjective contribution of the perceiver, it can resemble representationalism. Since, however, he emphasizes that perception is a direct perception of independent objects, it can resembles naïve realism. Sellars counters that critical realism is the view that human knowing is a direct knowledge of objects, but that this knowledge is mediated by “logical ideas” (See his 1970a, 113 and the “Epilogue on Berkeley” in his 1968). The problem is that it is hard to see how knowledge can be both mediated and direct. The claim that one perceives independent objects via one’s sensations but does not perceive those sensations themselves is a fair negative point, but seems to require a more robust positive account of the precise role of sensations in the perception of external objects. Sellars’ version of critical realism is intriguing, but many feel it requires further clarification (Chisholm 1955; Herbert, 1994; Wright, 1994; Levine, 2007).Perhaps this is why Sellars continued to return to the issue again and again over the decades (See his 1929a; 1929b; 1929c; 1937a; 1938b; 1939b; 1950a; 1961a; 1962; 1963; 1965; 1969d, Ch’s 4-5; 1970a, 112-131; and so forth).

3. Evolutionary Naturalism

Sellars does not have a fully developed philosophy of science, this being more characteristic of his son’s generation, but he does have definite views about scientific method and about the close relation of science to philosophy, some of which do anticipate his son’s views. Sellars’ conception of science and its relation to philosophy is intimately related to his own views of evolutionary naturalism.

In Sellars’ (1973, 160-1) view, science “builds” on common sense, but it develops new concepts based on new instruments and the application of mathematics to experience, and so forth. He rejects the monochrome Newtonian universe in favor of an evolution-generated hierarchy of different levels of emergent causality: Under certain favorable conditions, life emerges from matter and mind from life (See his 1920c; 1922a, Ch. IX; 1924a; 1927a; 1933a; 1944b; 1959a; 1932, 4; 1969d, 64-68; and 1973, 290). He is committed to the emergence of downward causal forces. That is, while the emergence of higher-order entities is causally dependent upon lower-order entities (bottom-up causation), once they emerge, the former may causally influence the latter (top-down causation) in ways not reducible to bottom-up causation (see Roy’s 1970, 38, 44-46 and Meehl and Sellars 1956). Sellars insists that the higher emergent entities are still material systems.

Although he does not deny the possibility of reductions in special cases, his conception of science is generally anti-reductionist (1922a, 16, 332; 1970, 136, 141, 240-1; Warren, 1975, 29).This explains why he holds that the scientific method cannot be identified with that of any particular science, such as physics (Warren, 1975, 29). When he (1932a, 5) describes his own view as physicalism, he does not mean physicalism in the more familiar sense but a view that accepts his own critical realism and emergence. Each of the sciences; natural, psychological, and social, treats of a particular domain in the emergent hierarchy, but none is privileged over the others.

The commitment to real independent substances in his critical realism dovetails with his evolutionary naturalism. The different levels in the emergent hierarchy are not just of events or properties, but of substances (1922a, Ch. XIII; 1932a, Ch. XII; 1943c; 1959a; 1970, 215). Though the higher emergent levels are not reducible to material mechanisms, they do not introduce new non-natural forces. Life and mind are not non-natural forces entering nature from outside, but emergent capacities of natural substances (See his 1917b, 276-283; 1922a, vii-ix, 277-278, 333-336; 1933a; 1950b). See Emmet (1932, 222-23) for Whitehead’s very different Platonistic view)!

Sellars tends not to employ the classical formulation of emergence, that certain wholes are “greater than the sum of their parts”. He (1922a, 302) does, however, use such formulations occasionally. See also his remarks on the relations of wholes and parts (1917a, 31, 145, 288). Since he talks of new unitary substantial wholes, talk of separable “parts” may be seen as misleading.Wilfrid Sellars (1949) clarifies his father’s somewhat obscure views. In general, however, in language reminiscent of Bergson but understood naturalistically, Sellars (1922a, viii, 17, 139, 167, 214-215, 297, 303, 322, 335, and so forth; 1932a, 3, 401; Blitz 2010) holds that modern science is beginning to accept the notion of “creative synthesis”, the view that change sometimes involves “the genesis of what Locke called ‘real essences’”.For a discussion of the classical part-whole formulations of emergence see McDonough (2002).

Agential causality, which is central to Sellars’ ethics, is underwritten by his evolutionary naturalism (1970a, 262-267). Agential causality emerges at a certain level of evolution and organization (1970a, viii; 1973a, Ch. 15). Human beings possess no “pushbutton free will,” but rather, an emergent capacity of the human brain is able to develop new judgments and standards that make a causal difference in behaviour (1932a, 396, 405; 1957a; 1959a; 1970a, 305; 1973a, 290-1, 361-384). He called his view “critical anthropomorphism” (1917b, 278).

Sellars’ evolutionary naturalism colors his view of the relation between science and philosophy. The diversity of the various irreducible levels in the emergent hierarchy requires a diversity of distinct autonomous sciences: physics, chemistry, biology, and so forth. This yields problems with which none of the special sciences are prepared to deal. The physicist can describe the behaviour of subatomic particles, but, qua physicist, is unfamiliar with the regularities and properties at higher levels in the emergent hierarchy. Similar points, in reverse, can be made about the biologist (psychologist, sociologist, and so forth), who are familiar with the objects at their higher levels of the hierarchy, but qua biologist, psychologist, sociologist, and so forth, are unfamiliar with the laws and properties at the lower levels. Since, however, the evolutionary naturalist holds that the different levels in the emergent hierarchy constitute autonomous regions that fall outside any of the particular sciences, and since the items at different levels of the emergent hierarchy are linked in interesting ways that cannot be captured by reductions of one level to another, knowledge of the interrelations between these levels requires a different sort of knowledge, not possessed by any of the special sciences.

It is the distinctive job of the philosopher to obtain an overview of the relations between the different sciences, and between the sciences and the common sense framework, harmonize the new levels in the emergent hierarchy with each other and with the more stable and fixed background of inorganic nature (1922a, 263, 329; 1932a, 44ff, 79ff, 92ff). Thus, philosophy completes science. “The job of philosophy is to size up the whole situation; and it often needs new leads” (1973, 161).One can see here the general outlines of his son’s (1991, 2, 18-19, 34, and so forth) view, that the distinctive job of philosophy is to obtain a synoptic view of the way things hang together, in the broadest sense.

Sellars published Evolutionary Naturalism in 1922, a year before both Morgan’s Emergent Evolution and Alexander’s “Natural Piety” (Warren, 1970, vi), although the latter two came to be better known for the formulation of emergent evolution. Warren (1973b) remarks that Morgan told Sellars that to his knowledge, Sellars was the first to publish on emergent evolution. Bergson’s Creative Evolution, first published in 1907, does precede Sellars’ publications, but it differs in that it posits the non-scientific élan vital. Sellars saw his position as more systematic, empirical, and naturalistic than Bergson’s and Morgan’s since it does not introduce any non-natural controlling factors. Although Sellars’ evolutionary naturalism fell out of favor as reductionism gained ground, emergentism has once again arisen as a viable position in science, philosophy and religion (Beckermann, Kim, and Flores 1992; Hasker 2001; McDonough 2002; Davies and Clayton 2008, Blitz 2010; Vintiadis, and so forth).

4. Organicism

Although Sellars (1991, 415, 433) states that no other writer in recent times had challenged him as much, he claims that his own view deserves the title “philosophy of organism” more than Whitehead’s. This is because Sellars sees living organisms as substantial wholes, whereas Whitehead sees them as a societies or nexuses of more fundamental entities. Sellars (1922a, vii-ix, 164-168) sees an organism as a product of emergent evolution in which simpler materials at a lower level are organized into new integrated substances with new causal powers at higher levels in the hierarchy. This higher-order substance is a true unity and not, as for Whitehead, a plurality (see Roy’s 1961b).

The living organism is, for Sellars, the background against which consciousness must be understood (1922a, 63, 298; 1932a, 446-7; 1949b, 95, 99). This leads him (1991, 415; 1970, 205) to agree with contemporaneous developments in physics, chemistry, biology, and psychology that emphasize fields and Gestalten, both of which are wholes that are not reducible to more fundamental entities. Even so, the focus on the important organismic background should not lead one to confuse knowledge of the object with knowledge about the organism (1922a, 186-187). For similar reasons, he does not see a person as a combination of two separable substances as in Cartesian Dualism. He (1991, 415) describes his own position, which rejects the vitalistic and non-evolutionary elements in classical Aristotelianism, as an “Aristotelianism of the Left”. The same considerations lead him (1932a, 14-15; 1961b; 1973, 354-56; 1991, 416-7) to oppose the “reformed subjectivism” which he saw as the source both of the Platonism and rejection of naturalism and humanism in Whitehead’s philosophy of organism.

5. Value Theory

Sellars’ evolutionary naturalism make values “centripetal” to human life and supports a humanistic theory of ethics and religion (1932a, 448; 1948b; 1949b, 78; 973, Ch. 14), all of which he counts as a virtue He holds that human freedom emerges at a certain level or organization of organic development and lends a dignity and meaning to human life that is absent in a purely mechanical cosmos (1957a; 1949b, 103-4; 1970, 319-331). Whereas the “old materialism” had been criticized as being unable to accommodate higher values, Sellars sees it as a virtue of his “new materialism” that it “flowers into humanism” (See also his 1932a, 19; 1944b; 1950b, 427-428). The emergence of living organisms from inorganic nature is a necessary condition for the existence of a world of values (1932a, 446-7). It is people and human institutions that form the “hot center” of conscious life, while the inorganic world forms the “periphery and yet absolute condition for the whole drama” (1932a, 450).

Sellars is generally averse to ontological dualisms (1916a, 204, 245; 1922, 3091973a, Ch. 14; see also Sellars, McGill, and Farber, 1949) and holds they have done particular damage in value theory (see Roy’s 1917b, Ch. XVI; 1918, Ch. XII and Ch. XVI; 1921a; 1950b; Warren, 1975, 27, 41-2). In general, he holds that each side in value-dualisms captures some fragment of the truth, but in their pure forms such dualisms are incapable of yielding a coherent theory of value. Whereas some theories emphasize the objective basis, and others the subjective basis, for values, Sellars’ aims to do justice both “to the possibilities in the object and in the subject,” while taking “as objective a view of value as possible” (1932a, 445, 475; 1969d, Ch. 12). He sees this as an area where compromise and balance are essential. Value judgments are similar to cognitive judgments in some ways, but different in others. One can make mistakes in value judgments just as in cognitive judgments, but physical science does not discover values as properties of objects (1932a, 445; 1973, 344). Rather, values are an interpretation of objects as having the capacity to affect human life in ways important to an individual or group (1932a, 445, 459-473; Warren 1975, 40).

In cognitive judgments, human beings regard themselves as disclosing the object itself, while in value judgments human beings are estimating the object with respect to its bearing on human life (1932a, 46).When the subjectivist claims that values are based on feelings, Sellars agrees, but holds that these subjective feelings are directed towards facts that can be objectively criticized. When the objectivist claims that values are based on objective facts, Sellars agrees, but holds that these facts only have value when “estimated with respect to human living” (1932a, 444). In valuing we are constrained by objective factors just as in perceiving, but we are also “interpreting” the object in the light of factors which are taken to be intimately linked to the self (1932a, 471; 1970, 244, 253, and so forth). It is important to acknowledge that Sellars (1922a, 29-30, 194-5, 312; and see and Wood, 1950, 525) does see the need for a kind of dualism in epistemology.

Sellars subjects “absolutism” and “factualism” about values to similar criticisms. He (1932a, 457-459) rejects belief in absolute or intrinsic values since “a good which is not good for someone strikes me as meaningless”. He (1932a, 16ff) describes “Eleatic views” that deny the significance of everyday beliefs as versions of “illusionism”. Similarly, when the “factualist” attempts to reduce values to some fact about human beings or human groups, for example, the fact that human beings prefer certain things and not others, Sellars (1932a, 452-3; 1970a, 245) replies that people are not like stones with only one possible reaction. That is, alluding to his critique of “naïve realism”, these various “facts” are always really only some naïve immediate value (1932a,452). Even if some authority, for example, a church or an anthropologist, holds X is good, it is always possible to criticize that naïve immediate valuation by estimating its effect on human life. No authority, neither religious nor “scientific”, is immune to criticism.

Sellars (1932a, 446-7) stresses that “the background” to judgments of value is the emergent level of living organisms presupposed by the existence of value.Since an organism emerges from inorganic nature in the evolutionary process, his evolutionary naturalism is an essential part of his account of the genesis of the complex subject-object situations required for the existence of value (1922a, Ch. XV; 1932a, 68, 442; 1970a, 248-9, 267). Referring to his “open ended” emergent evolutionism (1970a, 267), he states that his “metaphysics of ethics in many ways represents its culmination” and that any attempt to explain the existence of value by reference to mere lifeless nature cannot succeed (1973, 359-60).

Sellars’ evolutionary naturalism is not just another version of materialism, but is enriched by his belief in the evolution of an emergent hierarchy containing the higher levels organisms and persons (1950b, 420, 422-6; 1970a, 154-173). His naturalism “does not,” as some older versions of materialism, focused only on the physical sciences, did, “ignore the specialized areas of human living, morals, art, politics” (1932a, 449). Because man is “not just a knower but an agent” and a “desirer of good things”, the philosopher, in order to avoid an overly narrow conception of the human situation, must turn to the poets for a sense of “creative agency and decision” (1932a, 449).

6. Socialism

In The Next Step in Democracy (1916b) Sellars defends his own version of socialism (See also his 1970a, 272-73, 277-79, 289, 311, 334). Sellars distinguishes three stages of socialism: (1) the Utopian socialism of Fourier and Saint-Simon, (2) the “political socialism” that began with Marx’s Communist Manifesto, and (3) the later modification of Marx’s socialism based on an updated understanding of how society and people really work (1944-45b; 1970a, 272). The political socialism of Marx is called “scientific socialism” by its admirers, “orthodox socialism” by its critics (1970a, 279ff).

Sellars also rejects Utopian socialism as naïve and romantic, having little understanding of the obstacles to the creation of a genuine socialist society (1970a, 81). In contrast to the Utopian socialists, Sellars promotes a gradual modification of existing institutions in the light of new scientific advances with a full awareness that any “reckless unsettling” of the social foundations leads to disaster (1970a, 280, 292-293). Sellars rejected the program to overthrow tradition on the basis of naïve romantic dreams of wishful thinking.

Although Sellars (1970a, 28-287) sees Marx as a fairly realistic and concrete “sort”, he holds that Marx was misled by revolutionary ardour into seeing history as a constant war of class struggle. Sellars, by contrast, sees the Marxian stage of socialism, not so much scientific as realistic, but he thinks Marxist realism (the recognition that the old order will not easily give way to rational persuasion) led to the introduction of a dangerous militancy into socialism. Further, whereas many saw Marx’s determinism as a strength, Sellars takes Marx’s view that capitalist society contains the seeds of its own destruction as empirically falsified (1970a, 308). Further, Marx underestimated the ability of capitalism to make adjustments (1970a, 284, 286, 307-8; 1944-45b). Sellars (1970a, 287, 303-304) replaces Marx’s “semi-mechanical and almost wholly deterministic” outlook by the view that the people must learn to emancipate themselves by participation in the political process. Participation in the democratic process requires the development of the necessary virtues: cooperation and ingenuity, the application of continuous experiments to find out what works best, the determination and patience to approach the ultimate goal by slow degrees (1970a, 287). Whereas Marx seems to absolve the individual of responsibility for the eventual outcome by representing the march towards the goal as the inevitable result of the great supra-individual forces of history, Sellars (1971a, 333-334) emphasizes the essential educative role of the individuals participation in the process that renders the individual prepared for and worthy of the final goal. Although Sellars was sometimes seen as a radical in his day (1970a, 272), he defines socialism as a democratic movement whose aim is to secure the greatest justice and liberty for the maximum number of people at any given time, without the wholesale overturning of tradition by violent methods (1943d). In opposition to the militant socialism of old, he presents a moderate democratic recipe for achieving socialist goals via “rational reform” while escaping the “vicious dialectic of hate and counter-hate” (1970a, 291, 304). Progress cannot be achieved by one side imposing its view on the whole but by the “interplay” of conservatives on the one side and liberals on the other that the direction and speed of social progress is determined” (1916b, 3; 1970a, 307-308).

7. The Humanist Manifesto

Early in his studies, Sellars considered a career in comparative religion, but with his usual idiosyncratic twist, he wished to do so from a scientific, humanistic, and atheistic point of view. In Evolutionary Naturalism, he describes the religious impulse as “one of the most admirable … in human nature” (1922, 5; see also his 1918, 26 and his 1969a, Ch. 11), but he also holds that religion must be “brought to the world disclosed through science” (1918, 44-45, 222; see also Warren 1975, 24-25).Given his naturalism, the appeal to supernatural entities and explanations must be eliminated and replaced by an emphasis on human flourishing as citizens of a shared world (Wilson, 1995, Ch. 17). Whereas religions traditionally conceived salvation as something that comes to man from the outside, Sellars (1918, 12) sees it as something that must arise out of the “loyal union” of human beings who share a belief in the values of life. Traditional religions also often see creation as completed, meaning that a person’s job is merely to understand the pattern in order to follow it, Sellars (1947), reflecting Bergson’s influence, holds that people must learn to recognize creation as “a going concern,” in which their contribution to the further emergence of the universe is essential.

In 1932, Sellars was approached by Raymond Bragg on behalf of a Chicago-based group of humanists associated with The New Humanist (for which Bragg was an associate editor). The group had for some time been contemplating the need for an official statement of the religious humanist position, but recognizing the difficulties inherent in group authorship, chose to have a complete first draft written by a single author. After hearing him lecture in Chicago, Bragg approached Sellars about the project and Sellars accepted with the unanimous support of the Chicago group. The document published in the following year, the Humanist Manifesto of 1933 (or Humanist Manifesto I), is the result of numerous revisions by multiple contributors upon Sellars’ original draft. While that draft has been lost to history, the fact that Sellars signed the 1933 document, and later-on claimed primary authorship of it, suggests that whatever changes were made did not, in his mind, affect the substance of what he had written. For these reasons it has Sellars as the pre-eminent author of the Manifesto, although that is not to minimize the contributions of others.

In the Manifesto, Sellars attempts to put the essence of his religious humanism into a form suitable not just for fellow professors, but for the general public. It is important to remember that along with many of the original signers of the Humanist Manifesto I, Sellars conceived of humanism not as a replacement for religion but as a new religion (1918, Ch. XVI; 1969d, Ch. 11; Wilson 1995, Ch. 17). Nevertheless, his naturalized religion shades inevitably into a this-worldly humanist philosophy that, he (1932a, 7) holds, attempts to blend “those two great naturalists, Spinoza and Nietzsche, uniting the passion for life of the one with the cosmic calm of the other.”

Humanist Manifesto I was conceived as the statement of a new secular religion designed to replace the old religions that had been founded on claims of supernatural revelation, or on fear and helplessness (1918c, Foreword). It opposes an acquisitive and profit-motivated society, and outlines a mutually cooperative worldwide society committed to the rational resolution of problems. Thirty-four of sixty-five persons asked to sign did, including Edwin Burtt of Cornell, and John Dewey and John Hermann Randall of Columbia. About one-third of the signatories were professors from the University of Chicago and from Columbia University; about half were Unitarians (Wilson 1995, Ch. 10).

The Manifesto contains fifteen theses (briefly summarized here):

The universe is self-existing, not created.
Man is a part of nature that has emerged in a continuous process.
Since humanists hold an organic view of life, they reject the traditional mind-body dualism.
Man’s religious culture is a result of gradual natural development as a result of man’s interaction with the natural environment and social heritage.
Science has shown that supernatural and cosmic guarantors of human values are unsupported, so religion must re-formulate its views in the light of scientific knowledge.
Theism, modernism, and other varieties of “new thought” have been surpassed.
The distinction between the secular and the religious cannot be defended any longer: Nothing that is human is alien to religion.
The purpose of man’s life is the complete realization of the possibilities in human personality.
Humanists find their religious feelings expressed in an intensified sense of their personal lives and the cooperative effort to produce social well-being.
There are no uniquely religious emotions connected with the supernatural.
Man must discourage sentimental hopes and wishful thinking and face the challenges of life by embracing rational procedures.
Religious humanists aim to enhance the creative element in man in order to add to produce a more meaningful life.
All social associations should exist for the promotion of human flourishing.
A socialized cooperative economic system must be established for the fair distribution of the necessities of life to all human beings.
Religious humanists seek to affirm human life rather than deny it, seek to discover the full possibilities of life, not run from them, and aim to establish the conditions of a just and meaningful life for all, not just the privileged few.

For a complete statement of the theses, see Sellars (1970a, 331-335).

Some humanists declined to sign Manifesto I. Dr. Arthur Morgan stated several differences of emphasis, but also some more substantial objections (Wilson 1995, Ch. 7). Anticipating recent views in “deep ecology” (See Sessions, 1995), Morgan felt that Manifesto I placed too much emphasis on human life and failed to recognize that there may be significance in other life-forms. Morgan called for a “race of businessmen” which sees business as a public trust, not a means to personal enrichment, and he objected to the “unjustified cocksureness” of Manifesto I, feeling that it is “not dictated by humility or imagination”. Morgan also felt that though religion should be disciplined by science, it should not be limited by it. His most biting criticism was that many humanists are “not strong in faith, hope, and love.”

John Haynes Holmes, the prominent Unitarian minister and noted pacifist, declined to sign Manifesto I since he objected to the rejection of theism in the 6^th thesis, holding instead that a rational humanism “inevitably unfolds into a rational theism” (Wilson 1995,Ch. 7). He also found terms like “modernism,” in the 6^th thesis “hopelessly vague” and wondered why a humanist could not claim to represent the best of modernism. Although he found the deism of some of the authors “not half bad,” he insists that “Theism … is the blossom that grows on the plant of humanism, the poetry into which it unfolds in mystic beauty”.

Howard Shapley, a Harvard astronomer, spoke for many scientists who were reluctant to make judgments about religion: “As a social philosopher I am embryonic and I have decided that I should not misuse my position by pretending to intelligence or comprehension in a field in which my thoughts have been too scattered and probably too prejudiced” (Wilson 1995, Ch. 7). Although Shapley agrees with current traditions of protecting the weak, he is not sure that this is in keeping with “the biological traditions of the planet”. His point is not that the weak should not be protected, but that, as a scientist, he cannot claim to know this, and, therefore, he should not put his authority as a scientist behind the claim.

In his retrospective on Humanist Manifesto I, Wilson remarks that he now feels it to be a mistake to tie humanism directly to socialism. Humanism should not be tied to any particular economic system, but should concern itself with the more general goals of ending disease, poverty, ignorance, prejudice, and so forth (Wilson 1995, Ch. 18).

Later versions of the Manifesto found their own objections. Humanist Manifesto II found the language in Manifesto I to be “far too optimistic” about the possibility of eliminating social evils. Frances Schaeffer (2005) authored A Christian Manifesto (in opposition to the Communist Manifesto) which holds that both the humanist and communist Manifestos, despite significant differences between them, tend to foster similar forms of social degeneration. Schaeffer sees humanism as the unfortunate view that man is the measure of all things, and holds that even if that is not the humanist’s intention Manifesto I undermines the ideals of objective truth and morality. One major difference between Manifesto I and later humanist Manifestos and statements is that Manifesto I arose out of religious humanism (1918, Ch. XVI), and was, accordingly, much more sympathetic to religion per se than these later documents.

The objections by various humanists, both earlier and later, to signing Humanist Manifesto I show just how difficult it is to obtain agreement on such a central issue from such a diverse group of intellectuals representing different fields and backgrounds. Nevertheless, despite the various objections and reservations to Manifesto I, and the various replacement manifestos and declarations that appeared in later years, Manifesto I remains a significant historical document in the genesis of the humanist movement, and one that Sellars, who, it is probably fair to say, is “the principal author” of the published version, played an fundamental role in creating.

8. References and Further Reading

Several of Roy Wood Sellars’ works can be obtained in electronic form at The Internet Archive, The Autodidact Project and the online library of The Secular Web. Additional information on the various versions of the Humanist Manifestos and The Amsterdam Declaration is available online from the International Humanist and Ethical Union, the American Humanist Association, and the Council for Secular Humanism.

a. Primary Sources

Sellars, Roy Wood. 1902. “Re-interpretation of Democracy.” Inlander (University of Michigan publication), 12: 252-61.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1907a. “The Nature of Experience.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods: 14-18.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1907b. “A Fourth Progression in the Relation of Body and Mind.” Psychological Review 14: 315-28.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1907c. “Professor Dewey’s View of Agreement.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 4 (16): 315-28.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1908a. “An Important Antinomy.” Psychological Review 15 (4): 237-249.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1908b. “Consciousness and Conservation.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 5 (9): 235-38.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1908c. “Critical Realism and the Time Problem I.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 5 (20): 542-48.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1908d. “Critical Realism and the Time Problem II.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 5 (27): 597-602.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1909a. “Causality.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 6: 323-28.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1909b. “Space.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods. 6: 617-23.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1912. “Is There a Cognitive Relation?” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 9 (9): 225-328.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1915. “A Thing and its Properties.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 12 (12): 318-28.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1916a. Critical Realism: A Study of the Nature and Conditions of Knowledge. Chicago: Rand-McNally and Co.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1916b. The Next Step in Democracy. New York: Macmillan.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1917a. The Essentials of Logic. Boston: Houghton Mifflin Co.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1917b. The Essentials of Philosophy. New York: Macmillan.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1918a. “An Approach to the Mind-Body Problem.” Philosophical Review 27 (2): 150-63.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1918b. “On the Nature of Our Knowledge of the External World.” Philosophical Review 27 (5): 502-12.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1918c. The Next Step in Religion. New York: Macmillan.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1918d. “Review of P. Coffey, Epistemology, Journal of Philosophy,” Psychology and Scientific Methods 15: 557-8.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1919a. “The Epistemology of Evolutionary Naturalism.” Mind 28 (112): 407-26.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1919b. “Review of George Wobbermin, Christian Belief in God.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 16: 277-9.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1920a. “The Status of Categories.” The Monist 30 (2): 220-39.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1920b. “Space and Time.” The Monist 30 (3): 321-64.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1920c. “Evolutionary Naturalism and the Mind-Body Problem.” The Monist 30 (4): 568-98.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1920d. “Knowledge and Its Categories.” Essays in Critical Realism, R.W. Sellars, Durant Drake, A.O. Lovejoy, James Pratt, Arthur Rogers, George Santayana, (ed’s). New York: Macmillan: 187-219.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1920e. “Review of J. A. Leighton, The Field of Philosophy.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 17: 79-81.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1920f. “Preface.” to Evolution of Values, Helen Maud Sellars, (trans.). New York: Henry Holt.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1921a. “Epistemological Dualism versus Metaphysical Dualism.” Philosophical Review 30 (5): 482-93.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1921b. “The Requirement of an Adequate Naturalism.” The Monist 31 (2): 249-70.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1922a. Evolutionary Naturalism. Chicago: Open Court.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1922b. “Is Consciousness Physical?” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 19 (25): 690-94.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1922c. “Concerning ‘Transcendence’ and ‘Bifurcation'” Mind 31 (121): 31-39.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1923a. “Le Cerveau, L’âme et La Conscience.” Bulletin de la Société Francais de Philosophie: 1-14.
Sellars, Roy Wood. January, 1923b (some sources say 1922). “The Double Knowledge Approach to the Mind-Body Problem.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, N.S. 23: 55-70 (reprinted in Principles of Emergent Realism: 188-201).
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1924a. “The Emergence of Naturalism.” International Journal of Ethics 34 (4): 309-38.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1924b. “Critical Realism and Its Critics.” Philosophical Review 33 (4): 379-97.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1926a. The Principles and Problems of Philosophy. New York: Macmillan.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1926b. “Cognition and Valuation,” Philosophical Review 35 (2): 124-44.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1927a. “Realism and Evolutionary Naturalism: A Reply to Professor Hoernlé.” The Monist. 37 (1): 150-55.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1927b. “Current Realism in Great Britain and the United States.” The Monist 37 (4): 503-520.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1927c. “What is the Correct Interpretation of Critical Realism?,” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 24 (9): 238-241.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1927d. “Why Naturalism and Not Materialism?,” Philosophical Review 36 (3): 215-25.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1928a. Religion Coming of Age. New York: Macmillan.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1928b. “Current Realism in Great Britain and the United States.” Philosophy Today Edward L. Schaub, (ed.). Chicago and London (reprint from The Monist, 1927): 19-36.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1929a. “Current Realism.” Anthology of Recent Philosophy D. S. Robinson, (ed.). New York: Thomas Y. Crowell Co. (re-print from Philosophy Today): 279-290.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1929b. “A Re-examination of Critical Realism.” Philosophical Review 38 (5): 439-55.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1929c. “Critical Realism and Substance.” Mind 38 (152): 473-88. Reprinted in Ruth Goff, (ed.). 2008. Revitalizing Causality: Realism About Causality in Philosophy and Social Science. New York: Routledge: 13-25.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1930a. “A Naturalistic Interpretation of Religion.” The New Humanist 3 (4): 1-4.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1930b. “Realism, Naturalism and Humanism.” in Contemporary American Philosophy G. P. Adams and W. P. Montague, v. 2. (eds.), New York: Macmillan: 261-85.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1931. “Humanism, Viewed and Reviewed.” The New Humanist 4 (15): 12-16.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1932a. The Philosophy of Physical Realism. New York: Macmillan.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1932b. “Reinterpretation of Relativity.” Philosophical Review 41 (5): 517-18.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1933a. “L’Hypothèse de l’Émergence.” Revue de Métaphysique et de Morale 40 (3): 309-24.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1933b. “Religious Humanism.” The New Humanist 6 (3): 7-12.
Sellars, Roy Wood (Drafter and co-signer). May-June, 1933c. “Humanist Manifesto.” The New Humanist 6 (3): 58-61.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1933d. “In Defense of the Manifesto.” The New Humanist 6 (6): 6-12.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1933e. “Review of Durant Drake, Introduction to Philosophy.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 3: 667-9.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1934. “Nature and Naturalism.” The New Humanist 7 (2): 1-8.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1935a. “Review of C. F. Gauss, Primer for Tomorrow.” Michigan Alumnus Quarterly Review. 41: 465-6.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1935b. “George S. Morris.” Dictionary of American Biography 13: 208-9.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1937a. “Critical Realism and the Independence of the Object.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 34 (20): 541-550.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1937b. “Henry Philip Tappan.” Dictionary of American Biography 18: 302-3.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1938a. “An Analytic Approach to the Mind-Body Problem.” Philosophical Review 47 (5): 461-87.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1938b. “A Statement of Critical Realism.” Revue Internationale de Philosophie 3: 472-496.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1939a. “Positivism in Contemporary Philosophical Thought.” American Sociological Review: 26-42.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1939b. “A Clarification of Critical Realism.” Philosophy of Science 6 (4): 412-92.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1940. “Knowledge and its Categories.” The Development of American Philosophy, W. G. Muelder and Laurence Sears, (ed’s). Cambridge, Mass: 431-40 (Reprinted from Drake, Durant. 1920. Essays in Critical Realism. New York: Gordian Press: 187-219)
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1941a. “Humanism as a Religion.” The Humanist 1 (1): 5-8.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1941b. “A Correspondence Theory of Truth.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 38 (24): 653-54.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1942a. “Aspects of Democracy II: the Quality of Democracy.” Michigan Alumnus Quarterly Review 48: 98-103.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1942b. “Galileo Galilei.” Michigan Alumnus Quarterly Review 48: 301-7.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1942c. “Review of E. Gilson, God and Philosophy.” The Humanist 2: 36-7.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1942-43. “Dewey on Materialism.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 3 (4): 381-92.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1943a. “Science , Philosophy, and Religion.” The Humanist 3: 84-5.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1943b. “Verification of Categories: Existence and Substance” Journal of Philosophy 40 (8): 197-205.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1943c. “Causality and Substance.” Philosophical Review.”. 52 (1): 1-27 (Reprinted in Ruth Goff, (ed.). 2008. Revitalizing Causality: Realism About Causality in Philosophy and Social Science. New York: Routledge: 26-45).
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1943d. “Reason and Revolution,” Michigan Alumnus Quarterly Review 49: 212-14.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1943e. “Review of J. Maritain, Education at the Cross Roads.” The Humanist 3: 165-70.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1944a. “Causation and Perception.” Philosophical Review 53 (6): 534-56.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1944b. “Reformed Materialism and Intrinsic Endurance.” Philosophical Review. 53: 359-82.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1944c. “Is Naturalism Enough?” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 41 (September): 533-44.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1944d. “Does Naturalism Need Ontology?” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 41 (25): 686-94.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1944e. “Can a Reformed Materialism Do Justice to Values?” Ethics 55 (1): 28-45.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1944-45a. “The Meaning of True and False.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 5 (1): 98-103.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1944-45b. “Reflections on Dialectical Materialism.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 5 (2): 157-79.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1944-45c. “Knowing and Knowledge.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 5 (3): 341-344.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1944-45d. “Knowing through Propositions.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 5 (3): 348-9.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1945-46. “Review of Yervant Krikorian, Naturalism and the Human Spirit.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 6: 436-9.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1946a. “A Note on the Theory of Relativity.” Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods 43 (12): 309-17.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1946b. “Materialism and Relativity: A Semantic Analysis.” Philosophical Review 55 (1): 25-51.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1946c. “Philosophy and Physics of Relativity.” Philosophy of Science 13 (3): 177-95.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1946-47. “Positivism and Materialism.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 7 (1): 12-40.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1947. “Accept the Universe as a Going Concern.” Religious Liberals Reply Henry Wieman, (ed.). Boston: Beacon Press.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1948a. “Do the Natural Sciences Have a Need of the Social Sciences?,” Philosophy of Science 15 (2): 104-8.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1948b. “Naturalistic Humanism.” Religion in the Twentieth Century Vergilius Ferm, (ed.). New York: Littlefield and Adams (later edition date 1958): 415-31.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1948c. “Review of A. N. Whitehead, Essays in Science and Philosophy.” The Humanist 8: 92-3.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1949a. “Social Philosophy and the American Scene.” Philosophy for the Future R. W. Sellars, V. J. McGill, and M. Farber, (ed.’s). New York: Macmillan: 61-75.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1949b. “Materialism and Human Knowing.” Philosophy for the Future R. W. Sellars, V. J. McGill, and M. Farber, (ed’s). New York: Macmillan: 75-106.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1949c. “Resume of W. Cook Foundation Lectures.” (delivered by Ralph Barton Perry), Michigan Alumnus Quarterly Review 55: 185-94.
Sellars, Roy Wood, McGill, V.J., Farber, Marvin. 1949. Forward to Philosophy for the Future, R. W. Sellars, V. J. McGill, and M. Farber, (ed’s). New York: Macmillan: v-xii.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1949-50. “Review of Leslie A. White, The Science of Culture.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 10: 586-7.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1950a. “Critical Realism and Modern Materialism.” Philosophical Thought in France and the United States, Marvin Farber, (ed.). Buffalo: The University of Buffalo Publications: 463-82.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1950b. “The New Materialism.” A History of Philosophical Systems V. Ferm, (ed.). New York: Philosophical Library: 418-28.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1950c. “Review of Frank Chapman Sharp, Good Will and Ill Will,” The Humanist. 10: 277-8
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1950d. “Review of Leslie A. White, The Science of Culture.” Michigan Alumnus Quarterly Review 56: 175-6.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1950-51. “The Spiritualism of Lavelle and Le Senne.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 11 (3): 386-93.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1951. “Professor Goudge’s Queries with Respect to Materialism.” Philosophical Review 60 (2): 243-8.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1951-52a. “Review of R. W. Boynton, Beyond Mythology.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 12: 146-8.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1951-52b. “Review of Charles Mayer, “Man: Mind or Matter.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 12: 436-42.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1952. “Le spiritualisme de Louis Lavelle et de René le sense.” Les Études Philosophiques 9(1/2): 30-40.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1955. “My Philosophical Position: A Rejoinder.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 16 (1): 72-97.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1956a. “Physical Realism and Relativity: Some Unfinished Business.” Philosophy of Science 23 (2): 75-81.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1956b. “Gestalt and Relativity: An Analogy.” Philosophy of Science 23 (4): 275-279.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1957a. “Guided Causality, Using Reason and ‘Free Will’.” Journal of Philosophy 54 (August): 485-93.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1957b. “Philosophical Orientation and Peace.” The Idea of War and Peace in Contemporary Philosophy Irving Louis Horowitz, (ed.). New York: vii-xx (The book was re-released by Literary Licensing Publisher in 2012).
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1959a. “Levels of Causality: The Emergence of Guidance and Reason in Nature.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 20 (1): 1-17.
Sellars, Roy Wood. January, 1959b. “Sensations as Guides to Perceiving.” Mind 68 (January): 2-15.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1959c. “‘True’ as Contextually Implying Correspondence.” Journal of Philosophy 56 (18): 712-22.
Sellars, Roy Wood; Lamont, Corliss; Otto, Max; Huxley, Julien; Williams, Gardner; Randall Jr; John Herman. 1959. A Humanist Symposium on Metaphysics. Journal of Philosophy 56 (2): 45-64.
Sellars, Roy Wood. October 1960. “Panpsychism or Evolutionary Materialism.” Philosophy of Science 27 (October): 229-50.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1961a. “Referential Transcendence.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 22 (1): 1-15.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1961b. “Querying Whitehead’s Framework.” Revue Internationale de Philosophie 56-57: 135-66.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1962. “American Critical Realism and British Theories of Sense Perception I and II.” Methodos: 61-108.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1963. “Direct, Referential Realism.” in Dialogue 2 (02): 135-43.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1965. “Existentialism, Realistic Empiricism, and Materialism.” Journal of Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 25 (3): 315-32.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1968. Lending a Hand to Hylas. Ann Arbor: Edward Brothers.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1969a. “A Possible Integration of Science and Philosophy,” Zygon 4 (3): 293-97
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1969b. “Some Questions and Suggestions: An Exposition,” Journal of Philosophy. 66 (24): 859-60
Sellars, R.W. 1969c. “Le naturalisme de Sellars,” Dialectica 23 (1): 79-80
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1969d. Reflections on American Philosophy from Within. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1970a. Principles of Emergent Realism. W. Preston Warren, (ed.) . St. Louis: Warren H. Green.
This book is really the best place to obtain an overview of R.W. Sellars’ writings with both extensive primary sources and commentary over the course of his development.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1970b. Social Patterns and Political Horizons. Nashville: Aurora Publishers.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1970c. Principles, Perspectives, and Problems of Philosophy. New York: Pageant Press International Corp.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1973a. Neglected Alternatives: Critical Essays by Roy Wood Sellars. William. Preston Warren, (ed.), Lewisburg: Bucknell University Press.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1973b. January-February. “Toward a New Humanist Manifesto.” The Humanist
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1973c. “Recollections of Marvin Farber.” In Phenomenology and Natural Existence, Dale Riepe, (ed.). Albany: State University of New York Press.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1975. Forward to William Preston Warren. Roy Wood Sellars. Boston: Twayne.
Sellars, Roy Wood. 1991. “Philosophy of Organism and Physical Realism”. The Philosophy of Alfred North Whitehead. Paul A. Schlipp, (ed.). LaSalle: Open Court: 407-433 (Original publication date, 1941).

b. Secondary Sources

Avery, Jon Henry. 1989. “An Analysis and Critique of Roy Wood Sellars’ Descriptive and Normative Theories of Religious Humanism.” PhD diss., The Iliff School of Theology and University of Denver.
Bahm, Archie, 1954. “Evolutionary Naturalism.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 15 (1): 1-12.
Baker, Richard R. 1950. “The Naturalism of Roy Wood Sellars,” New Scholasticism. 24 (1): 3-31.
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Bergson, Henri. 1998. Creative Evolution. Arthur Mitchell, (trans.). New York: Dover.
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Delaney, C. F. 1971. “Sellars and the Contemporary Mind-Body Problem,” The New Scholasticism 45: 245-68.
Emmet, Dorothy. 1932. Whitehead’s Philosophy of Organism. London: Macmillan.
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Gluck, Samuel E. 1971. Review of Norman Paul Melchert’s Realism, Materialism, and the Mind: The Philosophy of Roy Wood Sellars. Springfield, Illinois: Charles C. Thomas. Philosophy 46 (177): 281ff.
Grayling, A.C. 2003. Meditations for the Humanist: Ethics for a Secular Age. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Griffin, James Phillip, 1966. “Foundations of Ethical Value in the Philosophy of Roy Wood Sellars and William Temple.” PhD diss., Boston University.
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Warren, William Preston. 1975. Roy Wood Sellars. Boston: Twayne.
This book is probably the best sympathetic secondary source on R.W. Sellars’ views.
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Author Information

Richard McDonough
Email: rmm249@cornell.edu
Arium School of Arts & Sciences
Singapore

African Sage Philosophy

The Sage Philosophy Project began in the mid-1970s at the Department of Philosophy of the University of Nairobi Kenya. At the University, Henry Odera Oruka (1944-1995) popularized the term “Sage Philosophy Project,” and closely related terms such as “philosophic sagacity,” both by initiating a project of interviewing African sages, and by naming this project in a widely read popular article as the most promising of four trends of the relatively new field of African philosophy.

This encyclopedia article focuses primarily on Oruka and his immediate sources of inspiration, and then includes others whose projects share similar methodologies and goals.

Although the definition of the key terms is not always completely uniform, at the heart of this approach to African philosophy lies the emphasis on academically-trained philosophy students and professors interviewing non-academic wise persons whom Oruka called “sages,” and then engaging philosophically with the interview material. Oruka usually (but not always) emphasized keeping the identity of the individual sage well known. He also insisted that it was the sage who knew the traditions of his or her ethnic group the best, and who would be able to have critical distance to evaluate and sometimes reject prevailing beliefs and practices. The goals of collecting the interviews and evaluating them have been articulated in Oruka’s many works. The first goal was to help construct texts of indigenous African philosophies. Before Oruka’s project there was a dearth of existing texts and a need to record indigenous ideas, both for posterity (that is, for a sense of identity and for historical reasons) and for the present and future. African wisdom that had been marginalized by academia, and by city life, could provide valuable solutions to contemporaneous problems in Africa. Such texts of interviews could also sustain intellectual curiosity and provide practical guidance (or phronesis).

Oruka searched for sages and wanted a wider public to know not only their words (written down in transcripts) but also about their lives. For him, a sage’s worth was not only in their ideas but also in the way they live: by embodying their philosophies, developing their character, and affecting their communities over the years. After all, the sages in Kenya operate in contexts of social conflict and exploitation. Sages are those from whom others seek moral and metaphysical advice and consultation on issues involving moral and psychological attitudes and judgments.Oruka looked to the term japaro in Luo, meaning “thinker,” to approximate the translation of sage. The term japaro is closely related to jang’ ad rieko which means “professional advisor.” He emphasized that people would single out sages for advice on even the most delicate matters.

Oruka Biography and Early Writings
Sage Philosophy in Philosophical Context
Beginning Interviews in Kenya
Relationship to the Hallen-Sodipo Study
Folk Sages and Philosophic Sages
Criticisms of Sage Philosophy
Culture Philosophy and Its Relationship to Philosophic Sages
Oruka’s Sage Philosophy: the Last Few Years
Sage Philosophy Research by Other Philosophers: Students
Sage Philosophy Research by Other Philosophers: Other Scholars
References and Further Reading

1. Oruka Biography and Early Writings

The history of the project begins in the 1970s; nevertheless, it is important to understand the project’s beginning in the context of its immediate precursors, both those that served as partial models and those that served as negative examples of what must not be done. It is also important to know something about Oruka’s academic training and background, and the skills and interests he brought to the project.

Oruka grew up surrounded by sages in his home area of Ugenya, in the Nyanza Province of Kenya, and as a youth he looked up to them and learned much wisdom from them. Graduating from St. Mary’s High School in Yala, he won a scholarship to study geography at Uppsala University in Sweden. While there, Oruka was influenced by philosophy Professor Ingemar Hedenius to follow his newly developing interests and study philosophy instead. Philosophy studies at Uppsala were divided into two tracks, Practical and Theoretical, and Oruka specialized in Practical Philosophy: Applied Ethics and Political Philosophy. The approach to philosophy Oruka learned both in Sweden and later at Wayne State University in Detroit, Michigan, was greatly influenced by the logical empiricists. Indeed, Oruka referred to himself an empiricist as well (Practical 283). He would later remark that this narrow emphasis on analytic philosophy that he received in his formal training was an initial “handicap” to his ability to enter the debates on African philosophy upon his return to Kenya (Oruka, Trends 127).

When he returned to Kenya in 1970, Oruka became one of the first two African philosophy faculty members at University of Nairobi. At that time, many departments at the University of Nairobi (UON) were questioning the Eurocentric curriculum that was their colonial heritage. Ngugi wa Thiong’o, Okot p’Bitek, and Taban Lo Liyong were some of the scholars challenging the curriculum in literature, development studies, and other areas (Ogot). The Institute for African Studies at UON was founded in 1970. Sage philosophy was an attempt to rise to the challenge of imagining an approach to philosophy that focused on African ideas and realities. The fields of literature and history had turned to oral sources; there was no reason that philosophy could not do the same.

When Oruka received his first full-time position in 1970, the field of African Philosophy was dominated by Placide Tempels, John Mbiti, and other early scholars who sometimes blurred the line between religious and philosophical thinking. Also, at that time, the Philosophy and Religious Studies departments at UON were merged. Having studied with Hedenius, famous for his arguments in favor of atheism, Oruka distinguished himself with early essays in 1972 and 1975 denouncing much of what was passing for “African philosophy” as no more than dressed-up mythical thinking. (He later judged these articles as “youthful” as well as “simplistic and unnecessarily offensive” Oruka, Trends 12, n.1; 125-29; Practical 285; Graness and Kresse 12). He championed a secular and logical approach to life’s big questions. However, also impressed by the need to appreciate an unfairly-marginalized, substantial body of thought coming from Africa, Oruka proposed his “sage philosophy” project as a way to provide missing information about African ideas and values. He was convinced that rural sages were not merely “religious figures” but thinkers who used their own rational powers to develop insights, and who could explain their reasoning to others.

In his early 1972 article “Mythologies as African Philosophy” Oruka was to insist on jettisoning traditions harmful to Africa’s present and future. He criticized both Placide Tempels’ book Bantu Philosophy and John Mbiti’s book African Religions and Philosophy as backward-looking champions of absolutely unphilosophical African traditions. He agreed with Fanon’s criticism of a certain type of misguided African intellectual who falsely builds up the greatness of African tradition in a futile attempt to convince Europeans that African culture is as good as theirs. Oruka wanted instead to write for an African audience (Oruka in Graness and Kresse Sagacious 1999 ed., 23).

In “Mythologies,” Oruka began to articulate his emphasis on the need to acknowledge individual thinkers. By anonymizing everyone and providing only group consensus, Tempels, Mbiti, and W. E. Abraham (author of The Mind of Africa) presented “philosophy without philosophers.” He suggested, “We can as well start afresh by interviewing sage Africans and eliciting philosophical expositions from them” (Oruka in Graness and Kresse Sagacious 1999 ed., 30). While individuals’ thinking is influenced by their community and material conditions, they are not determined by them, and in fact individuals can also influence groups. Oruka also pointed out that a philosopher’s role is not just to describe how people think and act, but to make suggestions as to how they ought to think and act (Oruka in Graness and Kresse Sagacious 1999 ed., 31).

2. Sage Philosophy in Philosophical Context

Oruka conceived of the project in relation to interjections from Kwasi Wiredu and Paulin Hountondji, whom he had met and who had both been invited to University of Nairobi. He had become familiar with their written works in early philosophy journals published in Africa, such as Second Order (University of Ife Press, Nigeria), Universitas (Accra), and Cahiers philosophiques africains/African philosophical journal (Zaire) (Oruka, Trends 129-30, 132-33). Both scholars had studied philosophy in African universities and abroad, Wiredu at University College, Oxford, and Hountondji at the École Normale Supérieure, and both were critical of the ethnophilosophical approaches of Tempels and Mbiti.

Wiredu, based in Ghana, emphasized the secular and rational nature of much ethical thought among the Akan groups in Ghana. He outlined three major hindrances to African cultural regeneration: anachronism, authoritarianism, and supernaturalism. But he also insisted that Africa had very wise and philosophical persons from whom a lot could be learned, especially if one paid attention to the nuances of concepts in African languages. In a 1972 issue of Second Order, Wiredu wrote that “it is a particular (though not exclusive) responsibility of African philosophers to research into their traditional background of philosophical thought” (“On an African Orientation” 12). However, he argued, while traditional concepts and codes of conduct should be an area of study, they should not lead to anachronism—an attempt to turn back the hands of time or cling to the days of yesteryear (7).

Wiredu was the first to label “what ‘our elders’ said” as “folk philosophies.” He found exciting the prospect of constructing, from “the living wise men of the tribe,” “the elaborate and argumentative reasons” behind the belief systems and moral guidelines of “our philosophers of old.” Still, the resulting material could not, Wiredu believed, help to tackle most modern problems in Africa (“On an African Orientation” 5). Along with interest in past traditions, he maintained, scientific method and clear argumentation were necessary to guide African youths in confronting the new moral dilemmas facing contemporary African society. Barry Hallen, scrutinizing Wiredu’s article, says that Wiredu intended the phrase “folk philosophies” to refer to unreasoned beliefs whether they were African or Western (Hallen “Yoruba” 106-08). Wiredu followed up this exploration with an article that Oruka recommended to his readers, in which Wiredu compared and contrasted the meaning of “philosopher” and “wise man.” The material, first published in the article (Wiredu “What Is”), was later incorporated in Wiredu’s book (Wiredu Philosophy 139-173; see Oruka Trends 69n5).

Three years later (1975), in Second Order, Oruka explained that he and others at UON were already engaged in a project along the lines of Wiredu’s description. He said, “We are seeking to unsheathe, through constant contacts and discussions with those concerned, the elaborate philosophical views and reasons from the living traditional Kenyan thinkers and sages” (Oruka “The Fundamental” 54n6). He followed Wiredu’s words and ideas closely enough to repeat the descriptors “elaborate” and “reasons.” In his subsequent book he adopted the descriptors “folk philosophies” and “folk sage,” but clarified that, in addition to elders who are examples of folk sagacity, there were some philosophic sages able to scrutinize prevailing beliefs and give sustained arguments for their positions. The elders, he asserted, were more than just depositories of outdated folk wisdom. Philosophical sages were able both to describe the “culture philosophy” held by most members of their community and also to evaluate the content (or at least understand the genesis) of such culture philosophies. In Philosophy and an African Culture (1980) Wiredu affirmed that “The recording and critical study of the thought of individual indigenous thinkers is worthy of the most serious attention of contemporary African philosophers” (37). In Cultural Universals and Particulars (1996), Wiredu wrote that Oruka’s sage philosophy book was the first to give “substantial notice” to individual philosophical thinkers in Africa (116).

Paulin Hountondji was another key influence on the development of sage philosophy. Hountondji gave a talk, “Philosophy and Its Revolutions,” at the National University of Zaire during “Special Philosophy Days” in June 1973, and a second time at University of Nairobi in November, 1973. Invitations for these talks came from the Philosophical Association of Kenya, which Oruka had founded (African 71).A paper based on the talks was published in French in 1973 in Cahiers philosophiques africains/African Philosophical Journal and later incorporated into Hountondji’s book, African Philosophy: Myth and Reality (71-108). Hountondji’s “Revolution” article, and chapter, which Oruka and other Kenyans heard in person in 1973, criticized Tempels’ book Bantu Philosophy but appreciated the works of two European anthropologists, Paul Radin and Marcel Griaule, suggesting that their approach was much more careful than Tempels’. In fact, Hountondji said, Tempels’ study was “behind the anthropology of the time” (African 76). Twenty years earlier than Tempels, Radin wrote Primitive Man as Philosopher, a study of philosophy in Africa that focused on original thinkers who were members of an intellectual class in their communities. Hountoundji explained that Radin denounced the prejudice that African individuals are submerged in unitary group-think and took it upon himself to transcribe faithfully what members of this intellectual class told him (African 76; “La Philosophie” 30-31).

Paul Radin was an anthropologist originally from Poland who had studied with Franz Boas at Columbia University. Radin recorded interviews with members of a Native American community from Nebraska called the Winnebago. He explained in his book the necessity of researchers presenting “statements made by the Winnebago” word-for-word to the public, rather than merely recounting others’ ideas in ways that mixed the researcher’s interpretation with the words and views of those interviewed (64). Researchers who thought they did readers a service, by weaving together narratives and accounts of multiple informants in a harmonizing way, actually hid the extent of disagreement and diversity of opinion in the community (xxxviii).. Since primary sources are so valuable, Radin advocated a method of careful direct questioning, a process which under the best circumstances “can become something analogous to a true philosophical dialogue” (xxxi). Radin first published his book in 1927 but came out with a second edition in 1957 which critiqued Placide Tempels’ approach as presumptive and wrong-headed insofar as Tempels presumed to describe Bantu philosophy on behalf of Bantu speaking people, instead of letting them speak for themselves.

Hountondji stated that “Radin’s work is still, to the best of my knowledge, the most lucid ethnological critique of the theoretical assumptions of ethnophilosophy” (African 79). He praised Radin for showing the level of variations in retellings of particular myths and the ways each narrator influenced the myth in their own way, thus demonstrating the “profound individualism” among African intellectuals. Though he faulted Radin for use of the insulting word “primitive,” Hountondji was struck by how, unlike other Western anthropologists, Radin conveyed Africa as a place with views as plural as those of Western societies (African 79). While Radin’s study predated Oruka’s coining of the term “sage philosophy,” certainly Radin’s project shared much in common (both in goals and method) with Oruka’s later project. While Radin’s own first-hand research was with the Winnebago tribe (now more accurately called the Ho-Chunk people) in North America, Radin’s book drew upon primary source narratives of philosophical thought from various communities around the world, including proverbs and poems from Africa.

John Dewey, who wrote the foreword to Radin’s book, thanked Radin for challenging certain common misconceptions of Africa, which tended to present Africans as accepting “automatic moral standards” based on custom, when in fact African communities respected freedom of expression and emphasized individual moral responsibility (Radin xix). The relationship and consistency between Radin’s approach and that of Oruka’s sage philosophy project was alluded to by Kai Kresse (27-28), Lucius Outlaw (in Oruka Sage 244n27), and Godwin Azenabor (73).

While Oruka probably heard about Radin in Hountondji’s 1973 presentation in Nairobi, Oruka nowhere credited Radin as an inspiration for his own chosen methods. In fact, Oruka engaged in a lifelong castigation of anthropologists, condemning them along with missionaries like Tempels. Oruka presumed that all anthropologists anonymized and conglomerated their sources into one, and he asserted that no anthropologist had devised a method similar to his own. Another important distinction to highlight is that Radin made extensive use of proverbs, poems, and songs, which he considered primary sources even if the specific authors were unknown, and found profound philosophical thought in these sources. Many in the field of African philosophy have also argued for using these kinds of sources as philosophical sources, for example, Kwame Gyekye of Ghana (An Essay 8-19) and Claude Sumner, a Canadian who researched Ethiopian philosophy for many years, and Ethiopian philosopher Workineh Kelbessa (“Logic”; Indigenous chap. 11). Even Oruka’s philosophy colleague at UON, Gerald Wanjohi, engaged in extensive analysis of proverbs (Wanjohi Wisdom). Oruka did not consider the study of proverbs to be related to his project. He narrowly focused on interviews with living sages as his only source, despite the fact that other contemporaries of his argued that one could find clear expression of logical argument as well as insightful reflection in proverbs (Sumner 22-23, 391-403). In an article he wrote on Sumner, Oruka mentioned that Sumner spent much effort studying and publishing Oromo proverbs (Practical 156), and maintained that studying proverbs is a different method than ethnophilosophy, but he did not develop these ideas. In Sage Philosophy (1990 ed. 115-16; 1991 ed. 117), the sage Simiyu Chaungo discussed the use of proverbs, but it is the only time proverbs are mentioned in the book.

Along with Radin, Hountonji’s 1973 article also included Marcel Griaule as an example of anthropologists whose methods differed from Tempels’ (31). Griaule interviewed Ogotemmeli, a Dogon elder in Mali, at length. Hountondji was disappointed that certain political factions inside and outside of Africa preferred Tempels’ style of massive, definitive synthesis of all Bantu views to capturing the plurality and disorderliness of individual thought by direct interview. In the preface to the second edition of his book, which included “Philosophy and Its Revolutions,” Hountondji again reiterated his 1974 opinion of Griaule as an important trend-setter:

The French anthropologist had chosen to transcribe the words of one sage among many. He showed the possibility of a long term project which would consist of a systematic transcription of such speeches, at least as a starting point of a critical discussion—what my Kenyan colleague the late Odera Oruka would later call “philosophical sagacity”—rather than as reconstruction of implicit philosophy behind the habits and customs of the host society through a lot of non-verifiable hypotheses which always amount to over-interpreting the facts”(ix).

In 1996, Hountondji saw Griaule’s project as an earlier version of Oruka’s project. He reiterated his estimation of Griaule in his reflections, published in English as The Struggle for Meaning (2002). In this work he reflected on his views back in 1970, saying of Griaule’s work: “Voluntarily assigning to himself the humble task of a secretary, custodian, transcriber of the worldview of a black sage, of one spiritual master among others, the French ethnologist gave the example of scientific patience and, in my eyes, did more useful work than the ethnophilosophers proper who were in a hurry to reach definitive conclusions on African philosophy in general” (99).

Oruka himself was not that impressed with Griaule and Ogotommeli. In his 1983 article in International Philosophical Quarterly, later included in Sage Philosophy, Oruka argued that Ogotemmeli was at best a “folk sage” and not a philosophical sage, because he did not transcend his group’s views. Therefore, Griaule was not engaged in sage philosophy, but only in “culture philosophy” (Oruka Sage, 1991 ed., 34, 47, 49-50).

Hountondji and Oruka both missed research published by other anthropologists in the 1960s that cast doubt on whether Griaule really followed his professed method of interviewing one person and transcribing what that person said. D. A. Masolo made a thorough review of the anthropological literature on Griaule, most but not all of it in French, in which the authors questioned whether the conversation was recorded verbatim on the series of days that Griaule recounted. They suspected Griaule of reconstructing the conversation (Masolo African 69, 77, 260). Jack Goody’s book review discussed the painstaking detail an interview must have in order to meet standards of even a “soft” science like anthropology. The words of the person interviewed should be clearly demarcated from those that are the author’s commentary. Field notes should be identified as such and distinguished from the words of the on-site translator. Original language transcriptions should be available, and the difficulty of translating esoteric words should be discussed by the author. Griaule’s book did not meet these standards (Goody review). Kibujjo Kalumba, who considered Griaule’s book on Ogotommeli one of three possible sources of sage philosophy, complained that the book contained too much of Griaule’s re-wording of Ogotommeli’s ideas (274, 276).

While Oruka declared in 1972 his intent to interview wise elders, he had just the previous year been quite critical of another philosopher’s use of the interview method applied to the topic of Ethics. Tore Nordenstam, a Norwegian based in Khartoum, Sudan, had interviewed three of his students, and on the basis of the interviews, published a book called Sudanese Ethics. In his rather harshly critical review of the book, Oruka questioned how interviews could be helpful at all in the study of ethics.

Oruka himself changed from someone with antipathy toward Nordenstam’s project to a person who promoted a large project interviewing African sages. His own project tried to avoid all of the pitfalls he pointed out in Nordenstam’s project: he did not interview students; he tried to interview those without exposure to studies in European philosophy; he addressed gender issues in most of his interviews; and he asked his interviewees sensitive political questions, even at great risk to himself (as in his interviews with Oginga Odinga). He shared with Nordenstam the focus on ethical issues. Before leaving this section on early precursors and influences on sage philosophy, it is important to note that a Kenyan scholar wrote an article in 1959 that is considered by several African philosophy scholars to be a clear precedent to sage philosophy. Taaita Towett (d. 2007) is known these days mostly for his role in Kenyan education and politics. As Minister of Education, he was “Patron” of the Philosophical Association of Kenya (see Thought and Practice 1.2 [1974] inside back cover). Towett’s 1959 article, translated into French as “Le Role d’un philosophie Africain,” “earlier expressed an identical argument” to Oruka’s, according to Ochieng’-Odhaimbo (“The Tripartite” 30n4). In the PhD thesis he wrote under Oruka’s supervision (later excerpted in Sage Philosophy) and in a 1983 journal article, Anthony Oseghare claimed that Towett’s 1959 article provided “evidence of the existence of critical philosophical reasoning in Africa” (Oseghare “Sagacity” 95; Oruka Sage 1991 ed., 237). D. A. Masolo noted that Towett, as Oruka did later, argued that literacy was not a prerequisite for philosophizing and that Socrates was an example of an oral philosopher. Towett and Oruka both contended that “there must have been African philosophers engaged in the formulation of culture philosophy” (Masolo African Philosophy 236).

3. Beginning Interviews in Kenya

In his published works, Oruka explained that he began his sage philosophy project along with his philosophy colleague Joseph Donders, a White Father from the Netherlands (“The Fundamental” 54n6; Sage 1991 ed., 17-18). Donders explained that the funds for the study were originally received from the UON’s Dean’s Committee (“Don’t Fence” 11).

Oruka’s early publications describing his projects and his methods began in the mid-1970s. At the time, Oruka made it clear that his project was a national one, and was to include wise sages from a wide variety of ethnic groups in Kenya. At this time, there was a lot of focus on building up Kenya’s national identity, and Oruka wanted his project to be a unifier for the country, where all Kenyans could take pride in a common heritage of wise philosophers. He also wanted Kenyans to evaluate and be able to justify their cultural practices (see Oruka “Philosophy”; Ochieng’-Odhiambo Trends, 116-117; Presbey “Attempts”). At the same time, Oruka focused on sages who could articulate reasons for their philosophical and ethical positions that did not rely on mere tradition or on religious authority. He also focused on the individual identities and arguments of the sages rather than melding the ideas of individuals into the “group think” of an ethnic group; to do the latter would have been to engage in the common error in African studies in philosophy.

As F. Ochieng’-Odhiambo has noted, the exact terminology for Oruka’s project has changed over time. In 1974, when Oruka first announced his project, he called it “Thoughts on Traditional Kenyan Sages.” He first coined the term “philosophic sagacity” in 1978, referring to individual critical and reflective sages engaging in thought in such a way that even European or analytic philosophers would have to admit that philosophers were present in Africa. He created and emphasized the approach as an alternative to ethnophilosophy, which he disparaged. Ochieng’-Odhiambo noted that as early as 1983, Oruka called those engaged in philosophic sagacity “sage philosophers.” He contrasted them to ordinary sages (later called “folk sages”) who, in 1983, were not considered philosophical because they lacked critical reflection and ability to create independent positions on topics. In 1984, in “Philosophy in English Speaking Africa,” Oruka used the term “sage philosophy.” At first, the two terms “philosophic sagacity” and “sage philosophy” were used interchangeably and no distinctions were drawn. But during this third stage of Oruka’s works (1984–1995), he used the term “philosophic sagacity” increasingly less, while he used “sage philosophy” increasingly more. Oruka then used the term “sage philosophy” retrospectively to refer to his pre-1984 works (Ochieng’-Odhaimbo, “The Evolution” 19, 24).

The term “philosophic sagacity” Ochieng’-Odhiambo says, was first presented in Oruka’s “Four Trends in African Philosophy” at a conference on Dr. William Amo in Accra, Ghana, in July, 1978 (Oruka Trends 21n1; also see Ochieng’-Odhaimbo “Philosophic Sagacity: Aims”). “Four Trends” was later revised and presented at the World Congress of Philosophy conference in Dusseldorf, Germany, in August, 1978 (Ochieng’-Odhiambo “The Evolution” 22, 30n6). However a Nigerian philosopher, M. Akin Makinde, commenting on Oruka’s popularization of the term, claimed to be the originator of the term in the context of African philosophy. Makinde said he used the term “philosophic sagacity” (with a different connotation than Oruka) earlier than Oruka in a conference paper he presented in June, 1978, at University of Ife (Makinde “Robin”; “Philosophy” 107). Makinde’s 1978 paper drew upon concepts in Bombastus Paracelsus’ essay Philosophia Sagax. Collins English Dictionary explains that “philosophic” is a term created in Middle English around 1350-1400 C.E. that meant “learned, pertaining to alchemy.” Makinde claimed that Oruka used the term and concept “wrongly” but admitted that Oruka’s usage became the more widespread (African 9, 122, 137). Many scholars in African philosophy do not pay attention to the term “philosophic” and refer to Oruka’s method as “philosophical sagacity” (for example see Hallen African 68-75; Imbo 25-26).

Oruka articulated his project and his methods in the context of growing debates on the topic of African philosophy. He spearheaded the founding of the Philosophical Association of Kenya and the creation of its journal, Thought and Practice, in 1974. In his famous “Four Trends” article, he divided African Philosophy into four diverse interests/trends with differing methodologies (ethno-, nationalist-ideological, and professional philosophies including his own, philosophic sagacity). At these venues and in publications he explained how his own project was not just another example of the wrong-headed “ethnophilosophy” approach (criticized by Paulin Hountondji) but was instead an alternative to it.

In a 1988 article of Oruka’s first published in German and later included in English in Trends (50-69), Oruka described his sage philosophy project, listed eight sages (all men) who were part of his study, and gave a biography of each. Two of them, Paul Mbuya Akoko (d. 1981) and Oruka Rang’inya (d. 1979), would be included at greater length in his soon-to-be-released, book-length study of sage philosophy. The others mentioned in 1988 had only biographies and short excerpts of their interviews in the German-language article, which were repeated in two books. These latter sages were Njeru wa Kanuenje, Nyaga wa Mauch, Arap Baliach, Muganda Okwako (d. 1979), Joash Walumoli, and Kasina Wa Ndoo (Trends 57-61, 66-67; Sage 1991 ed., 37-40). Oruka explained that he and researcher Jesse N.K. Mugambi interviewed Njeru wa Kanyenje of Embu district together, in the Embu language (Trends 66, 132).

Oruka’s book Sage Philosophy was published first by Brill in 1990 and later in Nairobi in 1991. There are a few differences between the two publications, but most changes are minor editorial ones, with the major exception that chapter one of the Brill edition has an extra twelve pages telling the background of the study. The book has three parts. The first is Oruka’s introduction to his project. Here, Oruka gathered (with little revision) several of his articles on sage philosophy that had been published over the years. The second part includes interviews with sages, and the third part includes commentators and critics. Documentation of the sages as individuals, and the publication of their originally oral philosophical thoughts, are crucial to Oruka’s methodology; this stands in contrast to ethnophilosophy’s practice of summarizing what informants (often anonymous) say and searching for a common denominator. Also in the second part, a brief biographical sketch and photograph precedes each interview. Oruka insisted on identifying both folk and philosophic sages in the same manner. In this way, his project does not merely repeat the same ground covered by ethnophilosophy.

The book minimizes the editorial/interpretive role of the professional philosopher, in comparison to other anthropological approaches, by including direct excerpts from interviews of sages who were self-conscious of their role as cultural critics and were respected for the critical views they articulated. Interviews with sages covered topics related to philosophy of religion (such as the existence of God, life after death, and so forth), free will and determinism, and ethics. These topics were of central concern to Oruka, whose own academic background from Uppsala was in practical philosophy rather than theoretical philosophy. Oruka mentioned “Chaungo Barasa, Fred Ochieng’-Odhiambo, Sam Oluoch Imbo, Samuel Wanjohi Kimiti and Mwangi Samuel Chege” as his key research assistants in the project (Sage 1991 ed., xi).

Oruka closely followed this first book-length publication with a monograph focusing on the interviews of Jaramogi Oginga Odinga. He explained that for the 1982 interviews he was accompanied by E. S. Atieno-Odhiambo, a well-known Kenyan historian who focuses on oral history, and in 1992 Chaungo Barasa assisted him. Odera Oruka provided his own commentary on the interviews, which focused on Odinga’s love of truth, and how Odinga’s commitment to truth and love of the masses contrasted with Plato’s own position in the Republic regarding the myth of metals, sometimes called the “noble lie” (Oginga Odinga xi, 3-4, 12-13).

4. Relationship to the Hallen-Sodipo Study

Barry Hallen and J. Olubi Sodipo engaged in a research project that involved interviewing wise men among the Yoruba in Nigeria. They began their project around the same time as Oruka, in 1973-74. As Hallen and Sodipo explain, they started in 1973 with a non-credit student study group at the University of Lagos. During university breaks they asked students to “establish face-to-face fieldwork relationships with the elders and wise men of their family compounds, villages, and towns” (Hallen and Sodipo 9). They chose the concept of the person as the theme for these first discussions. After this first study, they interviewed people in the Ekiti region from 1974-84 and moved the project to the University of Ife (now Obafemi Awolowo University) in 1975 (Hallen and Sodipo xvi, 11). Sodipo became head of the newly independent philosophy department that separated from the religious studies department in 1975.

Hallen and Sodipo chose to study herbalists and native doctors because they were more critically sophisticated than the “ordinary persons” whom they advised, and were able to offer theoretical concepts (10-11). They explained that the onisegun (Yoruba wise men) they interviewed were organized into their own professional society called an egbe, with rules, evaluations, possible reprimands, and a pledge of secrecy. The onisegun were not mere masters of medicine, but rather, they “[gave] advice and counsel about business dealings, family problems, unhappy personal situations, religious problems, and the future, as well as about physical and mental illness” (13). They did not name their individual interlocutors because, as they explained, those they interviewed requested to remain anonymous (14). They acknowledged that the practical questions regarding interviewing methods were many, and they tried to sort out the question: “is each man to be treated as an individual, potentially eccentric thinker, or are opinions to be somehow collated and presented as shared and communal?” (8). They followed the latter plan, due to the fact that they were studying language use. Their study had philosophical insights regarding how the use of words “knowledge” and “belief” were understood, and came to note that among the Yoruba, the use of the term translated as “knowledge” is much narrower than the usage in Britain or the United States, because it was reserved for first-hand knowledge alone. In Britain or the U.S., people commonly claimed to know a vast amount of information (in the form of propositions) that went beyond their first-hand knowledge (see Hallen and Sodipo; Hallen “Yoruba”).

Because it involved academic philosophers interviewing wise elders in Africa, many people associated the Hallen and Sodipo project with Oruka’s sage philosophy project. However, at least in some of his writings, Oruka clarified that he did not consider their work that of sage philosophy due to its lack of emphasis on individual sages. In fact, Oruka complained that it looked like the onisegun of the study held views “in consensus” and therefore to study their views was “anthropology, not philosophy” (Oruka Sage 1991 ed., 8-10; quote, 10), or even “culture philosophy,” “cultural prejudices” or “philosophication” (Oruka Sage 1991 ed., 50). “Philosophication” is a term that Oruka intended to have a derogatory tone. At one point he defined it as “the discovery of a philosophy out of no philosophy;” he also played with coining the word “philosofolkation” which involved loving the “folk” so much that one invented a philosophy for them and made oneself its spokesperson (1990b, 7). Oruka’s criticisms began as early as his 1975 article, when he charged J. O. Sodipo with trying to pass off African superstitions regarding the agency of the Yoruba gods as an African understanding of cause and, hence, philosophical (Oruka “The Fundamental” 48). In a more conciliatory tone, he wrote in his 1983 article that the Hallen-Sodipo project, like Griaule’s Ogotemmeli, while not “philosophic sagacity,” may be “some form of sagacity” (Oruka “Sagacity” 389; Ochieng’-Odhiambo Trends 133).

On this point, Ochieng’-Odhiambo pointed out (“The Evolution” 27) that a particular end note in an article of Oruka’s 1990 book, Trends in Contemporary African Philosophy (Oruka Trends 68), suggested that Hallen and Sodipo’s project might be part of sage philosophy, despite Oruka’s clarification in other works (Oruka Sage 1991 ed., 8-9, 50) that it was not. This endnote is a bit indirect. Oruka listed Hallen and Sodipo’s works along with several others that directly address sage philosophy, and then added the caveat, “It is not the case that every one of these writings addresses itself to the direct question of Sage philosophy. But they all make special reference to a type of thinking in Africa that can only owe its existence to the thoughts of some wise men (and women) in traditional Africa.” This statement makes it sound like Hallen and Sodipo were fellow travelers. Interestingly enough, Oruka mentioned that at a certain point in his research he interviewed some sages who wanted their names withheld (Sage 1991 ed., 65n4), and he mentioned specifically a parallel with Hallen and Sodipo’s study.

In his 2006 book, African Philosophy: The Analytic Approach, Hallen agreed that it was best to keep his own project and Oruka’s separate. As good grounds for separating them, Hallen explained that his and Sodipo’s project was always intended to be an exercise in philosophy of language, and he admitted that such was not the case with Oruka’s interviews. He also acknowledged that Oruka wanted to keep them separate (4–5). But he also explained, in Knowledge, Belief, and Witchcraft, that he thought that the kinds of description of their project that Oruka engaged in were unkind and unfair. Oruka did not take into account that when one does philosophy of language one cannot help but search for common usages of terms and concepts. Hallen recounted in an afterword to the 1997 edition of Knowledge, Belief, and Witchcraft the shock he experienced upon first reading criticisms of their work such as this. He and Sodipo had been bracing for criticisms from anthropologists; they expected to be told that they weren’t properly trained to do fieldwork. But they were surprised to find themselves criticized by philosophers for advocating a communal consensus account of African thought, basically being accused of the dreaded “ethnophilosophy” as Hountondji had described it.

Hallen asked Hountodji and Oruka to rethink their criticism, since there was no way to practice ordinary language philosophical analysis, whether in Africa, England, or elsewhere, without focusing on common meanings. Hallen thought that the fact that their study was able to debunk many prevailing myths and stereotypes about Africa, including misconceptions made popular by some anthropologists that considered African thought as pre-reflective, uncritical, traditional, emotional, and non-reasonable. This was evidence that they should be appreciated, not lumped in with anthropologists and ethnophilosophers whose projects were evaluated negatively (Hallen and Sodipo 136-37n16; 140). Indeed, one of the surprising conclusions of Hallen and Sodipo’s study was that the onisegun had such stringent criteria for counting something as knowledge (that is, restricting it to first-hand experience, and requiring careful reporting and testimony from all witnesses), that they made Euro-Americans who accept second-hand propositional knowledge as true seem “dangerously naïve or perhaps even ignorant” in comparison to the onisegun (Hallen Yoruba 299).

While discussing parallels in Nigeria, it is important to note that Campbell S. Momoh (d. 2006) engaged in interviews with elders of the Uchi community. Momoh says he responded to Hallen’s call for philosophers to go to villages to discuss philosophical topics with illiterate elders (Momoh “African” 99). He cited as his intellectual sources for the methodology of the project not Oruka but instead both Paul Radin and William Abraham. In his 1962 book, Abraham distinguished public philosophy from private philosophy, referring to Griaule’s study of Ogotommeli as an example of “of an individual African philosopher rather than a repository of the public philosophy” (104). Momoh saw a commonality between Radin’s notion of the African intellectual and what Abraham called “private philosophy” (Momoh The Substance 53, 55). Momoh insisted that interviewees should be named and credited.

Momoh was himself involved in interviewing elder sages. He did his dissertation fieldwork in 1978 and submitted his dissertation in 1979 to Indiana University. His dissertation committee included William Abraham and Ivan Karp (An African Conception). The dissertation includes lengthy sections naming elder interlocutors (such as Aliu Oshiothenaua, Saliu Ikharo and others), paraphrasing their conversation in detail as well as quoting them directly (92-120). Momoh also provides contextual background of the sages’ standing and purpose in their communities (see especially 45-48, 67-70, 85-87). He even mentions seeming interruptions in the discussion, such as the presence of a young boy or a chicken, and how the conversation is shaped by these interactions (something for the most part missing from the interviews in Oruka’s study). Topics focus on metaphysics and ethics. Along with accounts of the elders’ discussions, Momoh includes his interpretation and analysis of what the elders say. While the elders may convey their ideas in story and myths, these do not just reflect communal philosophies since some of the stories are creations of individual men (for example, Ikharo’s story of woman’s refusal to accept marrying man as her God-given duty and role, see 116-117).

In his published work, Momoh names some elders, quotes them verbatim, and gives specific examples of methodological challenges during his interview of them (“African Philosophy” 87-88). He named Aliu Oshiothenaua, Pa Egbue, Pa Abudah (Momoh’s uncle), and a hunter named A. M. J. Momoh (The Substance 66, 245, 254-55, 376-78). He found in the interview of the hunter a “doctrine of existential gratitude” (The Substance 382). Oshiothenaua asserted a theory of human dependence on nature (The Substance 376). An ethnophilosophical study that merely explored communally held beliefs in the sense of Abraham’s “public philosophy” would be incomplete, Momoh insisted, because “alongside with it” it would need to name individual intellectuals and add additional contextual information such as the time period, cultural paradigm, and branch of philosophy relevant to the discussions. He criticized Bodunrin, who wanted to make an “absolute dichotomy” between ethnophilosophy and the sagacious elders, since, according to Momoh, the latter were based on the former–that is, the “sagacious elders” philosophized in a general context provided by public philosophy (“African” 77-78, 80-81; The Substance 56, 58, 59).

Momoh also insisted that sagacious elders had a better practice than much of contemporary analytic academic philosophy, since their goal was not the narrow one of negatively appraising received ideas, but the broader project of building holistic systems and attending to important moral issues (“African Philosophy” 91; The Substance 69, 75, 78). While Oruka notes that in Momoh’s earlier 1985 article Momoh seemed unaware of Oruka’s sage philosophy project (Oruka, Sage 1990 ed., xxiv) and castigated Oruka as a member of the “African logical neo-positivists” who denigrated ancient African philosophy (Momoh based this estimate on Oruka’s 1972 article critical of myth, see The Substance 64), he later revised his estimate of Oruka and acknowledged his sage philosophy project (The Substance x). In an article originally published in 1987 (included in Sage 1990 ed.), Oruka expressed his agreement with C. S. Momoh’s position that the names of sages interviewed must be given and their views credited to them (Sage 1990 ed., 20). Fayemi Ademola Kazeem considered Momoh to be engaging in a sage philosophy project as was Oruka, noting that Momoh preferred to call it “ancient African philosophy” (Kazeem 196).

Godwin Azenabor included Hallen and Sodipo, Momoh, Oruka and others in a common category of African philosophy which he called the “Purist school” because all were committed to the assertions that Africa has a similar practice of raising philosophical questions and answering them as does the West; however they all saw the need to break free of Western paradigms, conceptual schemes, and conditioning. All in the Purist School emphasized the relevance of African culture and tradition for both philosophy as well as models for African development (Azenabor Understanding xiv). While the choice of “Purist” as a descriptor can be questioned (see Sophie Oluwole’s defense of Oruka’s project as admitting up front the multiple influences on contemporary rural sages, in Graness and Kresse Sagacious 155), Azenabor’s categorization helps us to see the common themes and approaches of authors who emphasized their distinction from and competition with each other.

5. Folk Sages and Philosophic Sages

In some works Oruka was at pains to distinguish “folk sages” and “folk sagacity” (wise elders who could recount community traditions and beliefs but not take a critical, evaluative stance toward them) from “philosophical sages” or “philosophic sagacity” which were the interviews and ideas of particularly reflective and evaluative sages. The distinction copied “first order” and “second order” distinctions in philosophy to a great extent. Many philosophers concluded that the only important part of the sage philosophy project was the “philosophic sagacity” part. However, such an approach left unexplained the role that folk sages played in the project. Why continue to include folk sages if they are examples of unphilosophical individuals? Several scholars addressed this thorny topic (Presbey “Sage Philosophy: Criteria”; Van Hook).

Omedi Ochieng noted the irony that while Oruka first began his project to debunk Western scoffers who thought Africans were involved in unreflective groupthink, his comments championing the philosophic sages as “geniuses” in contrast to folk sages and other Africans who were satisfied at following others and not thinking for themselves ended up reinforcing the negative stereotype of Africans (“Epistemology” 348-351). He thought that Oruka capitulated and accepted academic definitions of philosophy that belittled folk wisdom and championed abstraction in a way that silenced the important contributions of many Africans (“Ideology” 153-57). Oluwole likewise noted that in some of Oruka’s texts he seemed to define “philosophy” so narrowly that even his own sages would fail to meet such narrow criteria, which would ironically lead to the failure of his own project. She insists, however, that if the sage interviews could be approached by sensitive scholars familiar with the sages’ language and context, without the near-ubiquitous prejudice against finding philosophy in African oral practices, that the project in this sense is very promising (Oluwole in Graness and Kresse 158-61).

An additional problem is that even when Oruka sorted out his folk and philosophical sages, the folk sages still demonstrated the intellectual virtues Oruka insisted belonged only to the philosophical sages. To illustrate this point, let me highlight that each of the seven “folk sages” in Sage Philosophy (chap. 6) distinguished their views from those of their communities on at least one topic. Chege Kamau said that he didn’t believe the afterlife consists in ancestral spirits as others believe. Rather, he posited, all people rejoin one big soul, which he called God. Joseph Muthee advocated sometimes unpopular inter-tribal marriages as a means of building a national culture. Ali Mwitani Masero argued that death is the end of the human being. Zacharia Nyandere said he believed men and women were equal, despite Luo perceptions to the contrary. Abel M’Nkabui said all humans were equal, and that inequalities were historical accidents. Based on this conviction, he was critical of Meru prejudice against blacksmiths. Joseph Osuru said that the Teso think that God does not belong to other tribes or races. But he thought that God belongs to all people. He also mentioned that some Teso think that having dreams of the deceased is proof that they live in a world after death. But, he pointed out, having a dream is not proof. Peris Njuhi Muthoni said that it was good that the practice of female circumcision is dying, because it led to medical problems. She stated that it was her conviction that Luo should not remove their teeth as a rite of passage. These concrete examples show that all of the so-called “folk sages” can critique their own societies, an attribute Oruka assigned only to the “philosophic sages.”

Oruka listed “philosophic sages” in their own chapter (chap. 7). The sages included there were Okemba Simiuyu Chaungo, Oruka Rang’inya, Stephen M. Kithanje, Paul Mbuya Akoko, and Chaungo Barasa (Sage 1991 ed., 109-155). An additional aspect of the sage philosophy project was that Oruka did not want the project to stay on the descriptive level. He wanted Kenyans to read and grapple with the ideas of the sages, evaluate them, extend them, and apply them to their lives. However, his own published commentary on the interviews was brief (Trends 64-65). In Sage Philosophy, he left the job of commentary on the interviews to his student, Anthony Oseghare (Sage 1991 ed., 156-160).

D. A. Masolo made the point that it is not mere disagreement with one’s cultural group that makes one a philosophic sage, but rather that “the criterion for a moral ideal, according to the sage, is not that it match the historical belief of the community but that it satisfies an acceptable idea of right, fairness, and respectfulness toward all those who are involved or may be affected by its practical application” (Masolo “Sage”). He gave the example of a sage who would counsel against the practice of a certain ritual if it would jeopardize the health of an individual. In these circumstances, the important criteria “was not their mere variance from the communal beliefs of the sages’ own groups but also a theoretical account provided by the sage as the foundation of his or her own view. . . The sage attends to the rationality of views rather than to the judgment of the group” (Masolo “Sage”).

One of the tensions found within sage philosophy is that, while Oruka privileged sages critical of their societies’ prejudices, as in the examples above, on the other hand he championed sages who hold in high esteem traditional values forgotten or marginalized by young Kenyans. In a 1979 research proposal for sage philosophy, he explained that his project was a way of defending his nation from the “invasion by foreign ideas,” which could not be stopped by guns but instead must be combated on the level of ideas. This cultural invasion included worship of technology and an adherence to crass materialism as a measure of success. Oruka bemoaned the fact that African traditional morality was already eroded by European colonialism, and their replacements, Christianity and Islam, he argued, were incapable of standing up to the cultural erosion of values (“The Philosophical”).

Oruka often asked questions about the proper relationship between men and women during his interviews with sages. Many of the sages insisted that women were inferior to men. Oruka cautioned readers that the sages were reflecting the cultural prejudices of their times, and he reminded those familiar with Western philosophy that such assertions of women’s inferiority could be found as well throughout the Western canon of well-known and respected philosophers. Still, he was proud of the fact that some of his sages held relatively progressive views on this topic (Sage 1990 ed., xix-xx; Ochieng’-Odhiambo Trends, 136), and he even had one sage’s views on the topic published in a Nairobi newspaper (“Paul Mbuya”). The views asserting men’s superiority could be found in the sages interviewed by his student F. Ochieng’-Odhiambo and Ngungi Kathanga. In Oruka’s studies as well as his students’ studies, few women sages were interviewed. Gail Presbey has drawn attention to women sages in her works (“Who”; “Kenyan”).

6. Criticisms of Sage Philosophy

From early on, critics from within the community of African philosophy scholars put forward their criticisms. Oruka included three critics (Bodunrin, Kaphagawani, and Keita) and three supporters (Outlaw, Oseghare, and Neugebauer) in Sage Philosophy. Peter Bondunrin said Oruka’s sages were not enough like the Greek philosophers, who expounded their view in a context of literacy (Oruka Sage 1991 ed., 163-179, esp. 168-69). Lansana Keita said that when Oruka relegated creative individual thinking to the critical views of “philosophic sagacity,” he failed to acknowledge that the folk or ethnophilosophy of the community could itself be a product of earlier creative individual philosophizing (Sage 1990 ed., 210). While some of these criticisms were perhaps based on a misunderstanding of Oruka’s project (see Bewaji review 109), Oruka did appreciate the debates that ensued and responded to these critics in his own articles, which were included in the first part of the book.

After the publication of the book, criticism continued. D. A. Masolo said the sages Oruka quoted often made comments that were no more than common sense, perhaps with some cleverness thrown in, rather than sustained arguments (Masolo African Philosophy 236-245). Ochieng’-Odhiambo had a clever and insightful response to this kind of criticism. “The idea that philosophy must always operate at a higher rarefied level with deep abstractions is not always true . . . Philosophy can, in many ways, be expressed very simply”; in fact, he agreed with Christopher Nwondo, who advocated that philosophers in Africa should attempt to write in clear and simple language (Trends 138). But Ochieng’-Odhiambo did clarify that Masolo was not against the sage philosophy project itself, but had just stated that he thought the interviews included were not yet strong enough to prove the point to his liking (Trends 137).

Tunde Bewaji reviewed Sage Philosophy and was impressed by Oruka’s sage interviews because they “reflect a clarity of thought which is not seen in ethnographic, anthropological or sociological studies” (106). While Simiyu Chaungo argued that God was the sun, because without the sun there could be no life, Ali Mwitani Masero, on page 96 of Sage Philosophy, argued that if God created the sun, God cannot also be the sun. Bewaji also commended Osuru’s criticism of popular practices that regarded dreams as evidence about the afterlife. Bewaji pointed out that many persons from so-called civilized societies still consider dreams evidence of another world. He also commended Kithanje for arguing that there could not be many gods, because such gods could not account for the uniformity of creation (106-07).

In chapter four of his book, Philosophy in an African Place, Bruce Janz reflected upon Oruka’s sage philosophy project. He noted that the approach seemed to solve the paradox of African philosophy by appealing to universal principles of reason and exploring the context of African lived experience. Yet, Oruka imported Western philosophical ideas to a large extent and left them mostly unacknowledged. This was problematic since his project purports to be all about African philosophizing. Additionally, Janz offered critiques of the methodology. The method at first looked promising, by focusing on conversation between sage and the interviewer (an academically trained philosopher) where the two cooperatively worked toward truth. Yet, to Janz, it often sounded nevertheless like it was the academic philosopher who focused upon and made manifest the latent reasoning in the sage’s conversation. Janz noted that past, outmoded ethnographies turned Africans into objects of others’ studies and declared that he therefore preferred open-ended conversation. But the structure of questions that most sages were asked in interviews steered them toward certain answers that fit in the context of past Western philosophical paradigms such as asking for an essence (What is wisdom? What is virtue?). Such questions presumed that increasing levels of abstraction were abilities to be praised in a sage. Interviewers guided the sages, he argued, by eliciting the sage’s opinion on topics that the interviewer thought important. Janz also took Oruka to task for promising to evaluate which of the sages were wise according to an objective criterion. Janz noted the complex and multiple aspects of being a wise person, and suggested that it would not be easy for anyone to sort out the wise from the not-wise. Further, Oruka did not address whether or not wisdom is a culture-bound concept. Janz suggested that wisdom was better recognized intersubjectively, identified in “a process of explicating shared meanings in a community, rather than identifying an essence” (107).

Omedi Ochieng likewise insisted that the sages be placed in a context where their speech could be understood contextually, and he found several places where Oruka failed to fill in important aspects of context. In fact he questioned the “interview” as Oruka’s chosen method, suggesting that sages might not understand an interview as a context in which to justify their philosophical beliefs when challenged by a provocateur. Adversarial debate is a particular form of philosophizing that may not be valued by the sage. But Ochieng did think that interviews with sages in some form should still be done in a “reconstructed” version of African sage philosophy (“Epistemology” 346-47, 359).

Janz similarly suggested that Oruka depended too much on the idea of philosophizing as critique and divergence from communally accepted beliefs. Why not look for other signs of wisdom, such as creative thinking? Janz found many examples of creative thinking among the sages, such as Stephen Kithanje’s “fecund metaphor of God being like heat and cold.” Likewise, Okemba Chaungo showed through his debate of the relative good of wisdom versus land that the seeming contradiction could be overcome by understanding different senses of “good” (109). In general, Janz was frustrated that sage philosophy was not more self-critical about its methods, did not come to terms with its positionality, and did not devote time to critiquing its own methods.

W. J. Ndaba critiqued Oruka’s work, arguing that the ideal of philosophy as “an individual, explicit, critical and self-critical ratiocinative consciousness” was a Western notion, since such emphasis was “counterproductive for the emergence of a genuinely rooted African philosophy” (17). He held that an African perspective would value the folk sage, that is, the person who consulted the wisdom of their community and did not try to do it alone. He referred to the Zulu proverb, Iso—elilodwa—kaliphumeleli (“An eye—when it is one—does not succeed”), to emphasize the importance of consulting other persons who could “note points of detail which elude him or unforeseen snags which turn up to mar his plan” (20-21). He disagreed with Oruka’s claims that the philosophic sage was more valuable than the folk sage. He did, however, appreciate Oruka’s emphasis on the philosophical sage being able to warn society against holding one-sided or close-minded, ethnocentric views.

While there have been critics of sage philosophy, there have also been many scholars who have appreciated its contribution. In addition to those already mentioned above, substantive treatments of Oruka’s project can be found in the works of Lucius Outlaw (in Oruka Sage); Sophie Oluwole, Muyiwa Falaiye and Ulrich Loelke (in Graness and Kresse), and others.

7. Culture Philosophy and Its Relationship to Philosophic Sages

Oruka was convinced, both by his training in practical philosophy as well as his own sense of values and priorities, that philosophy in general, and the sage philosophy project in particular, had to address itself to the concrete problems facing Kenyans and Africans. It should address issues in the present and suggest a course of action to make Africa’s future better.. Thus, he wanted his project to be both practical and accessible to a general audience beyond academia. He often wrote for the newspapers, such as the Daily Nation, and other popular publications. In 1986, he participated in a study sponsored by the Institute of African Studies at the University of Nairobi called “Kenya’s Socio-Political Profiles” where he was required to contribute a broad outline of the general beliefs and practices of the Luo ethnic group (Oruka Sage 1990 ed., 53, 58-61). In 1986 he became an expert witness for a now-famous trial often referred to as the S. M. Otieno burial saga. Oruka took the witness stand, and gave an account of the philosophy and practices of burial among those from the Luo ethnic group. He argued that his expertise was due to his study of so many interviews with philosophical sages from the area. He included a transcript of his evidence in court in Sage Philosophy (1990 ed., 65-80).

Note that “culture philosophy,” that is, an account of the prevailing beliefs of an ethnic community, was an offshoot of interviews aimed at discovering philosophic sagacity. In order to see how a particular sage deviated from norms in his individual, critical thinking, the sage often began by recounting reigning shared values in his community. This “offshoot” of sorts (which Oruka had before dismissed in a disparaging way as philosophy only in a broad or even “debased” sense) now became a focus. Some experts in customary law even accused Oruka of giving the court an outdated account of practices, presented as timeless truths of the Luo ethnic group (Cotran 155). When Oruka was in the witness stand, Khaminwa, Wambui Otieno’s lawyer, asked him whether in traditional society there may be people opposed to customs who want to depart from those customs and do things their own way. Oruka explained to Khaminwa that “in a traditional communal society there were very few rebels” (Sage 1990 ed., 70). He minimized the existence and role of such dissent, even though in his academic work on sage philosophy he particularly championed such dissent.

Rather than see him as taking on the role of ethnophilosopher, Ochieng’-Odhiambo suggested that, at that point, Oruka showed that he himself was a philosophic sage able to recount the traditions of his ethnic group while also resolving any inconsistencies (Ochieng’-Odhiambo Trends 125). Masolo thought that Oruka’s popularity grew because of his role in the trial, due to his ability to unmask the faulty logic of the widow’s defense team that equated “modern” with “Western” in a stereotypical and unfair way (“Sage”). Be that as it may, the court case can also be seen as another missed opportunity for Oruka to champion the rights of women in a male-dominated context (Presbey, 2012, 2013).

The court case was the beginning of a new phase in Oruka’s sage research. As Oruka explained, due to his notoriety in the case, he was offered work sensitizing District Officers and Commissioners to Luo philosophy and customs. When he gave these talks, he reiterated common beliefs among the Luos and quoted individual philosophical sages (Sage 1990 ed., 58-64). He also put his sage sources to use when studying Kenyan beliefs and practices regarding family planning, for the Department of Populations. He had two control groups, non-sages and sages, and gave the views of both. His main point was that Kenyan traditions and values already had the resources for population control through natural family planning. Further, a sensitive study of the culture of Kenyan people could reveal attitudes and practices that worked against family planning and then point the way to solutions to the problem. Here he seemed to have crossed over quite a bit into the social sciences. Dorothy Munyakho explained that his approach was still considered experimental and controversial from the perspective of people in Population Studies who were more familiar with demographics and statistics than with qualitative analysis of interview content (21).

Critic Didier Kaphagawani, in a 1987 article reprinted in Sage Philosophy, charged sage philosophy with being parasitic on ethnophilosophy, insofar as philosophic sages practiced second-order reflection and analysis of first-order ethnophilosophy (Kaphagawani in Oruka Sage 1991 ed., 181-204). But Oruka responded and clarified. He said instead that philosophic sagacity is second order to culture philosophy. Sages reflect upon the culture, though not as it is summarized in consensus form and analyzed by professional philosophers, theologians, or missionaries (as in ethnophilosophy); rather, they do so based on their first-hand observations of the culture philosophy through their personal experiences in the community (Sage 1991 ed., xxiii). This same point could serve as a fine-tuned criticism of Momoh’s terminology mentioned above, since Momoh sometimes referred to ethnophilosophy and communal philosophy without distinction. Momoh added the helpful point that all communal philosophies, not just African communal philosophies, are non-critical, and he gave some examples from Britain (The Substance 59, 63).

In an article, “Sage Philosophy Revisited,” based on a radio interview in 1993 and published posthumously, Oruka noted that some scholars considered his project “just one of the brands of ethnophilosophy,” similar to Mbiti and others, and disagreed with those critics (Practical 183). He agreed that he studied “culture philosophy” and described it as the “beliefs, practices, myths, taboos, and general values of a people” (Sage 1991 ed., xxiii). To the end, Oruka trusted his method more than that of ethnophilosophers like Tempels because he based his accounts of culture philosophy on the testimony of trusted indigenous experts (the philosophical sages), and he considered himself to be conveying only what they had told him (Sage 1990 ed., 57; 1991 ed., 43n2). Of course, there is no escaping one’s role in shaping the data insofar as the researcher, even Oruka himself, decides which parts of which interviews to highlight when presenting them to others. This methodological point was raised by Emmanuel Eze regarding Oruka’s work (Eze and Lewis 19).

It’s important to note that as time went on, ethnophilosophy’s staunchest critic, Paulin Hountondji, modified his position. He reflected on the debate that was started by his criticism of ethnophilosophy and said in 2002 that his earlier rejection of collective thought was excessive. He explained that collective culture must be taken seriously, and that individuality is fashioned from a basic personality, which has rootedness. While he agreed that individual thought should be seen in cultural context, he noted that it should not be stuck there. Roots should not become a “prison house” (The Struggle 128, 151-52, 204-05). Also, one of Hountondji’s biggest complaints about the ethnophilosophers like Tempels was that they were foreigners, or if not foreigners, at least they were writing for a foreign audience, responding to debates and criteria created abroad. Hountondji called this “extroversion,” and wanted instead to have African philosophy being written by Africans and responding to the interests and needs of Africans (“Introduction”). Certainly, the trajectory of Oruka’s interests in the sages showed that over time, the issue of proving anything to outsiders diminished in importance, as the question of how sage wisdom and reflection could help Kenya and Africa took center stage (Ochieng’-Odhiambo “The Tripartite” 21, “The Evolution” 29, and “Philosophic” 78; Kalumba 39-40; Presbey “Sage Philosophy: Criteria”).

8. Oruka’s Sage Philosophy: the Last Few Years

Oruka intended his sage philosophy project to continue to grow. He called his 1992 book, on former Vice-President of Kenya Jaramogi Oginga Odinga, a continuing study in sage philosophy (Practical 162). In many respects, Oginga Odinga was quite different than the other sages, insofar as he was literate, had formal education and extensive experience in government (being first vice president of Kenya and later a presidential candidate) and had also traveled abroad. Nevertheless, Oruka insisted that in Oginga Odinga’s role as ker, that is, spiritual and cultural leader of the Luo people, he maintained with the other sages an important commitment to the betterment of his community. Oruka also clarified that, while he had begun his sage philosophy research interviewing illiterate elder sages, because their testimony might soon be lost, he never intended his project to be limited to the illiterate, elderly or rural persons. Thus, speculations that his project would become out of date the more that literacy spread in Africa were based on a misunderstanding of his project (Sage 1990 ed., xviii). Indeed, in Sage Philosophy, he included an interview of one young, educated sage, Chaungo Barasa (a water engineer), due to his wisdom and his commitment to his community (1990 ed., 149-57).

Oruka articulated and emphasized other reasons to continue sage philosophy as a project, including the need for a generation of Kenyans who grew up in cities to remain connected to their roots. He was also concerned with the practical challenges of poverty and corruption and curtailment of liberties in Kenya. He thought that sages, from the obscure rural ones to the more famous ones like Oginga Odinga, could offer a bold moral critique of Kenyan society that could help people improve their lives both individually and as a community and nation.

Oruka’s life was cut short in a road accident in December of 1995. As a pedestrian, he was struck down by a motorist in the streets of Nairobi (Nation Reporter 40). Further studies in sage philosophy have certainly been stymied by this loss but not wholly halted. Anke Graness and Kai Kresse quickly assembled scholars to comment on sage philosophy’s legacy in a memorial book to Oruka that came out shortly after his death, Sagacious Reasoning. A book of essays that Oruka had been working on at the time of his death, Practical Philosophy, was subsequently published. This book divided Oruka’s essays into four sections, one on African philosophy and culture and the other three covering issues of truth and faith, value and ideology, and environmental ethics. Excerpts of sage interviews can be found in some collections on African philosophy (see Oruka’s interview of Paul Mbuya Akoko in Hord and Lee 32-44).

9. Sage Philosophy Research by Other Philosophers: Students

To explore the ongoing influence of sage philosophy, it’s best to cast a wide net. While “philosophic sagacity” was a specialized part of sage philosophy, the project also included folk sages and culture philosophy. It makes sense to survey those who found Oruka’s emphasis on the interview process central to their own work in African philosophy. Some of these persons did not mind drawing upon interviews as well as proverbs. Many provided extensive historical background and filled in details of the context of those they interviewed to a far greater extent than Oruka ever did in his studies, and they did so for good methodological reasons. Some refined the interview method beyond Oruka’s own practice, going more in-depth, refraining from misleading questions, and some even preferred participant observation to interview. With all of these variations, it is best to understand these works as influenced by Oruka and perhaps even as improvements on his project, rather than as strict copies.

This survey will begin with those who had been Oruka’s own graduate students. Most published work beyond their original theses and many became scholars in their own right. During Oruka’s time at University of Nairobi, MA and PhD students such as Kenyans Ngungi Kathanga, Oriare Nyarwath, Patrick Dikirr, F. Ochieng’-Odhiambo (“The Significance”), Wairimu Gichohi, and Nigerian Anthony Oseghare incorporated sage philosophy as a topic and/or interviews with sages into their studies while under Oruka’s supervision. Some of them published articles sharing their research with others. Oseghare’s thesis reiterated many points of Oruka’s own position—holding a universalist definition of philosophy, limiting investigation to texts that met the philosophical standards of being critical, rigorous and of a second-order activity—and analyzed three sages according to this criteria. Two of the sages appeared in Oruka’s book, and Oseghare’s commentary on those two sages was excerpted and included in Sage Philosophy. But the thesis included discussion of a third sage, Oigara from the Kisii community. Oseghare liked Oigara best because unlike Oruka Rang’inya (who happened to be Oruka’s father) who explained the psychology behind “explaining events through the activities of spirits as a ploy of encouraging good behavior,” Oigara instead directly appealed to individuals’ abilities to make rational judgments (Oseghare xii). Oseghare concluded that the sages met his criteria for philosophical thinking.

Gichohi analyzed the interviews of sages included in Sage Philosophy (1991), finding contradictions in the concepts and positions held by some of the sages regarding their concepts of God. For starters, she questioned why Paul Mbuya Akoko said there must be one god to account for the orderliness of the universe. According to Gichohi, Mbuya begged the question, for who is to say that many gods must take on a mischievous character? (89). She also noted that Mbuya said that no one really knows God but later affirmed that God exists and rules nature (91). She noted that Oruka Rang’inya was involved in a contradiction between God being a concept and God’s living in the wind (93). She further was concerned that M’Mukindia Kithanje’s interpretation of God as present at the biological process of procreation confused the mysterious or marvelous with God (94). When it came to their ideas for the improvement of society, Gichohi found some of the sages’ suggestions problematic. Gichohi was particularly concerned with Mbuya Akoko’s suggestion that a criminal should be administered a drug during which time he could be reformed. She expressed her skepticism that such a procedure would reform the individual. Since being subjected to such drugs involuntarily is dehumanizing, how could one be reformed while his humanity has been eroded? In addition, Mbuya did not explain what type of offender and under what circumstance the punishment should be administered. These are all very important objections to the procedure which were not even questioned during the interview (103-04). Likewise, when Simiyu said that illness is due to laziness, his view, although perhaps sometimes true, could not count for all cases, such as physical destruction and disease brought on by earthquakes and other large-scale calamities not caused by humans. (131-32).

Ochieng’-Odhiambo described in his thesis and subsequent articles that his efforts were aimed at exploring “philosophic sagacity” to prove to skeptics that Africans can philosophize. For this reason, he explained, “my efforts were channeled toward presenting the thoughts of some sages in an elaborate and rarefied manner. More specifically, I concentrated on those topics that had been the focus of most ancient Greek philosophers” (“The Tripartite” 18). By proceeding in such a way, he would not only “uncoil” the philosophical ideas and logic of the sages but also “show beyond the shadow of a doubt that philosophers existed in traditional Africa” (“The Tripartite” 19). As Ochieng’-Odhiambo explained in a 1997 article that presented some of his 1994 dissertation’s findings, “The rationale of my approach was that if the thoughts of the pre-Socratics are philosophical (and this is never doubted) and if the African (Kenyan) sages think in a similar manner, then they should also be granted the prestige of being philosophical” (“Philosophic” 174). Oruka himself made references to the sages being at least as good as the pre-Socratics (Sage 1990 ed., xv-xvi, xxv, 37), so Ochieng’-Odhiambo was clearly following Oruka’s lead. The rest of the article, based on the research he did for his dissertation, involved interviewing sages and asking them, for example, questions on change and permanence. Ochieng’-Odhiambo asked Rose Ondhewe Odhiambo whether things change or are permanent (in obvious reference to the Parmenides and Heraclitus paradox). She gave a nuanced answer: some things change more than they are permanent, and some are more permanent and change little. Certainly she used reason and put forward a rational view. Ochieng’-Odhiambo went on to interview a man, Naftali Ong’alo, who when asked what the single most important element is, argued that “water is the single most important thing in the universe” (“Philosophic” 175-77).

It’s possible to raise some methodological questions regarding the approach in Ochieng’-Odhaimbo’s early works. The problem of asking “leading questions,” whether pursued intentionally or not, is a real one for any interviewer; Ochieng’-Odhaimbo himself addressed the dangers of leading questions in another work of his (Trends 132-33). While his studies with Oruka were in the 1990s, he continued to address African Philosophy in general, and sage philosophy in particular, as a key topic in his philosophical writings. He gave a thorough account of Oruka’s sage project in his 2002 and 2006 articles, and in his 2010 book (Trends 115-150).

Patrick Maison Dikirr published some findings from his 1994 master’s thesis which he wrote under Oruka’s supervision. Dikirr interviewed Maasai sages on the topic of death. As Dikirr explained, by discussing death, certain ideas, values, or lessons were reinforced about life. There were ambiguous practices among the Maasais, some of which seemed to argue for an idea of the afterlife. For example, when a Maasai person saw a snake (black python or cobra) in a hut of someone who has recently died, they fed it milk, greeted it, and told it, “We are always together!” After all, the snake may be a deceased important person such as an oloiboni (diviner), a great chief or counselor, or a wealthy man. But Dikirr wondered further, were snakes fed just to avert their anger, so that humans could survive? Or, were there ethical lessons contained in the treatment of snakes, such as: do not despise strangers who may show up to one’s house? He preferred that these lessons be the real reason behind the stories. Likewise, Maasais thought that waking someone suddenly from deep sleep should be discouraged, because the spirit travels while sleeping. But, Dikirr preferred to understand this practice as a focus on the ethical values of politeness and humility toward others. Dikirr thought the Maasai conception of self was closer to the Aristotelean unitary self-experience. He found evidence to show that Maasais thought there was a permanent end to life. The dead are no longer around. The only thing left after death is how one’s personality affects the children. A person who has children will not easily fade from memory like the single person who dies without children. Here, immortality is understood as a name to remember.

Ngungi Kathanga wrote a master’s thesis on philosophic sagacity at UON in 1992. Seven male (and no female) sages, all Kikuyus from Kirinyaga district, were included in Kathanga’s study. He explained that he originally interviewed fifty women and men (he does not mention how many of the fifty were women), but only the seven men included were judged by him to be sages (96). He included three sages’ responses to questions of men and women’s equality. All three said men were superior to women. All pointed out her physical weakness, and some added other weaknesses. Mwangi Wangu stated that women are unable to keep secrets. But he said they are respected for their roles as child-bearers, because through the naming of children, the dead survive. Joel Rukenya said women cannot rise up to tough challenges in life, and therefore should not be put in positions of power (122-24). The sages are, however, quoted as supporting racial equality (128-131).

Regarding Oginga Odinga, Peter Ogola Onyango of Moi University claims that a philosophic sage must first become a folk sage before he or she can become a philosophic sage. He then argues that Oginga Odinga proves his ability to be a folk sage by the fact that he is chosen as Ker of the Luo. Ogola Onyango then shows that Oginga Odinga is a philosophic sage because he disagreed with popular opinion of many Luos during the S. M. Otieno burial trial, when he claimed that it is fine for Luos to be buried anywhere in Kenya (240-42).

Oriare Nyarwath analyzed several of Oruka’s sages on the topic of freedom (Nyarwath in Graness and Kresse 211-218). He went on to write a PhD thesis in 2009 on Oruka’s philosophical works which included his review of the sage philosophy project’s purpose and methodology, but he did not include interviews of sages or commentary upon Oruka’s sage interviews (139-161, 247-48). Instead, the thesis focused on the question of Oruka’s commitments and overarching themes throughout his published works.

Also, students at Tangaza College in Nairobi’s Maryknoll Institute of African Studies program were regularly offered a course in sage philosophy, earlier taught by Oruka himself, then by F. Ochieng’-Odhiambo, and later, by Oriare Nyarwath (Maryknoll “Sage Philosophy”). These students continued to interview sages; their reports can be found in the Tangaza College library. In the earlier years, that is, in the 1990s, reports were almost always accompanied by transcripts of the interviews. But after around 2000, the number of student papers containing the transcript of the interviews declined. Either students gave short quotes of the interviews, or they only referred to interviews without giving any direct quotes.

10. Sage Philosophy Research by Other Philosophers: Other Scholars

Kai Kresse’s book, Philosophising in Mombasa, got its inspiration from Oruka’s project. Kresse explained that he was seeking knowledge about knowledge in the context of the Muslim community living on Kenya’s Swahili coast. He wanted to study the self-reflexive, critical knowledge of local thinkers there. His book contained three in-depth portraits of local elder intellectuals and several briefer portraits of younger thinkers. Kresse explained how his methodology differed from Oruka’s. Unlike Oruka, Kresse did not center his study on direct questions put to each thinker interviewed, but instead observed the intellectuals during their philosophical discourses with members of their community. Kresse himself became fluent in Swahili so that he could follow such discussions directly, and read the scholars’ lectures, poetry and other writings. He lived in the Mombasa Old Town community so that he could be socially accepted and therefore placed in situations to hear and document the most interesting discussions. Kresse also helped his readers by describing the historical, religious and cultural context in which the debates occurred, as well as the personal biographies of the participants. But like Oruka and Brenner, Kresse saw a key part of his work as documenting “the utterances of the intellectuals” (31; Brenner). While Kresse added his own interpretation, he provided clear demarcation to his commentary, so that the reader could accept or reject the interpretations offered.

Kresse then followed with several chapters, each focusing on a particular thinker. Ahmed Sheikh Nabhany had as his goal the preservation of all that was good in Swahili traditions. Through poetry he was able to use his creative skills to communicate the basics of Islamic practices as well as moral guidelines and cultural practices. Nabhany was active in his proposals for preservation of a moral code that was losing ground in contemporary society. In his next chapter Kresse explored Ahmad Nassir, who in his poem “Utenzi wa Mtu ni Utu” summed up a moral code that involved respecting all human beings, that provided guidelines for distinguishing between good and bad actions, and that offered a way to measure moral status. Kresse considered Nassir to be an innovator insofar as he constructed a theory of utu (humaneness) and formulated sub-concepts that enforce utu. The next chapter focused on Sheikh Abdilahi Nassir’s Ramadan lectures. Kresse argued that Abdilahi was a sage, referring to Oruka’s use of the term in the context of his sage philosophy project. Abdulahi’s practice of rethinking his own positions on issues of dire importance to his community, and the extent of his conscious effort to clarify his ideas, made Abdulahi’s practices a clear example of philosophizing (206-07).

Kresse followed the book with an article in 2008 that engaged in a study of the concept of wisdom, based on two Swahili sages. He argued that a person is identified as wise if they are able to make others see the world in a different light or from a new perspective. He argued that wisdom required social performance and interaction (“Can,” 194, 199).

Workineh Kelbessa, a philosopher from Ethiopia who had met Oruka and was inspired by his project, used Oruka’s interview method to gain knowledge about environmental values among the Oromo of Ethiopia. He wrote a book about his findings. His work drew upon culture philosophy as well as the insights of philosophic sages. He explained, “In this work, the term ‘indigenous environmental ethics’ is used sometimes to refer to the ethical views of philosophic sages who have their own independent views, and in most cases it is used as a plural (of ‘environmental ethic’) to refer to the norms and values of various Oromo groups and of other indigenous peoples” (ch. 1). His objective was to “show how indigenous knowledge systems can serve as a critical resource base for the process of development and a healthy environment.” He cautioned that he did not intend to engage in uncritical, nostalgic acceptance of Oromo indigenous knowledge. He used various sources, but depended most upon “interviewing, focus group discussion and observation” because they “enable us to understand values and attitudes of the people towards the environment at a level inaccessible to a questionnaire.” He interviewed peasant farmers and pastoralists to learn about their concepts of time and divination, their ecotheology, and their attitudes toward wild animals, forests, and agriculture (ch. 1). His study drew upon many proverbs.

A further sage philosophy study which attempted to apply the insights gained from sage philosophy to the topic of a new national culture for Kenya was written by Chaungo Barasa, who helped Oruka conduct his sage philosophy interviews. Chaungo argued that cultural practices needed to be connected to consistent thoughts and belief systems. He suggested Kenyans re-examine their lives and cultures in five areas: the intersection/harmonization of tradition and modernity, death and burial ceremonies, marriage and inheritance, inter-family and clan relations, and leadership and role-modeling. All of this could be attained with the help of sage philosophy, which encouraged people to pursue wisdom and reflect on their beliefs. The family taught moral behavior, he noted; however, in Kenya’s modern families (making up about 35 percent of the population) there was, he argued, a lack of morality. “Modern” Kenyans, he wrote, held a flawed concept of modernity, equating it with European culture and religion, and their understanding of that culture was rudimentary and incoherent. Chaungo maintained that the modern Kenyan also had a stunted understanding of indigenous cultures and traditions; in their place were materialism, and consumerism, and status. They barely masked their distaste for rural folk and environment, Chaungo argued; yet, they engaged in gender oppression which contradicted modernity. Also, modern Kenyans were easily manipulated and bought by various politicians. Such a description showed that philosophical reflection upon tradition was mandatory in order for society to become productive and coherent.

Oral historian E. S. Atieno-Odhiambo’s article “Luo Perspectives on Knowledge and Development: Samuel G. Ayany and Paul Mbuya” (2000) analyzed and evaluated books and pamphlets written by these two sages. Paul Mbuya Akoko, interviewed by Oruka and included in Sage Philosophy, was also a writer. This article met the two criteria of quoting individual sages, and engaging in critical analysis. Since the sages addressed the topic of development, the thrust of the article also fit in with Oruka’s expressed goals for his sage philosophy project. Mbuya was not the only sage included in Oruka’s Sage Philosophy who had written down his own ideas, and yet Oruka did not analyze the written works of the sages he included in his study.

In his “Conversations with Luo Sages,” D. A. Masolo recorded a conversation of pressing issues of the day in which a sage takes center stage, and in which Masolo was a participant but did not direct the conversation. Masolo considered this an example of participant observation, which, according to some anthropologists, could be a more reliable source of texts for understanding African philosophy than interviews. Masolo included this conversation transcript in his book Self and Community (255-60) because it shed light on contemporary moral debate in Kenya. While not explicitly expressed, what “emerged” during the conversation was the question of whether the worth of abstract moral principles “ought to be judged independently of any real situation” (263). Masolo then further analyzed the issues raised, in the context of moral positions expressed by Kant, Hume, and Wiredu. In another part of the same work, Masolo drew upon the insights of a sage interviewed by Oruka, Paul Mbuya Akoko. He found these to express helpful ideas for grounding the ethics of communalism, described by the sage as, in Masolo’s words, “a norm arrived at for purposes of affecting order in the lives of people by reducing social differences and promoting peace” (50). Masolo could be seen as a contemporary advocate and practitioner of a variant of sage philosophy. His methods focused not on interviews of a sage by a researcher, but rather the analysis of discourse at various public fora in which the sages gathered, such as “palavers,” public debates and negotiations. In these contexts, sages used their mental skills and were involved in sustained critical inquiry (“Sage Philosophy”).

Richard Bell’s book, Understanding African Philosophy, devoted a section to Oruka’s sage philosophy. He wanted to take Oruka’s project further by exploring oral philosophy as an example of narrative and Socratic discourse found not only in the texts of sages but also in everyday discourse and village palavers (32-35, 111-12).). For Bell, philosophy in Africa had to be tied to the experience of the lived reality of Africa, which was made up of the pre-colonial traditions of Africa, and its colonial history, current harsh circumstances, and human struggles (35). Bell analogized to Plato’s dialogues, such as Euthyphro, where, in the context of everyday life, circumstances give rise to philosophical dilemmas. Sages similarly prompted to engage in discussion as well as deep thought, and they grappled with situations which gave rise to what Bell called the “narrative ‘stuff’ of philosophy” (112).

Bekele Gutema argued that sage philosophy’s method was particularly productive in exploring topics of conflict resolution, such as crises of democracy, problems of ruling elites and corruption, and ethnic strife. Sages emphasized solutions that addressed the needs and perspectives of all parties, having as their goals the harmony between people as well as between people and nature. He added what he knew about elders being involved in reconciliation from his own experience (208-11). Presbey interviewed sages with these themes in mind. She found sages in both Kenya and Ghana who shared their insights into conflict, whether interpersonal or ethnic, and their procedures for bringing estranged parties together. She quoted from her interviews with the sages and evaluated their insights (Presbey “Contemporary African Sages”; “Philosophic Sages”; “Sage Philosophy and Critical Thinking”).

Charles Verharen of Howard University engaged in a project which combined Oruka’s sage philosophy project with the methods of Claude Sumner, S.J., the scholar who studied Ethiopian philosophy while living there for 45 years. Verharen noted that Sumner, following the suggestion of Alain Locke, enlisted the aid of linguists and anthropologists to do his philosophical work, something that Oruka did not do, but that Verharen considered essential to his project. Verharen engaged in interviews both among the Oromo and, with the help of Rianna Oelofsen of University of Fort Hare, South Africa, among the Xhosa and San. Verharen explained that he was drawn to study sage philosophy out of concerns for cultural survival as well as philosophy’s survival, as he searched for “better stories to tell” in a world where human survival was jeopardized (83-88). He suggested interviewing both those known as sages and a broader group drawn from all parts of the society, questioning them in such a way as to reveal their level of critical rationality (75-76).

Kazeem likewise suggests that sage philosophy research should continue with slight modifications in order that philosophers can salvage “indigenous epistemologies threatened with extinction” and thereby contribute to a “polycentric global epistemology” (200). Kazeem names his approach “hermeneutico-reconstructionism” and asserts that it can be used to solve Africa’s current problems (200-01).

Oruka’s contribution to the field of African philosophy was substantial, and his influence is ongoing, as sage research continues.

11. References and Further Reading

Abraham, W. E. The Mind of Africa. Chicago: U of Chicago P, 1962.
Atieno-Odhiambo, E. S. “Luo Perspectives on Knowledge and Development: Samuel G. Ayany and Paul Mbuya.” African Philosophy as Cultural Inquiry. Ed Ivan Karp and D. A. Masolo. Bloomington: Indiana UP, 2000. 244–258. African Systems of Thought.
Azenabor, Godwin. “Odera Oruka’s Philosophic Sagacity: Problems and Challenges of Conversation Method in African Philosophy.” Premier Issue. Spec. issue of Thought and Practice: A Journal of the Philosophical Association of Kenya ns 1.1 (June 2009): 69-86.
Azenabor, Godwin. Understanding the Problems in African Philosophy. Second Edition. Lagos, Nigeria: First Academic Publishers, 2002.
Bell, Richard H. Understanding African Philosophy: A Cross-Cultural Approach to Classical and Contemporary Issues. New York: Routledge, 2002.
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Chaungo, Barasa. “Narrowing the Gap between Past Practices and Future Thoughts in a Transitional Kenyan Cultural Model, for Sustainable Family Livelihood Security (FLS).” Presbey, et al. Thought and Practice 217–222.
Cotran, E. “The Future of Customary Law in Kenya.” The S. M. Otieno Case: Death and Burial in Modern Kenya. Ed. J. B. Ojwang and J. N. K. Mugambi. Kenya: Nairobi UP, 1989. 149-165.
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Eze, Emmanuel, and Rick Lewis. “African Philosophy at the Turn of the Millennium: Rick Lewis in Dialogue with Emmanuel Chukwudi Eze.” Polylog: Forum for Intercultural Philosophizing 1.1 (2000): 1-28.
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Gutema, Bekele. “The Role of Sagacity in Resolving Conflicts Peacefully.” Presbey et.al., Thought and Practice 207-216.
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Hountondji, Paulin J. “Introduction: Recentring Africa,” Endogenous Knowledge: Research Trails. Ed. Paulin Hountondji. Dakar, Senegal: CODESRIA, 1997, 1-39.
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Momoh, Campbell Shittu, ed. The Substance of African Philosophy. Auchi, Nigeria: African Philosophy Projects, 1989. See esp. “Issues in African Philosophy” by Momoh.
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Nyarwath, Oriare.“Philosophy and Rationality in Taboos, with Special Reference to the Kenyan Luo Culture”. MA thesis U of Nairobi, 1994.
Ochieng, Omedi. “The Epistemology of African Philosophy: Sagacious Knowledge and the Call for a Critical and Contextual Epistemology.” International Philosophical Quarterly 48.3 (September 2008): 337-59.
Ochieng, Omedi. “The Ideology of African Philosophy: The Silences and Possibilities of African Rhetorical Knowledge.” Silence and Listening as Rhetorical Arts. Ed. Cheryl Glenn and Krista Ratcliffe. Carbondale: Southern Illinois University Press, 2011. 147-162.
Ochieng’-Odhiambo, Fredrick. “The Evolution of Sagacity: the Three Stages of Odera Oruka’s Philosophy.” Philosophia Africana 5.1 (March 2002): 19-32.
Ochieng’-Odhiambo, Fredrick. “Philosophic Sagacity: Aims and Functions.” Caribbean Journal of Philosophy 1.1 (2009).
Ochieng’-Odhiambo, Fredrick. “Philosophic Sagacity Revisited.” Graness and Kresse 171-79.
Ochieng’-Odhiambo, Fredrick. “The Significance of Philosophic Sagacity in African Philosophy”. PhD thesis, U of Nairobi, 1994.
Ochieng’-Odhiambo, Fredrick. “Some Basic Issues about Philosophic Sagacity: Twenty Years Later.” Sumner and Yohannes 64-75.
Ochieng’-Odhiambo, Fredrick. Trends and Issues in African Philosophy. New York: Peter Lang, 2010.
Ochieng’-Odhiambo, Fredrick. “The Tripartite in Sagacity,” Philosophia Africana 9.1 (March 2006): 17-34.
Oruka, Henry Odera. “Ethics, Beliefs, and Attitudes Affecting Family Planning in Kenya Today.” Report. Inst. of Population Studies, U of Nairobi, 1989.
Oruka, Henry Odera. “The Fundamental Principles in the Question of ‘African Philosophy’ I.” Second Order 4.1 (January 1975): 44-55.
Oruka, Henry Odera. “Grundlegende Fragen der Afrikanischen Sage-Philosophy.” Vier Fragen Zur Philosophie in Afrika, Asien und Lateinamerika. Ed Franz M. Wimmer. Vienna: Passagen, 1988. 35ff.
Oruka, Henry Odera. “Paul Mbuya the Sage Philosopher.” Sunday Nation 17 May 1981: 17.
Oruka, Henry Odera. “The Philosophical Roots of Culture in Western Kenya.” Grant proposal, in possession of the author. [1979?] (For corroboration of the date, see Ochieng’-Odhiambo 2002, 29).
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Oruka, Henry Odera. Practical Philosophy: In Search of an Ethical Minimum. Nairobi: East African Educational, 1997.
Oruka, Henry Odera. Oginga Odinga: His Philosophy and Beliefs. Nairobi: Initiatives Publishers, 1992.
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Author Information

Gail M. Presbey
Email: presbegm@udmercy.edu
University of Detroit Mercy
U. S. A.

Desert

Desert is a normative concept that is used in day-to-day life. Many believe that being treated as one deserves to be treated is a matter of justice, fairness, or rightness. Although desert claims come in a variety of forms, generally they are claims about some positive or negative treatment that someone or something ought to receive. One might claim that a hard-working employee deserves a raise, an exceptional student deserves an academic scholarship, a dishonest politician deserves to lose an election, or a thief deserves to be imprisoned. But while such appeals to desert are common, there are a number of unsettled issues regarding the concept of desert itself and its relevance to justice. For example, it is common for people to claim that things other than humans, such as nonhuman animals or inanimate objects, can be deserving. How should we assess such claims? Some argue that desert presupposes responsibility. But must this be the case? According to some theories, desert is an important component of justice. Yet according to other theories, it has little or no role in justice. Some even question whether desert itself is a defensible concept. This article is designed to capture the scholarly agreement about these and other issues regarding desert. Where there is not such agreement, overviews of some of the competing accounts are presented.

The Structure of Desert
Desert and Some Related Concepts
1. Merit
2. Entitlement
The Role of Desert in Justice
1. Desert in Distributive and Retributive Justice
2. Desert, Institutions, and Justice
Meritocracy
Some Arguments against Desert
Concluding Remarks
References and Further Reading

1. The Structure of Desert

It is widely held that desert is a relation among three elements: a subject, a mode of treatment or state of affairs deserved by the subject, and some fact or facts about the subject, which are often referred to as desert base or desert bases (McLeod 1999a, 61-62; Pojman 2006, 21; Sher 1987, 7). This relation is shown in the formula:

S deserves M in virtue of B,

where S is the subject, M is the mode of treatment, and B is the desert base or bases. Each of these elements will be examined in greater detail.

a. Deserving Subjects

One’s view about who or what are the appropriate subjects of desert is going to be influenced by one’s view about what desert requires on the part of a subject. If one thinks that merely having a quality or feature is sufficient to establish desert, then one will place few restrictions on the kinds of things that can be deserving. If one thinks that having some baseline self-awareness is sufficient to make one the appropriate subject of desert, then nonhuman animals such as bottlenose dolphins and chimpanzees can be appropriate bearers of desert. If one thinks that desert requires a certain level of responsibility, then one will advocate for a conception that places stricter limits on who or what qualify as deserving subjects. While there is some disagreement in the literature, most who theorize about desert view human beings, or at least some subset of human beings, as appropriate subjects of desert A very broad conception of desert might seek to extend the concept to apply to certain or all sentient creatures, living things in general, or even inanimate objects. In fact, common language usage seems to support such a broad understanding. One might claim that Gone with the Wind deserves its reputation as one of the greatest movies ever made or that K2 deserves its reputation as one of the most difficult mountains to climb. But such a broad understanding of desert might involve problematic conflations of desert with other concepts. For example, while one might think Gone with the Wind’s lofty reputation is appropriate, one might argue that, strictly speaking, its reputation is not deserved. Instead, one might argue that in the cases of movies, mountains, and the like, the proposed desert claims are best understood as nothing more than general claims about how something should be judged or about what something should have or receive. So, in an effort to maintain conceptual clarity, it might be best to attribute some common uses of the term ‘desert’ to inexact language usage. A survey of the literature suggests some support for both broader (Schmidtz 2002, 777) and narrower uses of the term (Miller 1999, 137-138).

b. Deserved Modes of Treatment

Subjects are said to deserve a wide variety of things. The modes of treatment or states of affairs that one can deserve can be classified as positive or negative outcomes, harms or benefits, or gains or losses (Kristjánsson 2003, 41). Positive modes of treatment include such things as awards, compensation, good luck, jobs, praise, prizes, remuneration, rewards, and success. Negative modes of treatment include such things as bad luck, blame, censure, failure, fines, and punishment. Oftentimes, a deserved mode of treatment will incorporate a source or supplier of that treatment. For example, one might argue that an athlete deserves praise from his manager. But such a source need not be specified in all cases since legitimate desert claims need not be directed toward any source. This is, in part, because legitimate desert claims need not be enforceable or even prescribe any action. Consider the claim that certain hardworking people deserve good fortune. While this is a legitimate desert claim, it need not be directed toward any source and it need not result in a call for any corrective action in cases in which particular hardworking people have not had good fortune (Kekes 1997, 124).

c. Desert Bases

There are a variety of ways in which desert bases can be categorized. Two categories that are commonly used in the philosophical literature are desert based on effort and desert based on performance. Some accounts of desert focus primarily on one’s effort toward achieving some goal. Usually the goal has to be viewed as worthwhile, since quixotic effort is rarely considered to be a basis for desert. Some argue that desert is not based solely, or even primarily, on effort, but also on one’s performance in a given context. The performance can be any number of activities that give rise to positive or negative evaluation, such as the winning of a race or performing poorly in a music competition. In some contexts, the performance can be assessed in terms of the contribution that one makes as a part of some group, such as a family, company, community, or even a society as a whole. Depending on the context, this contribution can be measured in terms of productivity, success, or some other similar measure. Michael Boylan presents a thought experiment that raises questions concerning how one’s effort and performance often are, and how they should be weighed as factors in determining one’s desert. We are presented with two puzzle makers. The first puzzle maker is presented with a puzzle that is 80 percent complete, and he finishes the puzzle by completing the remaining 20 percent. The second puzzle maker is presented with a puzzle that is totally incomplete. He manages to complete 80 percent of the puzzle, and therefore does not finish it (2004, p. 139 ff). Boylan notes that, according to a common interpretation, the first puzzle maker would be the one who deserves the credit, and the resultant spoils, for completing the puzzle. But why should this puzzle maker get more credit when he completed significantly less of the puzzle? He cannot claim credit for, and therefore cannot claim to deserve, receiving the puzzle in a more advanced stage of completion, since he did nothing to bring the puzzle to that stage of completion. The puzzle maker example highlights important issues regarding the nature and use of desert. First, there is the question of what basis or bases one should use to determine desert. Should effort, performance, or some combination of the two be used? Are there other criteria that ought to be used? Second, even if one determines that effort and performance are the relevant desert bases, then one must still determine how to correctly weigh the two in a given situation.

i. Desert and Responsibility

As noted above, one’s view about who or what can qualify as a deserving subject will be influenced by one’s view of the role of responsibility in establishing desert. Some have argued that at least some type of responsibility is a necessary condition for all desert (Smilansky 1996a, 1996b), whereas others have argued that, in at least some cases, one can deserve some mode of treatment without anyone being responsible for the desert base that gives rise to that mode of treatment (Feldman 1995, 1996). An example of responsibility without desert could be cases in which a victim of theft is said to deserve compensation even though he was not responsible for having his money stolen. In such a case, however, there is still someone, namely the thief, who is responsible for the desert base. Others might offer desert claims based on suffering that people endure at the hands of beings with dubious levels of responsibility, such as children, mentally handicapped or emotionally disturbed adults, and nonhuman animals. Some argue that there can be desert in cases in which the suffering is not caused by any being, such as when people suffer as the result of a natural phenomenon. One who supports this view might argue that a tornado victim can deserve financial support as a result of his suffering through that natural disaster. So, one can argue that while certain cases of desert require responsibility, not all do. In at least some cases, one can attempt to maintain a connection between desert and responsibility by appealing to a notion of negative responsibility. That is, one can argue that if someone suffers a misfortune for which she is not responsible, and this misfortune causes her to fall below some baseline condition, then she can deserve some treatment as a result of her suffering (Smilansky 1996a, 1996b). Alternatively, one could argue that cases like those of the crime and tornado victims are not cases of genuine desert. One might argue that in situations in which a person suffers through no fault of her own she might be due compensation, and while it is a matter of justice whether she receives compensation, strictly speaking she does not deserve compensation.

ii. Desert and Time

Most desert theorists argue that desert is strictly a backward-looking concept. According to this standard view, a person’s desert is based strictly on past and present facts about him (Rachels 1997, 176; Feinberg 1970, 72; Miller 1976, 93). The view that desert must be backward looking has been challenged, however. According to these alternative, forward-looking accounts, certain legitimate desert claims can be based on future performances (Feldman 1995, Schmidtz 2002). This forward-looking view has been questioned based in part on a concern that it relies on instances of desert without legitimately grounded desert bases. The argument is that in order for a person to deserve something at a given time there must be some relevant fact about the person at that time that gives rise to his desert. The concern is that a desert base with sufficient grounding conditions that lie in the future cannot be such a fact, for it is metaphysically dubious (Celello 2009, 156).

2. Desert and Some Related Concepts

Desert is one of many concepts that are used to assess the appropriateness of what one does or should have. Prior to discussing the role of desert in justice, it is worthwhile to consider a couple of these other concepts.

a. Merit

There is not a consensus on how to understand the relationship between desert and merit. Some argue that the terms ‘desert’ and ‘merit’ do not identify separate concepts. And, in ordinary language, the two are often used interchangeably (McLeod 1999a, 67). But many scholars have offered important distinctions between the two concepts. One way to distinguish between the two is to claim that merit should understood more broadly than desert, since merit results from any quality or feature of a subject that serves as a basis for the positive or negative treatment of that subject even if that treatment is not strictly speaking deserved. On this account, desert is a species of the genus merit (Pojman 1997, 22-23). Although scholars discuss other distinguishing factors, e.g. effort and intention, a main factor used to distinguish desert from merit is responsibility. David Miller claims that a distinction between desert and merit is supported by the ways in which the two are discussed in contemporary discourse (1999, 125). He notes that ‘merit’ is used to refer to a person’s admirable qualities whereas ‘desert’ is used in cases in which someone is responsible for a particular result. One who supports such a distinction might claim that a person can merit treatment based on factors over which he has little or no control, based on characteristics that he did little to develop, and based on performances that required very little effort. For example, a man can merit, but not deserve, admiration for his native good looks. In addition, since merit does not require responsibility, it can apply to a wide variety of things, including nonhuman animals and even inanimate objects.

b. Entitlement

Understood in one way, entitlement claims are specific to particular associations, organizations, or institutions. Entitlement results from a subject having a claim or right to some treatment as a result of following the rules or meeting some explicit criterion or criteria of an association, organization, or institution. Although certain entitlements might be related to or give rise to desert (McLeod 1999b, 192), it is important to keep the two concepts distinct. There are many situations in which one deserves some treatment without being entitled to that treatment or in which one is entitled to something that one does not also deserve. Consider an automobile race in which the leading driver is caused to wreck by debris on the track. As a result, he crashes just prior to crossing the finish line. In such races, crossing the finish line first is the criterion used to establish the winner. If the crash prevented the driver from winning, one could reasonably argue that, although the driver is not entitled to win, he deserved to win because he had made the requisite effort, performed better than all of the other drivers for the entire race leading up to the crash, and was clearly going to win before he crashed. In addition to the fact that one can deserve something that one is not entitled to, one can be entitled to something that one does not deserve. Based on the laws of his country, an evil dictator could be entitled to a subject’s property that the dictator seized on a whim, but this does not mean that the dictator deserves the property. To use another common example, a son might be entitled to an inheritance left to him by his father, but he might not have done anything to deserve that inheritance.

3. The Role of Desert in Justice

In a general sense, justice can be understood to consist in persons getting what is appropriate or fitting for them. This idea of justice can be traced back to ancient times. Plato discussed justice in general, and distributive justice in particular, as involving a type of appropriateness or fittingness of treatment (Republic 1.332bc). According to some translations of Laws, Plato suggested that justice involves treating people as they deserve to be treated (6.757cd). Although there are many important differences between their theories, Aristotle joined Plato by arguing that justice involves a type of equality. In Nicomachean Ethics, Aristotle maintained that distributive justice involves judging people according to certain criteria in order to determine whether they are equal or unequal. He argued that, in distributions, it is just for equals to receive equal shares, unjust for equals to receive unequal shares, and unjust for those who are unequal to receive equal shares. He maintained that what each person receives should be geometrically proportional to the degree or extent to which his or her actions fit or match these criteria (5.3.1131a10-b16). People are judged based on normative concepts such as desert, merit, and entitlement to determine whether they are equal or unequal. Consider a distributive context in which two people are to be treated based on what each deserves. According to the idea of geometrical proportionality, if one person is twice as deserving as the other, then she ought to receive twice the share of what is to be distributed. According to the classical tradition, desert is one of the conceptual components of justice. But it is not understood as being the only conceptual component of justice. The Greek word axia, a word used by both Plato and Aristotle in their discussions of the distribution of things such as goods, honors, and services, can be translated as, or understood to include, “desert”. But, in certain contexts, it might be misleading to translate axia as ‘desert’ instead of translating it as ‘merit’ or some other related concept (Miller 1999, 125-126). Desert has a prominent role in certain more recent conceptions of justice, such as those of John Stuart Mill and Henry Sidgwick. In Utilitarianism, Mill claimed that it is considered just when a person gets whatever good or evil he deserves and unjust when he receives a good or suffers an evil that he does not deserve (2001, 45). Sidgwick argued that justice involved one’s desert being requited (1907, 280 ff). According to some contemporary theories of justice, often referred to as “pluralist” theories, desert is one among other important conceptual components of justice. These other components can include, but need not be limited to, entitlement, equality, merit, need, reciprocity, and moral worth. According to these theories, whether and to what extent desert is relevant to justice depends on the context in which the judgment is being made. And, when desert conflicts with the other components of justice, it must be measured against them in order to determine what justice requires (Miller 1999, 133; Schmidtz 2006, 4).

a. Desert in Distributive and Retributive Justice

Some scholars argue that desert’s role in distributive justice and retributive justice is symmetrical, i.e., that desert is more or less equally relevant in both (Sher 1987; Pojman 2006, 126). There is disagreement in the literature as to whether desert’s role ought to be understood in this way (Moriarty 2003; Smilansky 2006). Those who argue in favor of an asymmetry in desert’s role may attempt to explain the asymmetry in different ways. Some might argue that desert is relevant in retributive justice but not in distributive justice because being the appropriate recipient of a harm requires a level of responsibility that being the appropriate recipient of a benefit does not. Or, some might argue in favor of the asymmetry based on the differing modes of treatment that are called for in distributive and retributive contexts. The motivating idea used to support this view is that desert is an appropriate and important basis for punishment, but other concepts, e.g. equality and need, are the appropriate bases for distributions of goods and services. Even if one recognizes desert as an important conceptual component of both distributive and retributive justice, one might argue that desert differs in these different spheres. For example, one might argue that desert in distributive justice can be forward looking, while desert in retributive justice cannot (Feldman 1995, 74-76; Schmidtz 2002, 783-784).

b. Desert, Institutions, and Justice

In many cases, what one is said to deserve is connected to a certain convention or practice within an association, organization, or larger social institution. One cannot deserve first place in an automobile race if there are not any such competitions, nor can an employee at a steel mill deserve a raise absent the existence of the steel mill and the economic system of which the steel mill is some very small part. In the light of such examples, some scholars claim that, if it is a defensible concept at all, desert cannot exist in the absence of such institutional conventions or practices (Cummiskey 1987). This idea leads some scholars to offer what they view as an important distinction between pre-institutional desert (p-desert) and institutional desert (i-desert). Those who recognize p-desert argue that although specific desert bases or deserved modes of treatment are often defined within a particular associational, organizational, or institutional context, desert is a concept that is logically prior to and independent of both tacit and explicit institutional criteria and rules. They argue that the conflation of p-desert with i-desert is based on a failure to recognize the distinction between desert as a general normative concept and a particular type of desert that is influenced by institutions. According to this view, the distinction between p-desert and i-desert is based on an important difference between one deserving something regardless of whether one is a part of an institution and deserving a specific thing based mostly or wholly on institutional criteria or rules. The reason why someone deserves a specific trophy made of a specific material for his effort and performance toward winning a particular automobile race is because there is an institution that holds and regulates such an event. But the underlying reason why the person deserves something for winning the automobile race is that, pre-institutionally, effort and performance give rise to desert. Some argue that rejecting p-desert is problematic since, without it, there is no independent normative concept of desert. That is, there is no concept of desert that is external to any given institution which can be used to evaluate the justice of institutions. Another difficulty with the rejection of p-desert is that it would disallow the seemingly reasonable claim that a person can deserve something even if she is not a part of any identifiable institution. One could argue that a person could deserve something in a state of nature or that she could deserve something even if she were the last person on Earth. If she were to work hard to build a shelter and grow crops, for example, one could argue that she thereby deserves the benefits that resulted from those activities. Some who argue that John Rawls’s theory of justice as fairness allows for desert in distributive contexts interpret his theory as advancing a purely institutional conception of desert. Samuel Scheffler (2000) argues that Rawls rejects prejusticial desert and not pre-institutional desert, however. According to Scheffler, Rawls rejects prejusticial desert because Rawls thinks that desert can exist only after the principles of justice have been established. Scheffler interprets Rawls as arguing that a person deserves whatever it is that justice dictates he should receive and only what justice dictates he should receive. On this view, desert is not prejusticial since desert is defined in terms of justice as opposed to justice being defined, at least in part, in terms of desert. But justice is understood as being pre-institutional since justice is a normative concept, external to any particular institution, which can be used to judge institutions. The rejection of prejusticial desert will be viewed as problematic by those who, following more traditional conceptions of justice, define justice, at least in part, in terms of desert. The concern is that defining desert in terms of justice, instead of defining justice in terms of desert, results in a backward understanding of the relationship between the two concepts.

4. Meritocracy

In general, a meritocracy is a social system in which advancement, reward, and status are based on individual abilities and talents. In theory, those who are more able and talented would advance further, reap greater rewards, and achieve loftier status. Meritocracy can involve attempting to erect a basic structure of society according to the ideas of a meritocracy or it can involve attempting to implement a system in which a society’s basic institutions are governed, at least in part, by principles of awarding jobs and specifying rewards for jobs on the basis of merit. Although the two issues are sometimes conflated, Norman Daniels notes that whether someone merits a job is separate from what rewards are attached to that job. So, while a person might merit a particular job of great importance, one should not assume that he merits higher wages or greater rewards than another person who merits a job of much less importance (Daniels, 218-219). As discussed above, there is some scholarly disagreement about the relationship between merit and desert. For those who offer clear distinctions between the two, a social system in which advancement, reward, and status were based on desert would be different from one in which such benefits were based on merit. A system of merit would be based on persons’ abilities and talents, whereas a system based on desert would focus on persons’ efforts and performances for which they are responsible. As a result, although the creation of either would be difficult, the creation of a system based on desert, a “desertocracy” if you will, seems to be more problematic than one based on merit. This is because a desertocracy would seem to require more, and more specific, information about persons than would a meritocracy.

5. Some Arguments against Desert

While many consider desert to be an important conceptual component of justice, others have argued against this view. Some argue that the concept of desert itself is problematic. This is known as the metaphysical argument against desert. Others claim that, even if desert is a defensible concept, determining what people deserve or treating people according to what they deserve is not feasible. These ideas are defended in the epistemological and pragmatic arguments against desert. Some maintain that, regardless of the force of the metaphysical, epistemological, or pragmatic arguments, desert does not have a prominent role in distributive justice. Examples of this view can be found in right- and left-libertarian theories of justice.

a. Rawls’s Metaphysical Argument

Among the contemporary theories of justice in which desert does not have a prominent role, John Rawls’s is the most often discussed. Drawing from Herbert Spiegelberg’s (1944, 113) idea that the inequalities of birth are types of underserved discrimination, Rawls (1971, 104) claims that desert does not apply to one’s place in the distribution of native endowments, one’s initial starting place in society, i.e. the familial and social circumstances into which one is born, or to the superior character that enables one to put forth the effort to develop one’s abilities. As is often the case with Rawls’s work, as evidenced by the discussion of pre-institutional and prejusticial desert above, there are many competing interpretations of his views on the relationship between desert and justice. Yet, regardless of which of these interpretations is correct, Rawls work suggests a metaphysical argument against desert. According to this metaphysical argument, since most of who we are and what we do is greatly influenced by undeserved native endowments and by the undeserved circumstances into which we are born, one cannot deserve anything, or, at best, one can deserve very little. According to a common interpretation, Rawls believes that desert should not have any role in distributive justice, since these undeserved factors have a major influence on all would-be desert bases (Sher 1987, 22 ff). Others contend that Rawls does allow for some limited amount of desert (Moriarty 2002, 136-137). Regardless of whether Rawls does allow for some limited amount of desert, if sound, the metaphysical argument against desert would either substantially or completely undermine the concept.

b. The Epistemological and Pragmatic Arguments

David Hume was an early critic of those theories of distributive justice in which merit was assigned a prominent role. Although, as discussed above, there are differences between the concepts of desert and merit, and although Hume’s use of the term ‘merit’ differs from more modern uses, the kinds of arguments that Hume offered against merit are often used against desert in contemporary discussions. Hume argued that since humans are both fallible in their knowledge of the factors that would establish others’ merit and prone to overestimating their own merit, distributive schemes based on merit could not result in determinate rules of conduct and would be utterly destructive to society (Hume, 27). This thinking is captured in the epistemological and pragmatic arguments against desert. According to the epistemological argument, since we cannot know the specific details of the lives of every member in a community or society, we cannot accurately treat people according to their desert. Recall that effort and performance are commonly cited as appropriate desert bases. Even if one agrees that only effort and performance should be used to determine one’s desert, concerns about how such determinations could be made with any accuracy or consistency still remain. How could one know how much of a person’s performance was the result of effort as opposed to natural talent, brute luck, or any other number of complicating factors? The pragmatic argument against desert is that, regardless of whether we could gain the knowledge needed to treat people according to their desert accurately, attempting to do so would have overriding negative consequences. Such negative consequences could include expending large amounts of time and resources in an effort to make accurate desert judgments and, perhaps, losses of personal privacy as one delves into the details of others’ lives. Both the epistemological and pragmatic arguments must be accounted for when attempting to explain how a true meritocracy could and should be arranged. Those who do not advocate meritocracies on a large scale might overcome the difficulties suggested by the epistemological and pragmatic arguments by maintaining that the use of desert should be limited to smaller, local contexts. According to this view, since it is easier to determine a person’s desert in contexts that are limited in size and scope, accurate desert judgments would be both possible and feasible in such contexts.

c. Libertarian Arguments

According to Libertarianism, each individual agent fully owns himself. As a full self-owner, the agent is entitled to use his various abilities to acquire property rights in the world. For the libertarian, the primary goal of justice is the protection of negative liberty. Based on a principle of non-interference, negative liberty is understood as the absence of constraints on an individual’s actions. Some mark a distinction between right-libertarianism and left-libertarianism. Perhaps the most well-known explication of right-libertarianism, which is often understood as the traditional version of libertarianism, is given by Robert Nozick in Anarchy, State, and Utopia. Nozick advances an entitlement theory of justice. On this view, a just distribution is one in which each person is entitled to the holdings that she possesses according to the principles of justice in acquisition, transfer, and rectification. Nozick describes his entitlement theory as “historical,” because it determines the justice of holdings on the basis of how those holdings came to be held, and “unpatterned,” because the justice of holdings is not determined on the basis of some additional normative criteria, such as merit, need, or effort (1974, 155 ff). Because meritocracies are patterned, Nozick would reject them. Right-libertarians would be concerned with liberty-restricting attempts at distributing or redistributing resources according to prevailing conceptions of merit or desert. Therefore, the concept of desert does not have a major role in their theories of justice. Libertarians need not reject the concept of desert entirely, however. And Nozick offers various arguments against Rawls’s rejection of desert (1974, 215 ff). For the right-libertarian, desert could be a concept for the individual to consider in his personal decision-making processes, but not one that the state should use to try to guide allocations or distributions of resources. As with right-libertarianism, left-libertarianism is based on the idea that each individual agent fully owns himself. But the left-libertarian view about the appropriation of natural resources differs greatly from the right-libertarian view. Left-libertarians believe in the egalitarian ownership of natural resources. Anyone who appropriates a natural resource would have to pay others for the value of that resource. Such a payment might then be placed into a social fund, from which distributions to other members of a society are made. The resources are divided according to egalitarian principles and not on the basis of merit or desert. The rejection of desert as a basis of distribution could be based on the metaphysical argument that, strictly speaking, people do not deserve anything. Or, a left-libertarian could recognize desert as a distributive concept, but one that is less important than equality. According to such a view, equality, and not desert, should be the primary basis of distribution within a society.

6. Concluding Remarks

Despite its use in daily life, desert is a concept that remains somewhat nebulous. Regardless of certain areas of disagreement, those who recognize desert as an important normative concept generally agree on a number of issues regarding the nature of desert. One point of general agreement is that desert consists of, at least, three main parts – a subject, a mode of treatment, and a desert base. In addition, scholars generally argue in favor of the view that desert is applicable to human beings, or at least some subset of them. Lastly, scholars generally agree that understanding the nature of desert is important to understanding the nature of justice.

7. References and Further Reading

Aristotle. Nicomachean Ethics. 2^nd Ed. Translated, with an Introduction, by Terence Irwin. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1999.
- An accessible translation that also includes detailed notes and a glossary.
Boylan, Michael. A Just Society. Lanham, MD: Rowan & Littlefield, 2004.
- Presents a worldview theory of ethics and social philosophy.
Celello, Peter. “Against Desert as a Forward-Looking Concept.” Journal of Applied Philosophy 26, no.2 (May 2009): 144-159.
- Argues that desert should be understood as a strictly backward-looking concept.
Cummiskey, David. “Desert and Entitlement: A Rawlsian Consequentialist Account.” Analysis, 47, no. 1 (Jan., 1987): 15-19.
- Advances an institution-dependent account of desert.
Daniels, Norman. “Merit and Meritocracy.” Philosophy and Public Affairs, 7, no. 3 (1978): 206-233.
- A discussion of meritocracy, and the meriting of both jobs and the rewards attached to those jobs.
Feinberg, Joel. Doing and Deserving: Essay in the Theory of Responsibility. Princeton: PrincetonUniversity Press, 1970.
- A collection of previously published essays, and previously unpublished lectures, focused on issues surrounding the harm and benefit of others.
Feldman, Fred. “Desert: Reconsideration of Some Received Wisdom.” Mind, New Series 104, no. 413 (January 1995): 63-77.
- Argues against the ideas that desert must be backward-looking and that desert requires responsibility.
Feldman, Fred. “Responsibility as a Condition for Desert.” Mind, New Series 105, no. 417 (January 1996): 165-68.
- A reply to Smilansky’s “The Connection between Responsibility and Desert: The Crucial Distinction,” in which Feldman argues that Smilansky’s solution to maintaining a connection between desert and responsibility fails.
Hume, David. An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals. Edited by J. B. Schneewind. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett, 1983.
- A presentation of Hume’s moral philosophy in which he develops ideas from Book III of A Treatise of Human Nature.
Kekes, John. Against Liberalism. Ithaca, NY: CornellUniversity Press, 1997.
- A sustained criticism of political liberalism, which includes a defense of the view that justice should be understood to combine desert and consistency.
Kristjánsson, Kristján. “Justice, Desert, and Virtue Revisited.” Social Theory and Practice 29, no. 1 (January 2003): 39-63.
- Argues that the sole basis for desert is moral virtue.
McLeod, Owen. “Contemporary Interpretations of Desert: Introduction.” In Pojman and McLeod, eds., (1999a): 61-69.
- A brief essay about desert, its bases, and its relation to other concepts.
McLeod, Owen. “Desert and Institutions.” In Pojman and McLeod, eds., (1999b): 186-95.
- Argues that some desert is institutional and some is preinstitutional.
Mill, John Stuart. Utilitarianism. 2^nd ed. Edited by George Sher. Indianapolis: Hackett, 2001.
- Mill’s highly influential explication of the normative ethical theory of utilitarianism.
Miller, David. Principles of Social Justice. Cambridge, MA: HarvardUniversity Press, 1999.
- A theory of social justice that includes detailed treatments of the concept of desert and its role in justice.
Miller, David. Social Justice. Oxford: OxfordUniversity Press, 1976.
- A work on social justice, including a chapter devoted to desert.
Moriarty, Jeffrey. “Against the Asymmetry of Desert.” Nous 37, no. 3 (2003): 518–536.
- Argues against the view that desert can have an important role in retributive justice, while not having an important role in distributive justice.
Moriarty, Jeffrey. “Desert and Distributive Justice in A Theory of Justice.” Journal of Social Philosophy 33, no. 1 (Spring 2002): 131-43.
- Argues that John Rawls recognizes pre-institutional desert and that Rawls’s failure to consider such desert in his theory of justice seems unjust.
Nozick, Robert. Anarchy, State, and Utopia. New York: Basic Books, 1974.
- An influential defense of libertarian principles.
Plato. Laws. Translated by Trevor J. Saunders. In Plato: Complete Works, edited by John Cooper. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1997.
Plato. Republic. Translated by G. M. A. Grube. Revised by C. D. C. Reeve. In Plato: Complete Works.
- The Complete Works contains recent translations of all of Plato’s works, dubia, and spuria.
Pojman, Louis. “Equality and Desert.” Philosophy, 72, no. 282 (Oct. 1997): 549-570.
- Argues that the underlying justification of punishment and reward is desert or merit.
Pojman, Louis. Justice. Upper Saddle River, NJ: Pearson, 2006.
- An accessible introduction to different theories of justice, which includes a chapter on justice as desert.
Pojman, Louis, and Owen McLeod, eds. What Do We Deserve?: A Reader on Justice and Desert. New York: OxfordUniversity Press, 1999.
- Contains selections from many influential works on desert and its role in justice.
Rachels, James. “What People Deserve.” In Can Ethics Provide Answers?: And Other Essays in Moral Philosophy, 175-97. Lanham, MD: Rowman and Littlefield, 1997.
- A chapter on desert, which includes a discussion of the relationship between desert and responsibility and a discussion of desert’s temporal orientation.
Rawls, John. A Theory of Justice. Cambridge, MA: HarvardUniversity Press, 1971.
- Rawls’s seminal work in which he advances a theory of justice as fairness.
Scheffler, Samuel. “Justice and Desert in Liberal Theory.” California Law Review 88 (May 2000): 965-90.
- Discusses Rawls’s view on the asymmetry between desert’s role in distributive and retributive justice, and argues that Rawls rejects prejusticial, but not pre-institutional desert.
Schmidtz, David. Elements of Justice. Cambridge: CambridgeUniversity Press, 2006.
- Argues for a pluralist theory of justice based on principles of equality, desert, need, and reciprocity.
Schmidtz, David. “How to Deserve.” Political Theory 30, no. 6 (December 2002): 774-99.
- Includes a “promissory account” of desert, which has forward-looking aspects.
Sher, George. Desert. Princeton: PrincetonUniversity Press, 1987.
- A detailed examination of desert and its role in justice.
Sidgwick, Henry. The Methods of Ethics. 7^th ed. London: Macmillan, 1907.
- His seminal work in which he discusses egoism, intuitional morality, and utilitarianism.
Smilansky, Saul. “The Connection between Responsibility and Desert: The Crucial Distinction.” Mind, New Series 105, no. 419 (July 1996a): 485-86.
- A reply to Feldman’s “Desert: Reconsideration of Some Received Wisdom,” in which Smilansky argues that there is a connection between desert and responsibility.
Smilansky, Saul. “Control, Desert, and the Difference between Distributive and Retributive Justice. Philosophical Studies, 131(3) (2006): 511–524.
- Provides a defense of the asymmetry between desert’s role in distributive and retributive justice.
Smilansky, Saul. “Responsibility and Desert: Defending the Connection.” Mind, New Series 105, no. 417 (January 1996b): 157-63.
- A reply to Feldman in which Smilansky argues for a distinction between positive and negative responsibility conditions for desert.
Spiegelberg, Herbert. “A Defense of Human Equality.” Philosophical Review 53, no. 2 (1944): 101-24.
- Defends an ethical principle of human equality, and a view of justice based on that principle.

Author Information

Peter Celello
Email: celello.3@osu.edu
Ohio State University Newark
U. S. A.

American Wilderness Philosophy

Wilderness has been defined in diverse ways, but most famously in the Wilderness Act of 1964, which describes it “in contrast with those areas where man and his own works dominate the landscape … as an area where the earth and its community of life are untrammeled by man, where man himself is a visitor who does not remain.” The idea of wilderness has played a curious and crucial role in American culture generally, and especially in the rise of American environmentalism. Conquering wilderness was central to colonial and pioneer narratives of progress. Reverence and nostalgia for wilderness became tangled with American nationalism at the end of the 19^th century, with the end of the frontier. The passage of the Wilderness Act was an historically important event in American environmental politics, which tied the fate of much of America’s public lands to disputes over the meaning of wilderness. Since then, critics both international and domestic, but mostly from within the environmental movement, have criticized the idea of wilderness. Not that preserving or protecting natural places is a bad idea, rather they argue that thinking about nature in terms of wilderness obscures important issues and leads to bad decisions.

Etymology
Historical Attitudes
1. Sources of Antipathy
2. Sources of Appreciation
Wilderness Preservation: Major Figures
The Wilderness Act
Critical Scholarship
References and Further Reading

1. Etymology

The etymology, or history of a word, is sometimes offered as though the roots revealed the word’s correct, present meaning. This is a misunderstanding, as the meaning of a word changes over time and may end up far from its original use. However, an etymology may provide important clues into the biography of an idea and may have rhetorical significance when the meaning of a word is contested. Both of these are true of the etymology of wilderness. A rough summary of the roots of wilderness is a place essentially characterized by wild animals. The oldest and central root in this word is wild. It is present in Common Germanic, and is found in Old English as wilde, with surviving instances from c.725 as an adjective for plants and animals that were not tamed or domesticated and applied similarly to places by c.893. The Oxford English Dictionary gives its probable origin as the pre-Germanic ghweltijos, with a possible parallel in the root of the Latin and Greek words for wild beast.

An alternate and apparently mistaken origin of wild often given in the wilderness literature, repeated in Thoreau’s journals and given by Roderick Nash for instance, is that it is the past participle of will (Nash 2014). Wilderness is understood to be self-willed land, not subjected to the will of a domesticator or cultivator. The resonance of the idea is strong, but unfortunately the Old English willian, the root of will, has no clear connection to wilde. One upshot of rejecting this interpretation is that wild is first a word for plants and animals, later applied by analogy to people, and not vice versa as Nash reports.

The next piece in the etymology is the Common Germanic word for beast, found in Old English as deor. This was combined with wilde to form wilddeor, “wild animal,” with instances known from c.825. The “(d)er” which separates wilderness from wildness, is the root of our modern word for deer. In Old English, this was combined with the suffix –en, to make the adjective wilddeoren, which became wildern in Middle English, and was used to describe places. The –en suffix generally denotes what something is made of, as in “wooden” and “earthen,” so a wildern place is one made of wilddeor, of wild beasts. To this is joined the suffix –ness in an unusually concrete sense to form wilderness..

The centrality of wild animals in the etymology is important. Wilderness points not only to the absence of human culture in the landscape but to the presence of that which is often incompatible with it. When the wolves and the bears flourish, the domestic livestock are in danger, and people fear to walk at night. And wild beasts are easily displaced by human activity and presence. Aldo Leopold calls the crane “wildness incarnate” because of its love of solitude (1949). Nash draws out this connection to animals when he interprets the etymology as “the place of wild beasts” (1970). “If wildlife is removed,” he writes, “although everything else remains visibly the same, the intensity of the sense of wilderness is diminished” (Nash 1970). He cites Thoreau’s delight in the New England Lynx, Theodore Roosevelt’s equating wilderness with big game ranges and Leopold’s discussion of the last Grizzly on Escudilla. Leopold often treats particular species as defining the character of the places they dwell.

2. Historical Attitudes

A history of conflicted attitudes towards wild places and nonhuman nature goes much further back than the roots of the word wilderness. Many languages have no equivalent word to wilderness, but still they have managed sophisticated literature on the question. Both the beauty and the inhospitality of wild nature, and humanity’s ambiguous relationship to it, are common themes going back to the very oldest preserved literature.

In telling the history of attitudes toward wild nature, there are two opposite errors of oversimplification to avoid. On the one hand, some treat the modern American and romantic elevation of wilderness as something entirely new, contrasting with previous expressions of antipathy toward wild nature. Roderick Nash (2014) leans in this direction when he says wilderness began “as the unrecognized and unnamed environmental norm for most of Earth’s history, created as a concept by civilization, thereafter widely hated and feared, and quite recently and remarkably, appreciated.” On the other hand, one might find romantic sounding passages of wilderness appreciation in diverse ancient texts, whether the Epic of Gilgamesh, the Vedas or the Psalms, and conclude that there is nothing particularly new or interesting about the American idea. The more interesting historical questions are the more nuanced considerations concerning how and why wilderness is valued or shunned across times and cultures.

a. Sources of Antipathy

While there was no universal hatred or fear of wild nature in the ancient world, at least not to the exclusion of a great deal of appreciation, there was a remarkable degree of denigration of wild nature, reaching something of a climax in early modern Europe. Romanticism was in part a reaction against this, and the ideas that lead to it, and modern wilderness appreciation and preservation took root in the soil of romanticism. The origins of that hostility are variously attributed to the Jewish and Christian scriptures, Greek and Roman philosophy, the scientific and industrial revolutions, or some combination of these.

Clear claims of anthropocentrism, of the relative worthlessness and proper subjugation of wild nature, are frequently found in ancient Greek and Roman philosophers. Here, rationality is established both as the substance of dignity and worth and as the dividing line between the human and the nonhuman (as well as marking the proper hierarchies between some humans and others). Plato, in the voice of Socrates, makes clear his limited estimation of the value of wild things in the Phaedrus (section 230d) when he writes, “I am devoted to learning; landscapes and trees have nothing to teach me—only the people in the city can do that.” Aristotle shows a much greater inclination to appreciate and study wild nature, but he makes clear its subjugation and secondary value: nature making nothing in vain means that it all must exist for the sake of man (Politics 1256b7-22). Chrysippus agrees, finding it absurd to think that the world could have been made for the plants, or the irrational animals (cited in Coates 1998). The Roman philosopher Lucretius describes the presence of forests, mountains and wild beasts on the earth as a serious defect, taking heart that “these regions it is generally in our power to shun” (cited in Nash 2014). This is not to say that there were no elements of appreciation for wild nature in Greek or Roman society or letters, for that is not the case. But there was a clearly articulated and enduring view which implied wild nature was essentially wasted space.

Many commentators, including Nash, have followed Lynn White’s lead in pointing to theism and the Jewish and Christian scriptures as the source of antipathy toward wild nature (White 1967). These scriptures had a formative influence on modern attitudes toward wilderness because of the prominent use of the word in English translations of the Bible. Spiritual connotations, especially from the Exodus account of the Israelites wandering in the wilderness for forty years, were laid onto the word, as well as new physical associations with arid and desert landscapes. The meaning of these spiritual connotations is complex, as wilderness is at once a place of divine revelation as well as temptation and punishment. The Bible does not clearly convey an overarching attitude of fear or hatred of the wild. Genesis 1 repeatedly declares the goodness of everything, prior to the creation of humans. The Psalms celebrate both the useless parts of nature, such as rock badgers, as well as the dangerous, such as lions, as independently glorifying to God (Psalm 104). Animals, both wild and domestic, plants and even soil are given protections in the Mosaic Law (for example, Exodus 23:10-11; Deuteronomy 20:19-20, 22:6, 25:4), and God is described as making covenant with the Earth and all its creatures (Genesis 9). Even the often cited passage giving people dominion over the other animals, does not clearly put them at human disposal, for it manifestly did not include permission to eat animals (Genesis 1:28-29; Genesis 9:3).

As Greco-Roman philosophy and Christian theology increasingly joined together in medieval and modern European intellectual culture, the ideas of Plato and Aristotle were given new expression in biblical and theological language. Rationality is privileged by Aquinas in this combined way, for instance, arguing that only the rational creatures can know and love God and thereby fulfill the purpose of creation (Summa Contra Gentiles c.1270). The enlightenment and scientific revolution included a great revival of interest in Greek and Roman philosophy, and serious interest in nature was focused onto the search for universal, mathematical laws. Francis Bacon’s writings in the early 17^th century established a lasting connection between the idea of dominion in Genesis and the project of scientific-technological mastery over nature. The metaphor of nature as machine came to dominate. Descartes argued that, lacking rationality, non-human animals should not be supposed to have souls or consciousness at all, but are mere automata, to be freely experimented upon (Discourse on Method 1637). As the scientific project bore fruit in the industrial revolution, the dominant view of wild nature was as disordered material which could be brought into rational order through science and labor, and thus serve its ultimate purpose of existing for the benefit of mankind. This view is clearly expressed in John Locke’s influential labor-theory of property, which justifies the human worker’s property rights over nature on the basis of nature having little to no value before the worker’s labor was mixed with it (Second Treatise on Government 1689).

The Lockean attitude toward wilderness as waste is clearly evident among the early American colonists. For instance, the Puritan John Winthrop gave as a reason for going to America that it would be wrong to let a whole continent lie waste (Nash 2014). Justification for displacing indigenous people was often asserted on the basis that they had not worked it, or at least not rationally. And the attitude continued to dominate well into the settlement of the west. Alexis de Tocqueville complained upon visiting America in the 1830s that Americans could only see their wilderness as an obstacle to progress (cited in Nash 2014). During the time of the exploration, colonization and settlement of the North America by the Europeans, the idea that the less rational parts of nature existed for the sake of the more rational was thoroughly entrenched. And wilderness especially had to be transformed by labor to fulfill that purpose.

b. Sources of Appreciation

The scientific revolution also produced a contrary attitude towards nonhuman nature, however, best expressed in a group known as the physic-theologians. Writers such as John Ray (1627-1705) found in wild nature, not the absence of rationality, but the rational design of God, worthy of study and contemplation. Indeed, studying wild nature was thought to be an especially important path to understanding God, since only wild nature was unaffected by the fall and sin of mankind. Physico-theology contributed to the rise and influence of natural history, an approach to science that in turn deeply informed the wilderness preservation movement.

The practice of natural history flourished in America in the 18^th and 19^th centuries and was characterized by the description, collection and classification of natural specimens and objects. The fondness of European aristocrats and intellectuals for natural curiosities from around the world made natural history a singular way for colonists to stay connected to the social and intellectual affairs of Europe. The travel and work of natural historians was thus often tangled with the broader European projects of exploration and conquest, and the naturalists, who frequently found themselves caring for what was being destroyed, often expressed significant concern about this connection. Natural historians were largely generalists, writing about nature as a comprehensive whole, and often organized in local, amateur, natural history societies (Smallwood 1967). Some like Alexander von Humboldt, were well connected members of European society who travelled over much of the world, while others like John and William Bartram and John James Audubon were from the colonies and travelled only regionally. Artistic and literary abilities were crucial for their success, and the travel narratives of naturalists became a popular literary genre, where some of the earliest and strongest positive evaluations of wild nature found their greatest audiences.

Romanticism, a multifaceted cultural trend and backlash against the scientific and industrial revolutions, brought not just an acceptance but an enthusiastic veneration of wild nature and wilderness to cultural prominence. Romanticism had strong connections to the natural history tradition: William Wordsworth and Samuel Coleridge were readers of William Bartram (Smallwood 1967), and Alexander von Humboldt was closely associated with Goethe. But romanticism’s influence on wilderness appreciation comprised much more than its further endorsement of natural history as a significant mode of science. Romanticism treated aesthetic responses to nature as just as important as nature’s quantifiable properties, and developed a robust conception of the sublime. Romantic trends in literature and painting, especially the Hudson River school, produced many powerful, positive portrayals of wilderness. Suspecting that modern industrial society corrupts people rather than cultivates them, romanticism also endorsed primitivism and the pursuit of frequent solitude in nature.

Another aspect of romanticism that was important for the rise of wilderness preservation, was its emphasis on nationalism. America’s great wilderness became a point of pride and national identity, something that set it apart from Europe. The historian Frederick Jackson Turner argued that several aspects of the American character, from self-reliance to a democratic spirit, were products of the American frontier experience (1921). And he worried that the continuation of the American national distinctiveness was jeopardized by the end of the frontier, which was formally declared in the 1890 census. Frontier nostalgia drove a lot of early preservation work, as well as related phenomena, particularly the scouting movement and recreational hunting.

America also saw the development of a distinctive form of the romantic movement known as American transcendentalism. Ralph Waldo Emerson’s Nature, a seminal text for transcendentalism, explores the importance of solitude, the beauty of nature and the significance for both of these for understanding God. Emerson’s influence on Henry David Thoreau, and his long relationship with him, plants the roots of the American wilderness preservation movement firmly in transcendentalism. For Thoreau is the first major figure and intellectual of the wilderness tradition.

Another important factor in in the growing appreciation of wilderness was America’s early experience with extensive deforestation. Among the many who bemoaned this loss, none articulated the problem for the public more clearly and effectively than George Perkins Marsh. His 1864 Man and Nature first clearly indicted deforestation for its effects on soil and water. Marsh refuted the naïve optimism of the day, concerning the beneficial effects of all human labor on nature, and outlined rather the devastating, unintended harms caused by inappropriate uses of land. The economically practical case he provided for the conservation of forests and general care for the land provided an important complement to the aesthetic and spiritual emphasis of the romantics.

3. Wilderness Preservation: Major Figures

Expressions of wilderness appreciation multiplied quickly in the late 19^th and early 20^th century, and many people made distinctive contributions in art, literature, science and policy. A few major figures, however, laid out distinctive visions which guided the course of wilderness preservation, and which contemporary scholars tend to treat as the defining core of the tradition.

a. Henry David Thoreau

Thoreau’s work develops many of the romantic themes towards nature. Especially in Walden, he is concerned with the degrading influence of too much society, commerce and industry and with the salutary effects of nature’s company. He was a frequent canoe traveler and mountaineer, and developed a daily habit of extensive hiking. Both Walden and his travel writings argue for the existence of deeper meanings and higher uses in nature than as mere material for the human economy. He found the aesthetic value of nature to be spiritually and morally important, and woefully underappreciated. But he also spoke of a broader point view, which sees the weeds as food for the birds and the squirrels as planters of the forest. Recognizing that nature, often in the very places it is widely despised, has hidden and indirect values, he anticipates the contemporary economic idea of ecosystem services.

After his stay at Walden Pond, Thoreau turned his energies increasingly to natural history, particularly in the mode of Humboldt. He expressed some concern about the possibility of a purely scientific disenchanting nature and dulling of the imagination. But he was committed to cultivating the greatest awareness of nature as possible and to fully appreciating the value of facts, refusing to reduce appearances to the merely symbolic as Emerson had tended to. He kept careful records of plant and animal distribution and phenology, which have proven valuable for current climate science, and made seminal contributions to the understanding of forest succession and seed distribution. Unfortunately Thoreau’s early death left many of these projects unfinished and unpublished, although most are now available. His extensive journals, influential works in their own right, show a rich blending of this careful attention to natural history with the poetic and philosophical insight.

The essay Walking, revised and reworked until the end of his life, is particularly significant for wilderness thought. In this essay he treats wildness as the highest ideal of ethics and aesthetics and defends the view that both land and people need a balance of the cultivated and the wild, albeit sharply tilted toward the wild. In this work appears his oft-quoted dictum that “In wildness is the preservation of the world.” Max Oelschlaeger points to Thoreau’s lament for pine trees reduced to mere lumber as the earliest and clearest statement of a preservationist’s credo: “Every creature is better alive than dead, men and moose and pine trees, and he who understands it aright will rather preserve its life than destroy it” (cited in Oelschlaeger 1991). Other late works, such as Huckleberries, progress from his early radical valuations of nature to clear preservationist policy arguments for parks, greenways and protected areas.

Considered a minor figure at first, then highly esteemed in American literature and political thought, Thoreau’s philosophical contributions—not only to environmental philosophy but also epistemology, philosophy of science and ethics—received increasing attention in the early 21^st century.

b. John Muir

The Muir family emigrated from Scotland when Muir was a young boy, as his father sought the opportunity to live his Campbellite faith more authentically. Muir’s childhood was saturated with an evangelical Biblicism and the poetry of Robert Burns, the Scottish romantic. His experience as a frontier farmer was largely negative, as he was sorely abused by his father for hard labor. Thanks in part to his genius for mechanics and invention, he found his way to the University of Wisconsin in Madison where he found an enthusiasm for botany. He also encountered transcendentalism and a romantic, nature-centered spirituality, which at first supplemented and then gradually transformed his evangelical faith. There is substantial debate on if and when he might be considered a pantheist. What is clear is that Muir’s wilderness philosophy is often expressed in much more intensely religious language than Thoreau’s, and is frequently wrapped in biblical metaphor.

Frequently a solitary traveler in the wilderness himself, he often focused on the potential of wilderness and of nature study for personal and spiritual transformation. His prescription for overworked and materialistic America was a conversion, a baptism in mountain beauty and reconciliation to wild nature. Muir found nature to be not only sublime and beautiful but earnestly benevolent. Even what appears harsh and destructive in nature, such as glaciation (a process on which he became a significant expert), should be seen as part of the ongoing, loving, creative process. Like Thoreau, Muir found tame and domestic plants and animals to be generally degraded versions of their wild counterparts, and he sometimes spoke in terms of the rights of nonhuman nature.

Muir’s increasing political significance grew out of his personal involvement with Yosemite, and its gradual progress toward becoming a national park. He became convinced that federal ownership was the only way that such exceptional places could be preserved from destruction. While God had preserved California’s giant trees through the ages, he wrote, only Uncle Sam could protect them from fools (1901). His eloquent writing on behalf of national parks and preservation made him a figurehead for the movement, a role which was formalized with the formation of the Sierra Club with him as charter president.

Early in the 20^th century, the movement for conservation on public lands began to fracture. Muir came to represent one end of a spectrum on how much and what sort of economic uses should be present in the federal reserves. Muir’s emphasis on the spiritual and aesthetic values of wilderness clashed with the progressive, utilitarian vision of Gifford Pinchot, who was more concerned that the nation’s resources should be developed efficiently for the public good, protected from shortsighted exploitation for private enrichment. The proposed and eventual damming of Hetch Hetchy Valley, within Yosemite National Park, for municipal water and power, brought this tension to bitter conflict during Muir’s later years. Muir was not opposed to productive work in nature, nor the human transformation of it in many places. He spent many profitable years working in sawmills and later managing a vineyard. But beauty, he held, is as much a need as bread or water is, and our physical needs can be met without destroying our most beautiful scenery. Just as timber can be had without cutting the redwoods, water could be had without flooding a national park. Muir saw the problem as one of greed for profit unconstrained by higher sensibilities.

c. Aldo Leopold

Aldo Leopold made significant contributions to both wilderness philosophy and policy. An avid naturalist and outdoorsman, Leopold worked within the new forest service to enhance recreation and hunting opportunities. He developed and established the scientific practice of game management. He was constant in his advocacy of a thoughtful and informed stewardship of nature, but his early confidence in the possibility and value of scientific manipulation the land for increased timber and game production was heavily tempered in his mature work.

Leopold’s major policy contribution was to push for a separate classification of land within the national forests, to be kept as roadless wilderness—a clear precursor to the Wilderness Act. Leopold, and those who followed his lead, such as Bob Marshall and the other founders of the Wilderness Society, were responding to the rise of the automobile, which Muir had not so much appreciated as a threat to wilderness. Touring and camping by automobile was growing rapidly, and the parks and forest recreation areas were filling with the roads and hotels to accommodate them. Leopold sought to protect some areas from this sort of development, first for those who wished to pursue more primitive types of recreation, including travel by canoe and pack train, and seekers of solitude, and then later for the protection of land and wildlife.

Philosophically, Leopold integrated wilderness appreciation with the maturing science of ecology, developed new arguments for preserving wilderness and articulated a moral vision for human relations to nonhuman nature, which he called the land ethic. From ecology, Leopold took a much more detailed picture of the land as an interdependent system of plants, animals, soils and natural processes—a biotic community. Understanding the land as a functionally integrated entity means that the land can be healthy or sick, analogously to an organism. Nutrients can be retained in cycles or lost; soils can be accumulated or depleted; species can persist or become extinct. Only healthy land has the capacity to replenish itself when disturbed. And since the workings of the land mechanism are beyond a full human understanding, an attitude of caution is warranted. Removing predators (the standard practice when he began his forestry career) could lead to disastrous consequences for soils and plants, a lesson he learned from personal experience.

Leopold developed the recreation argument for wilderness along several lines. Against charges of elitism, that big wilderness served the small minority with the strength and leisure time for it, he held that minority interests are worthy of protection. There is no danger of insufficient places for the more popular auto tourism, and public lands should not all be devoted to one kind of recreation. Camping and woodcraft are not only an idle nostalgia for our frontier past, they are a moral improvement upon it, directing old instincts to higher ends. He likened this change to the way football is an improvement over war; the transformation to sport preserved the best parts of the older practice without the downsides.

In later works, Leopold increasingly emphasized the value of wilderness for science. Wilderness is not the only healthy land, some traditional agricultural landscapes have showed long-term resilience, but it provides crucial examples of biotic communities that have functioned well over long time spans. Ecologists need wilderness the way doctors need healthy bodies to study. His own restoration of a worn-out farm demonstrated the practical value of this kind of ecological knowledge. Wilderness is also an important refuge for preserving wildlife, especially the large predators generally eliminated in other places. The arguments from science and wildlife are not entirely separate from the recreation argument, as Leopold suggests that wildlife study is one of the greatest forms of outdoor recreation.

The land ethic grew out of Leopold’s conviction that only a change in our ethical attitude toward the land could prevent us from spoiling it. Such a change he thought was not only possible but underway. The care people naturally feel toward their community and their neighbor can be extended to the land, for ecology clearly shows that the land is a community to which we belong. The recognition that we are plain members and citizens of that community supports the restraint and forbearance that is necessary to live in harmony with the land. Preserving the “integrity, stability and beauty of the biotic community” should limit our use of the land, as surely as economic feasibility does.

Leopold’s land ethic has been heralded as the first ecocentric ethic, an approach finally adequate to our environmental problems. It has also been criticized as offering a fascist justification for overriding individual rights in the interest of the community (Tom Regan, cited in Callicott 1987). Its lineage has also been debated: whether it is based on Darwin’s use of Hume’s ethics (Callicott 1987), or if it has more in common with the pragmatism Leopold would have encountered at Yale (Norton 1988). Either way, Leopold’s respect for the biotic community and his vision of wilderness as an important use within federal lands profoundly shaped the future of environmental thought and the coming Wilderness Act.

4. The Wilderness Act

The National Wilderness Preservation System was created with the passage of the Wilderness Act in 1964. The Act did not create a separate agency, but designated and protected roadless areas within federal lands, whether managed by the Forest Service, National Park Service, Fish and Wildlife Service or the Bureau of Land Management. The Act provides for substantial public input on proposed listings and requires congressional action for land to be added or removed from the system. Similar to national parks, wilderness areas are required to be managed under a twin mandate, kept both for the “use and enjoyment” of the people and preserving their wilderness character unimpaired.

The Wilderness Act includes a poetic definition of wilderness, which has been the subject of much critical discussion:

A wilderness, in contrast with those areas where man and his own works dominate the landscape, is hereby recognized as an area where the earth and its community of life are untrammeled by man, where man himself is a visitor who does not remain. An area of wilderness is further defined to mean in this Act an area of undeveloped Federal land retaining its primeval character and influence, without permanent improvements or human habitation, which is protected and managed so as to preserve its natural conditions and which (1) generally appears to have been affected primarily by the forces of nature, with the imprint of man’s work substantially unnoticeable; (2) has outstanding opportunities for solitude or a primitive and unconfined type of recreation; (3) has at least five thousand acres of land or is of sufficient size as to make practicable its preservation and use in an unimpaired condition; and (4) may also contain ecological, geological, or other features of scientific, educational, scenic, or historical value.

Some of the definition’s notable features are the emphasis on the absence of human presence and impact, the language of degree and subjective appearance and the unusual word, “untrammeled.” Trammel is not a form of trample, and does not involve the idea of walking. It means to bind up, constrain or fetter, not simply touch or influence. Trammel can also be a noun, referring to a kind of fish net or to rope shackles tied on a horse’s legs to keep it from galloping.

Implementation of the Wilderness Act required some interpretive decisions. The Forest Service, generally seeking to maintain more flexible control over its lands, argued for a strict interpretation of wilderness, excluding any lands with a significant history of human impact. This came to be known as the purity policy. Others, including the Wilderness Society, the non-profit organization which had first pushed for the law and shepherded it through the years of debate before it finally passed, argued for a more flexible and pragmatic understanding of wilderness (Turner 2012). Rather than looking back at whether the land had suffered human impact, the question was whether it could be managed in a way that would render human impact substantially unnoticeable in the future (Woods 1998).

At stake in this question was both how big the wilderness system could be and whether there would be more than a few wilderness areas east of the Mississippi, where historic impacts were generally greater. The forward-looking approach championed by the Wilderness Society eventually triumphed with the 1975 designation of many eastern areas with significant past impacts, which has come to be called the Eastern Wilderness Act.

Another issue that came into the question of purity was how much wilderness should be protected from recreational overuse. Frontier nostalgia tended to a form of recreational woodcraft that was fairly high impact, with campers cutting boughs for beds and lean-tos, for instance. As outdoor recreation continued to increase in popularity through the 1960s and 70s, there was debate over whether wilderness and lands for recreation ought to be given separate designations, which would have resulted in far less wilderness areas. The dilemma was mitigated with a movement toward low-impact camping, culminating in the Leave No Trace program (Turner 2002). While vastly increasing the number of people who can camp in a wilderness area without spoiling it, the new methods have also introduced a greater dependence on consumer products and synthetic materials and reduced the need for knowledge of the natural history of the place.

Another test for the meaning of federal wilderness areas would come with the debates over public lands in Alaska, where vast roadless areas often contained indigenous peoples practicing subsistence lifestyles. In 1980, the Alaska National Interest Lands Conservation Act added 56 million acres to the National Wilderness Preservation System, more than doubling its size, but permitting many activities crucial to subsistence living not permitted in designated wilderness outside Alaska. Some motorized access and even log cabins, it was decided, do not pose the same threat to the “Earth and its community of life” in Alaska as they would in the more densely populated U.S. states.

5. Critical Scholarship

Wilderness preservation has often faced criticism and opposition in the political arena. The Sagebrush Rebellion was largely a reaction against the implementation of the Wilderness Act on western lands. Such conflict is often rooted in issues of public versus private property rights. The academic literature on wilderness has tended to focus on other issues—the history of the idea, its influence on policy, and whether it represents a reasonable or appropriate approach to nonhuman nature.

Roderick Nash’s 1967 book, Wilderness and the American Mind, was the seminal work for contemporary wilderness scholarship. It traced the history of the idea of wilderness from ancient attitudes toward nature through the passage of the Wilderness Act. Nash frames the story as the remarkable rise of appreciation for wilderness from the midst of long-standing antipathy. Though not without offering some criticism, the work is largely celebratory of the wilderness tradition and preservation movement and has had an enduring popularity with the backpackers and activists as well as a lasting influence on scholarship. Much of the wilderness scholarship subsequent to Nash’s work has essentially aimed to supplement or correct the general picture given in it.

The first in a series of criticisms and responses, that came to be known as the great new wilderness debate, came from Ramachandra Guha, an environmental and political historian from India (1989). Guha argued that the radical environmental movement in America had an unhealthy focus on biocentrism and wilderness, which are largely irrelevant to the problems he claims are at the root of the environmental crisis: overconsumption and militarization. Environmentalism in India has largely been a class struggle between the rural poor, who depend on the forests for their subsistence, and the over-consuming urban industrialists, which threaten to destroy the forests and poor alike. Western environmental organizations coming into India and working to establish wilderness-like reserves, such as the tiger reserves, are further displacing traditional subsistence economies to make playgrounds for the wealthy. Wilderness, according to Guha, was not appropriate in densely and long inhabited places like India.

William Cronon, an environmental historian, and J. Baird Callicott, an environmental philosopher, followed with arguments that there was something more deeply flawed about the idea of wilderness, even in North America (Cronon 1995; Callicott 1991). Unlike Guha, both insisted that they support protected areas; their problem was with a way of thinking. Wilderness is historically false, denying the long and extensive human influences on the North American landscape, and thus continuing the denial of the humanity of Native Americans. Wilderness thinking presupposes a pre-Darwinian dichotomy between people and nature by treating only people-less places as real or pristine nature. The result of this dualism is misanthropy and a tendency to see the removal of people as the solution to every environmental problem. Holding wilderness to be the ideal form of nature, they argued, is an obstacle to a responsible environmentalism, which must help us live in harmony with nature in the places we inhabit and work not just the places we visit and play in. Cronon in particular worried that caring for pristine nature far from home makes it easier to tolerate the abuse and destruction of mundane nature close to home. Wilderness thinking, they alleged, also tends to treat nature as static, seeking to preserve a place in a particular form, instead of recognizing the dynamic processes at play in nature.

More critics soon followed, drawing out the imperialism, colonialism or ethnocentrism latent in the preservation project. Many of the criticisms were clearly grounded. Frontier nostalgia requires a certain blindness to the perspectives of Native Americans, and western style parks have been implemented in Africa in ways that are brutal to the indigenous inhabitants. But many wilderness advocates found the criticisms to be unfair overall and not helpful to achieving the responsible environmentalism the critics claimed to desire. The Wilderness Act had not endorsed an ideal of pristine or untouched nature, and the Forest Service’s attempt to interpret it that way had been roundly defeated (Friskics 2008). And the experience in Alaska had showed that wilderness preservation need not be hostile to indigenous people or traditional subsistence cultures. It is not that the environmental movement in America has only sought wilderness preservation and not worked for reform in forestry, agriculture and industry; it is just that reform efforts have often been less successful and harder to accomplish than wilderness designation (Foreman 1998).

Val Plumwood gives a thorough analysis of the issue of dualism in the wilderness tradition, finding it in the frequent appellation, “virgin,” and the legal doctrine of terra nullius in the Australian outback (1998). But she also demonstrated how much of the tradition is open to a non-dualistic interpretation, treating the other of wilderness not as the mere absence of the human but as the presence of something else. The extensive concern with natural history in all the major figures of the wilderness tradition strongly supports this non-dualistic interpretation of wilderness as presence. And if wilderness is not simply the absence of human touch, then valuing and preserving it need not lead to misanthropy. People visiting but not remaining is not the essence of wilderness but a practical strategy for protecting what is essential to wilderness: the living, active presence of nonhuman nature, whether it be grizzly bears or giant trees.

Other responses have come from the new conservationists, a diverse alliance of wilderness activists and conservation biologists, which have pushed for a much more aggressive preservation strategy in the 90s and 2000s. The Wildlands Project, for example, proposed a map of wilderness areas, buffer zones and wildlife corridors that puts 50% of the contiguous US into some form of protected status. James Turner suggests that this more aggressive strategy precipitated the great new wilderness debate (2012). But the new conservationists, such as Reed Noss and Dave Foreman, are clear that their sense of wilderness is largely about securing the wildlife habitat necessary to mitigate the extinction crisis (Foreman 1995, 1998 and Noss 1991). Rather than looking for lands supposedly never touched by people, they seek to restore much land that is presently heavily trammeled and dominated by the works of man. And rather than seeing nature as static, their pursuit of bigger and bigger wilderness areas is driven by an increased understanding of landscape dynamics and of the population sizes needed for evolution to occur.

The legacy of wilderness in America thought and policy is complex, with some parts that have many opponents (for example, the erasure of indigenous cultures and histories) and some that have very wide appeal (for example, the national parks). The writings of Thoreau, Muir and Leopold have enriched and enchanted the lives of many Americans. The National Wilderness Preservation System has been remarkably successful at preserving large roadless areas, and many conservation biologists see an extension of this strategy as the best hope for protecting biodiversity. Others have found the cultural baggage of wilderness too great, and would prefer to take other strategies, hoping to better integrate the human economy with natural systems. Clearly wilderness preservation cannot solve all environmental problems, such as environmental injustice or climate change, but it may help with a lot of problems, even those.

6. References and Further Reading

Abbey, Edward. Desert Solitaire: A Season in the Wilderness. (New York: McGraw Hill, 1968).
- An influential articulation of a wilderness philosophy, this book was written after the Wilderness Act but early in the process of review and designation. It is deeply imbued with an appreciation of the desert southwest.
Bartram, William. Travels and Other Writings. Thomas P. Slaughter, ed. (New York: Library of America, 1996).
Bartram’s Travels, first published in 1791.
- His major literary work, representing natural history in a romantic mode and a literary genre of significant importance for the growing wilderness appreciation.
Bugbee, Henry. The Inward Morning: A Philosophical Exploration in Journal Form (Athens, Ga: University of Georgia Press, 1999). First published in 1958.
- A remarkable and beautiful use of wilderness for understanding reality and our place in it. Deep Thoreauvian reflections in dialogue with mid-20^th century philosophy.
Callicott, J. Baird. “The Conceptual Foundations of the Land Ethic.” Companion to A Sand County Almanac: Interpretive and Critical Essays. J. Baird Callicott, ed. (Madison: University of Wisconsin Press, 1987): 186-217.
Callicott, J. Baird. “The Wilderness Idea Revisited: The Sustainable Development Alternative” The Environmental Professional 13 (1991): 235-47. Reprinted in The Great New Wilderness Debate.
Callicott, J. Baird and Michael Nelson, eds. The Great New Wilderness Debate (Athens, GA: University of Georgia Press, 1998).
- A comprehensive collection of contemporary wilderness criticism, including a selection of important works from across the history of the wilderness tradition. It also includes several significant original pieces.
Callicott, J. Baird and Michael Nelson, eds. The Wilderness Debate Rages On: Continuing the Great New Wilderness Debate (Athens, GA: University of Georgia Press, 2008).
- A second large collection, this volume includes a lot of the critical scholarship on wilderness published since the first collection. It also covers some gaps in the previous volume, including important works by early 20^th century ecologists and more discussion of race and class.
Chipeniuk, Raymond. “The Old and Middle English Origins of ‘Wilderness.’” Environments 21(1991): 22-28.
Coates, Peter. Nature: Western Attitudes since Ancient Times (Berkeley: University of California Press, 1998).
- This book is especially helpful on Roman and Medieval times, often skipped over in other treatments, and it balances the history of ideas with the history of the environment, considering ancient impacts in some depth.
Cole, David N. and Laurie Yung, eds. Beyond Naturalness: Rethinking Park and Wilderness Stewardship in an Era of Rapid Change. 2^nd ed. (Washington, D.C.: Island Press, 2010).
- Diverse approaches to interpreting naturalness and wildness are considered in light of the practical management of protected areas and the challenges currently facing such management, including climate change and invasive species.
Cronon, William, ed. Uncommon Ground: Rethinking the Human Place in Nature. (New York: W. W. Norton & Company, 1995).
- This anthology is largely critical of the idea of wilderness and includes Cronon’s much discussed piece, “The Trouble with Wilderness, or, Getting Back to the Wrong Nature.” It includes several other worthwhile chapters as well, particularly Anne Spirn’s chapter on the legacy of Frederick Law Olmsted.
Emerson, Ralph Waldo. Nature (Boston: James Munroe & Company, 1836).
- Emerson’s classic is widely available in print and on the internet, including a scanned image of the 1836 original.
Friskics, Scott. “The Twofold Myth of Pristine Wilderness: Misreading the Wilderness Act in Terms of Purity” Environmental Ethics 30 (2008): 381-99.
Foreman, Dave. “Wilderness Areas for Real.” The Great New Wilderness Debate.. J. Baird Callicott and Michael Nelson, eds. (Athens, GA: University of Georgia Press, 1998): 395-407.
Foreman, Dave. “Wilderness: From Scenery to Nature” Wild Earth 5(4) (Winter 1995/96): 9-16. Reprinted in The Great New Wilderness Debate.
Guha, Ramachandra. “Radical American Environmentalism and Wilderness Preservation: A Third World Critique.” Environmental Ethics 11 (1989): 71-83. Reprinted in The Great New Wilderness Debate.
Harding, Walter. The Days of Henry Thoreau: A Biography. 2^nd ed. (Mineola, NY: Dover Publications, 2011).
- First published by Knopf in 1965, this biography has seen many printings. See also Richardson, 1988.
Hargrove, Eugene C. Foundations of Environmental Ethics (Denton: Environmental Ethics Books, 1996).
- First published in 1989, this work is valuable for its discussion of the history of property rights and their tension with preservation. It also defends the viability of aesthetic arguments for preservation and their connection to wildlife conservation.
Harvey, Mark. Wilderness Forever: Howard Zhaniser and the Path to the Wilderness Act (Seattle: University of Washington Press, 2005).
- Zhaniser was the primary author of the Wilderness Act and a driving force behind its eventual passage.
Leopold, Aldo. A Sand County Almanac and Sketches Here and There. Special Commemorative Edition (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1987). First published in 1949.
- Aldo Leopold’s most influential work, accepted for publication just before his death. The last section of the book, called the “Upshot,” contains the most direct discussion of wilderness and the land ethic.
Leopold, Aldo. The River of the Mother of God and Other Essays. Susan L. Flader and J. Baird Callicott, eds. (Madison: University of Wisconsin Press, 1991).
- Many of Leopold’s other works, arranged chronologically, enabling the reader to see the development of his thought over time.
Lewis, Michael. American Wilderness: A New History (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2007).
- An anthology covering diverse aspects of the history of wilderness and preservation in America, updating and complementing Nash’s work in several ways. For instance, it includes a chapter chronicling the extensive role of women and women’s clubs in the early preservation movement.
Lowenthal, David. George Perkins Marsh: Prophet of Conservation (Seattle: University of Washington Press, 2000).
- A scholarly biography situating Marsh’s life and work in relation to the early conservation movement.
Marsh, George Perkins. Man and Nature; or, Physical Geography as Modified by Human Action (New York: Charles Scribner, 1864).
- Immensely influential on the beginnings of the conservation movement, this work by Marsh first clearly established that human labor in nature is often more destructive than helpful. He focuses on the role of forests and deforestation on the condition of waters and soils and on the possibility of people working to heal or restore damaged land.
Meine, Curt D. Aldo Leopold: His Life and Work (Madison: University of Wisconsin Press: 1988).
- This is the foremost biography of Leopold. The 2010 edition has a new preface and a contribution from Wendell Berry.
Muir, John. Our National Parks. (Boston: Houghton, Mifflin & Company, 1901).
Muir, John. Nature Writings. William Cronon, ed. (New York: Library of America, 1997.)
- Most of Muir’s writings were published first as magazine articles, and later collected into books. This collection contains many of the most influential pieces.
Nash, Roderick Frazier. Wilderness and the American Mind. 5^th ed. (New Haven: Yale, 2014)
- First published in 1967, this work was path breaking scholarship and has had enduring popularity with wilderness enthusiasts and activists. Several chapters have been added in subsequent additions, and the 5^th edition includes a forward by Char Miller.
Nash, Roderick Frazier. “‘Wild-dēor-ness,’ The Place of Wild Beasts.” Wilderness: the Edge of Knowledge. Maxine E. McCloskey, ed. (San Francisco: Sierra Club, 1970): 34-37.
Norton, Bryan G. “The Constancy of Leopold’s Land Ethic.” Conservation Biology 2(1) (1988): 93-102.
Noss, Reed. “Wilderness Recovery: Thinking Big in Restoration Ecology.” The Environmental Professional 13 (1991): 225-34. Reprinted in The Great New Wilderness Debate.
Oelschlaeger, Max. The Idea of Wilderness (New Haven: Yale, 1991).
- Extensive treatment of the major figures of the wilderness tradition. Includes a notable chapter on the poets Robinson Jeffers and Gary Snyder.
Plumwood, Val. “Wilderness Skepticism and Wilderness Dualism.” The Great New Wilderness Debate. J. Baird Callicott and Michael Nelson, eds. (Athens, GA: University of Georgia Press, 1998): 652-690.
Richardson, Robert. Henry Thoreau: A Life of the Mind (Oakland: University of California Press, 1988).
- This biography focuses on the intellectual development of Thoreau, with critical discussion of his written work.
Sachs, Aaron. The Humboldt Current: Nineteenth-Century Exploration and the Roots of American Environmentalism (New York: Viking, 2006.)
- Sachs provides an in depth discussion of the influence of romantic natural history, especially in the person of Alexander von Humboldt, on American culture and attitudes toward nature.
Smallwood, William Martin. Natural History and the American Mind (New York: AMS Press, 1967).
- Chronicles the development of natural history and its cultural importance in the American colonies and the young republic.
Spence, Mark David. Dispossessing the Wilderness: Indian Removal and the Making of the National Parks (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999).
Sutter, Paul. Driven Wild: How the Fight Against Automobiles Launched the Modern Wilderness Movement (Seattle: University of Washington Press, 2002).
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Thoreau, Henry David. Walden: A Fully Annotated Edition. Jeffrey S. Cramer, ed. (New Haven: Yale University Press, 2004).
Thoreau, Henry David. Essays: A Fully Annotated Edition. Jeffrey S. Cramer, ed. (New Haven: Yale University Press, 2013).
- This volume contains “Walking” and his most important wilderness travel and natural history writings.
Turner, Frederick Jackson. The Frontier in American History (New York: Henry Holt & Company, 1921).
- Turner’s “frontier thesis” was originally given as an address in 1893, just after the census declared the end of the frontier. The idea gave fervor to the growing frontier nostalgia, and its accuracy as history has been long debated.
Turner, Jack. The Abstract Wild. (Tucson: University of Arizona Press, 1996).
- A manifesto and sustained argument against, among other things, the sufficiency of managed parks for the preservation of wildness.
Turner, James Morton. “From Woodcraft to ‘Leave No Trace’: Wilderness, Consumerism, and Environmentalism in Twentieth-Century America” Environmental History 7(3) (2002): 462-84. Reprinted in The Wilderness Debate Rages On.
Turner, James Morton. The Promise of Wilderness: American Environmental Politics since 1964 (Seattle: University of Washington Press, 2012).
- This work picks up the history where Nash’s book left off, successfully putting to rest any notion that public lands preservation has been less important to environmentalism since the 60s. This is the best source on the way different agencies and organizations have interpreted wilderness in applying the legal designation.
White, Lynn, Jr. “The Historical Roots of Our Ecological Crisis.” Science 155 (1967): 1203-07.
Woods, Mark. “Federal Wilderness Preservation in the United States: The Preservation of Wilderness?” The Great New Wilderness Debate. J. Baird Callicott and Michael Nelson, eds. (Athens, GA: University of Georgia Press, 1998): 131-153.
Worster, Donald. A Passion for Nature: The Life of John Muir (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2008).
- An extensive biography of Muir by one of the foremost environmental historians.
Worster, Donald. Nature’s Economy: A History of Ecological Ideas. 2^nd ed. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1994).
- This is an important treatment of the romantic natural history tradition and its legacy in general, and of Thoreau in particular.

Author Information

David Henderson
Email: dghenderson@wcu.edu
Western Carolina University
U. S. A.

Ethics and Contrastivism

A contrastive theory of some concept holds that the concept in question only applies or fails to apply relative to a set of alternatives. Contrastivism has been applied to a wide range of philosophically important topics, including several topics in ethics. Contrastivism about reasons, for example, holds that whether some consideration is a reason for some action depends on what we are comparing that action to. The fact that your guests are vegetarian is a reason to make vegetable lasagna rather than make roast duck, but not a reason to make vegetable lasagna rather than make mushroom risotto. Contrastivism about obligation holds that what agents are obligated to do can likewise vary with the alternatives. So, for example, you may be obligated to take the book back to the library rather than leave it on your shelf, but not obligated to take the book back to the library rather than send it to the library with a friend. The article begins by clarifying what contrastivism is more generally, in order to see what motivates philosophers to accept contrastivism about some topic. Along the way, challenges and choice points facing the contrastivist will be highlighted. Attention is then given to exploring arguments for, and applications of, contrastivism to topics in ethics, including obligations, reasons, and freedom and responsibility.

Contrastivism in General
Contrastivism in Ethics
General Challenges
1. Setting the Contrast Class
2. Cross-Context Inferences
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Contrastivism in General

In this section we will briefly introduce the broad range of topics that have received a contrastive treatment in areas outside of ethics, and see what kinds of arguments contrastivists about some concept deploy. This will give us a broad outline of contrastivism as a general kind of view in philosophy.

a. Contrastivism in Different Domains

i. Epistemology

One of the most well known applications of contrastivism relates to knowledge. There are also contrastive theories of justification and of belief, but I will focus here on knowledge. According to the traditional, non-contrastive conception of knowledge, it is a two-place relation holding between a subject and a proposition: Ksp—s knows that p. Contrastivism, on the other hand, holds that knowledge is a three-place relation holding between a subject, a proposition, and a contrast.

There are differences in conceptions of the contrast. Some contrastivists treat the contrast as a single proposition, q, incompatible with p, yielding Kspq—s knows that p rather than q. Others treat the contrast as a set of mutually exclusive propositions, including p, Q, yielding KspQ—s knows that p out of Q, where Q may be {p, q, r, s}. This difference is non-essential, at least for most purposes, since we can translate from Kspq to KspQ by letting Q = {p, q}, and we can translate from KspQ to Kspq, where Q = {p, r, s, t}, by letting q = r˅s˅t. Many examples used in arguments for contrastivism involve the phrase “rather than”, which generally contrasts two propositions (“s knows that p rather than q”). So for these examples, the single proposition conception of the contrast is more natural. Nevertheless, we will adopt the set of alternatives conception. As we will see in the section Contrastivism and Questions, this conception more directly represents the important contrastivist idea that contrastivity can be thought of as question-relativity.

Contrastivism about knowledge has its roots in the relevant alternatives contextualist theory of knowledge, developed in, for example, Dretske (1970) and Lewis (1996). According to this theory, whether a knowledge ascription, “s knows that p”, is true in a context depends on which alternatives to p are relevant in that context, and whether s can rule them out. As the context varies, the relevant alternatives may vary, and so whether a knowledge ascription is true can also vary. Relevant alternatives theorists have worked to spell out what makes an alternative relevant in a context, but have not yet produced a very satisfying picture. Contrastivists claim to do better: the relevant alternatives are provided by a question under discussion, which we have independent reason to accept in our theory of communication. For example, linguists (for example, Roberts, 201)) have argued that positing such a question under discussion helps explain various linguistic phenomena.

Contrastivists about knowledge claim several advantages over non-contrastive conceptions. The first kind of argument for contrastivism is linguistic: the theory can make better sense of a range of knowledge ascriptions, including explicitly contrastive ascriptions (“Ann knows that it’s a zebra rather than an ostrich”), ascriptions involving intonational stress (“Ann knows that the zebra is in the pen”), and ascriptions with a wh-complement (“Ann knows where the zebra pen is”). All of these ascriptions are plausibly treated as making reference to a question under discussion, or set of alternatives.

A second kind of argument appeals to theoretical advantages of contrastivism. For example, contrastivism promises to provide a solution to puzzles that have haunted epistemology, like the closure paradox. Moore knows that he has hands, and knows that if he has hands, then he is not a brain in a vat. But Moore does not know that he is not a brain in a vat. How can this be? Well, Moore knows that he has hands rather than flippers, but he does not know that he has hands rather than that he is a brain in a vat. So according to the contrastivist, this seemingly intractable paradox actually relies on a fallacious equivocation: we cannot assume that because Moore knows that he has hands rather than flippers that he therefore knows that he has hands rather than that he’s a brain in a vat. One way to read the closure paradox is as a puzzle about knowledge ascriptions: why do we ascribe Moore knowledge that he has hands but not knowledge that he is not a brain in a vat? But there is also a nonlinguistic side to the puzzle: Moore’s knowledge that he has hands seems incompatible with his ignorance about whether he’s a brain in a vat, given a very plausible closure principle. This does not have anything directly to do with knowledge ascriptions (though obviously intuitions must be drawn out by presenting knowledge ascriptions). It rather points out something troubling about the concept of knowledge: either it does not apply where we think it does, or it does not obey the kind of logic we think it does. The contrastivist solution is to say that knowledge is a contrastive concept, so that the puzzling question is simply ill-conceived. Moore’s knowledge that he has hands is in fact not incompatible with his ignorance about whether he’s a brain in a vat. I call this a theoretical argument for contrastivism, rather than a linguistic one, because it involves showing how contrastivism can resolve paradoxes involving the concept of knowledge, not merely deliver attractive interpretations about a range of knowledge ascriptions.

There are other theoretical arguments for contrastivism about knowledge. First, the theory allows us to track inquiry (See Schaffer, 2005a). Inquiry involves answering questions and ruling out alternatives, and the contrast argument place lets us keep track of the question we are answering, and the alternatives we have ruled out. A further theoretical motivation for contrastivism about knowledge comes from the idea that the most important theoretical and practical function of knowledge is to identify good sources of information (see especially Craig, 1990; Schaffer, 2005a). The contrastivist can add to this claim the observation that when we are looking for good sources of information, we have a particular question in mind (though it may be a quite general question). A good informant for one question (for example, why is it raining rather than snowing?) may not be a good informant for a different question (for example, why is it raining rather than not precipitating at all?). So a contrastive concept of knowledge would best explain its primary function.

These arguments, like other theoretical arguments (for example, Morton, 2012) aim to show that contrastivism lets us best make sense of the theoretical, as well as practical, role of knowledge. The specifics of how these arguments go are less important for our purposes here; the important point is that there are two broad classes of arguments for contrastivism about some concept: (i) linguistic arguments and (ii) theoretical arguments. This pattern carries over to different domains, including ethics. The line between the two kinds of arguments will not be sharp. This is due in part to the fact, noted above, that often theoretical puzzles about some concept have to be drawn out by appealing to ascriptions of that concept. Though many of the clearest motivations for contrastivism do involve ascriptions of the target concept, it is nevertheless important to keep in mind that contrastivism is more than simply a linguistic thesis and has more than simply linguistic advantages.

A special case of contrastivism about knowledge—one that is especially relevant for this article—is Sinnott-Armstrong’s (2006) contrastive account of moral knowledge. Sinnott-Armstrong applies contrastivist ideas developed in his own earlier work and by contrastivists like Schaffer to moral epistemology. An interesting twist is that Sinnott-Armstrong uses contrastivism as a route to a kind of moral skepticism—the view that we do not have moral knowledge. Here is the basic idea: though many explicitly contrastive knowledge ascriptions, like “I know that it is morally wrong to terminate the pregnancy using non-sterilized equipment rather than to terminate the pregnancy using sterilized equipment”, may well be true, we should suspend judgment about the truth of non-contrastive ascriptions like “I know that it is morally wrong to terminate the pregnancy“. All knowledge ascriptions require some set of alternatives before they can be evaluated for truth. If one is not provided explicitly, Sinnott-Armstrong argues, we should understand the ascriptions as “I know that p out of the relevant contrast class”. And this is where the skeptical turn appears: Sinnott-Armstrong argues that we should be relevance skeptics—we should suspend judgment about what the relevant contrast class is. Hence, we cannot evaluate the truth of the unrelativized knowledge claims. This is not quite the dogmatic skeptical claim that we lack moral knowledge. Instead, this is a Pyrrhonian skeptical thesis: we should suspend judgment about the truth of unrelativized attributions of moral knowledge (and of knowledge more generally). Nevertheless, it is notable that other contrastivists appeal to contrastivism to resolve skeptical paradoxes, while Sinnott-Armstrong uses contrastivism in an argument for a kind of skepticism.

ii. Philosophy of Science

Contrastive theses have also been offered in the philosophy of science. Traditional theories of explanation hold that the explanatory relation holds between two relata: pEq—p explains q. Contrastive theories of explanation hold that we need at least one, and possibly two, more argument places for contrasts. We may have pQEq—p out of Q (or “rather than any other member of Q”) explains q; pEqQ—p explains q out of Q; or pQ1EqQ2—p out of Q1 explains q out of Q2. Once again, there are both linguistic arguments and theoretical arguments for these contrastivist theories. For example, “The warm temperature explains why it is raining rather than snowing” may be true, while “The warm temperature explains why it is raining rather than not precipitating” may be false. (For more on contrastivism about explanation, see van Fraassen, 1980; Lipton, 1990 and Hitchcock, 1996.)

Relatedly, philosophers have offered contrastive theories of causation. Instead of holding that the causal relation is two place, eCf—e causes f—contrastivists hold that we need at least one, and possibly two, more argument places. Either eQ1Cf, eCfQ2, or eQ1CfQ2. Contrastivism purports to solve several puzzles facing traditional non-contrastive theories of causation, including causation by absences and the puzzle of saying what the cause of some event is. (See, for example, Schaffer, 2005b, 2012; and Hitchcock, 1996a, 1996b.)

Finally, philosophers have also offered contrastive theories of confirmation. According to this view, whether some evidence confirms a hypothesis depends on what we are comparing that hypothesis to. For example, the wet sidewalk confirms the hypothesis that it rained rather than that it was sunny all day, but does not confirm the hypothesis that it rained rather than that someone washed her bike on the sidewalk a few minutes ago. (See Chandler, 2007, 2013 and Fitelson, 2012 for discussion.)

b. Contrastivism and Questions

Contrastivists often claim that their theories are ones according to which the target concept is question-relative: relative to one question, the concept holds, while relative to another, it does not. For example, Schaffer (2005a, 2007a) argues that to know that p is to know that p as the answer to the contextually relevant question. So relative to a question like, “Is the bird a canary or a raven?”, you know that it is a canary—you know the answer to this question. But relative to the question, “Is the bird a canary or a goldfinch?”, you do not know that it is a canary—you do not know the answer to this second question.

Question-relativity is a natural idea for contrastivists. Questions—thought of as the informational contents of interrogative sentences, analogously to thinking of propositions as the informational contents of declarative sentences—are standardly treated as partitions over (some part of) logical space. These partitions divide logical space into cells, so that the possibilities are grouped in mutually exclusive classes. These partitions can also be thought of, then, as sets of mutually exclusive alternatives—each alternative in the set corresponds to one cell in the partition. Thus, relativizing a concept to questions simply amounts to relativizing it to sets of alternatives, which is exactly what the contrastivist wants to do. Different questions give us different partitions, and so correspond to different sets of alternatives.

To see this approach in action, return to the epistemological example. The question expressed by “Is the bird a canary or a raven?” is represented by the set of alternatives, {the bird is a canary, the bird is a raven}. Recall that this is a representation of a partition of (part of) logical space into two cells, one containing possibilities in which the bird is a canary and the other containing possibilities in which the bird is a raven. Similarly, the question expressed by “Is the bird a canary or a goldfinch?” is represented by the set of alternatives, {the bird is a canary, the bird is a goldfinch}. If we relativize knowledge to questions, then, we can explain why “You know the bird is a canary” is true when the relevant question is the first, but false when the relevant question is the second. For now, we will assume that in a given context, there is a relevant question which supplies the set of alternatives. In the section “Setting the Contrast Class” we will consider some problems for this assumption.

More directly relevant for ethics, contrastivists about normative concepts like “ought” and reasons have developed theories according to which these concepts are relativized to deliberative questions, or questions of what to do. In a given deliberative context—the kinds of context in which we ordinarily appeal to concepts like “ought” and reasons—there is some particular deliberative question we are trying to answer, since answering a deliberative question is just deciding what to do. This question supplies the set of alternatives relative to which claims about what we ought to do or have reason to do are interpreted.

c. Non-Exhaustivity and Resolution-Sensitivity

Thinking of a contrastive theory of some concept in terms of question-relativity helps bring out two important features of contrastivism. Both of these features are exploited by contrastivists.

First, questions may partition only part of, or some subspace of, logical space. Some possibilities may just not be relevant, for one reason for another, or may be ruled out by the presuppositions of the question. For example, if I ask which beer you want to try, possibilities in which you do not want to try any of the beers are plausibly not included. You can of course say that you do not want to try any beers, but this seems more like rejecting the question (admittedly in a conversationally cooperative way), rather than answering it—answering a question requires selecting one of the alternatives, or one cell of the partition. The relevance of this point for contrastivism is that the set of alternatives to which a concept is relativized may be non-exhaustive of logical space. This is most clear in the case of explicitly contrastive “rather than” ascriptions, like “You know that the bird is a canary rather than a raven”. Here, the contrastivist about knowledge will say that this sentence means that you know that the bird is a canary relative to the set {the bird is a canary, the bird is a raven}. Clearly there are many other possibilities—the bird could be a goldfinch, a crow, a robot made to look like a canary, or you could be dreaming. Relative to sets that include some of these other alternatives, you may not know that the bird is a canary. But since, on this view, knowledge claims are relativized to non-exhaustive sets of alternatives, it may still be true that you know that it is a canary relative to {the bird is a canary, the bird is a raven}.

Second, the possibilities that are partitioned can be grouped together in more or less fine-grained ways. Some distinctions between possibilities may be respected by the partition while others are smudged over. Compare the following two sets: {it’s a bird, it’s not a bird}, {it’s a canary, it’s a goldfinch, it’s a crow, it’s some other kind of bird, it’s a robot, it’s a hallucination, it’s some other kind of non-bird}. The second set makes distinctions between possibilities that are ignored in the first set. These sets differ in what Yalcin (2011) and Cariani (2013) call resolution: sets which make more fine-grained distinctions partition (parts of) logical space at a higher resolution. To say that some concept is resolution-sensitive, at least here, is to say that it is relativized to sets that may vary in resolution. Relative to a set at one resolution, the concept may hold of something, while relative to a set at a different resolution—either higher or lower—it may not.

2. Contrastivism in Ethics

While applications of contrastivism within epistemology and the philosophy of science are more well known, contrastivism has also been applied to a wide range of topics in ethics and normative philosophy more generally. We have already seen that contrastivist ideas have interesting applications in moral epistemology. This section introduces contrastivism about obligation, normative reasons, and freedom and moral responsibility. Having already introduced contrastivism more generally in the previous section, I will focus primarily on describing the specific motivations for the contrastive theories in ethics.

One application of contrastivist ideas in ethics that I will not discuss in detail is due to Driver (2012). Driver suggests a contrastive conception of luck, and makes use of this in her defense of a consequentialist treatment of moral luck. The central contrastivist claim is that no one, or no event, is lucky simpliciter. Rather, something is only lucky or unlucky relative to some contrasts. For example, a patient may be lucky to survive a serious illness rather than die from it, but not lucky to survive the serious illness, rather than not contract the illness in the first place.

a. Contrastivism about Obligation

The oldest application of contrastive ideas in ethics is contrastivism about obligation. Much of the work defending and developing contrastivism about obligation has focused primarily on developing contrastive semantic theories for the terms used to ascribe obligations, especially the deontic modal “ought”. This is not unexpected, since as we saw above, one important style of argument for contrastivism is linguistic in nature; contrastivism about obligation is no different. (Here I will conflate obligation and ought to stick more closely to the literature; the concept of obligation is better expressed using stronger deontic modals like “must” and “have to”.)

Contrastivism about obligation holds that what you ought to do can vary with the comparison being made. For example, though you ought to take the book back to the library rather than leave it on the shelf, it is not the case that you ought to take it back to the library rather than send it with me on my trip to the library.

It is important to distinguish the distinctive contrastivist claim from the much more widely accepted claim that what you ought to do depends on the available alternatives. If some option is the best one available, the non-contrastivist will say that it is what you ought to do. If circumstances change so that that option is no longer available, then obviously it is not the case that you ought to do it—it is not even an option. So what you ought to do has changed with the alternatives. But importantly, it has changed with the available alternatives. There is nothing surprising about this claim, and it is not the distinctive contrastivist claim. The distinctive contrastivist claim is that even holding the available alternatives fixed, what you ought to do can vary with the particular comparison. That is, claims about what you ought to do are only true or false relative to some particular set of alternatives, which may not include all of the available alternatives.

This puts us in a position to see one argument for contrastivism about obligation. Suppose that all of the following methods of getting to work are available: driving your SUV, taking the bus, riding your bike. The relevant factors here are environmental friendliness and getting some exercise. So riding your bike is best and driving your SUV is worst. The non-contrastivist will of course say that, in this case, you ought to ride your bike. And this is very plausible. But the following claim is also very plausible:

(1) You ought to take the bus rather than drive your SUV.

But since taking the bus is not the best available alternative—riding your bike is also an available alternative—it is hard to see how the non-contrastivist can explain the truth of (1). The contrastivist, on the other hand, has an easy time explaining this. Out of the set of alternatives {take the bus, drive your SUV}, taking the bus is the best. And what you ought to do out of a set of alternatives is the best alternative in that set. So even if there are better available alternatives, we can still make true “ought” claims about suboptimal alternatives, as long as they are the best in the relevant set of alternatives; using a “rather than” claim as in (1) is one way of making a set the relevant one.

The non-contrastivist can of course try to reinterpret claims like (1) so that they do not require relativizing “ought” to sets of alternatives. For example, we may read (1) as saying something like, “If you are going to either take the bus or drive your SUV, you ought to take the bus”. One problem for this reply, as emphasized in an epistemic context by Schaffer (2008), is that this requires reading “rather than” as contributing some kind of conditional. But this is not a plausible general theory about the contribution of “rather than” clauses. It is much more linguistically plausible to treat “rather than” as making explicit the comparison being made, as the contrastivist does.

An even more important source of motivation for contrastivism about obligation comes from the puzzles of deontic logic, the logic of obligation. Many of these puzzles have the following form: acceptable “ought” claims lead, via plausible inference rules, to unacceptable “ought” claims. Here is just one example, called Ross’s Paradox, since it is originally due to Alf Ross (1941). Suppose you promise your friend that you will mail a letter for her. Then (2) is true:

(2) You ought to mail the letter.

One inference rule that is validated by the standard semantics for “ought”, and by standard deontic logic, is the following:

Inheritance: If doing A entails doing B, then if you ought to do A, you ought to do B.

(This rule is usually stated treating “ought” as a propositional operator, read as “it ought to be that p”, instead of as (directly) ascribing an obligation, as in “you ought to A”. This goes beyond the scope of this article.) Besides being validated by orthodox treatments of “ought”, this inference rule has a lot of initial plausibility. One way to see this plausibility is to think of the special case in which doing B is a necessary means to doing A, and in that sense doing A entails doing B. If the only way to do something you ought to do requires doing B, then very plausibly, you thereby ought to do B. But inheritance leads to unacceptable results. Note that mailing the letter entails either mailing it or burning it, just because A entails (A or B), for any B. So from the acceptable “ought” claim (2), via Inheritance, (3) follows:

(3) You ought to either mail the letter or burn it.

While (2) is acceptable, (3) is not. It ascribes an obligation to you, mailing the letter or burning it, that you can satisfy by burning the letter. But burning the letter is not a way to do anything you ought to do.

The standard reply to Ross’s Paradox is to accept the consequence, that (3) is true, but explain its apparent unacceptability pragmatically. The basic idea is that (3) is weaker than something else we are in a position to say, namely (2). This is to appeal to Grice’s (1989) maxim of quantity, that we should say the strongest thing we are in a position to say. Saying something weaker, like (3), suggests that we are not in a position to say something stronger, like (2). But in this case, we are in a position to say (2)—in fact, we derived (3) from (2). There have been various challenges to this line of reply; see in particular Cariani (2013).

The contrastivist offers a different solution. The outline of the solution is that the inference from (2) to (3) involves an illicit shift in the set of alternatives to which the “ought” claims are relativized—and hence is equivocal. To see why, remember that the alternatives in a set of alternatives must be mutually exclusive. Then notice that “mail the letter” and “mail the letter or burn it” are not mutually exclusive; so they cannot be members of the same set of alternatives. Thus, (2) and (3) cannot be relativized to the same set of alternatives. In an ordinary context, (2) would be relativized to a set like {mail the letter, leave the letter on the table, give the letter back to your friend, burn the letter}. (3), on the other hand, must be relativized to a set that includes “mail the letter or burn it” as an option, such as {mail the letter or burn it, leave the letter on the table, give the letter back to your friend}. In terms of our distinction between the non-exhaustivity of a set of alternatives, and the resolution of a set of alternatives, inferences like the one from (2) to (3) require a shift in resolution: the second set of alternatives lumps together two options—”mail the letter” and “burn the letter”—that are distinct in the first set. Since the contrastivist about obligation holds that obligation claims are sensitive to the resolution of the set of alternatives to which they are relativized, she can hold that the shift in resolution generates a shift in the truth of the obligation claim.

The first thing to see is that we simply cannot infer (3) from (2): to do so would be to equivocate, since the set of alternatives has shifted. It would be like inferring “Chris Paul is tall”, when he’s playing in a professional basketball game, from the truth of “Chris Paul is tall” when he’s at his family reunion (crucial background: Chris Paul is taller than most other members of his family, but shorter than most basketball players). The comparison class has shifted, and “tall” ascriptions are very plausibly relativized to comparison classes—to count as tall, you have to be taller than most members of the relevant comparison class.

The second thing to notice is that, not only can we not infer (3) from (2), we can also say that (3) is actually false. That is because, very plausibly, out of the set {mail the letter or burn it, leave the letter on the table, give the letter back to your friend}, it is not true that you ought to mail the letter or burn it—this is not the best option in the set.

This is the basic outline for one kind of contrastivist solution to puzzles of deontic logic. Cariani (2013) offers an interestingly different kind of contrastivist solution. Cariani takes up the task of blocking problematic inferences, such as Ross’s Paradox, while retaining intuitively acceptable ones that also seem to be supported by rules like inheritance.

b. Contrastivism and Freedom

Another implementation of contrastivist ideas in ethics is Sinnott-Armstrong’s (2012) contrastive account of freedom and moral responsibility. Central questions in this domain concern whether an agent’s act is free, and hence whether the agent is responsible for the act. Responsibility skeptics argue that since we can always trace the causal history of an act back to causes outside the agent, no one is ever responsible. Their opponents give various responses to this argument, including that freedom and responsibility do not require a lack of causation from outside the agent.

The first application of contrastivism is to what agents are free from. For example, an agent’s act may be free from external physical constraints (for example, chains or a shove) or internal compulsions (for example, addiction), but not free from all preceding causes (for example, the initial conditions of the universe). Such an act would be free rather than the result of a shove or addiction, but not free rather than caused (via a long chain) by the initial conditions of the universe. Adopting this contrastive conception of freedom helps clarify the dispute between responsibility skeptics and their opponents: the debate is over which kind of constraint is the relevant one for attributing responsibility. (Sinnott-Armstrong himself once again denies that there is any one relevant kind of constraint, and so does not take sides in the dispute between responsibility skeptics and their opponents.)

This contrastive picture also explains conflicting intuitions about whether a given act is free. Ordinarily, perhaps, we have in mind constraints like chains or addictions. Most acts in question in debates about freedom and responsibility are free, rather than being constrained by these kinds of things. But what the responsibility skeptic does, is to draw our attention to another kind of constraint—that of causes outside the agent. Actions are very plausibly not free, rather than being caused at all. If the contrastivist about freedom is right that freedom is a contrastive concept, and that both of these kinds of freedom—freedom from constraints and freedom from preceding causes—are legitimate, then this explains why we may be puzzled by questions about whether a given action is free.

The second application of contrastivism is to what agents are free to do. Sinnott-Armstrong’s illustrative example is of an alcoholic, Al. Suppose Al drinks some whisky at 8pm on Tuesday. We may ask whether this act was free. It seems to depend on the contrasts. Depending on how we specify the details of the case, all of the following may be true:

Al’s drinking whisky rather than wine was free.
Al’s drinking whisky at 8pm rather than at 9pm was free.
Al’s drinking whisky rather than a non-alcoholic drink was not free.
Al’s drinking whisky on Tuesday rather than waiting until Wednesday was not free.

As Sinnott-Armstrong sums up the point: “Addicts never have no control at all in any circumstances…most people are free to choose out of some contrast classes but not out of others.” (Sinnott-Armstrong, 2012:145). So the question of whether Al’s act was free is, for the contrastivist, incomplete. To say whether an action was free, we have to specify what the contrast is—relative to some contrasts, it may be free while relative to others it may not be. The important question then becomes which contrasts are relevant for which purposes. In particular, we can ask which contrasts are relevant for blaming and holding responsible. So contrastivism has helped us isolate the important questions in the debate about moral responsibility.

A related position is contrastivism about legal responsibility. Schaffer (2010) applies his contrastive account of causation (described in the section Philosophy of Science) to the notion of legal causation. If we accept that there is a close connection between the claim that someone caused, in the legally relevant sense, some outcome and the claim that she is legally responsible for that outcome, this contrastive account of causation in the law leads naturally to a contrastive theory of legal responsibility.

c. Contrastivism about Normative Reasons

The last application of contrastivism to ethics is contrastivism about normative reasons. A normative reason for an action is a consideration that counts in favor of performing that action. For example, the fact that you promised to return the book is a reason to return it, and the fact that you are causing me pain is a reason to get off of my foot. Many philosophers think reasons are central to ethics, and to normativity more generally. If that is correct, then contrastivism about normative reasons will likely have widespread implications throughout ethics.

As with most other implementations of contrastivism, contrastivism about reasons can be motivated by linguistic considerations:

The fact that my guest is vegetarian is a reason to make vegetable lasagna rather than roast duck.
The fact that my guest is vegetarian is not a reason to make vegetable lasagna rather than mushroom risotto.

Both of these contrastive claims are true. But now we might want to know, “Is the fact that my guest is vegetarian a reason to make vegetable lasagna or not?”. This is to ask whether this fact is a non-contrastive reason. This question is hard to answer. What this seems to show is that whether this fact is a reason or not depends on the alternatives—that it is a contrastive reason.

There are various ways for the non-contrastivist to respond to this argument. In particular, she may try to provide non-contrastive analyses of these contrastive claims. For example, we may appeal to the fact that reasons have strengths or weights, and hold that some consideration is a reason to do A rather than B when it is a stronger (non-contrastive) reason to do A than it is to do B. In this way, we can explain the truth of claims like (4) and (5) without adopting a contrastive view of reasons.

There are various problems with this kind of strategy. For just one, recall the similar strategy for dealing with contrastive obligation claims discussed in the section ”Contrastivism About Obligation”. The idea there was to say that the “rather than” in these claims should be analyzed out as a conditional. The problem was that this is not particularly linguistically plausible, since “rather than” does not ordinarily contribute a conditional. This strategy for dealing with contrastive reason claims faces a similar problem. “Rather than” does not ordinarily mean “stronger than”; instead, “rather than” should be understood as introducing contrasts.

Besides linguistic arguments, the second major kind of argument for contrastivism in some domain is theoretical. Recall that these kinds of arguments are not based primarily on contrastivism’s ability to give attractive interpretations of ascriptions of the target concept—in this case, reasons. Rather, they aim to show that given some theoretical role or property of the target the concept would be best explained by a contrastive view of the concept. A theoretical argument for contrastivism about reasons is that it best makes sense of the connection between reasons and the promotion of various objectives, like desires or values. A schematic statement of this very common idea is the following:

Promotion: Consideration R is a reason to perform act A if R explains why A-ing would promote objective O.

Again, an objective is some valuable thing to be promoted. Different theories will say different things: desire-based theories think reasons are tied to the promotion of the objects of desires, value-based theories think reasons are tied to the promotion of values like justice or goodness, and so on. No matter which of these theories we accept, we have to say what it takes for some action to promote an objective.

Snedegar (2014b) argues that the best way to do this is to adopt a contrastive picture. Relative to some contrasts an action may promote an objective, while relative to another, it may not. Suppose the relevant objective is contributing to the relief of hunger in the third world. This objective is not promoted by donating to an unreliable charity (they only get the money where it should go 20% of the time) rather than donating to a reliable charity. But it is promoted by donating to an unreliable charity rather than spending the money on an expensive dinner for myself. Hence, this objective gives me a reason to donate to the unreliable charity rather than spend the money on an expensive dinner, but does not give me a reason to donate to the unreliable charity rather than donate to the reliable charity. Non-contrastive views of promotion will deliver the verdict that this objective gives me no reason whatsoever to donate to the unreliable charity. So it is hard for them to explain the fact that it gives me a reason to donate to the unreliable charity rather than spending the money on an expensive dinner.

We have seen both linguistic and theoretical motivations for contrastivism about reasons. As we saw at the beginning of this section, reasons are often taken to be central to ethics and normativity more generally. So contrastivism about reasons is likely to have many upshots throughout ethics and normative philosophy. One nice thing about this is that it gives us a huge swathe of philosophy against which to test contrastivism about reasons: contrastivism may lead to exciting insights in normative philosophy, or it may lead to unacceptable results. Either way, this seems to be a fruitful area for research.

3. General Challenges

To close, consider some general challenges facing contrastivism of any variety. The specific form of these challenges, and the plausible responses, will likely vary from domain to domain. When it is necessary to apply the challenge to a concrete contrastivist theory, one from ethics will be chosen. As much as possible, however, the article remains at a general level, because it is instructive to think about the general shape of the challenges, as they face the contrastivist qua contrastivist.

a. Setting the Contrast Class

The first few challenges are interrelated, and have to do with setting the relevant contrast class. First, contrastivists face the challenge of saying what set of alternatives a given claim should be relativized to. For explicitly contrastive ascriptions of a concept, for example those using “rather than”, it is straightforward: the “rather than” clause makes the alternatives explicit. But for ascriptions that are not explicitly contrastive, the contrastivist has to provide some way of settling what the relevant set of alternatives is, or else admit that these unrelativized claims are not truth-evaluable, or at least that we should suspend judgment about their truth. To be satisfactory, this should be done in a relatively principled way. Otherwise, the contrastivist may face charges of fixing the contrasts in an ad hoc way to get the results she wants.

We have already seen one popular way to answer this challenge. This is to appeal to a question under discussion in the context. Linguists and philosophers of language have given arguments independent of contrastivism for the inclusion of such a device in our theory of communication. For example, it is useful in interpreting intonational stress (see Rooth, 1992) and in explaining several kinds of pragmatic phenomena (see Roberts, 2012). The contrastivist can exploit this: the question under discussion fixes the set of alternatives relative to which the ascription is interpreted.

But there are other options. Rather than appealing to a question under discussion, the contrastivist may instead appeal to the speaker’s intention, to features of the assessor’s context, or even to features of the subject (of the ascription) or her context. As we have already seen, one prominent contrastivist, Walter Sinnott-Armstrong, argues for a very different solution to the problem of determining the contrast class. Sinnott-Armstrong (2004, 2006) argues that no way of determining relevance is correct, and that we should instead be relevance skeptics. We should simply suspend judgment about the content and truth of non-relativized claims employing a contrastive concept. Sinnott-Armstrong’s arguments are challenging, and if the contrastivist wants to avoid his skepticism, she needs to grapple with them. One way to gain traction here, though this goes beyond the scope of this article, is to seek independent evidence for the existence of a relevant question under discussion in explanations of natural language phenomena. Linguists have developed powerful explanatory theories of various natural language phenomena using questions under discussion. So even if specific proposals about how to determine the relevant contrast class, or question under discussion, face challenges, we at least have some reason to be optimistic that there is such a relevant contrast class or question.

A second and related challenge is that contrastivism delivers apparently objectionable results, as long as the relevant contrast class is set up in the right way. This problem is perhaps sharpest for the contrastivist about obligation. You may be obligated to do all kinds of terrible or crazy things, because the contrast class is crazy. For example, the contrastivist about obligation will say that you are obligated to burn down your neighbor’s house while she is at work—as long as the relevant alternatives are worse than this. So you are obligated to burn down her house while she is at work rather than burn it down with her inside. This is even more objectionable when we remember that these need not be the only options open to you—it may be perfectly possible for you to take her a plate of freshly baked cookies, or to simply stay at home and watch television, instead. Still, the contrastivist will say that you are obligated to burn down her house while she is at work, as long as the relevant alternative is burning it down with her inside.

The contrastivist about obligation is committed to this result, when paired with any plausible theory about what an agent is obligated to do out of a given contrast class. But it is not clear how serious this problem actually is. The explicitly contrastive claim, “You are obligated to burn down her house while she’s at work rather than burn it down when she’s inside” is not obviously false. After all, burning it down while she’s at work is clearly better than burning it down while she’s inside. The bare, non-contrastive claim, “You are obligated to burn down her house while she’s at work” does sound obviously false. But the contrastivist is only committed to the truth of this claim when the only relevant alternatives are things like “burn it down while she’s inside” (or even worse alternatives). In any ordinary context—for example, a context in which you could take her a plate of freshly baked cookies, instead—these will not be the only relevant alternatives. In fact, they are unlikely to be relevant alternatives at all, at least before they are mentioned. In these ordinary contexts, the contrastivist about obligation will not be committed to the truth of the objectionable non-contrastive claim. The details of this solution will depend on what our theory tells us about fixing the relevant set of alternatives, but it should be clear that the contrastivist has options here.

A closely related problem is raised against contrastive theories of moral reasons by Andrew Jordan. Jordan argues that some actions should be, and are, performed in a whole-hearted way—that is, without considering alternatives at all. The virtuous person will simply see that taking her sick pet to the vet is the thing to do and will not consider alternatives, or take into account reasons for alternatives, for example, the potentially high cost. So the reasons favoring the whole-hearted action do not seem to be relativized to any contrast class at all.

This problem only arises if the contrastivist about reasons holds that the contrast class is fixed by the options the subject is considering. But as we have seen, there are many more options for the contrastivist. It is not clear, for example, how this problem could arise on a speaker contextualist theory. So this is not a problem for the contrastivist as such.

Though these last two challenges are not serious problems for contrastivism as such, they are useful in thinking about the first challenge—that of saying what fixes the contrast class for a given claim. The problem of crazy verdicts resulting from crazy contrast classes puts pressure on a very simple version of speaker contextualism, according to which the relevant contrast class is wholly fixed by the speaker’s intentions. As long as the speaker intends a crazy contrast class, the objectionable ascriptions may come out true. This kind of contrastivist would then need to try to explain why this result is not actually objectionable. Jordan’s problem of whole-hearted action puts pressure on a version of contrastivism according to which the relevant contrast class is wholly determined by what the agent is considering—if the virtuous agent is not considering any alternatives, then this version of contrastivism could not supply a contrast class.

Another problem in this vein is harder to articulate in a sharp way. It stems from the idea that there must be an answer to whether the concept really applies, over and above whether it applies relative to any particular set of alternatives. In the case of “ought”, for example, there is a feeling that there must be something that we really ought to do. We can imagine the objector saying, in an exasperated tone, “I know I ought to take the bus rather than drive my SUV. What I want to know is, ought I take the bus?”. Read straightforwardly, this objection is just a rejection of the central thesis of contrastivism. Read in that way, there is not much the contrastivist can say.

There is another, more contrastivist-friendly way to construe this idea. The idea may be that, though there are lots of true claims about when I ought to or have reason to perform some action rather than some other action, in certain kinds of deliberation and theorizing, we are interested in “oughts” and in reasons with some kind of special status. The contrastivist can accommodate this idea by identifying special contrast classes, and claiming that they are relevant in the cases the objector has in mind. Some good candidates include (i) a trivial contrast class, {A, ~A}, (ii) an exhaustive contrast class that includes every possibility open to the agent, (iii) a maximally fine-grained contrast class, and (iv) a contrast class that makes all morally relevant distinctions. These are not mutually exclusive options, of course—for example, all four could be construed as exhaustive sets of alternatives. The contrastivist can hold that some reasons or obligations, for example, moral reasons or obligations, are always relativized to one of these special kinds of contrast class, while other reasons and obligations are not. This is all perfectly consistent with contrastivism, and lets us capture something very close to the idea that there is something we really ought to do or really have reason to do.

b. Cross-Context Inferences

A very different kind of challenge involves cross-context inferences. The central feature of contrastivism, that lets it solve puzzles facing non-contrastive theories, is that a concept may apply relative to one set of alternatives without applying relative to others. For example, just because we know that you ought to A rather than B, that does not tell us anything about whether you ought to A rather than C. This central feature leads to a very important challenge: sometimes, knowing that a concept applies relative to some alternatives should tell us whether it applies relative to certain other alternatives. For example, if I know that I ought to A rather than either of B or C (out of {A, B, C}), our theory should guarantee that I ought to A rather than B (out of {A, B}). Similarly, if I ought to A rather than B and I ought to B rather than C, then our theory should guarantee that I ought to A rather than C.

The advantages of contrastivism come from letting the application of a concept vary with the alternatives. What this problem shows is that we have to constrain this variation in certain ways. The strategy adopted by contrastivists who have addressed this problem is to appeal to some non-contrastive foundation on which the application of the concept depends. For example, contrastivists about “ought” who have addressed this problem appeal to a contrast-invariant ranking of alternatives, and let the application of “ought” depend on this ranking in ways that deliver the necessary constraints.

4. Conclusion

Contrastivism has been applied across much of philosophy, and it is no wonder why. It promises to resolve the closure paradox in epistemology, provide the best theory of explanation, perhaps the central concept in philosophy and science, and finally give a true theory of causation. And that is before we even broach the field of ethics. There, contrastivism promises to resolve—or at least shed serious light on—the paradoxes of deontic logic, the problem of determinism, and provide an account of reasons for action. There is much more work to be done in making good on these promises. But at the very least, this appears to be a very fruitful research program—especially in ethics, where less work has been done.

5. References and Further Reading

Baumann, P. 2008. “Problems for Sinnott-Armstrong’s Moral Contrastivism.” The Philosophical Quarterly 58(232): 463-470.
- Argues that contrastivism about knowledge makes bad predictions in cases of “crazy contrast classes”.
Blaauw, M. (ed.) 2012. Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge.
- A collection of papers demonstrating the breadth of the contrastivist program in philosophy, including several in ethics.
Cariani, F. 2013. “Ought and Resolution Semantics.” Noûs 47(3): 534-558.
- Develops a sophisticated contrastive semantic theory for “ought”.
Chandler, J. 2007. “Solving the Tacking Problem with Contrast Classes.” British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 58(3): 489-502.
- Uses contrastive confirmation to solve an important problem in confirmation theory.
Chandler, J. 2013. “Contrastive Confirmation: Some Competing Accounts.” Synthese 190(1): 129-138.
Craig, W. 1990. Knowledge and the State of Nature: An Essay in Conceptual Synthesis. Oxford University Press.
- Argues that the central function of the concept of knowledge is to identify good sources of information, and develops a theory of knowledge based on this conception.
Dretske, F. 1970. “Epistemic Operators.” Journal of Philosophy 67: 1007-1023.
- Early version of the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge, direct predecessor of contrastivism.
Driver, J. 2012. “Luck and Fortune in Moral Evaluation.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 154-172.
- Sketches a contrastive account of luck, and applies it to the problem of moral luck.
Finlay, S. 2009. “Oughts and Ends.” Philosophical Studies 143(3): 315-340.
Finlay, S. 2014. Confusion of Tongues: A Theory of Normative Language. Oxford University Press.
- Develops a theory of “ought” which makes use of contrastivist machinery in the service of providing a comprehensive theory of normativity.
Finlay, S. and Snedegar, J. 2014. “One Ought Too Many.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 89(1): 102-124.
- Defends a uniform, propositional operator semantics for “ought”, making crucial use of contrastivism.
Fitelson, B. 2012. “Contrastive Bayesianism.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 64-87.
- Discussion of contrastive theories of confirmation.
van Fraassen, B. 1980. The Scientific Image. Oxford University Press.
- Influential development of a contrastive theory of explanation.
Grice, H. P. 1989. “Logic and Conversation.” In Grice, Studies in the Way of Words. Harvard University Press, 22-40.
- Classic discussion of conversational implicature, where speakers communicate more than they literally say.
Groenendijk, J. and Stokhof, M. 1997. “Questions.” In van Benthem, J. and ter Meulen, A. (eds.), Handbook of Logic and Language. Elsevier Science Publishers, 1055-1124.
- Detailed discussion of the semantics of questions, including the partition/set of alternatives semantics.
Hamblin, C. L. 1958. “Questions.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 36: 159-168.
- Early development of the partition semantics for questions.
Higginbotham, J. 1996. “The Semantics of Questions.” In Lappin, S. (ed.), The Handbook of Contemporary Semantic Theory. Oxford University Press, 361-383.
Hitchcock, C. 1996a. “The Role of Contrast in Causal and Explanatory Claims.” Synthese 107: 395-419.
Hitchcock, C. 1996b. “Farewell to Binary Causation.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 26: 267-282.
- Development of a contrastive theory of causation.
Jackson, F. 1985. “On the Semantics and Logic of Obligation.” Mind 94(374): 177-195.
- Development of a contrastive theory of obligation, motivated by puzzles from deontic logic.
Jackson, F. and Pargetter, R. 1986. “Oughts, Options, and Actualism.” Philosophical Review 95(2): 233-255.
- Development of a contrastive theory of obligation.
Jordan, A. 2014. “Whole-Hearted Motivation and Relevant Alternatives: A Problem for the Contrastivist Account of Moral Reasons.” Ethical Theory and Moral Practice 17(5): 835-845.
Karjalainen, A. and Morton, A. 2003. “Contrastive Knowledge.” Philosophical Explorations 6(2): 74-89.
- Argues for a contrastive conception of knowledge.
Lewis, D. 1996. “Elusive Knowledge.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 549-567.
- Influential development of the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge, a direct predecessor of contrastivism about knowledge.
Lipton, P. 1990. “Contrastive Explanation.” Royal Institute for Philosophy Supplement 27: 247-266.
- Development of a contrastive theory of explanation.
McNamara, P. 2014. “Deontic Logic.” In Zalta (ed.), Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
- Detailed overview of deontic logic, including the puzzles that motivate contrastivism about obligation.
Morton, A. 2012. “Contrastive Knowledge.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 101-115.
- Gives primarily theoretical, rather than linguistic, arguments for contrastivism about knowledge.
Roberts, C. 2012. “Information Structure in Discourse: Towards an Integrated Formal Theory of Pragmatics.” Semantics and Pragmatics 5: 1-69.
- Detailed development of a formal pragmatic theory making crucial use of questions under discussion.
Rooth, M. 1992. “A Theory of Focus Interpretation.” Natural Language Semantics 1: 75-116.
- Develops a theory for interpreting focus (for example, intonational stress) in natural language, making crucial use of sets of alternatives.
Ross, J. 2009. Acceptance and Practical Reason. PhD Thesis, Rutgers University, Chapter 9.
- Gives arguments for a contrastive treatment of normative reasons.
Schaffer, J. 2004. “From Contextualism to Contrastivism.” Philosophical Studies 119(1-2): 73-104.
- Argues that contrastivism about knowledge is superior to standard forms of contextualism.
Schaffer, J. 2005a. “Contrastive Knowledge.” In Gendler and Hawthorne (eds.), Oxford Studies in Epistemology, Vol. 1. Oxford University Press, 235-271.
- Argues for and develops a contrastive theory of knowledge.
Schaffer, J. 2005b. ‘Contrastive Causation.’ The Philosophical Review 114: 327-358.
- Argues for and develops a contrastive theory of causation.
Schaffer, J. 2007a. “Knowing the Answer.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 75(2): 383-403.
- Argues for and develops a contrastive theory of knowledge, based primarily on knowledge-wh ascriptions—for example, “knows who”, “knows whether”.
Schaffer, J. 2007b. “Closure, Contrast, and Answer.” Philosophical Studies 133(2): 233-255.
- Shows how a contrastivist about knowledge can explain inferences supported by closure principles, even though the contrastivist has to reject standard closure principles.
Schaffer, J. 2008. “The Contrast-Sensitivity of Knowledge Ascriptions.” Social Epistemology 22(3): 235-245.
- Argues against non-contrastivist treatments of the linguistic data used to motivate contrastivism.
Schaffer, J. 2010. “Contrastive Causation in the Law.” Legal Theory 16: 259-297.
- Applies contrastivism about causation to causation as appealed to in judgments of legal responsibility.
Schaffer, J. 2012. “Causal Contextualisms.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 35-63.
- Discussion of contrastivism about causation, with a somewhat pessimistic conclusion for its ultimate prospects.
Sinnott-Armstrong, W. 2004. “Classy Pyrrhonism.” In W. Sinnott-Armstrong (ed.), Pyrrhonian Skepticism. Oxford University Press, 188-207.
- Argues for contrastivism about knowledge, but uses this theory to support Pyrrhonian skepticism about unrelativized knowledge claims by arguing for skepticism about the notion of a “relevant” contrast class.
Sinnott-Armstrong, W. 2006. Moral Skepticisms. Oxford University Press.
- Applies the ideas in Sinnott-Armstrong (2004) to moral epistemology.
Sinnott-Armstrong, W. 2008a. “A Contrastivist Manifesto.” Social Epistemology 22(3): 257-270.
- An overview of contrastivism across philosophy.
Sinnott-Armstrong, W. 2008b. “Replies to Hough, Baumann, and Blaauw.” Philosophical Quarterly 58(232): 478-488.
- Replies to Baumann’s (2008) “crazy contrast class” objection to contrastivism about knowledge.
Sinnott-Armstrong, W. 2012. “Free Contrastivism.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 134-153.
- Shows how a contrastive account of freedom can clarify disputes in discussions of determinism and moral responsibility.
Sloman, A. 1970. “Ought and Better.” Mind 79(315): 385-394.
- Early development of a contrastive view of obligation.
Snedegar, J. 2012. “Contrastive Semantics for Deontic Modals.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 116-133.
- Argues for a contrastive treatment of deontic modals like “ought”, “must”, and “may”.
Snedegar, J. 2013a. “Negative Reason Existentials.” Thought 2(2): 108-116.
- Shows how to use contrastivism to solve a puzzle about claims like “There’s no reason to cry over spilled milk.”
Snedegar, J. 2013b. “Reason Claims and Contrastivism about Reasons.” Philosophical Studies 166(2): 231-242.
- Argues for contrastivism about normative reasons on the basis of reason claims employing “rather than”.
Snedegar, J. 2014a. “Deontic Reasoning across Contexts.” In F. Cariani, and others (eds.), Deontic Logic and Normative Systems, Vol. 12, Springer Lecture Notes in Computer Science, 2014a: 208-223.
- Shows how a contrastivist about obligation can recapture intuitive inferences supported by inference rules the contrastivist rejects.
Snedegar, J. 2014b. “Contrastive Reasons and Promotion.” Ethics 125 (2014b): 39-63.
- Argues for and develops a version of contrastivism, based on the idea that normative reasons are tied to the promotion of objectives.
Yalcin, S. 2011. “Nonfactualism about Epistemic Modality.” In Egan, A. and Weatherson, B. (eds.), Epistemic Modality. Oxford University Press, 295-332.
- Introduces the idea of resolution-sensitivity in a discussion of epistemic modality.

Author Information

Justin Snedegar
Email: js280@st-andrews.ac.uk
University of St Andrews
United Kingdom

Leibniz: Logic

The revolutionary ideas of Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646-1716) on logic were developed by him between 1670 and 1690. The ideas can be divided into four areas: the Syllogism, the Universal Calculus, Propositional Logic, and Modal Logic.

These revolutionary ideas remained hidden in the Archive of the Royal Library in Hanover until 1903 when the French mathematician Louis Couturat published the Opuscules et fragments inédits de Leibniz. Couturat was a great admirer of Leibniz’s thinking in general, and he saw in Leibniz a brilliant forerunner of modern logic. Nevertheless he came to the conclusion that Leibniz’s logic had largely failed and that in general the so-called “intensional” approach to logic was necessarily bound to fail. Similarly, in their standard historiography of logic, W. & M. Kneale (1962) maintained that Leibniz “never succeeded in producing a calculus which covered even the whole theory of the syllogism”. Even in recent years, scholars like Liske (1994), Swoyer (1995), and Schupp (2000) argued that Leibniz’s intensional conception must give rise to inconsistencies and paradoxes.

On the other hand, starting with Dürr (1930), Rescher (1954), and Kauppi (1960), a certain rehabilitation of Leibniz’s intensional logic may be observed which was by and by supported and supplemented by Poser (1969), Ishiguro (1972), Rescher (1979), Burkhardt (1980), Schupp (1982), and Mugnai (1992). However, the full wealth of Leibniz’s logical ideas became visible only in Lenzen (1990), (2004a), and (2004b), where the many pieces and fragments were joined together to an impressive system of four calculi:

The algebra of concepts L1 (which turns out to be deductively equivalent to the Boolean algebra of sets)
The quantificational system L2 (where “indefinite concepts” function as quantifiers ranging over concepts)
A propositional calculus of strict implication (obtained from L1 by the strict analogy between the containment-relation among concepts and the inference-relation among propositions)
The so-called “Plus-Minus-Calculus” (which is to be viewed as a theory of set-theoretical containment, “addition,” and “subtraction”).

Leibniz’s Logical Works
Works on the Theory of the Syllogism
Works on the Universal Calculus
Leibniz’s Calculus of Strict Implication
Works on Modal Logic
1. Possible-Worlds-Semantics for Alethic Modalities
2. Basic Principles of Deontic Logic
References and Further Reading
1. Abbreviations for Leibniz’s works
2. Secondary Literature

1. Leibniz’s Logical Works

Throughout his life (beginning in 1646 in Leipzig and ending in 1716 in Hanover), Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz did not publish a single paper on logic, except perhaps for the mathematical dissertation “De Arte Combinatoria” and the juridical disputation “De Conditionibus” (GP 4, 27-104 and AE IV, 1, 97-150; the abbreviations for Leibniz’s works are resolved in section 6). The former work deals with some issues in the theory of the syllogism, while the latter contains investigations of what is nowadays called deontic logic. Leibniz’s main aim in logic, however, was to extend the traditional syllogistic to a “Universal Calculus.” Although there exist several drafts of such a calculus which seem to have been composed for publication, none of them was eventually sent to press. So Leibniz’s logical essays appeared only posthumously. The early editions of his philosophical works, however, contained only a small selection of logical papers. It was not before the beginning of the 20^th century that the majority of his logical fragments became generally accessible by the valuable edition of Louis Couturat.

Since only few manuscripts were dated by Leibniz, his logical oeuvre shall not be described here in chronological order but from a merely systematic point of view by distinguishing four groups:

Works on the Theory of the Syllogism
Works on the Universal Calculus
Works on Propositional Logic
Works on Modal Logic.

2. Works on the Theory of the Syllogism

Leibniz’s innovations within the theory of the syllogism comprise at least three topics:

(a) An “Axiomatization” of the theory of the syllogism, that is, a reduction of the traditional inferences to a small number of basic laws which are sufficient to derive all other syllogisms.

(b) The development of the semantics of so-called “characteristic numbers” for evaluating the logical validity of a syllogistic inference.

(c) The invention of two sorts of graphical devices, that is to say, linear diagrams and (later) so-called “Euler-circles,” as a heuristic for checking the validity of a syllogism.

a. Axiomatization of the Theory of the Syllogism

In the 17^th century, logic was still strongly influenced, if not dominated, by syllogistic, that is, by the traditional theory of the four categorical forms:

Universal affirmative proposition (UA) Every S is P SaP

Universal negative proposition (UN) No S is P SeP

Particular affirmative proposition (PA) Some S is P SiP

Particular negative proposition (PN) Some S isn’t P SoP

A typical textbook of that time is the famous “Logique de Port Royal” (Arnauld & Nicole (1683)) which, apart from an introductory investigation of ideas, concepts, and propositions in general, basically consists of:

(i) The theory of the so-called “simple” laws of subalternation, opposition, and conversion;

(ii) The theory of the syllogistic “moods” which are classified into four different “figures” for which specific rules hold.

As Leibniz defines it, a “subalternation takes place whenever a particular proposition is inferred from the corresponding universal proposition” (Cout, 80), that is:

SUB 1 SaP → SiP

SUB 2 SeP → SoP.

According to the modern analysis of the categorical forms in terms of first order logic, these laws are not strictly valid but hold only under the assumption that the subject term S is not empty. This problem of “existential import” will be discussed below.

The theory of opposition first has to determine which propositions are contradictories of each other in the sense that they can neither be together true nor be together false. Clearly, the PN is the contradictory, or negation, of the UA, while the PA is the negation of the UN:

OPP 1 ¬SaP ↔ SoP

OPP 2 ¬SeP ↔ SiP.

The next task is to determine which propositions are contraries to each other in the sense that they cannot be together true, while they may well be together false. As Leibniz states in “Theorem 6: The universal affirmative and the universal negative are contrary to each other” (Cout, 82). Finally, two propositions are said to be subcontraries if they cannot be together false while it is possible that are together true. As Leibniz notes in another theorem, the two particular propositions, SiP and SoP, are logically related to each other in this way. The theory of subalternation and opposition is often summarized in the familiar “Square of Opposition”:

In the paper “De formis syllogismorum Mathematice definiendis” written around 1682 (Cout, 410-416, and the text-critical edition in AE VI, 4, 496-505) Leibniz tackled the task of “axiomatizing” the theory of the syllogistic figures and moods by reducing them to a small number of basic principles. The “Fundamentum syllogisticum”, that is, the axiomatic basis of the theory of the syllogism, is the “Dictum de omni et nullo” (The saying of ‘all’ and ‘none’):

If a total C falls within another total D, or if the total C falls outside D, then whatever is in C, also falls within D (in the former case) or outside D (in the latter case) (Cout, 410-411).

These laws warrant the validity of the following “perfect” moods of the “First Figure”:

BARBARA CaD, BaC → BaD

CELARENT CeD, BaC → BeD

DARII CaD, BiC → BiD

FERIO CeD, BiC → BoD.

On the one hand, if the second premise of the affirmative moods BARBARA and DARII is satisfied, that is, if B is either totally or partially contained in D, then, according to the “Dictum de Omni”, also B must be either totally or partially contained in D since, by the first premise, C is entirely contained in D. Similarly the negative moods CELARENT and FERIO follow from the “Dictum de Nullo”: “B is either totally or partially contained in C; but the entire C falls outside D; hence also B either totally or partially falls outside D” (Cout, 411).

Next Leibniz derives the laws of subalternation from the syllogisms DARII and FERIO by substituting ‘B’ for ‘C’ and ‘C’ for ‘D’, respectively. This derivation (and hence also the validity of the laws of subalternation) tacitly presupposes the following principle which Leibniz considered as an “identity”:

SOME BiB.

With the help of the laws of subalternation, BARBARA and CELARENT may be “weakened” into

BARBARI CaD, BaC → BiD

CELARO CeD, BaC → BoD.

Thus the First Figure altogether has six valid moods, from which one obtains six moods of the Second and six of the Third Figure by means of a logical inference-scheme called “Regressus”:

REGRESS If a conclusion Q logically follows from premises P₁, P₂, but if Q is false, then one of the premises must be false.

When Leibniz carefully carries out these derivations, he presupposes the laws of opposition, Opp 1, Opp 2. Finally, six valid moods of the Fourth Figure can be derived from corresponding moods of the First Figure with the help of the laws of conversions.According to traditional doctrines, the PA and the UN may be converted “simpliciter”, while the UA can only be converted “per accidens”:

CONV 1 BiD → DiB

CONV 2 BeD → DeB

CONV 3 BaD → DiB.

As Leibniz shows, these laws can in turn be derived from some previously proven syllogisms with the help of the “identical” proposition:

ALL BaB.

Furthermore one easily obtains another law of conversion according to which the UN can also be converted “accidentally”:

CONV 4 BeD → DoB.

The announced derivation of the moods of the Fourth Figure was not carried out in the fragment “De formis syllogismorum Mathematice definiendis” which just breaks off with a reference to “Figura Quarta”. It may, however, be found in the manuscript LH IV, 6, 14, 3 which, unfortunately, was only partially edited in Cout, 204. At any rate, Leibniz managed to prove that all valid moods can be reduced to the “Fundamentum syllogisticum” in conjunction with the laws of opposition, the inference scheme “Regressus”, and the “identical” propositions SOME and ALL.

Now while ALL is an identity or theorem of first order logic, ∀x(Bx → Bx), SOME is nowadays interpreted as ∃x(Bx ∧ Bx). This formula is equivalent to ∃x(Bx), that is, to the assumption that there “exists” at least one x such that x is B. Hence the laws of subalternation presuppose that each concept B (which can occupy the position of the subject of a categorical form) is “non-empty”. Leibniz discussed this problem of “existential import” in a paper entitled “Difficultates quaedam logicae” (GP 7, 211-217) where he distinguished two kinds of “existence”: Actual existence of the individuals inhabiting our real world vs. merely possible subsistence of individuals “in the region of ideas”. According to Leibniz, logical inferences should always be evaluated with reference to “the region of ideas”, that is, the larger set of all possible individuals. Therefore all that is required for the validity of subalternation is that the term B occupying the position of the subject of a categorical form has a non-empty extension within the domain of possible individuals. As will turn out below (compare the definition of an extensional interpretation of L1 in section 3.1), this weak condition of “existential import” becomes tantamount to the assumption that the respective concept B is self-consistent!

b. The Semantics of “Characteristic Numbers”

In a series of papers of April 1679, Leibniz elaborated the idea of assigning natural numbers to the subject and predicate of a proposition a in such a way that the truth of a can be “read off” from these numbers. Apparently Leibniz was hoping that mankind might once discover the “true” characteristic numbers which would enable one to determine the truth of arbitrary propositions just by mathematical calculations! In the essays of April 1679, however, he pursued only the much more modest goal of defining appropriate arithmetical conditions for determining whether a syllogistic inference is logically valid. This task was guided by the idea that a term composed of concepts A and B gets assigned the product of the numbers assigned to the components:

For example, since ‘man’ is ‘rational animal’, if the number of ‘animal’, a, is 2, and the number of ‘rational’, r, is 3, then the number of ‘man’, m, will be the same as a*r, in this example 2*3 or 6. (LLP, 17).

Now a UA like ‘All gold is metal’ can be understood as maintaining that the concept ‘gold’ contains the concept ‘metal’ (because ‘gold’ can be defined as ‘the heaviest metal’). Therefore it seems obvious to postulate that in general ‘Every S is P’ is true if and only if s, the characteristic number assigned to S, contains p, the number assigned to P, as a prime factor; or, in other words, s must be divisible by p. In a first approach, Leibniz thought that the truth-conditions for the particular proposition ‘Some S are P’ might be construed similarly by requiring that either s can be divided by p or conversely p can be divided by s. But this was mistaken. After some trials and errors, Leibniz found the following more complicated solution:

(i) To every term T, a pair of natural numbers <+t₁;-t₂> is assigned such that t₁ and t₂ are relatively prime, that is, they don’t have a common divisor.

(ii) The UA ‘Every S is P’ is true (relative to the assignment (i)) if and only if +s₁ is divisible by +p₁ and -s₂ is divisible by -p₂.

(iii) The UN ‘No S is P’ is true if and only if +s₁ and -p₂ have a common divisor or +p₁ and -s₂ have a common divisor.

(iv) The PA ‘Some S is P’ is true if and only if condition (iii) is not satisfied.

(v) The PN ‘Some S isn’t P’ is true if and only if condition (ii) is not satisfied.

(vi) An inference from premises P₁, P₂ to the conclusion C is logically valid if and only if for each assignment of numbers satisfying condition (i), C becomes true whenever both P₁ and P₂ are true.

As was shown by Lukasiewicz (1951), this semantics satisfies the simple inferences of opposition, subalternation, and conversion, as well as all (and only) the syllogisms which are commonly regarded as valid. Leibniz tried to generalize this semantics for the entire algebra of concepts, but he never found a way to cope with negative concepts. This problem has only been solved by contemporary logicians; compare Sanchez-Mazas (1979), Sotirov (1999).

c. Linear Diagrams and Euler-circles

In the paper “De Formae Logicae Comprobatione per Linearum ductus” probably written after 1686 (Cout, 292-321), Leibniz elaborated two methods for representing the content of categorical propositions. The UA, for example, ‘Every man is an animal’, can be represented either by two nested circles or by two horizontal lines which symbolize that the extension of B is contained in the extension of C (the subsequent graphics are scans from Cout, 292-295):

In the case of a UN like ‘No man is a stone’, one obtains the following diagrams which symbolize that the extension of B is set-theoretically disjoint from the extension of C:

Similarly, the following circles and lines symbolize that, in the case of a PA like ‘Some men are wise’, the extensions of B and C overlap:

Finally, in the case of a PN like ‘Some men are not ruffians’, the diagrams are meant to symbolize that the extension of B is partially disjoint from the extension of C,that is, that some elements of B are not elements of C:

These diagrams may then be used to check whether a given inference is valid. Thus, for example, the validity of FERIO can be illustrated as follows:

Here the conclusion ‘Some D is not B’ follows from the premises ‘No C is B’ and ‘Some D is C’ because the elements of D which are in C can’t be elements of B. On the other hand, invalid syllogisms as, for example, the mood “AOO” of the Fourth Figure, can be refuted as follows:

As the diagram illustrates, the truth of the premises ‘Every B is C’ and ‘Some C is not D’ is compatible with a situation where the conclusion ‘Some D is not B’ is false, that is, where ‘Every D is B’ is true.

Of course, Leibniz’s diagrams which were re-discovered in the 18^th century among others by Euler (1768) are not without problems. In particular, the circles for the PA and the PN are somewhat inaccurate because they basically visualize one and the same state of affairs, namely that (i) some B are C, and (ii) some B are not C, and also (iii) some C are not B. The need to distinguish between different situations such as ((i) & (ii)) in contrast to ((i) & not (ii)) led to improvements of the method of “Euler-circles” as suggested by Venn (1881), Hamilton (1861), and others. Note, incidentally, that, in the GI, Leibniz himself improved the linear diagrams for the UA, PA and PN by drawing perpendicular lines symbolizing the “maximum”,that is, “the limits beyond which the terms cannot, and within which they can, be extended”. At the same time he used a double horizontal line to symbolize “the minimum, that is, that which cannot be taken away without affecting the relation of the terms” (LLP, 73-4, fn. 2).

3. Works on the Universal Calculus

In the period between, roughly, 1679 and 1690, Leibniz spent much effort to generalize the traditional logic to a “Universal Calculus”. At least three different calculi may be distinguished:

(a) The algebra of concepts which is provably equivalent to the Boolean algebra of sets;

(b) A fragmentary quantificational system in which the quantifiers range over concepts but in which quantification over individuals may be introduced by definition;

(c) The so-called “Plus-Minus-calculus” which constitutes an abstract system of “real addition” and “subtraction”. When this calculus is applied to concepts, it yields a weaker logic than the full algebra (a).

a. The Algebra of Concepts L1

The algebra of concepts grows out of the syllogistic framework by three achievements. First, Leibniz drops the informal quantifier expression ‘every’ and formulates the UA simply as “A is B” or, equivalently, as “A contains B”. This fundamental proposition shall here be symbolized as A∈B while its negation will be abbreviated as A∉B. Second, Leibniz introduces an operator of conceptual conjunction which combines two concepts A and B into AB (sometimes also written as “A+B”). Third, Leibniz allows the unrestricted use of conceptual negation which shall here be symbolized as ~A (“Not-A”). Hence, in particular, one can form the inconsistent concept A~A (“A Not-A”) and its tautological counterpart ~(A~A).

Identity or coincidence of concepts might be defined as mutual containment:

DEF 1 (A = B) =_df (A∈B) ∧ (B∈A).

Alternatively, the algebra of concepts can be built up with ‘=’ as a primitive operator while ‘∈’ is defined by:

DEF 2 (A∈B) =_df (A = AB).

Another important operator may be introduced by definition. Concept B is possible if B does not contain a contradiction like A~A:

DEF 3 P(B) =_df (B∉A~A).

Leibniz uses many different locutions to express the self-consistency of a concept A. Instead of ‘A est possibile’ he often says ‘A est res’, ‘A est ens’; or simply ‘A est’. In the opposite case of an impossible concept he also calls A a “false term” (“terminus falsus”).

Identity can be axiomatized by the law of reflexivity in conjunction with the rule of substitutivity:

IDEN 1 A = A

IDEN 2 If A = B, then α[A] ↔ α[B].

By means of these principles, one easily derives the following corollaries:

IDEN 3 A = B → B = A

IDEN 4 A = B ∧ B = C → A = C

IDEN 5 A = B → ~A = ~B

IDEN 6 A = B → AC = BC.

The following laws express the reflexivity and the transitivity of the containment relation:

CONT 1 A∈A

CONT 2 A∈B ∧ B∈C → A∈C.

The most fundamental principle for the operator of conceptual conjunction says: “That A contains B and A contains C is the same as that A contains BC” (LLP, 58, fn. 4), that is,

CONJ 1 A∈BC ↔ A∈B ∧ A∈C.

Conjunction then satisfies the following laws:

CONJ 2 AA = A

CONJ 3 AB = BA

CONJ 4 AB∈A

CONJ 5 AB∈B.

The next operator is conceptual negation, ‘not’. Leibniz had serious problems with finding the proper laws governing this operator. From the tradition, he knew little more than the “law of double negation”:

NEG 1 ~~A = A

One important step towards a complete theory of conceptual negation was to transform the informal principle of contraposition, ‘Every A is B, therefore Every Not-B is Not-A’ into the following principle:

NEG 2 A∈B ↔ ~B∈~A.

Furthermore Leibniz discovered various variants of the “law of consistency”:

NEG 3 A ≠ ~A

NEG 4 A = B → A ≠ ~B.

NEG 5* A∉~A

NEG 6* A∈B → A∉~B.

In the GI, these principles are formulated as follows: “A proposition false in itself is ‘A coincides with Not-A’” (§ 11); “If A = B, then A ≠ Not-B” (§ 171); “It is false that B contains Not-B, that is, B doesn’t contain Not-B” (§ 43); and “A is B, therefore A isn’t Not-B” (§ 91).

Principles NEG 5* and NEG 6* have been marked with a ‘*’ in order to indicate that the laws as stated by Leibniz are not absolutely valid but have to be restricted to self-consistent terms:

NEG 5 P(A) → A∉~A

NEG 6 P(A) → (A∈B → A∉~B).

The following two laws describe some characteristic relations between the possibility-operator P and the other operators of L1:

POSS 1 A∈B ∧ P(A) → P(B)

POSS 2 A∈B ↔ ¬P(A~B).

All these principles have been discovered by Leibniz himself who thus provided an almost complete axiomatization of L1. As a matter of fact, the “intensional” algebra of concept can be proven to be equivalent to Boole’s extensional algebra of sets provided that one adds the following counterpart of the “ex contradictorio quodlibet”:

NEG 7 (A~A)∈B.

As regards the relation of conceptual containment, A∈B, it is important to observe that Leibniz’s standard formulation ‘A contains B’ expresses the so-called “intensional” view of concepts as ideas, while we here want to develop an extensional interpretation in terms of the sets of individuals that fall under the concepts. Leibniz explained the mutual relationship between the “intensional” and the extensional point of view in the following passage from the “New Essays on Human understanding”:

The common manner of statement concerns individuals, whereas Aristotle’s refers rather to ideas or universals. For when I say Every man is an animal I mean that all the men are included among all the animals; but at the same time I mean that the idea of animal is included in the idea of man. ‘Animal’ comprises more individuals than ‘man’ does, but ‘man’ comprises more ideas or more attributes: one has more instances, the other more degrees of reality; one has the greater extension, the other the greater intension. (NE, Book IV, ch. XVII, § 8; compare the original French version in GP 5, 469).

If ‘Int(A)’ and ‘Ext(A)’ abbreviate the “intension” and the extension of a concept A, respectively, then the so-called law of reciprocity can be formalized as follows:

RECI Int(A) ⊆ Int (B) ↔ Ext(A) ⊇ Ext(B).

From this it immediately follows that two concepts A, B have the same “intension” iff they have the same extension. This somewhat surprising result might seem to unveil an inadequacy of Leibniz’s conception. However, “intensionality” in the sense of traditional logic must not be mixed up with intensionality in the modern sense. Furthermore, in Leibniz’s view, the extension of a concept A is not just the set of actually existing individuals, but rather the set of all possible individuals that fall under concept A. Therefore one may define the concept of an extensional interpretation of L1 in accordance with Leibniz’s ideas as follows:

DEF 4 Let U be a non-empty set (the domain of all possible individuals), and let ϕ be a function such that ϕ(A) ⊆ U for each concept-letter A. Then ϕ is an extensional interpretation of L1 if and only if:

(1) ϕ(A∈B) = true iff ϕ(A) ⊆ ϕ(B);

(2) ϕ(A=B) = true iff ϕ(A) = ϕ(B);

(3) ϕ(AB) = ϕ(A) ∩ ϕ(B);

(4) ϕ(~A) = complement of ϕ(A);

(5) ϕ(P(A)) = true iff ϕ(A) ≠ ∅.

Conditions (1) and (2) are straightforward consequences of RECI. Condition (3) also is trivial since it expresses that an individual x belongs to the extension of AB just in case that x belongs to the extension of both concepts (and hence to their intersection). According to condition (4), the extension of the negative concept ~A is just the set of all individuals which do not fall under the concept A. Condition (5) says that a concept A is possible if and only if it has a non-empty extension.

At first sight, this requirement appears inadequate, since there are certain concepts – such as that of a unicorn – which happen to be empty but which may nevertheless be regarded as possible, that is, not involving a contradiction. However, the universe of discourse underlying the extensional interpretation of L1 does not consist of actually existing objects only, but instead comprises all possible individuals. Therefore the non-emptiness of the extension of A is both necessary and sufficient for guaranteeing the self-consistency of A. Clearly, if A is possible, then there must be at least one possible individual x that falls under concept A.

It has often been noted that Leibniz’s logic of concepts lacks the operator of disjunction. Although this is by and large correct, it doesn’t imply any defect or any incompleteness of the system L1 because the operator A∨B may simply be introduced by definition:

DISJ 1 A∨B =_df ~(~A ~B).

On the background of the above axioms of negation and conjunction, the standard laws for disjunction, for example

DISJ 2 A∈(A∨B)

DISJ 3 B∈(A∨B)

DISJ 4 A∈C ∧ B∈C → (A∨B)∈C,

then become provable (Lenzen (1984)).

b. The Quantificational System L2

Leibniz’s quantifier logic L2 emerges from L1 by the introduction of so-called “indefinite concepts”. These concepts are symbolized by letters from the end of the alphabet X, Y, Z …, and they function as quantifiers ranging over concepts. Thus, in the GI, Leibniz explains:

(16) An affirmative proposition is ‘A is B’ or ‘A contains B’ […]. That is, if we substitute the value for A, one obtains ‘A coincides with BY’. For example, ‘Man is an animal’, that is, ‘Man’ is the same as ‘a … animal’ (namely, ‘Man’ is ‘rational animal’). For by the sign ‘Y’ I mean something undetermined, so that ‘BY’ is the same as ‘Some B’, or ‘A … animal’ […], or ‘A certain animal’. So ‘A is B’ is the same as ‘A coincides with some B’, that is, ‘A = BY’.

With the help of the modern symbol for the existential quantifier, the latter law can be expressed more precisely as follows:

CONT 3 A∈B ↔ ∃Y(A = BY).

As Leibniz himself noted, the formalization of the UA according to CONT 3 is provably equivalent to the simpler representation according to DEF 2:

It is noteworthy that for ‘A = BY’ one can also say ‘A = AB’ so that there is no need to introduce a new letter. (Cout, 366; compare also LLP, 56, fn. 1.)

On the one hand, according to the rule of existential generalization,

EXIST 1 If α[A], then ∃Yα[Y],

A = AB immediately entails ∃Y(A = YB). On the other hand, if there exists some Y such that A = YB, then according to IDEN 6, AB = YBB, that is, AB = YB and hence (by the premise A = YB) AB = A. (This proof incidentally was given by Leibniz himself in the important paper “Primaria Calculi Logic Fundamenta” of August 1690; Cout, 235).

Next observe that Leibniz often used to formalize the PA ‘Some A is B’ by means of the indefinite concept Y as ‘YA∈B’. In view of CONT 3, this representation might be transformed into the (elliptic) equation YA = ZB. However, both formalizations are somewhat inadequate because they are easily seen to be theorems of L2! According to CONJ 4, BA contains B, hence by EXIST 1:

CONJ 6 ∃Y(YA∈B).

Similarly, since, according to CONJ 3, AB = BA, a twofold application of EXIST 1 yields:

CONJ 7 ∃Y∃Z(YA = BZ).

These tautologies, of course, cannot adequately represent the PA which for an appropriate choice of concepts A and B may become false! In order to resolve these difficulties, consider a draft of a calculus probably written between 1686 and 1690 (compare Cout, 259-261, and the text-critical edition in AE, VI, 4, # 171), where Leibniz proved principle:

NEG 8* A∉B ↔ ∃Y(YA∈~B).

On the one hand, it is interesting to see that after first formulating the right hand side of the equivalence, “as usual”, in the elliptic way ‘YA is Not-B’, Leibniz later paraphrased it by means of the explicit quantifier expression “there exists a Y such that YA is Not-B”. On the other hand, Leibniz discovered that NEG 8* has to be improved by requiring more exactly that there exists a Y such that YA contains ~B and YA is possible, that is, Y must be compatible with A:

NEG 8 A∉B ↔ ∃Y(P(YA) ∧ YA∈~B).

Leibniz’s proof of this important law is quite remarkable:

(18) […] to say ‘A isn’t B’ is the same as to say ‘there exists a Y such that YA is Not-B’. If ‘A is B’ is false, then ‘A Not-B’ is possible by [POSS 2]. ‘Not-B’ shall be called ‘Y’. Hence YA is possible. Hence YA is Not-B. Therefore we have shown that, if it is false that A is B, then QA is Not-B. Conversely, let us show that if QA is Not-B, ‘A is B’ is false. For if ‘A is B’ would be true, ‘B’ could be substituted for ‘A’ and we would obtain ‘QB is Not-B’ which is absurd. (Cout, 261)

To conclude the sketch of L2, let us consider some of the rare passages where an indefinite concept functions as a universal quantifier. In the above quoted draft (Cout, 260), Leibniz put forward principle “(15) ‘A is B’ is the same as ‘If L is A, it follows that L is B’”:

CONT 4 A∈B ↔ ∀Y(Y∈A → Y∈B).

Furthermore, in § 32 GI, Leibniz at least vaguely recognized that just as A∈B (according to CONJ 6) is equivalent to ∃Y(A = YB), so the negation A∉B means that, for any indefinite concept Y, A ≠ BY:

CONT 5 A∉B ↔ ∀Y(A ≠ YB).

According to AE, VI, 4, 753, Leibniz had written: “(32) Propositio Negativa. A non continet B, seu A esse (continere) B falsum est, seu A non coincidit BY”. Unfortunately, the last passage ‘seu A non coincidit BY’ had been overlooked by Couturat and it is therefore also missing in Parkinson’s translation in LLP! Anyway, with the help of ‘∀’, one can formalize Leibniz’s conception of individual concepts as maximally-consistent concepts as follows:

IND 1 Ind(A) ↔_df P(A) ∧ ∀Y(P(AY) → A∈Y).

Thus A is an individual concept iff A is “self-consistent and A contains every concept Y which is compatible with A. The underlying idea of the completeness of individual concepts had been formulated in § 72 GI as follows:

So if BY is [“being”], and the indefinite term Y is superfluous, that is, in the way that ‘a certain Alexander the Great’ and ‘Alexander the Great’ are the same, then B is an individual. If the term BA is [“being”] and if B is an individual, then A will be superfluous; or if BA=C, then B=C (LLP 65, § 72 + fn. 1; for a closer interpretation of this idea, see Lenzen (2004c)).

Note, incidentally, that IND 1 might be simplified by requiring that, for each concept Y, A either contains Y or contains ~Y:

IND 2 Ind(A) ↔ ∀Y(A∈~Y ↔ A∉Y).

As a corollary it follows that the invalid principle

NEG 9* A∉B → A∈~B,

which Leibniz again and again had considered as valid, in fact holds only for individual concepts:

NEG 9 Ind(A) → (A∉B → A∈~B).

Already in the “Calculi Universalis Investigationes” of 1679, Leibniz had pointed out:

…If two propositions are given with exactly the same singular [!] subject, where the predicate of the one is contradictory to the predicate of the other, then necessarily one proposition is true and the other is false. But I say: exactly the same [singular] subject, for example, ‘This gold is a metal’, ‘This gold is a not-metal.’ (AE VI, 4, 217-218).

The crucial issue here is that NEG 9* holds only for an individual concept like, for example, ‘Apostle Peter’, but not for general concepts as, for example, ‘man’. The text-critical apparatus of AE reveals that Leibniz was somewhat diffident about this decisive point. He began to illustrate the above rule by the correct example “if I say ‘Apostle Peter was a Roman bishop’, and ‘Apostle Peter was not a Roman bishop’” and then went on, erroneously, to generalize this law for arbitrary terms: “or if I say ‘Every man is learned’ ‘Every man is not learned’.” Finally he noticed this error “Here it becomes evident that I am mistaken, for this rule is not valid.” The long story of Leibniz’s cardinal mistake of mixing up ‘A isn’t B’ and ‘A is not-B’ is analyzed in detail in Lenzen (1986).

There are many different ways to represent the categorical forms by formulas of L1 or L2. The most straightforward formalization would be the following “homogenous” schema in terms of conceptual containment:

UA A∈B UN A∈~B

PA A∉~B PN A∉B.

The “homogeneity” consists in two facts:

(a) The formula for the UN is obtained from that of the UA by replacing the predicate B with its negation, ~B. This is the formal counterpart of the traditional principle of obversion according to which, for example, ‘No A is B’ is equivalent to ‘Every A is not-B’.

(b) In accordance with the traditional laws of opposition, the formulas for the particular propositions are just taken as the negations of corresponding universal propositions.

In view of DEF 2, the first schema may be transformed into

UA A = AB UN A = A~B

PA A ≠ A~B PN A ≠ AB.

Similarly, by means of the fundamental law POSS 2, one obtains

UA ¬P(A~B) UN ¬P(AB)

PA P(AB) PN P(A~B).

Furthermore, with the help of indefinite concepts, one can formulate, for example,

UA ∃Y(A = YB) UN ∃Y(A = Y~B)

PA ∀Y(A ≠ Y~B) PN ∀Y(A ≠ YB).

Leibniz used to work with various elements of these representations, often combining them into complicated inhomogeneous schemata such as:

“A = YB is the UA, where the adjunct Y is like an additional unknown term: ‘Every man’ is the same as ‘A certain animal’.

YA = ZB is the PA. ‘Some man’ or ‘Man of a certain kind’ is the same as ‘A certain learned’.

A = Y not-B [is the UN] No man is a stone, that is, Every man is a not-stone, that is, ‘Man’ and ‘A certain not-stone’ coincide.

YA = Z not-B [is the PN] A certain man isn’t learned or is not-learned, that is, ‘A certain man’ and ‘A certain not-learned’ coincide” (Cout, 233-234).

But the representations of PA and PN of this schema are inadequate because the formulas ‘[∃Y∃Z](YA = ZB)’ and ‘[∃Y∃Z](YA = Z~B)’ are theorems of L2! These conditions may, however, easily be corrected by adding the requirement that YA is self-consistent:

UA ∃Y(A = YB) UN ∃Y(A = Y~B)

PA ∃Y∃Z(P(YA) ∧ YA = ZB) PN ∃Y∃Z(P(YA) ∧ YA = Z~B).

Already in the paper “De Formae Logicae Comprobatione per Linearum ductus”, Leibniz had made numerous attempts to prove the basic laws of syllogistic with the help of these schemata. He continued these efforts in two interesting fragments of August 1690 dealing with “The Primary Bases of a Logical Calculus” (LLP, 90 – 92 + 93-94; compare also the closely related essays “Principia Calculi rationalis” in Cout, 229-231 and the untitled fragments Cout, 259-261 + 261-264). In the end, however, Leibniz remained unsatisfied with his attempts.

To be sure, a complete proof of the theory of the syllogism could easily be obtained by drawing upon the full list of “axioms” for L1 and L2 as stated above. But Leibniz more ambitiously tried to find proofs which presuppose only a small number of “self-evident” laws for identity. In particular, he was not willing to adopt principle

(17) Not-B = not-B not-(AB), that is, Not-B contains Not-AB, or Not-B is not-AB

as a fundamental axiom which therefore needs not itself be demonstrated. Although Leibniz realized that (17) is equivalent to the law of contraposition repeated in the subsequent §

(19) ‘A = AB’ and ‘Not-B = Not-B Not-A’ are equivalent. This is conversion by contraposition (Cout, 422),

he still thought it necessary to prove this “axiom”: “This remains to be demonstrated in our calculus”!

c. The Plus-Minus-Calculus

The so-called Plus-Minus-Calculus was mainly developed in the paper “Non inelegans specimen demonstrandi in abstractis” of around 1686/7 (compare GP 7, ## XIX, XX and the text-critical edition in AE VI, 4, ## 177, 178; English translations are provided in LLP, 122-130 + 131-144). Strictly speaking, the Plus-Minus-Calculus is not a logical calculus but rather a much more general calculus which admits of different applications and interpretations. In its abstract form, it should be regarded as a theory of set-theoretical containment, set-theoretical “addition”, and set-theoretical “subtraction”. Unlike modern systems of set-theory, however, Leibniz’s calculus has no counterpart of the relation ‘x is an element of A’; and it also lacks the operator of set-theoretical “negation”, that is, set-theoretical complement! The complement of set A might, though, be defined with the help of the subtraction operator as (U-A) where the constant ‘U’ designates the universe of discourse. But, in Leibniz’s calculus, this additional logical element is lacking.

Leibniz’s drafts exhibit certain inconsistencies which result from the experimental character of developing the laws for “real” addition and subtraction in close analogy to the laws of arithmetical addition and subtraction. The genesis of this idea is described in detail in Lenzen (1989). The inconsistencies might be removed basically in two ways. First, one might restrict A-B to the case where B is contained in A; such a conservative reconstruction of the Plus-Minus-Calculus has been developed in Dürr (1930). The second, more rewarding alternative consists in admitting the operation of “real subtraction” A-B also if B is not contained in A. In any case, however, one has to give up Leibniz’s idea that subtraction might yield “privative” entities which are “less than nothing”.

In the following reconstruction, Leibniz’s symbols ‘+’ for the addition (that is, union) and ‘-’ for the subtraction of sets are adopted, while his informal expressions ‘Nothing’ (“nihil”) and ‘is in’ (“est in”) are replaced by the modern symbols ‘∅’ and ‘⊆’. Set-theoretical identity may be treated either as a primitive or as a defined operator. In the former case, inclusion can be defined either by A⊆B =_df ∃Y(A+Y = B) or simpler as A⊆B =_df (A+B = B). If, conversely, inclusion is taken as primitive, identity can be defined as mutual inclusion: A=B =_df (A⊆B) ∧ (B⊆A) (see, for example, Definition 3, Propositions 13 +14 and Proposition 17 in LLP, 131-144).

Set-theoretical addition is symmetric, or, as Leibniz puts it, “transposition makes no difference here” (LLP, 132):

PLUS 1 A+B = B+A.

The main difference between arithmetical addition and “real addition” is that the addition of one and the same “real” thing (or set of things) doesn’t yield anything new:

PLUS 2 A+A = A.

As Leibniz puts it (LLP, 132): “A+A = A […] that is, repetition changes nothing. (For although four coins and another four coins are eight coins, four coins and the same four already counted are not)”.

The “real nothing”, that is, the empty set ∅, is characterized as follows: “It does not matter whether Nothing is put or not, that is, A+Nih. = A” (Cout, 267):

NIHIL 1 A+∅ = A.

In view of the relation (A⊆B) ↔ (A+B = B), this law can be transformed into:

NIHIL 2 ∅⊆A.

“Real” subtraction may be regarded as the converse operation of addition: “If the same is put and taken away […] it coincides with Nothing. That is, A […] – A […] = N” (LLP, 124, Axiom 2):

MINUS 1 A-A = ∅.

Leibniz also considered the following principles which in a stronger form express that subtraction is the converse of addition:

MINUS 2* (A+B)-B = A

MINUS 3* (A+B) = C → C-B = A.

But he soon recognized that these laws do not hold in general but only in the special case where the sets A and B are “uncommunicating” (Cout, 267, # 29: “Therefore if A+B = C, then A = C-B […] but it is necessary that A and B have nothing in common”.) The new operator of “communicating” sets has to be understood as follows:

If some term, M, is in A, and the same term is in B, this term is said to be ‘common’ to them, and they will be said to be ‘communicating’. (LLP, 123, Definition 4)

Hence two sets A and B have something in common if and only if there exists some set Y such that Y⊆A and Y⊆B. Now since, trivially, the empty set is included in every set A (NIHIL 2), one has to add the qualification that Y is not empty:

COMMON 1 Com(A,B) ↔_df ∃Y(Y≠∅ ∧ Y⊆A ∧ Y⊆B).

The necessary restriction of MINUS 2* and MINUS 3* can then be formalized as follows:

MINUS 2 ¬Com(A,B) → ((A+B)-B = A)

MINUS 3 ¬Com(A,B) ∧ (A+B = C) → (C-B = A).

Similarly, Leibniz recognized (LLP, 130) that from an equation A+B = A+C, A may be subtracted on both sides provided that C is “uncommunicating” both with A and with B, that is,

MINUS 4 ¬Com(A,B) ∧ ¬Com(A,C) → (A+B = A+C → B=C).

Furthermore Leibniz discovered that the implication in MINUS 2 may be converted (and hence strengthened into a biconditional). Thus one obtains the following criterion: Two sets A, B are “uncommunicating” if and only if the result of first adding and then subtracting B coincides with A. Inserting negations on both sides of this equivalence one obtains:

COMMON 2 Com(A,B) ↔ ((A+B)-B) ≠ A.

Whenever two sets A, B are communicating or “have something in common”, the intersection of A and B, in modern symbols A∩B, is not empty (LLP, 127, Case 2 of Theorem IX: “Let us assume meanwhile that E is everything which A and G have in common – if they have something in common, so that if they have nothing in common, E = Nothing”), that is,

COMMON 3 Com(A,B) ↔ A∩B ≠ ∅.

Furthermore, “What has been subtracted and the remainder are uncommunicating” (LLP, 128, Theorem X), that is,

COMMON 4 ¬Com(A-B,B).

Leibniz further discovered the following formula which allows one to “calculate” the intersection or “commune” of A and B by a series of additions and subtractions: A∩B = B-((A+B)-A). In a small fragment (Cout, 250) he explained:

Suppose you have A and B and you want to know if there exists some M which is in both of them. Solution: combine those two into one, A+B, which shall be called L […] and from L one of the constituents, A, shall be subtracted […] let the rest be N; then, if N coincides with the other constituent, B, they have nothing in common. But if they do not coincide, they have something in common which can be found by subtracting the rest N […] from B […] and there remains M, the commune of A and B, which was looked for.

4. Leibniz’s Calculus of Strict Implication

It is a characteristic feature of Leibniz’s logic that when he states and proves the laws of concept logic, he takes the requisite rules and laws of propositional logic for granted. Once the former have been established, however, the latter can be obtained from the former by observing a strict analogy between concepts and propositions which allows one to re-interpret the conceptual connectives as propositional connectives. Note, incidentally, that in the 19^th century George Boole in roughly the same way first presupposed propositional logic to develop his algebra of sets, and only afterwards derived the propositional calculus out of the set-theoretical calculus. While Boole thus arrived at the classical, two-valued propositional calculus, Leibniz’s approach instead yields a modal logic of strict implication.

Leibniz outlined a simple, ingenious method to transform the algebra of concepts into an algebra of propositions. Already in the “Notationes Generales” written between 1683 and 1685 (AE VI, 4, # 131), he pointed out to the parallel between the containment relation among concepts and the implication relation among propositions. Just as the simple proposition ‘A is B’ is true, “when the predicate [A] is contained in the subject” B, so a conditional proposition ‘If A is B, then C is D’ is true, “when the consequent is contained in the antecedent” (AE VI, 4, 551). In later works Leibniz compressed this idea into formulations such as “a proposition is true whose predicate is contained in the subject or more generally whose consequent is contained in the antecedent” (Cout, 401). The most detailed explanation of this idea was given in §§ 75, 137 and 189 of the GI:

If, as I hope, I can conceive all propositions as terms, and hypotheticals as categoricals and if I can treat all propositions universally, this promises a wonderful ease in my symbolism and analysis of concepts, and will be a discovery of the greatest importance […]

We have, then, discovered many secrets of great importance for the analysis of all our thoughts and for the discovery and proof of truths. We have discovered […] how absolute and hypothetical truths have one and the same laws and are contained in the same general theorems […]

Our principles, therefore, will be these […] Sixth, whatever is said of a term which contains a term can also be said of a proposition from which another proposition follows (LLP, 66, 78, and 85).

To conceive all propositions in analogy to concepts means in particular that the conditional ‘If a then b’ will be logically treated like the containment relation between concepts, ‘A contains B’. Furthermore, as Leibniz explained elsewhere, negations and conjunctions of propositions are to be conceived just as negations and conjunctions of concepts. Thus one obtains the following mapping of the primitive formulas of the algebra of concepts into formulas of the algebra of propositions:

A∈B α → β

A=B α ↔ β

~A ¬α

AB α∧β

P(A) ◊α

As Leibniz himself explained, the fundamental law POSS 2 does not only hold for the containment-relation between concepts but also for the entailment relation between propositions:

‘A contains B’ is a true proposition if ‘A non-B’ entails a contradiction. This applies both to categorical and to hypothetical propositions (Cout, 407).

Hence A∈B ↔ ¬P(A~B) may be “translated” into (α→β) ↔ ¬◊(α∧¬β). This formula unmistakably shows that Leibniz’s conditional is not a material but rather a strict implication. As Rescher already noted in (1954: 10), Leibniz’s account provides a definition of “entailment in terms of negation, conjunction, and the notion of possibility”, which coincides with the modern definition of strict implication put forward, for example, in Lewis & Langford (1932: 124): “The relation of strict implication can be defined in terms of negation, possibility, and product […] Thus ‘p implies q’ […] is to mean ‘It is false that it is possible that p should be true and q false’”. This definition is almost identical with Leibniz’s explanation in “Analysis Particularum”: “Thus if I say ‘If L is true it follows that M is true’, this means that one cannot suppose at the same time that L is true and that M is false” (AE VI, 4, 656).

Given the above “translation”, the basic axioms and theorems of the algebra of concepts can be transformed into the following laws of the algebra of propositions:

IMPL 1 α → α

IMPL 2 (α → β) ∧ (β→γ) → (α→γ)

IMPL 3 (α → β) ↔ (α ↔ α∧β)

CONJ 1 (α → β∧γ) ↔ ((α→β) ∧ (α→γ))

CONJ 2 α∧β → α

CONJ 3 α∧β → β

CONJ 4 α∧α ↔ α

CONJ 5 α∧β ↔ β∧α

NEG 1 ¬¬α ↔ α

NEG 2 ¬(α ↔ ¬α)

NEG 3 (α → β) ↔ (¬β→ ¬α)

NEG 4 ¬α → ¬(α∧β)

NEG 5 ◊α → ((α → β) → ¬(α → ¬β))

NEG 6 (α ∧¬α) → β

POSS 1 (α → β) ∧ ◊α → ◊β

POSS 2 (α → β) ↔ ¬◊(α ∧ ¬β)

POSS 3 ¬◊(α ∧ ¬α)

5. Works on Modal Logic

When people credit Leibniz with having anticipated “Possible-worlds-semantics”, they mostly refer to his philosophical writings, in particular to the “Nouveaux Essais sur l’entendement humain” (NE) and to the metaphysical speculations of the “Essais de theodicée” (Theo) of 1710. Leibniz argues there that while there are infinitely many ways how God might have created the world, the real world that God finally decided to create is the best of all possible worlds. As a matter of fact, however, Leibniz has much more to offer than this over-optimistic idea (which was rightly criticized by Voltaire and, for example, in part 2 of chapter 8 of Hume’s “An Enquiry concerning Human Understanding”). In what follows we briefly consider some of Leibniz’s early logical works where

(1) the idea that a necessary proposition is true in each possible world (while a possible proposition is true in at least one possible world) is formally elaborated, and where

(2) the close relation between alethic and deontic modalities is unveiled.

a. Possible-Worlds-Semantics for Alethic Modalities

The fundamental logical relations between necessity, ☐, possibility, ◊, and impossibility can be expressed, for example, by:

NEC 1 ☐(α) ↔ ¬◊(¬α)

NEC 2 ¬◊(α) ↔ ☐(¬α).

These laws were familiar already to logicians long before Leibniz. However, Leibniz “proved” these relations by means of an admirably clear analysis of modal operators in terms of “possible cases”, that is, possible worlds:

Possible is whatever can happen or what is true in some cases

Impossible is whatever cannot happen or what is true in no […] case

Necessary is whatever cannot not happen or what is true in every […] case

Contingent is whatever can not happen or what is [not] true in some case. (AE VI, 1, 466).

As this quotation shows, Leibniz uses the notion of contingency not in the modern sense of ‘neither necessary nor impossible’ but as the simple negation of ‘necessary’. The quoted analysis of the truth-conditions for modal propositions entails the validity not only of NEC 1, 2, but also of:

NEC 3 ☐α → ◊(α)

NEC 4 ¬◊(α) → ¬☐(α).

Leibniz “proves” these laws by reducing them to corresponding laws for quantifiers such as: If α is true in each case, then α is true in at least one case. In the “Modalia et Elementa Juris Naturalis” of around 1679, Leibniz mentions NEC 3 and NEC 4 in passing: “Since everything which is necessary is possible, so everything that is impossible is contingent, that is, can fail to happen” (AE IV, 4, 2759). A very elliptic “proof” of these laws was already sketched in the “Elementa juris naturalis” of 1669/70 (AE VI, 1, 469).

It cannot be overlooked, however, that Leibniz’s semi-formal truth conditions, even when combined with his later views on possible worlds, fail to come up to the standards of modern possible worlds semantics, since nothing in Leibniz’s considerations corresponds to an accessibility relation among worlds.

b. Basic Principles of Deontic Logic

As has already been pointed out by Schepers (1972) and Kalinowski (1974), Leibniz saw very clearly that the logical relations between the deontic modalities obligatory, permitted and forbidden exactly mirror the corresponding relations between necessary, possible and impossible, and that therefore all laws and rules of alethic modal logic may be applied to deontic logic as well.

Just like ‘necessary’, ‘contingent’, ‘possible’ and ‘impossible’ are related to each other, so also are ‘obligatory’, ‘not obligatory’, ‘permitted’, and ‘forbidden’ (AE VI, 4, 2762).

This structural analogy goes hand in hand with the important discovery that the deontic notions can be defined by means of the alethic notions plus the additional “logical” constant of a morally perfect man (“vir bonus”). Such a virtuous man is characterized by the requirements that he strictly obeys all laws, always acts in such a way that he does no harm to anybody, and is benevolent to all other people. Given this understanding of a “vir bonus”, Leibniz explains:

Obligatory is what is necessary for the virtuous man as such.

Not obligatory is what is contingent for the virtuous man as such.

Permitted is what is possible for the virtuous man as such.

Forbidden is what is impossible for the virtuous man as such (Grua, 605).

If we express the restriction of the modal operators ☐ and ◊ to the virtuous man by means of a subscript ‘v’, these definitions can be formalized as follows (where the letter ‘E’ reminding of the German notion ‘erlaubt’ is taken instead of ‘P’ for ‘permitted’ in order to avoid confusions with the operator of possibility):

DEON 1 O(α) ↔ ☐_v(α)

DEON 2 E(α) ↔ ◊_v(α)

DEON 3 F(α) ↔ ¬◊_v(α).

Now, as Leibniz mentioned in passing, all that is unconditionally necessary will also be necessary for the virtuous man:

NEC 5 ☐(α) → ☐_v(α).

Hence (as was shown in more detail in Lenzen (2005)), Leibniz’s derivation of the fundamental laws for the deontic operators from corresponding laws of the alethic modal operators proceeds in much the same way as the modern reduction of deontic logic to alethic modal logic “rediscovered” almost 300 years after Leibniz by Anderson (1958).

6. References and Further Reading

a. Abbreviations for Leibniz’s works

AE German Academy of Science (ed.), G. W. Leibniz, Sämtliche Schriften und Briefe, Series VI, „Philosophische Schriften“, Darmstadt 1930, Berlin 1962 ff.
Cout Louis Couturat (ed.), Opuscules et fragments inédits de Leibniz, Paris (Presses universitaires de France) 1903, reprint Hildesheim (Olms) 1961.
GI Generales Inquisitiones de Analysi Notionum et Veritatum; first edited in Cout, 356-399; text-critical edition in A, VI 4, 739-788; English translation in LLP, 47-87.
GP C. I. Gerhardt (ed.), Die philosophischen Schriften von G. W. Leibniz, seven volumes Berlin/Halle 1875-90, reprint Hildesheim (Olms) 1965.
Grua Gaston Grua (ed.), G. W. Leibniz – Textes Inédits, two Volumes, Paris (Presses Universitaires de France) 1948.
LH Eduard Bodemann (ed.), Die Leibniz-Handschriften der Königlichen Öffentlichen Bibliothek zu Hannover, Hannover 1895, reprint Hildesheim (Olms) 1966.
LLP G. H. R. Parkinson (ed.), Leibniz Logical Papers – A Selection, Oxford (Clarendon Press), 1966.
NE Nouveaux Essais sur l’entendement humain – Par l’Auteur du Système de l’Harmonie Preestablie, in GP 5, 41-509.
Theo Essais de Theodicée sur la Bonté de Dieu, la Liberté de l’Homme et l’Origine du Mal, in GP 6, 21-436.

b. Secondary Literature

Anderson, Alan Ross (1958): “A Reduction of Deontic Logic to Alethic Modal Logic”, in Mind LXVII, 100-103.
Arnauld, Antoine & Nicole, Pierre (1683) : La Logique ou L’Art de Penser, 5th edition, reprint 1965 Paris (Presses universitaires de France).
Burkhardt, Hans (1980): Logik und Semiotik in der Philosophie von Leibniz, München (Philosophia Verlag).
Couturat, Louis (1901): La Logique de Leibniz d’après des documents inédits, Paris (Félix Alcan).
Dürr, Karl (1930): Neue Beleuchtung einer Theorie von Leibniz – Grundzüge des Logikkalküls, Darmstadt.
Euler, Leonhard (1768): Lettres à une princesse d’Allemagne sur quelques sujets de physique et de philosophie, St Petersburg, 1768–1772.
Hamilton, William (1861): Lectures on Metaphysics and Logic, ed. by H.L. Mansel & J. Veitch, Edinburgh, London (William Blackwood); reprint Stuttgart Bad Cannstadt 1969.
Ishiguro, Hidé (1972): Leibniz’s Philosophy of Logic and Language, London (Duckworth).
Kalinowski, George (1974): “Un logicien déontique avant la lettre: Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz”, in Archiv für Rechts- und Sozialphilosophie 60, 79-98.
Kauppi, Raili (1960): Über die Leibnizsche Logik mit besonderer Berücksichtigung des Problems der Intension und der Extension, Helsinki (Acta Philosophica Fennica).
Kneale, William and Martha (1962): The Development of Logic, Oxford (Clarendon).
Lenzen, Wolfgang (1984): “Leibniz und die Boolesche Algebra”, in Studia Leibnitiana 16, 187-203.
Lenzen, Wolfgang (1986): “‘Non est’ non est ‘est non’ – Zu Leibnizens Theorie der Negation”, in Studia Leibnitiana 18, 1-37.
Lenzen, Wolfgang (1989): “Arithmetical vs. ‘Real’ Addition – A Case Study of the Relation between Logic, Mathematics, and Metaphysics in Leibniz”, in N. Rescher (ed.), Leibnizian Inquiries – A Group of Essays, Lanham, 149-157.
Lenzen, Wolfgang (1990): Das System der Leibnizschen Logik, Berlin (de Gruyter).
Lenzen, Wolfgang (2004a): Calculus Universalis – Studien zur Logik von G. W. Leibniz, Paderborn (mentis).
Lenzen, Wolfgang (2004b): “Leibniz’s Logic”, in D. Gabbay & J. Woods (eds.) The Rise of Modern Logic – From Leibniz to Frege (Handbook of the History of Logic, vol. 3), Amsterdam (Elsevier), 1-83.
Lenzen, Wolfgang (2004c): “Logical Criteria for Individual(concept)s”, in M. Carrara, A. M. Nunziante & G. Tomasi (eds.), Individuals, Minds, and Bodies: Themes from Leibniz, Stuttgart (Steiner), 87-107.
Lenzen, Wolfgang (2005): “Leibniz on Alethic and Deontic Modal Logic”. In D. Berlioz & F. Nef (eds.), Leibniz et les Puissances du Langage, Paris (Vrin), 2005, 341-362.
Lewis, Clarence I. & Langford, Cooper H. (1932): Symbolic Logic, New York, ²1959 (Dover Publications).
Liske M.-Th. (1994): “Ist eine reine Inhaltslogik möglich? Zu Leibniz’ Begriffstheorie”, in Studia Leibnitiana XXVI, 31-55.
Lukasiewicz, Jan (1951): Aristotle’s Syllogistic – From the Standpoint of Modern Formal Logic, Oxford (Clarendon Press).
Mugnai, Massimo (1992): Leibniz’s Theory of Relations, Stuttgart (Steiner).
Poser, Hans (1969): Zur Theorie der Modalbegriffe bei G. W. Leibniz, Wiesbaden (Steiner).
Rescher, Nicholas (1954): “Leibniz’s interpretation of his logical calculus”, in Journal of Symbolic Logic 19, 1-13.
Rescher, Nicholas (1979): Leibniz – An Introduction to his Philosophy, London (Billing & Sons).
Sanchez-Mazas, Miguel (1979): “Simplification de l’arithmétisation leibnitienne de la syllogistique par l’expression arithmétique de la notion intensionelle du ‘non ens’”, in Studia Leibnitiana Sonderheft 8, 46-58.
Schepers, Heinrich (1972): “Leibniz‘ Disputationen ‚De Conditionibus‘: Ansätze zu einer juristischen Aussagenlogik” in Studia Leibnitiana Supplementa XV, 1-17.
Schupp, Franz (ed.) (1982): G. W. Leibniz, Allgemeine Untersuchungen über die Analyse der Begriffe und Wahrheiten, Hamburg (Meiner).
Schupp, Franz (ed.) (2000): G. W. Leibniz, Die Grundlagen des logischen Kalküls, Hamburg (Meiner).
Swoyer, Chris (1995): “Leibniz on Intension and Extension”, in Noûs 29, 96-114.
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Author Information

Wolfgang Lenzen
Email: lenzen@uos.de
University of Osnabrück
Germany

Hugo Grotius (1583—1645)

Hugo Grotius was a Dutch humanist and jurist whose philosophy of natural law had a major impact on the development of seventeenth century political thought and on the moral theories of the Enlightenment. Valorized by contemporary international theorists as the father of international law, his work on sovereignty, international rights of commerce and the norms of just war continue to inform theories of the international legal order. His major work, De Jure Belli ac Pacis (The Rights of War and Peace), is particularly notable in this respect, as well as Mare Liberum, a doctrine in favor of the freedom of the seas, which is considered an antecedent, inspiration and the backbone of the modern law of the sea.

Grotius was heavily influenced by classical philosophy, most prominently Aristotle and the Stoics, as well as by the contemporary humanist tradition and the late-medieval Scholastics. Caught up in the religious strife of the Reformation, Grotius promoted an irenic vision that would unite and reconcile the Christian Church on the principles of civil religion and toleration. He was well known in his time as much for his poetry and philosophy of religion as for his work on law and politics but is best remembered for his influence on theories of the social contract, natural rights and the laws of war.

Life and Works
Irenicism and Tolerance
Sovereignty and Imperialism
1. Divisible Sovereignty
2. Resistance, War and Empire
Natural Right and the Law of Nations
Scholarly Interest in Grotius
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Life and Works

Huig de Groot, best known by the Latinized name Hugo Grotius, began his life in the commercial town of Delft while, in 1583, the Dutch Republic persevered through a second decade of war for independence from Hapsburg rule and was already positioning itself for ascendancy as an overseas trading power. Born into a family with standing among the city elite and connections to the recently founded University of Leiden, young Hugo would find many opportunities to develop his considerable talents for scholarly pursuits even as a child. His family tutored him in Greek and Latin at an early age, introduced him to classical letters, and brought him up in the disciplines of Reformed faith. So outstanding were his gifts for intellectual work that he was welcomed to enroll at Leiden University at the mere age of eleven. At the university, the boy de Groot became a favored student of some of the most celebrated scholars of the time, discovering his talents in a whole range of subjects in the liberal arts and new sciences. His reputation as a promising young man of letters would open a number of doors for him in the political life of the time, where humanist expertise was a valued asset. The most auspicious of these opportunities came as he was preparing for life beyond the university. In 1598, no less a figure than Jan van Oldenbarnevelt, the Grand Pensionary and most influential personality in Dutch politics, invited Grotius to accompany his delegation to the French court. The embassy, which ultimately failed in its aim to renew the king’s military support against Spain, nonetheless brought Grotius into the fold of high politics and even staked him a reputation with the French court when Henry IV lauded the learned youth as “the miracle of Holland.” The connections he made in France enabled Grotius to extend his stay and earn a Doctor of Laws degree from the University of Orléans before returning to Holland the following year.

Entering into practice as a lawyer in The Hague, Grotius took advantage of chances to hone his rhetorical skills and found time to devote to his diverse scholarly interests. His earliest writings to go into print included several imitations of classical verse and translations of significant works in compass navigation and astronomy, the latter being of keen interest to his friends invested in the burgeoning overseas trade. In 1601, he published a tragedy, Adamus Exul (Adam in Exile), that earned him instant acclaim as a poet; it was a work that John Milton would later study in preparing his Paradise Lost. While Grotius prized these pursuits more highly than the mundane work of a lawyer, he always strove to please his patrons and clients. Indeed, his most lasting contributions to political thought took shape in the course of his professional duties during this period.

In 1604, Grotius was drawn into the sensational controversy over privateering in the Southeast Asian trade. The United Dutch East India Company had been rising quickly as a major player in European overseas commerce, and Grotius shared the view of many of his associates involved in the trade that the Company not only buoyed up the young republic with wealth but also weakened its adversaries by cutting into Iberian dominance of the East Indian routes. Still, acts of piracy by a private concern did not sit well in the public opinion of many citizens and allies. When asked by a friend with Company connections to write a brief justifying a recent and very lucrative seizure of Spanish cargo, Grotius went on to produce not only an ardent defense of the capture but an investigation into the deep principles of law that connected those separated by nation and culture. The resulting manuscript, provisionally titled De Indis (On the Indies), was never published in full until long after Grotius’ death (appearing in 1868 as Commentary on the Laws of Prize and Booty). It was the young jurist’s first systematic work on the problems of international affairs and was in many ways his most philosophically developed. Many of the arguments worked out in the manuscript—that there is a basic law of nature determined by the need to reconcile self-preservation with social life, that the authority to govern and even to punish derive from the rights of natural persons prior to the founding of civil societies, and that claims to jurisdiction over the open seas are invalid—would give direction to his later works.

In fact, the last of these arguments would appear in print in 1609 as the anonymous pamphlet, Mare Liberum (The Free Seas). The pamphlet, which Grotius pulled directly from the text of De Indis, once again served the interests of those in the Dutch political and commercial establishment that were insisting upon the right of access to overseas routes in the ongoing negotiations for a truce with the Spanish. The work argued not only that the Spanish claims to a trading monopoly in the Southeast Asia and elsewhere failed to square with the facts—that these were rights conferred by papal authority or acquired by just conquest—but that there was, in principle, no basis for any monopoly on access to the seas. The freedom of the seas was entailed by the very nature of private property. To privately own a thing requires that one can occupy it, taking it out of the common store, and that one can make full use of it. The sea cannot be contained and is too plentiful for its usefulness to be exhausted by a few; hence, no one can take exclusive ownership of the sea. The seas remain open to all. This question was of great importance in European relations during this period of intense competition between aspiring overseas empires, and Grotius’ work would frame the intense debate to follow. During this time in his early legal career, he penned a number of other manuscripts touching on matters of international relations that, while mostly unpublished, shaped his later work on the subject. The Parellelon Rerumpublicarum (composed 1601-2) explored the concept of ‘good faith’ in dealings with other nations through some flattering comparisons among the customs of the Greek, Roman and Dutch peoples. In his Commentary on Eleven Theses (circa 1602-08), Grotius worked out an understanding of the ruling power of a state—its sovereignty—and its relation to the principles of just war.

Having proved the usefulness of his talents to the ruling elite, Grotius’ star continued to rise. He gained recognition from Prince Maurits of Orange, the executive and military leader of the United Provinces, when in 1607, the prince appointed him as attorney general of the provinces of Holland, Zeeland and West Friesland. It was during this time that he became engaged to be married to a young woman from a distinguished family in Zeeland, Maria van Reigersberch. Her partnership and personal courage would carry the family through a tumultuous life that the young couple could not have expected at the time of their wedding in 1608. Soon thereafter, Maria gave birth to the first of seven children. As his focus shifted from legal practice to public service, Grotius began to put a number of his writings into press. His second celebrated tragedy, The Passion of Christ, came out in 1608, followed by the anonymous Mare Liberum in 1609 and a political history of the old Dutch republic, De Antiquitate Reipublicae Batavicae, in 1610. The historical account provided ideological leverage for the position that Holland had persisted in its republican form of government despite the princely claims of the Hapsburgs. The governing States of Holland commissioned Grotius to write a detailed history of the conflict with Spain, which he submitted in 1612. The States declined, likely due to the delicate truce, to publicize the work, leaving the Annales et Historiae de Rebus Belgicus to rest until his sons brought it out posthumously in 1657. Opportunity for higher office came again when, in 1612, the town council of Rotterdam offered Grotius the mayoral position of Pensionary. The title brought with it a seat in the States of Holland where he would collaborate more closely with his mentor, Oldenbarnevelt, and key players in provincial and national politics.

The political controversy that would end up defining Grotius’ tenure in office began with small rumblings when, in 1608, the professor of theology at the University of Leiden, Jacob Arminius, put forth a doctrine that challenged key features of the reigning Calvinist orthodoxy concerning predestination (see below: Irenicism and Tolerance). Calvinist church officials and divines came out strongly against the preaching of such a view. Though Arminius died the following year, the conflict escalated in a way that pitted the church establishment against the civil authorities over the question of who could rule on such doctrinal disputes. Grotius shared with many in the government of Holland some sympathies with the Arminian view but a desire above all to prevent such matters from disturbing the peace. He had been composing, during this time, a manuscript on the idea that all faiths shared a set of core doctrines, a viewpoint capable of promoting a certain equanimity towards squabbles over the finer points of theology. This was in any case the political attitude Grotius favored, and while he never published the Meletius manuscript, he developed several writings on the role of the state in managing conflicts over religion. The pamphlet, Ordinum Hollandiae et Westfrisiae pietas (1613), defended the ‘piety’ of the governments of Holland and Westfriesland in imposing a policy of toleration that allowed Arminians to preach their dissenting doctrine. Grotius himself had drafted the policy, which failed in its aim of mollifying the factions and, in fact, heightened the conflict between the civil and ecclesiastical authorities. Convinced that the practice of religion was a concern proper to civil magistrates, Grotius set about justifying his views in a longer treatise. De Imperio Summarum Potestatum circa Sacra argued that, to avoid a conflict of rights, there must be only one final authority within a state on how religion is to be practiced, that because of its mandate to keep civil peace and form responsible citizens this authority ought to come under the civil power, and that civil magistrates would do well to limit their judgments to the core doctrines Grotius had worked out in Meletius. He developed, though never published, the manuscript of De Imperio as the political conflict continued to escalate during 1614-17. His sympathies with the Arminian theology also grew during this period, and in 1617 he took it upon himself to brush back the charges of heresy with the publication of a theological work, Defensio Fidei Catholicae de Satisfactione Christi adversus Faustum Socinum.

As Grotius was being drawn further into the controversy, it came to consume national politics. The orthodox Calvinists, who were a majority at the national level and now had the backing of Prince Maurits, were demanding a national synod to settle the matter. This set up a standoff between Maurits, the national executive and commander of the armed forces, and Oldenbarnevelt, the most influential figure in the States assembly. Oldenbarnevelt led the elites of Holland, including Grotius, in blocking the synod and managing the dispute at the provincial level. That policy culminated in a decision, when riots broke out in 1617, to authorize local militias to suppress the disorder. Maurits denounced the act as an offense against his military authority, and he seized the opportunity to turn the tide against his political adversaries. At the end of an extended political and military campaign to push the Arminian supporters out of the establishment, he ordered the arrest of Oldenbarnevelt and his key supporters in August 1618. Grotius, with his mentor, was locked up and set for trial. A national synod, the famous Synod of Dort, was scheduled. Though incensed at the military coup d’etat against the sovereign institutions of Holland, Grotius calmly petitioned Maurits and the national States-General to no effect. The trials commenced the following year, and Grotius saw his mentor condemned to death for high treason. On May 18, 1619, his own sentence came down: confiscation of property and life imprisonment.

Although he would strive for the rest of his life to vindicate himself and lift the disgrace of the charges from himself and his family, Grotius entered at the age of thirty-six into his term of imprisonment in the castle Loevestein. The only solace of his confinement was that his family was allowed to reside with him and that on her regular leaves his wife Maria was able to bring back books and papers. The scholar was able to turn his isolation to some greater purpose. In Loevestein, Grotius renewed a number of neglected projects. He wrote, fully in didactic verse, a more systematic treatment of his view that there are essential elements common to all religions and that the doctrines of Christianity were recognizable through reason as the most consistent and highest expression of the common faith. The work, initially composed in Dutch, would serve as the basis for his renowned De Veritate Religionis Christiane (The Truth of the Christian Religion). Through his work in law and legal history, he had conceived the plan of writing a rigorous guidebook on jurisprudence of Holland in the vernacular of the Dutch language. The later publication, in 1631, of Inleidinge to the Hollandsche Rechts-geleerdheid (Introduction the Jurisprudence of Holland) would eventually give his book a status in Dutch law analogous to Blackstone’s Commentaries in the English system. Grotius was convinced that he could achieve the same kind of ordered treatment of the concepts, principles and precedents governing relations at the international level. Closed within the walls of his cell, he reached out for a global view of human affairs and prepared parts of what would become the massive treatise, De Jure Belli ac Pacis (The Rights of War and Peace). At the same time, Grotius was looking beyond the walls of Loevestein with a mind for a more immediate scheme: escape. He knew that he had support in the court of Louis XIII in France, and his hopes for reestablishing himself pointed towards Paris. Maria and the family’s young maid-servant, Elsje van Houwening, hatched the plan for escape. On March 22, 1621, Maria made arrangements for a chest of books to be shipped to the nearby town of Gorcum, then helped her husband into the cramped chest and watched Elsje accompany the guards as they unwittingly delivered their prisoner into the hands of friends. A month later, Grotius was in Paris, separated from his family, exiled from his beloved country, yet free.

The long period Grotius spent in exile saw the publication of his most remembered works. Having secured the support of Louis XIII and being reunited with his family, he prepared several manuscripts that he hoped would restore him to prominence. The Apologeticus, appearing in 1622, was straight to the purpose: it contained a full defense of his conduct as a public official of Holland. Despite his earnest pleas of loyalty and the best efforts of his friends, the States-General spurned his arguments and authorized a bounty on him. He turned his attention to the scholarly projects begun in Loevestein. The treatise on the universal law of nature and nations, divided into three hefty books, grew out of the reflections on the subject he had begun twenty years prior. Its first book developed an account of natural justice, so central to his earlier arguments about the Southeast Asian trade, and laid out a broad framework for judging “controversies of any and every kind, as are likely to arise” (JBP I.I.i)—those among politically sovereign entities, private parties, or rival camps within a state. The lengthy second book provided a grounding for the rights in one’s person, property, and sovereignty (subjects he was revisiting from Mare Liberum and his unpublished commentaries) and a detailed consideration of the ways such rights could be acquired, transferred, lost, and protected by recourse to war. The third book, dramatizing the gap between the prevailing customs of warfare and the demands placed on us by a more humane conscience, considers what responsibilities parties have to all those they impact in wartime and in upholding good faith in efforts to build the peace. Many of the arguments of the work were forged in Grotius’ career as an advocate and public official, though he insists in the Prolegomena to the treatise that his perspective in the work is that of a mathematician, abstracting away from particular facts and controversies of the day. When the first edition of De Jure Belli ac Pacis made its appearance in 1625, its readers would have no shortage of conflicts to which to apply its ideas about war and peace, from the campaigns of conquest and appropriation overseas to the long-raging religious conflicts on the continent that were escalating into what would be the Thirty Years War.

Grotius continued, while in France, to write and visit scholars. His Latin edition of The Truth of Christian Religion came out in 1627. It would become his most widely read and translated work. Despite the unreliability of his pension from King Louis, he turned down some tempting offers to serve as a diplomat for other nations and instead renewed his efforts to rehabilitate his standing in the Netherlands. Upon the death of Prince Maurits, Grotius returned to Holland in 1631 in hopes of finding favor with the new Prince of Orange, Frederick Henry, but an arrest warrant from the States-General forced him to flee and take up refuge in Hamburg. Grotius and his wife remained for more than two years in the city without any great prospects. He set himself to composing a third major tragedy, Sophompaneas (Joseph), which would appear in 1635. By that time, his work on the laws of war had brought opportunity to his doorstep. In 1634, he was called to meet with the Swedish High Chancellor, Oxenstierna, who informed him that the recently slain King Gustavus Adolphus had been a great admirer of De Jure Belli and expressed a desire to bring Grotius into the service of Sweden. A major power, Sweden had risen up as a champion of the Protestant cause in the bloody war that gripped Europe, and Grotius was asked to provide counsel to the young queen and serve as her ambassador to another key power, France. The position required that he renounce his Dutch citizenship in order to declare his loyalty to the Swedish crown. Though he never let go of the hope of returning to his home, he accepted. The de Groot family would once again take up residence in Paris.

As ambassador, Grotius was charged with negotiating the terms of French support for the Protestant alliance. The relations were especially fraught due to the delicate position that the French crown, under the guidance of Cardinal Richelieu, had carved out between its opposition to Hapsburg power and its defense of Catholicism. As France increasingly entered the battle fray, much of Grotius’ duty was directed to the war effort. His scholarly projects from the late 1630s-40s, however, took as their object a long-cherished goal: the reconciliation and peace of the Christian community. He began in 1638 on a scriptural commentary that would deflate Protestant rhetoric charging that the Pope was the Antichrist. That same year he slipped an anonymous treatise through an Amsterdam press defending the lay administration of the Eucharist. He then released two lengthy collections of annotations, one on the New Testament and one on the Old, which emphasized the ethical role of the scriptures over the more divisive questions of theology. Building on the idea of shared core doctrines he had explored in his earlier manuscripts, he frankly promoted his vision for a reconciled faith in an appeal printed in Paris in 1642, Via ad Pacem Ecclesiasticam (The Way to Church Peace). Grotius had great hopes that the time was ripe for this vision, but he was disappointed when his arguments were swallowed up in the same old sectarian vitriol.

Having passed the age of sixty, Grotius met with some relief his recall to Swedish court in 1645. The Queen offered to settle his family in Sweden, but he instead requested a passport so that he could rejoin Maria and pursue opportunities elsewhere. He embarked in August in the midst of a terrible storm that damaged the ship and washed it upon the German coast. The ordeal left him ill and weather-beaten. With the aid of servants, he made it to the town of Rostock where he found a hospice. His condition worsened, and death came on August 28, 1645. Arrangements were made to convey his remains to Delft, where the town of his birth bestowed him with the honor that he could not regain in life by interring his body in the Nieuwe Kerk alongside the most celebrated figures of the republic. Maria resettled in Holland, and their sons set about preparing, from Grotius’ papers, updated editions and previously unpublished manuscripts for the press. De Jure Belli ac Pacis, especially, would come to have enduring influence as the Enlightenment philosophers of the next generations embraced its framework of natural jurisprudence as a model for a modern science of law and morals. His work would become a point of departure for those natural lawyers focusing on the law among nations, from Pufendorf and Barbeyrac to Thomasius and Vattel. It would inspire radical ideas about natural rights and the social contract in the Anglo-American political discourses of Hobbes, Locke, Jefferson and Madison. For the Scottish Enlightenment, it would be required reading, informing the moral theories of Carmichael, Hutcheson, Hume and Smith. As natural jurisprudence gave way to positivism and idealism in 19^th-century European thought, the place of Grotius receded in moral and political theory, but his work would be recovered in the context of emerging ideas about the international legal order as the next century approached. His work is most widely known today among those working on international relations and law, though there has been rapidly expanding scholarship on his contributions to political thought, ethics, and the philosophy of religion.

2. Irenicism and Tolerance

In the politics of the Dutch Republic and with regard to the broader religious strife in Europe, Grotius fashioned himself as an irenicist, one who seeks to bring the different denominations of Christianity together. The inflammatory conflicts among the Christian churches, which remained a persistent cause of war and upheaval in the political life of European societies, was in Grotius’ view largely attributable to excesses of dogmatism (see Heering 2004). If dogmatic claims could be reduced to an agreeable set of core tenets, he reasoned, then the various sects would have grounds for cooperating towards a reunified Christian church while allowing more esoteric matters to be contested without posing a threat to peace. This hope for Christian peace and unity characterizes Grotius’ theologically-oriented works from his early Meletius (1611) to Via ad Pacem Ecclesiasticam (1642), among his latest writings at the height of the Thirty Years War.

a. Religion and Civil Authority

In the early decades of the 17^th century when Grotius’ was cutting his teeth in Dutch politics, the temperature was rising on a theological dispute concerning salvation and freedom of the will. The reformed churches, which had the backing of the civil authorities, were founded on orthodox Calvinist doctrine. The standard Calvinist view of salvation held that God’s choice of who would be saved preceded the act of creation; this grace was, consequently, not a status that could be earned through good works but rather was predestined. This view was consistent with the dominant Protestant interpretations of scripture and represented a social and ethical worldview that was compelling to the reformed faithful. Yet this view also carried the ethically troubling implication that individual choice makes no difference to how one stands with God and, as the Leiden professor of theology, Jacob Arminius, would argue, did not account for elements of scripture that seemed to acknowledge a role for human will. Arminius maintained that God’s saving grace was on offer to anyone while still accepting the basic Calvinist premise that, prior to any human act, God had already determined who He would actually elect to everlasting happiness. The paradox could be resolved by recognizing that God’s grace might be resisted. This elegant solution enabled Arminius to account for freedom of the human will while retaining the key Protestant tenet that grace alone, not works, qualifies the elect. The Arminian view of salvation, to draw on Richard Tuck’s illuminating analogy, understands God’s offer of grace to the elect to be much like a parent’s offer to buy something for a child: “the child can refuse the offer, but he cannot purchase the present himself” (Tuck 1993 p. 182). While representing a significant revision to orthodox Calvinism, this view remained consistent with the larger doctrine.

The political question, however, was whether adherents of the Arminian position should be allowed to teach it within the publically established churches. Grotius’ writings from this period confront both the theological and political aspects of the debate. On the question of theology his sympathies laid with Arminius, and his defenses of the view led up to the publication of the substantial De Satisfactione (published in 1617), which distinguished many of the Arminian tenets from the ‘Socianian’ heresies charged by the view’s opponents. Politically, the Arminian preachers were seeking a policy of toleration within the public churches. Grotius and others aligned with Oldenbarnevelt recognized the advantages of such a policy for preserving quiet in the republic. Characteristically, Grotius saw the policy as rooted in philosophical concerns. As early as the (unpublished) manuscript Meletius (1611), he was developing a philosophy of religion according to which all faiths shared core beliefs about the nature of divinity and its role in human life. While this view stressed commonality, it did not entail pluralism. A religious tradition may possess a stronger claim to truth than others in virtue of its consistency with the central doctrines and the credibility of its supporting testimony; for Grotius, Christianity held this title. (This defense of Christianity is most fully developed in Grotius’ most widely published and popular work, On the Truth of the Christian Religion.) Yet Christian tradition, too, had a further set of core doctrines which were necessary for proper worship and for the promotion of responsible citizenship. The church could accommodate friendly debate over finer matters of theology as long as it was firmly rooted in the necessary articles of faith. This philosophical framework, while not made fully public at the time, undergirded Grotius’ advocacy of the toleration policy, which the States of Holland would eventually adopt.

The policy, Grotius well understood, required not only justification but also legitimacy: in defining acceptable doctrines, the civil authority was asserting itself in sacred matters. Grotius addressed this issue in his 1613 pamphlet defending the toleration policy, Ordinum Hollandiae et Westfrisiae pietas, and went on to develop the argument for the central principles into a major essay on the authority of civil government over the public practice of religion. De Imperio Summarum Potestatum circa sacra (1614-17, unpublished) argued that the supreme civil power holds legitimate authority over all matters concerning the public interest, whether sacred or profane. In addition to finding support from scripture and tradition, Grotius grounds his case on the simple Aristotelian argument that, because the commands of multiple authorities would allow for conflicting obligations, there can be only one supreme authority in a jurisdiction (ch. 1). Holding this authority enables the supreme power, then, to preserve civil peace as well as to promote, through the effects of religion, the formation of obedient and upright citizens. The bulk of the work is thus occupied with defending the plausibility of this conclusion by clearing away misconceptions and by reconciling it both with the variety of forms of political and legal organization and with the special calling of the church. To accept the authority of the civil power in religious matters, Grotius argues, does not imply that magistrates are competent to determine the truth of all fine points of theology: a wise ruler will make use of counsel from the most reliable pastors. With even greater wisdom, a ruler would do well to abstain from pronouncing on all but the most essential articles of faith, those that are necessary for salvation (ch. 6, 9). As an instance of an inessential matter in which a “prudent silence” recommends itself, he offers those “questions about the order of predestination and the reconciliation of human free will with grace” (ibid). The policy of the States of Holland, in this framework, was a form of containment: the policy defined the boundaries of permissible doctrine at the point that would endanger the salvation of those who accept it, while allowing the disagreements inside these bounds to play themselves out. Such was Grotius’ recommendation, in both theory and practice. At bottom, however, the policy had its validity not in view of its laudable tolerance but on Erastian grounds. (The citations in the work acknowledge the influence of Thomas Erastus, who a generation earlier had argued for the supreme authority of the state in church governance.) The central position of De imperio was that any policy issued by the civil power would be valid so long as it did not contradict God’s will. That this Erastian position made room for toleration and contributed to civil peace only added to its appeal.

b. Relations with Non-Christians

The principle of toleration guided Grotius’ handling of the Arminian conflict and also served as an ideal in his view of dealings with non-Christians. Among the groups that had found haven in the Netherlands from the Inquisition were Portuguese Jews, and Grotius was asked during his time as a public official to reconsider what ought to be the policy the States towards the presence and worship practices of Jewish communities. His Remonstrantie on the question was of a piece with his developing philosophy of public religion: Jewish worship could be consistent with the state interest in religion, as Judaism accepted the fundamental doctrines regarding God’s existence and concern for human conduct. The policy recommendation was to afford civil liberties and freedom of worship to Jews, under certain restrictions that would serve to “safeguard” the salvation of Christians. This meant, for instance, that Jewish synagogues would not enjoy the same freedom to preach to Christian audiences that could be granted to Arminian and Calvinist disputants, but Grotius maintained that this encumbered status was preferable to the other options in the field. He opposed forcing Jews to practice Christianity on the grounds that such a policy was incoherent, since faith cannot be forced, as well as sinful, since it would induce people to false professions. An alternative was to forbid Jewish worship altogether, but this would promote godlessness, which would be intolerable. Finally, to those who were calling for expulsion, Grotius gave a sustained response partly grounded in principles of natural law: the social bond that nature establishes among humans should not be severed except as punishment for crime. Jewish practice did not transgress natural law, and its faith supported civic life. It was proper, therefore, that Christians and Jews share social arrangements on the basis of common principles of public order and justice.

The same balance between Christian privilege and the potential for peaceful cooperation underwrote Grotius’ approach towards the expanding relationships between Europeans and non-Christian societies around the world. The principles of natural justice in De Jure Belli ac pacis—which grounded claims to sovereignty, property, and the fulfillment of pacts—were valid and binding in any human encounter, requiring no special relation to God. The principles would oblige us, in Grotius’ famous phrase, “even if we should concede (etiamsi daremus) that which cannot be conceded without the utmost wickedness, that there is no God, or that the affairs of men are of no concern to Him” (JBP Prol. 11). Mutual recognition of natural law provided the basis for any two parties to arrive at just and peaceful terms of association, most notably those concerning trade and alliances. This did not imply that all practices regarding religion were consistent with natural law. Because a sense of justice is not sufficient to motivate humans routinely to do right, the broader human society, even more than civil societies, depends upon religion to maintain order and instill reverence for its norms (see JBP Prol. 20 and II.XX.XLIV.6). To reject God involves not only the “utmost wickedness” but a criminal disregard for human society. Indeed, the two tenets that Grotius identifies—that there is a God and that human affairs are of concern to Him—constitute what he takes to be the core of religious belief, found in all societies. Those who oppose these core beliefs may be punished, by war if necessary, but differences among the religious are not, in themselves, grounds for war (JBP II.XX.XLVI-XLVIII). Pagans, polytheists, Jews and Muslims might fail to accept the “truths” of Christianity, but their participation in the common faith supports the basic ethical structure of society. Christianity, even under non-Christian sovereigns, yet has this privilege: that in virtue of its claim to truth, its adherents must not be punished for teaching the Gospel (JBP II.XX.XLIX). The right to suppress religious doctrine, which De imperio claimed for the civil power, extends only to teachings not essential to Christian salvation.

c. Christian Unity and Peace

The privileged status of Christianity among the world’s religions is the subject of The Truth of the Christian Religion. As in De Jure Belli, composed around the same time, Grotius argues that a basic understanding of divinity and its role in the world is accessible through the use of the natural capacity of reason alone. Such truths include not only the existence and providence of God, but also God’s oneness, perfection, causal responsibility for all that happens, and judgment in the afterlife. The proofs Grotius offers are not original but are borrowed from sources both ancient and recent, owning that people of varying sophistication have long been able to reason back to a necessary and singular ‘first cause’ and to grasp that the perfect nature of such a cause would not neglect the good of all creation (ch. 1). While some of these points require more subtle thought than others, all people can in principle arrive at the conclusions through rational reflection. Christ, however, is known through history. To learn of redemption and of what is required for salvation, one needs access to particular facts about Christ’s coming and His call to the faithful. The relevant facts, still, are supported by reasonable inferences based on reliable testimony (the evangelists), the consensus of historians, and the evidence of miracles performed. This project of deriving religious knowledge through rational investigation is what later philosophers would call “natural religion.” Significantly, Grotius argues that these facts gain further confirmation when one recognizes that the doctrines of Christianity have the greatest intrinsic appeal. The Gospel has this appeal in virtue of the reward it promises (the eternal beatitude of the soul), the quality of its ethical teachings (obeying out of love rather than fear, showing love to neighbors and enemies, and so forth), and the impeccable character of its teacher, Christ (ch. 2). Experience and rational consideration, while sufficient to establish the truth of Christianity, may not convince as readily as inferences from mere reason. Indeed, immediate acceptance is not possible without God’s help. On these grounds, Grotius would argue in De Jure Belli that one may neither punish those who fail to embrace Christianity nor impose belief by force (II.XX.XLVIII). Christians would do better to impress non-believers with their ethical example and offer persuasive arguments for conversion.

To this end, De Veritate provides a detailed debunking of other faiths. While its arguments reveal that Grotius undertook a serious study of non-Christian religions—with the aid of friends such as the Hebrew and Arabic scholar, Thomas Erpenius—some of his characterizations are far from generous, repeating old slurs about Jewish animosity towards Christians and the violent character of Islam. The arguments of the book were, after all, calculated to more than one purpose. Grotius intended the book to be of special use to seamen, whom while off to many corners of the earth to establish Dutch trading interests, would encounter a dazzling diversity of religious belief that might not only elude their attempts at persuasion but also challenge their own faith. It was the Christian reader, most of all, who may need to be assured of the Gospel’s special claim to truth.

The further effect Grotius hoped De Veritate would have on its Christian readers was to impress upon them that, in the range of religious diversity, the similarities among Christians are much more significant than the differences. The irenicist program that Grotius pursued in his later years had two main prongs. The first provided a map for Christian reunification based upon minimal agreement regarding core doctrines, beyond which some difference of belief and practice could be accommodated. The second urged Christians to recognize that the most important lessons to be taken from scripture are its ethical teachings, not its dogmas. This was the simple, practical faith that he saw reflected in the earliest Christian community and in the Christian humanists, like Erasmus, whom he so much admired. It was also a faith of which civil authorities, responsible for civic peace and virtue, could be worthy custodians.

3. Sovereignty and Imperialism

Connecting the political and international thought of Grotius is his conception of sovereignty, the supreme right of governing (summum imperium). The mark of the sovereign power is that it “cannot be made void by any other human will” (JBP, I.III.viii). Within a state, it is the highest authority; internationally it encounters other sovereign powers, among whom none holds a superior right.

a. Divisible Sovereignty

The guiding idea in Grotius’ treatment of sovereignty, as with his treatment of rights generally, is that systems of rights are radically alterable through the ways people choose to dispose of those rights. As a result, societies will vary widely in how they organize the powers of sovereignty. Philosophers might argue for the advantages of one scheme or another, “but as there are several ways of living, some better than others, and every one may choose which he pleases of all those sorts; so a people may choose what form of government they please: neither is the right which the sovereign has over his subjects to be measured by this or that form, of which divers men have divers opinions, but by the extent of the will of those who conferred it upon him” (JBP I.III.viii). What justifies a scheme of rights is that it has arisen from the historical choices of their legitimate holders, not any features of its form. This principle gave Grotius a great deal of flexibility in defending different political arrangements, provided the facts of history for the given society would play along.

On one side, Grotius was able to argue against royalists who sought to define sovereignty as an indivisible package of prerogatives that could be vested in only a singular will. Grotius takes this claim, which Jean Bodin had advanced a generation earlier, at face value but treats indivisibility as a purely conceptual point: to institute civil power in a society consists in gathering up a certain package of governmental rights and in designating who will hold that power supremely. The rights of governing come as a package, but a society may, if it chooses, designate different holders for the various rights.

Grotius developed this position early in his career in an unpublished manuscript that he called Commentary in Eleven Theses. The practical divisibility of sovereignty is an indispensable premise for the political argument of the work, which defends the ongoing Dutch war against the rule of the king of Spain. Unlike earlier apologists, Grotius does not conceive of the war as a revolt based on right of a people to resist a tyrannical ruler but rather as a war between sovereign powers (see Borschberg 1994 pp. 169ff. and Keene 2002 pp. 45ff.). If one studies the history of rights in the Dutch case, Grotius argues, one finds that the Dutch people did not transfer all governing rights to a prince bur reserved some, in particular the right to levy taxes, to the States of Holland. While holding supreme power on many matters, the Spanish king had sought to usurp a further supreme power from the States, an act which provided them a just cause to wage war in defense of its right. Put in the language of sovereignty, the king possessed no right to render void the will of the States when it came to taxation, just as this particular right of the States could not render void the king’s rights in other matters: each was supreme within the scope of its own authority (cf. JBP I.IV.xiii). Grotius retained and systematized this conception of divisible sovereignty in De Jure Belli, where he also considered the criticism that such arrangements based on divided powers were recipes for civil strife. His answer insists on the principle with which he began: while one can point to inconveniences in any arrangements, the only relevant question in matters of right is whether those arrangements were the ones chosen (I.III.xvii).

On the other side of the political spectrum, Grotius argued against theories of popular sovereignty. The position of constitutionalist thinkers, such as those among the reforming Huguenots who would come to be called ‘monarchomachs,’ was that the right of kings to rule derives from the rights of the people; since some of these rights are inalienable, the representatives of the people retain a right to resist a regime that tyrannically usurps these rights. Grotius’ response was to grant that rights originate from the people but to argue that the people can choose to alienate whatever rights they wish, even up to the extreme of enslaving themselves to another (JBP, I.III.viii). Utter subjection to an absolute monarch is, therefore, entirely possible and consistent with the history of political arrangements in many societies. Grotius’ flexible approach enabled him to defend the republican principles alive in the Dutch provinces from one side of his mouth while shoring up the absolutist claims of his later patrons from the other. In his defense of the latter claims, we find Grotius even paying homage to the time-worn doctrine of Aristotle that some people are naturally suited to be slaves. Importantly, Grotius does not admit the doctrine as grounds for imposing slavery but rather repurposes it: the doctrine can explain why a people might choose of their own accord to hand over their full rights to the more prudent government of another. Ineptitude at self-rule, it turns out, is just one of many considerations that might factor into the selection of a form of government.

b. Resistance, War and Empire

Grotius’ understanding of sovereignty carries several implications for his theory of just war. The first concerns his position on the “right of resistance,” the hotly contested question of whether a subject people may ever justly depose a ruler for misgovernment. While Grotius rejects constitutionalist arguments that reserve inalienable rights to the people, he finds a way to preserve this rationale for resistance in a more limited form. It is unlikely that most civil societies would have been founded on utter subjection. In the absence of clear evidence that subjects have completely alienated their rights, one has to presume that rational people would have preserved their most basic rights against arbitrary treatment. This presumption attaches only in cases of “extreme necessity,” as when a government turns its sword on innocent subjects, and then only when resistance could be carried out without creating an even bloodier civil conflict (I.VI.vii). When Grotius invokes this argument from extreme necessity, he relies on what Richard Tuck has called a kind of interpretive charity (1979 pp. 79-80): since civil authority is a human institution, the bounds of which are derived from the wills of those who established it, one must credit the founders with intentions that would rationally advance, not undermine, the aims of civil association. (Compare the parallel reasoning in limiting the rights of property, II.II.vi.) Second, Grotius assigns a role in this context to third-party humanitarian intervention. Even if it should turn out that subjects must bear the most arbitrary assaults from their proper sovereign, a third-party would remain free from the special obligations that constrain subjects from resisting and could intervene on their behalf. Such interventions should only be attempted when it is evident that a government is committing gross injustices against its people—“such Tyrannies over subjects, as no good Man living can approve” (JBP II.XXV.viii). The third implication concerns Grotius’ complicated relation to imperialism. In defending the legitimacy of diverse forms of political authority, he is rejecting the principle behind those forms of imperialism that seek to impose a more enlightened form of rule for the good of the governed. Elsewhere in De Jure Belli he explicitly refutes the argument that slavery can be imposed on those who might be naturally suited to it (II.XXII.xii) and castigates those who claim rights of ‘discovery’ over lands already occupied by supposedly less enlightened folk (II.XXII.ix). On these points, he is in agreement with earlier critics of the Spanish conquests such as Francisco de Vitoria and Bartolome de las Casas.

The strategies of commercial imperialism, which characterized Dutch practice, found much more support in Grotius’ theory of just war (see generally, Tuck 1999 ch. 3, van Ittersum 2006, Wilson 2008, Thomson 2009). The whole concern of De Jure Belli is how to justly settle controversies in the dealings of those who do not live under a shared system of civil laws. In the context of global trade, such dealings will involve the claims of private parties as well as the contentions of kings and states. It ultimately falls to each party, when operating outside the jurisdiction of a common court, to judge the controversy based on the applicable standards of natural, customary, state and divine law. Significantly, Grotius maintains that such relations can be peaceful so long as those involved have a clear understanding of the law and hold themselves to norms of justice, equity, temperance, and humanity. Yet, just as magistrates duly back their rulings with force, those involved in a dispute have the right to redress injuries by means of war. Used rightly, De Jure Belli would provide all parties with a clear understanding of how the law applied to various disputes and educate them in how to render fair and responsible verdicts. However, used rightly, it would also give trading powers the flexibility to leverage their arrangements with non-Europeans and the justifications to uphold these arrangements with force. One stratagem it enabled was encroachment on local sovereignty (see Keene 2002 pp. 48ff and 79ff). Grotius’ position was firmly that non-Christian rulers could hold full title to sovereignty, but his view of sovereignty was that its marks could be divided up among various holders. A foreign trading power might enter into an alliance with a ruler that required him, for instance, to provide land for a trading ‘factory’ or deliver up his people’s labor. These arrangements do not, in themselves, transfer any mark of sovereignty, but Grotius argues that, if the foreign power (unjustly) usurps this right over time without being challenged, its “long possession” provides it with a claim to sovereignty that is now just (JBP I.III.XXI.10-11). Because marks of sovereignty can be divided off in this way, the foreign power can take over limited rights of its own without being guilty of usurping the broader authority of the king. Once the limited right was established, however, it could also be protected with force should the king try to reconsolidate his power (by the same right that the Dutch defended their limited sovereignty against the ambitions of their Spanish overlord). Had the rulers of Southeast Asia read Grotius’ work, they might have found a useful warning about the risks of getting entangled with a powerful ally; the readers among the European mercantile class would also see its usefulness.

The natural-right framework of De Jure Belli also empowers parties to a contract to arrive at their own judgments about how to interpret indeterminate clauses (JBP II.XVI) and authorizes any party, public or private, to execute punishment for culpable violations of the law (II.XX). The idea that war-making can be understood as an extension of the right to punish had been part of the Christian just-war tradition from Augustine through Vitoria and Suarez, but Grotius reconceives punishment as a natural right that obtains prior to civil authority (see Tuck 1999 pp. 102f. and Straumann 2006). In circumstances beyond civil jurisdiction, law-respecting persons can take it upon themselves to police and punish crimes affecting society. Because this exercise of power over another assumes a position of superiority, Grotius recognizes the need to explain how this difference in standing can arise among those who are equal by nature. His solution is to point out that violators demote themselves beneath the rest of humanity (JBP II.XX.iii). Anyone who remains in this position of moral superiority can properly execute punishment. The natural right to punish was an important innovation in Grotius’ early De Indis, where he argued that Dutch merchants had legitimate authority to punish the Portuguese for monopolizing the seas (fol. 40). It remains a key feature of his theory of punishment in De Jure Belli, where it provides a further source for just causes to resort to war. In contrast to the anti-imperialist arguments of Vitoria and the school of Salamanca, which had maintained that the princes of Europe had no authority to punish those beyond their jurisdiction except in response to ‘an injury received’ (On the Law of War q.1 a.3; see also On the American Indians q. 2 a.5), Grotius opens the door to punitive war against those who commit ‘crimes against nature.’ Elevated as moral superiors above regimes that enjoin or condone manifestly unjust practices—including cannibalism, piracy, the oppression of their own people or the cruel treatment of foreigners—outside powers may seek to punish these regimes in the interests of human society (II.XX.XL). Adopted while Grotius still had ties to the interests of the Dutch trading companies, this interventionist stance would have expanded the range of justifications available for colonizing lands in both Asia and the Americas (see Tuck 1999 pp. 103-4 and van Ittersum 2010).

At the same time, Grotius shows an awareness, and some discomfort, that his position could be used as a pretext for expansionist wars. He cautions that only violations of universal norms, not of the evolving customs of Europe, count as punishable offenses. Quoting Plutarch, he explicitly warns of the lurking temptations of imperialism: “To wish to impose civilization upon uncivilized peoples is a pretext which may serve to conceal greed for what is another’s” (II.XX.XLI). The structure of Grotius’ position, characteristic of the framework of De Jure Belli, both insists on strict adherence to norms of justice, equity and humanity while still affording the powerful the flexibility to interpret, judge and enforce those norms by their own lights.

4. Natural Right and the Law of Nations

The broadest principles of just war in De Jure Belli ac pacis derive from two sources: the norms of natural justice and the customary law of nations (ius gentium). (Other human and divine laws, importantly, also lay down binding principles for those who have received them, but these sources do not have the universal character of the laws of nature and nations.) On any given question regarding the resort to war or its conduct, both systems of law must be consulted, as each system is capable of influencing the rights and obligations of the other.

a. Obligations from Nature and Custom

The account of natural law in De Jure Belli, heavily influenced by the Stoic notions of Cicero, begins from two universal human concerns: self-preservation and social connection (see JBP I.II.I and Prol. 6-8). The rights of obligations of natural law are all justified in terms of the rational balancing of these two primary concerns. This approach is an outgrowth of Grotius’ earliest work on the laws of war, De Indis, where he argued that the imperative of self-preservation justified two permissions of natural law: to defend one’s life and to acquire possessions (fol. 5’-6). The need for human fellowship justifies two basic obligations towards others: to refrain from inflicting injury and from seizing their possessions (fol. 6’-7’). One apparent change that Grotius makes to his earlier theory regards the basis for these obligations. In De Indis, he aligns himself with a voluntarist account of obligation, found in medieval thinkers such as Ockham, which maintains that natural law is binding upon humans in virtue of the divine will that commands it (fol 5’). The design of nature is one way in which we receive God’s commands. By the time of De Jure Belli, Grotius seems to accept the alternative, intellectualist position that natural law binds us by teaching what both humans and God can recognize as necessary for human life: it shows us not what is obligatory because commanded but what is obligatory or permissible “in itself” (JBP I.I.x). In fact, there is much ambiguity in the later work as to which position Grotius accepts, showing itself even in his very definition of natural law as “a dictate of right reason, which points out that an act has in it a quality of moral baseness of moral necessity; and that, in consequence, such an act is either forbidden or enjoined by the author of nature, God” (JBP I.I.x). This definition is perhaps closest to the ‘mediating’ position more recently advanced by Suárez, maintaining that intellect could recognize what is, in itself, good or bad for humans but that only God’s command makes it obligatory to live accordingly (De Legibus II.VI; see Schneewind 1998 pp. 61 and 74).

What is clear is that Grotius draws a basic distinction in law, following Aristotle, between obligations derived from nature and those derived from an authoritative will (JBP I.I.ix and xiii-xvi). Sources of this second, ‘volitional’ type of law can be divine (as revealed in scripture) or human, and the latter includes not only the laws of particular states but also those laws that nations accept in their relations with each other. Kings and peoples give their assent to the law of nations through custom, not typically by positive agreement. Long observance of a norm in the relations between states gives it the force of law. In contrast to natural law, which confers its basic rights and obligations to all persons whether in a private or public capacity, the law of nations applies to relations between sovereign entities (cf. JBP Prol. 40; De Indis fol. 12ff). It deals, accordingly, largely with matters of state, such as embassies, treaties, and the special privileges of sovereigns in waging war. This system of customary law, in turns out, makes the legal position of sovereigns radically different from that of private actors in the ‘universal society’ established by natural law.

b. Just War: Jus ad Bellum

The mutual influence of the laws of nature and nations can be seen in both the resort to war (traditionally called the jus ad bellum) and in its conduct (jus in bello). The only just grounds for resorting to war are those that involve the pursuit of a right. Among such pursuits, Grotius identifies three kinds: self-defense, the recovery of property and punishment. Each of these has its basis in natural law, though the particular rights at issue might arise from other sources, such as the law of nations. The right of self-defense arises from the natural permission every person has to protect against injury (II.I.iii). If our primary concern is self-preservation, we could not take the risk of living among other people without reserving the permission to protect ourselves from them. The right of defense extends not only to one’s life, but also to one’s body and property. Grotius argues that killing in defense of one’s body is justifiable even if the assailant’s objective is not to kill but to maim or rape (II.I.vi-vii). The reason is that one can never trust that a physical assault will not result in death (though it is unclear in Grotius’ treatment of rape whether it is the victim’s life or interests of men in her ‘chastity’ that is the justifying concern). There are two constraints on justified self-defense: that the attack is imminent and certain (II.I.v). Defense is a just cause that applies only to immediate danger. Even property, however, may be defended with lethal force, with the further constraint that such force is necessary for retaining it (II.I.xvi).

Apart from defense, war may be waged in order to recover one’s rights or to punish the offender. Acting under these just causes will often entail being the one to initiate violence. Grotius argues that this breach of peace is not anti-social (and hence in violation of natural justice) because the initiator is only demanding what the other party already owes (I.II.i.5-6) – they are not violating but upholding the system of rights. Recovery of property applies not only to moveable things and territory, but also to rights over persons (such as rightful subjects or slaves), rights to actions (such as the fulfillment of contracts), and compensation for damages. All of these might be claimed by natural right, though the particular claims might be shaped by prevailing domestic systems of property or by the law of nations. This single heading yields an expansive range of cases in which war is a just option for enforcing rights. Punishment multiplies such cases. When someone willfully violates a right, they become obligated not only to make restitution but to endure punishment equivalent to their crime. Any law-respecting person (as explained above) may execute this punishment, in principle, though a number of factors will tend to limit international punishment. Due to the high risk of harming the innocent in pursuit of the guilty, punitive wars are permissible only for serious crimes (II.XX.xxxviii). In most circumstances, only sovereign governments will be permitted to execute the punishment since individual citizens would have transferred this natural right to their state (see II.XX.xxiv and II.XX.xl; cf. De Indis, fol. 40-40’). Public authorities, therefore, can lay claim to special punitive causes such as the punishment of crimes against natural society (see above) and anticipatory defense. Whereas only an actual attack can justify self-defense, a plot to attack, once set in motion, is already a crime (II.I.xvi). Under the cause of punishment, a state may resort to preemptive warfare which defense alone could not justify. Finally, every exercise of punishment must be limited to the achievement of certain goods. While the right to punish has a retributive justification rooted in the offender’s obligation to endure it, the exercise of this right ought to be governed by consequentialist considerations. The good of the offender, of the victim and of the broader society, are all relevant benefits that need to be weighed against the harms to each of these (II.XX.iv-ix). Especially when the consequences of punishment include a broader war, these considerations may urge clemency, restraint or even pardon (II.XX.xxii-iv and xxxiv-xxxvi; see II.XXIV.ii-iii).

There is a general pattern of argument—that people are permitted, in the strictness of justice, to use violence in a great many cases that will nonetheless call for moderation in the name of humanity and peace—that characterizes the whole of De Jure Belli ac Pacis. Justice is a crucial virtue, as the maintenance of society and respect of law require it, but its guidance is limited to these minimal aims. To know what the laws ought to be and to decide when and how far to exercise one’s rights, it becomes necessary to follow the promptings of equity, humanity and prudence. These “virtues which have as their object the good of others” (I.I.viii) not only serve to measure the proper severity of punishments but also to determine whether war for a punitive cause is warranted at all. Humaneness imposes a moral limit, too, in how far one ought to press rights to property, so as not to use market power to squeeze people (II.XII.xvi) or to withhold vital information when making contracts (II.XII.ix). Even in self-defense, the resort to war can have humanitarian consequences that speak strongly against making full use of one’s right (II.I.iv, viii, ix and xi). It would be a grave error, Grotius warns, to think that “where a right has been adequately established, either war should be waged forthwith, or even that war is permissible in all cases” (II.XXIV.i). The resort to war must be squared not only with justice but with humanitarian concerns, especially for its impact on the lives of innocent people. This loving regard for others that aspires to universality is what Grotius held up, in his works on religion, as the great ethical appeal of the Gospel, and De Jure Belli instructs its readers to recognize that not only humanity but also God calls them to love, forbearance and restraint.

c. Just War: Jus in Bello

The meshing of these normative standards of justice and humanity is especially pronounced in Grotius’ treatment of the conduct of war in Book III of De Jure Belli. The natural law provides but one basic rule for the conduct of war: “things which lead to an end receive their intrinsic value from the end itself” (JBP III.I.ii). That is, if one has a right to resort to war, then one has a right to conduct the war by whatever means are necessary to vindicate the just case. Grotius finds natural justice an unsatisfactory basis for the ethics of combat for two main reasons: (i) it permits inhumane and intemperate actions on the part of those who fight under a just cause, and (ii) it provides no guidance whatsoever for those who fight under an unjust cause. The answer to the first deficiency is Grotius’ account of temperamenta, discussed below. The second deficiency finds its solution in the law of nations. Grotius recognizes that while no war can be naturally just on both sides—a right on one side precludes a right on the other—wars may be either unjust on both sides or justifiably believed to be just on both sides. In either case, there are belligerents for whom natural justice provides no guidance other than, ‘your cause is unjust: stop fighting.’ Grotius resigns himself to the realism that, aside from exceptional cases, most states will not admit to the injustice of their cause and simply stop fighting. The longer such states fight, the more injustices they pile up by resisting the just party. Before long there would be no limit to the punitive war that could be prosecuted against the unjust state (see III.IV.iv). Grotius suggests that nations, recognizing the perils of this situation, established a custom of holding both parties in a war to have equal standing on the battlefield. That is, the law of nations permits to both sides (regardless of the justice of their cause) all the actions that the natural law would permit to the just.

The customs of warfare under the law of nations turn out to be extremely permissive. Tracking the prevailing practice of states, the customs permit everything from the slaughter of innocents to the taking of slaves and the looting of civilian property. License to conduct warfare in this way is the special privilege of sovereigns who have ‘solemnized’ their war under the law of nations. Indifferent to the substantive justice of a state’s cause, the law of nations insists instead on certain formalities—a public declaration by the sovereign authority—to give the belligerent its legal status in a solemn war (I.III.iv and III.III). While Grotius defends this status as a way of restoring normal relations between sovereigns at the end of war, he insists that even kings remain accountable to natural justice. The law of nations is derived from human will, and the license it gives in solemn wars cannot contradict the requirements of natural law. The license amounts to an agreement among nations not to punish each other for certain acts (III.IV.ii-iii). So, after many lengthy chapters detailing the range of actions permitted by the law of nations, Grotius takes an abrupt turn, telling the reader that he must now retrace his steps and “deprive those who wage war of nearly all the privileges which I seemed to grant, yet did not grant to them” (III.X.i). Those waging a solemn war may have the privilege of impunity under human law, but a ‘sense of shame’ ought to instill a respect not only for the ‘external’ judgments of the courts but for the ‘internal’ judgments of conscience (III.X and III.XI.i-ii). Those waging an unjust war will be accountable to God, and they have an (unenforceable) obligation to make restitution to those they have wronged. Even those waging war for a just cause should observe the limits of natural justice by sparing the innocent and pursuing only those war aims that are necessary to securing one’s rights. Conducting war merely within the bounds of the law of nations may obtain impunity, but it brings no badge of honor.

What makes kings and peoples worthy of honor is their observance of temperamenta: moderation and restraint in pursuing their just claims. Such restraint comes out of a respect for justice—by restricting the means of war to only what is necessary to achieving the ends—and also out of a sense of humanity. This humane concern for others seeks to limit the impact of war on the innocent and even those fighting on the opposing side (see, for example, III.XI.viii, XII.viii, and XIII.iv). It requires in many cases the remission of punishment, to forgiveness of burdensome war debts, and a preference for restoring local sovereignty rather than imposing imperial rule. At all events, one must uphold good faith in agreements made with the other side in order to build the basis for normal relations after the war (III.XXI-XXV). Humanity holds in view not only the aim of restoring rights but of restoring peace (see III.XXV.ii-iii). Justice might condone war against injuries that threaten the basis for living together in society, but a sense of humanity is fostered by the recognition that we must live together again.

5. Scholarly Interest in Grotius

In the century following his death, Grotius’ works came to be viewed as pivotal in the development of early modern moral and political philosophy. Jean Barbeyrac, in his 1749 essay on the emerging Science of Morality, described Grotius as “breaking the ice” of medieval dogma to make way for a rational approach to ethics. The natural law philosophy of the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries—from Pufendorf to Locke, Vattel and Thomasius—took the framework of De Jure Belli ac pacis as a point of departure. This canonical status made Grotius required reading for Enlightenment intellectuals, such that Rousseau would come to describe him in Emile, however critically, as “the master of all the savants” and Adam Smith would credit him in his lectures on jurisprudence as giving the world the most systematic treatment of the subject to date. The 21^st century has seen a renewed debate among scholars over the extent of Grotius ‘originality’ in moral thought and in what it consists: the purported secularism of his approach, its rationalism, its refutation of skepticism, its account of obligation, or a variety of other candidates. Beyond these disputes, recent historians of moral and political philosophy have taken special interest in Grotius’ conception of natural rights, his theory of punishment, and his accounts of property and state sovereignty.

Grotius’ legacy, however, is most strongly connected to his contributions to international legal theory and the laws of war. Interest in Grotius saw a revival in the late nineteenth century amid efforts to articulate and institutionalize norms of international law. The peace societies of the time, closely bound up with the international women’s suffrage movement, traced back to the Grotius the evolving conscience of the ‘civilized’ world towards justice and mercy in international conflicts. Andrew Dickson White, the U.S. delegate to the 1899 Hague Peace Conference, regarded Grotius—whom he classed among the world’s Seven Great Statesmen in the Warfare of Humanity with Unreason—as providing the “real foundation of the modern science of international law.” While the claim to being ‘father’ of this law was as disputed as it was common, and despite many critical views of this work—in his 1925 history of political philosophy, Charles Vaughan had called De Jure Belli a “nest of sophistries and contradictions”—Grotius came to have a canonical status in international legal thought. By the end of the Second World War, the legal scholar Hersch Lauterpacht was able to discern a ‘Grotian tradition in international law’ rooted in commitments to the rule of law, to norms beyond positive law, and to the human capacity for moral progress in the law. Grotius continues to be most widely known within the study of just war theory and international law, most notably for the contribution of Mare Liberum to the modern law of the sea.

The preeminence of Grotius in the field of international law exerted its influence as well on the development of international relations theory. Theorists of international relations have commonly viewed Grotius as providing a distinctive conception of international society that provides a middle way between Hobbesian anarchy and Kantian cosmopolitanism. In this schema of ‘realist,’ ‘rationalist,’ and ‘revolutionist’ theories, proposed by Martin Wight and pursued in the work of Hedley Bull and others of the ‘English School’ of international relations theory, the Grotian tradition provides a rationalist account of international society. While rejecting the idea that there are common interests among states sufficient to underpin a supranational authority, the Grotian system identifies a ‘solidarity’ of interests around basic principles of order (such as mutual independence, adherence to promises, the limitation of war) that enables sovereign states to constitute their relations as a (limited) community rather than as a contest governed by the dynamics of power alone. The association of Grotius with this strain of thought has given his work enduring interest in contemporary international theory.

While reaching the greatest prominence in international thought, the early 21^st century scholarship on Grotius has a markedly interdisciplinary character. His works have received considerable attention from political theorists and historians of political thought, as well as by those studying his contributions to moral philosophy, theology and literature. Indeed, the eclecticism of Grotius’ thought pushes beyond modern disciplinary boundaries and springs up continuing dialogues across fields and borders.

6. References and Further Reading

Included in the Primary Sources are selected works of Grotius with a preference for most recently in-print English editions. (Note: references to De Jure Belli in the article provide the book, chapter and section numbers, e.g., II.XXIV.i.). The selected secondary sources include references from the article as well as suggested directions for further reading. The interested scholar will also want to consult the regularly published journal of Grotius studies, Grotiana.

a. Primary Sources

Grotius, H. (2006). De Jure Praedae Commentarius / Commentary on the law of prize and booty. Indianapolis, Liberty Fund.
Grotius, H. (1994). “Commentarius in Theses XI”: an Early Treatise on Sovereignty, the Just war, and the Legitimacy of the Dutch Revolt, P. Lang.
Grotius, H. (2004). The Free Sea. Indianapolis, IN, Liberty Fund.
Grotius, H. (1988). Meletius. Leiden, Netherlands, Brill.
Grotius, H. (1990). Defensio Fidei Catholicae de Satisfactione Christi, adversus Faustum Socinum Senensem. Assen/Maastricht, the Netherlands, Van Gorcum.
Grotius, H. (2001). De Imperio Summarum Potestatum circa Sacra. Studies in the history of Christian thought, v. 102. H.-J. v. Dam. Leiden, Brill.
Grotius, H. (1926). The Jurisprudence of Holland. R. W. Lee. Oxford, Clarendon Press.
Grotius, H. (2005). The rights of war and peace. Indianapolis, Liberty Fund.
Grotius, H. (1962). De Jure Belli ac pacis libri tres / The Law of War and Peace. Indianapolis, Bobbs-Merrill.
Grotius, H. (2012). The Truth of the Christian Religion. Indianapolis, Liberty Fund.

b. Secondary Sources

Borschberg, P. (1994). “Critical Introduction.” “Commentarius in Theses XI”: an Early Treatise on Sovereignty, the Just War, and the Legitimacy of the Dutch Revolt. H. Grotius, P. Lang.
Brett, A. (2002). “Natural Right and Civil Community: The Civil Philosophy of Hugo Grotius.” The Historical Journal 45(01): 31-51.
Bull, H., B. Kingsbury, et al. (1990). Hugo Grotius and International Relations. New York, Clarendon Press.
Dumbauld, E. (1969). The Life and Legal Writings of Hugo Grotius. Norman, University of Oklahoma Press.
Forde, S. (1998). “Hugo Grotius on Ethics and War.” American Political Science Review 92(3): 639-648.
Haakonssen, K. (1985). “Hugo Grotius and the History of Political Thought.” Political Theory 13(2): 239-265.
Heering, J. (2004). “Hugo Grotius’ De Veritate Religionis Christianae.” Hugo Grotius as Apologist for the Christian Religion: a Study of his Work De veritate Religionis Christianae, 1640. J. Heering. Leiden, Brill: 41-52.
Keene, E. (2002). Beyond the Anarchical Society: Grotius, Colonialism and Order in World Politics, Cambridge University Press.
Kinsella, H. M. (2006). “Gendering Grotius: Sex and Sex Difference in the Laws of War.” Political Theory 34(2): 161.
Meijer, J. (1955). “Hugo Grotius’ “Remonstrantie”.” Jewish Social Studies 17(2): 91-104.
Nellen, H. a. R. E., Ed. (1994). Hugo Grotius Theologian: Essays in Honor of G.H.M. Posthumus Meyjes. New York, Brill.
Onuma, Y., Ed. (1993). A Normative Approach to War: Peace, War, and Justice in Hugo Grotius. Oxford, Clarendon Press.
Schneewind, J. B. (1998). The Invention of Autonomy: A History of Modern Moral Philosophy. New York, Cambridge University Press, ch. 4.
Straumann, B. (2006). “The Right to Punish as a Just Cause of War in Hugo Grotius’ Natural Law.” Studies in the History of Ethics.
Suárez, F. (1944). De Legibus. Selections from Three Works. New York: Clarendon Press.
Thomson, E. (2009). “The Dutch Miracle, Modified. Hugo Grotius’s Mare Liberum, Commercial Governance and Imperial War in the Early-Seventeenth Century.” Grotiana 30(1): 107-130.
Tuck, R. (1993). Philosophy and Government, 1572-1651. New York, Cambridge University Press, ch. 5.
Tuck, R. (1999). The Rights of War and Peace : Political Thought and the International Order from Grotius to Kant. New York, Oxford University Press, ch. 3.
van Gelderen, M. (1993). “Vitoria, Grotius and Human Rights: The Early Experience of Colonialism in Spanish and Dutch Political Thought.” Human Rights and Cultural Diversity. W. Schmale. Goldbach, Germany, Keip Publishing: 215-238.
van Gelderen, M. (2006). ‘So Meerly Humane’: Theories of Resistance in Early-Modern Europe. Rethinking the Foundations of Modern Political Thought. A. S. Brett, J. Tully and H. Hamilton-Bleakley. New York, Cambridge University Press: 149-170.
van Ittersum, M. J. (2006). Profit and Principle : Hugo Grotius, Natural Rights Theories and the Rise of Dutch Power in the East Indies, 1595-1615. Leiden, Brill.
van Ittersum, M. J. (2010). “The Long Goodbye: Hugo Grotius’ Lustification of Dutch Expansion Overseas, 1615-1645.” History of European Ideas 36: 386-411.
Vitoria, F. d. (1991). On the American Indians. Political writings. A. L. J. Pagden. New York, Cambridge University Press.
Vitoria, F. d. (1991). On the Law of War. Political writings. A. L. J. Pagden. New York, Cambridge University Press.
Vreeland, H. (1917). Hugo Grotius, the Father of the Modern Science of International Law. New York, Oxford University Press.
Wilson, E. M. (2008). The Savage Republic: De Indis of Hugo Grotius, Republicanism, and Dutch Hegemony within the Early Modern World-System (c. 1600-1619), Martinus Nijhoff Publishers.

Author Information

Andrew Blom
Email: andrew.blom@cmich.edu
Central Michigan University
U. S. A.

The Moral Permissibility of Punishment

The legal institution of punishment presents a distinctive moral challenge because it involves a state’s infliction of intentionally harsh, or burdensome, treatment on some of its members—treatment that typically would be considered morally impermissible. Most of us would agree, for instance, that it is typically impermissible to imprison people, to force them to pay monetary sanctions or engage in community service, or to execute them. The moral challenge of punishment, then, is to establish what (if anything) makes it permissible to subject those who have been convicted of crimes to such treatment.

Traditionally, justifications of punishment have been either consequentialist or retributivist. Consequentialist accounts contend that punishment is justified as a means to securing some valuable end—typically crime reduction, by deterring, incapacitating, or reforming offenders. Retributivism, by contrast, holds that punishment is an intrinsically appropriate (because deserved) response to criminal wrongdoing. Each type of account has been roundly criticized, on a variety of grounds, by theorists in the other camp. In an effort to break this impasse, scholars have attempted to find alternative strategies that incorporate certain consequentialist or retributivist elements but avoid the standard objections directed at each. Each of these accounts has, in turn, met with criticism. Finally, abolitionists argue that none of these defenses of punishment is satisfactory, and that the practice is morally impermissible; the salient question for abolitionists, then, is how else (if at all) society should respond to those forms of wrongdoing that we now punish.

This article first looks more closely at what punishment is; in particular, it examines the distinctive features of punishment in virtue of which it stands in need of justification. It then highlights various questions that a full justification of punishment would need to answer. With these questions in mind, the article considers the most prominent consequentialist, retributivist, and hybrid attempts at establishing punishment’s moral permissibility. Finally, it considers the abolitionist alternative.

What is Punishment?
Various Questions
Consequentialist Accounts
Retributivist Accounts
Alternative Accounts
Abolitionism
References and Further Reading

1. What is Punishment?

When we consider whether punishment is morally permissible, it is important first to be clear about what it is that we are evaluating. Theorists disagree about a precise definition of punishment; nevertheless, we can identify a number of features that are commonly cited as elements of punishment.

First, it is generally accepted that punishment involves the infliction of a burden. The state confines people in jails and prisons, where liberties such as their freedom of movement and association, and their privacy, are heavily restricted. It imposes often heavy monetary sanctions or forces people to take part in community service work. It subjects people to periods of probation during which their movements and activities are closely supervised. In the most extreme cases, it executes people. Theorists disagree on precisely how to characterize this feature of punishment. Some describe punishment as essentially painful, or as involving the infliction of suffering, harsh treatment, or harm. Others instead write of punishment as involving the restriction of liberties. However we characterize the specific nature of the burden, it is relatively uncontroversial that punishment in its various forms is burdensome.

One might object that some prisoners could become accustomed to incarceration and so not see it as a burden, or that the masochist might even enjoy his corporal punishment. In response to supposed counterexamples such as these, a defender of the “burdensomeness” feature of punishment might argue that the comfortable prisoner and the masochist are still punished insofar as they are treated in ways that are typically regarded as burdensome by those on whom they are inflicted. Alternatively, one might argue that a particular case of incarceration, corporal punishment, and so forth, indeed does not count as punishment if the prisoner does not find it burdensome (Boonin, 2008: 8-10). Whatever one makes of these attempted counterexamples, it remains the case that punishment theorists by and large agree that burdensomeness is an essential feature of punishment.

But punishment is not merely burdensome. A second widely accepted feature of punishment is that it is intended to be burdensome. This feature distinguishes punishment from other forms of treatment that may be burdensome but are not intentionally so. Many people undoubtedly regard it as burdensome to pay their taxes, for instance, but presumably most do not regard this as a form of punishment. This is because although taxes may be foreseeably burdensome, they are not intentionally so. That is, the state does not levy taxes intending for them to be burdensome; rather, the intention is to pay for roads, an education system, and other public goods. That paying for these goods is burdensome to many taxpayers is incidental, and if there were a way to collect sufficient revenue to pay for needed public goods without this being a burden to taxpayers, then so much the better.

Punishment, however, is different. Punishment is intended to be burdensome. If it were not burdensome, then it would not be doing its job. For instance, as we will see below, some theorists contend that the aim of punishment is to reduce crime by deterring potential criminals. But for the threat of punishment to be the sort of thing likely to deter criminals, the punishment itself must be burdensome. Other theorists (retributivists) contend that wrongdoers deserve to suffer, and that punishment is justified as the infliction of this deserved suffering. Here again, the burdensomeness of punishment is not merely incidental, it is intended.

Of course, not all impositions of intended burdens count as punishment. A third commonly accepted feature of punishment is that it is imposed on someone guilty of an offense, as a response to that offense. Actually, there is some disagreement about this point. To count as punishment, must it be imposed on someone who is actually guilty of a crime? Or would it make sense to talk of punishing an innocent person (either mistakenly or intentionally)? Some scholars contend that punishment must be of a guilty person. Susan Dimock writes, “The innocent may be ‘victimized’ by the penal system, but they cannot be ‘punished’” (Dimock, 1997: 42). By contrast, H. L. A. Hart contends that we should acknowledge not only punishment of actual offenders, but also cases (which he calls “sub-standard or secondary”) of punishment “of persons…who neither are in fact nor supposed to be offenders” (see Hart, 1968: 5).

A fourth feature of punishment, widely acknowledged at least since the publication of Joel Feinberg’s seminal 1965 article “The Expressive Function of Punishment” is that it serves to express condemnation, or censure, of the offender for her offense. As Feinberg discusses, it is this condemning element that distinguishes punishment from what he calls “nonpunitive penalties” such as parking tickets, demotions, flunkings, and so forth. (Feinberg, 1965: 398-401). As we will see below, some scholars have taken this expression of censure to be central to the justification of punishment. But whether or not it plays a role in the justification of the practice, this expressive function is typically accepted as a distinctive feature of punishment.

Finally, it is worth highlighting that this article focuses on the legal institution of punishment—rather than, say, parents’ punishment of their children or other interpersonal cases of punishment (but see Zaibert, 2006). Legal theorists often assert as one of punishment’s features that it must be imposed by a properly constituted legal authority (typically, the state). They thereby aim to differentiate legal punishment from private vengeance or vigilantism. This does not mean we must accept uncritically that the state is the proper authority to impose punishment. Ideally, a full account of punishment should provide a plausible answer to why (or if) the state has an exclusive right to impose punishment.

These, then, are the most commonly cited features of punishment: punishment involves the state’s imposition of intended burdens—burdens that express social condemnation—on people (believed to be) guilty of crimes, in response to those crimes. This is not intended as a precise definition or a set of necessary and sufficient conditions for punishment. Theorists may disagree about particular elements, or especially about how exactly to flesh out the various elements. But this description is sufficient to give us a sense of why punishment stands in need of justification: It involves the state’s treating some of its members (imposing intentionally burdensome, censuring sanctions) in ways that typically would be morally impermissible.

2. Various Questions

When theorists ask whether punishment is justified, they typically assume a backdrop in which the legal system administering punishment is legitimate, and the criminal laws themselves are reasonably just. This is not to say that they assume that all legal systems are legitimate and all criminal laws are reasonably just in the actual world. Indeed, questions of political legitimacy and criminalization are important topics that have received a great deal of attention in their own right. But even in societies in which the legal system is legitimate and the laws are reasonably just, a general question arises of whether (and if so, why) it is permissible for the state to impose intended, censuring burdens on those who violate the laws.

This general question of punishment’s moral permissibility actually comprises a number of particular questions. A full normative account of punishment should provide answers to each of these questions.

First, there is the question of punishment’s function, or purpose. Put simply, what reason is there to want an institution of punishment? H. L. A. Hart referred to this as punishment’s “general justifying aim,” although this term may be misleading in two ways: on one hand, to say that the aim is justifying implies that it is sufficient, by itself, to establish punishment’s permissibility. As we will see, some scholars point out that more is needed to justify punishment than merely citing its function, no matter how valuable. On the other hand, talk of a justifying aim seems to privilege consequentialist accounts, according to which punishment is justified as a means to some socially valuable goal. But even for retributivist accounts, according to which punishment is justified not as a means to some end but rather as an intrinsically appropriate response to wrongdoing, we still need an explanation of why such a response is important enough to warrant the state’s institution of punishment. A first question, then, is what sufficiently important function punishment serves.

Even if we establish some sufficiently valuable function of punishment, this may not be enough to justify the practice. Some scholars contend that a crucial question is whether punishment violates the moral rights of those punished. If punishing offenders violates their rights, then it may be morally impermissible even if it serves some important function (Simmons, 1991; Wellman, 2009). What we need, according to this view, is an account of why, in principle, the practice of imposing intended burdens on people in the ways characteristic of punishment does not violate their moral rights.

In addition to justifying the practice of punishment in general, a complete account of punishment should also provide guidance in determining how to punish in particular cases. Even if the institution of punishment is morally permissible, a particular sentence may be impermissible if it is excessively harsh (or on some accounts, if it is too lenient). What principles and considerations should guide assessments of how severely to punish?

Relatedly, although this point has received less attention, we should ask not only about the appropriate severity of punishment but also about the proper mode of punishment. We may critique certain sentences not in virtue of their severity but because we believe the form of punishment (incarceration, capital punishment, and so forth) is in some sense inappropriate (Reiman, 1985; Moskos, 2011). What considerations, then, should guide assessments of whether imprisonment, fines, community service, probation, capital punishment, or some other form of punishment is the appropriate response to instances of criminal wrongdoing?

Finally, as mentioned, it is important to ask about the state’s role as the agent of punishment. Why is it the state’s right to impose punishment (if indeed it is)? Furthermore, what gives the state the exclusive right to punish (Wellman, 2009)? Why may victims not inflict punishment on their assailants (or hire someone to inflict the punishment)? Another question related to the proper agent of punishment—a question that has become increasingly salient in the decades following the Nuremberg trials—is when (if ever) the international community, rather than a particular state, can be the proper agent of punishment. What sorts of crime, and which criminals, are properly accountable to the institutions of international criminal law rather than (or perhaps in addition) to the domestic legal systems of particular states?

As we will see, various accounts of punishment focus on different questions. Also, some accounts seek to answer each of these questions by appealing to the same moral principles or considerations, whereas others appeal to different considerations in answering the different questions.

3. Consequentialist Accounts

Consequentialism holds that the rightness or wrongness of actions—or rules for action, or (relevant to our context) institutions—is determined solely by their consequences. Thus consequentialist accounts of punishment defend the practice as instrumentally valuable: the consequences of maintaining an institution of legal punishment, according to this view, are better than the consequences of not having such an institution. For many consequentialists, the burden of punishment itself is seen as a negative consequence—an “evil,” as Jeremy Bentham called it (Bentham, 1789: 158). Thus for punishment to be justified, it must be the case that it brings about other, sufficiently valuable consequences to outweigh its onerousness for the person on whom it is inflicted. Typically, punishment is defended as a necessary means to the socially valuable end of crime reduction, through deterrence, incapacitation, or offender reform.

a. Deterrence

Deterrence accounts contend that the threat of punishment serves as a disincentive for potential criminals. On such accounts, for the threat of punishment to be effective as a deterrent, it must be credible—it must have teeth, so to speak—and thus the legal system must follow through on the threat and impose punishment on those who violate laws. Theorists have distinguished two potential audiences for the deterrent threat: first, the threat of punishment might serve to dissuade members of the public generally from committing crimes that they might otherwise have committed. This is called general deterrence. Second, for those who do commit crimes and are subjected to punishment, the threat of future punishment (namely, the prospect of having to experience prison again, or pay further fines, and so forth) might provide a disincentive to reoffending. This is typically referred to as specific (or special) deterrence.

b. Incapacitation

Punishment might also help to reduce crime by incapacitating criminals. Unlike deterrence, incapacitation does not operate by dissuading potential offenders. Incapacitation instead aims to remove dangerous people from situations in which they could commit crimes. Imprisoning someone in a solitary confinement unit, for instance, may or may not convince her not to commit crimes in the future; but while she is locked up, she will be unable to commit (most) crimes.

c. Offender Reform

A third way in which punishment might help to reduce crime is by encouraging or facilitating offender reform. The aim of reform is like that of specific deterrence in one respect: both seek to induce a change in the offender’s behavior. That is, the aim for both is that she should choose not to reoffend. In this respect, both reform and specific deterrence differ from incapacitation, which is concerned with restricting rather than influencing offenders’ choices. But reform differs from specific deterrence in terms of the ways in which each seeks to induce different choices. Punishment aimed at specific deterrence provides prudential reasons: we impose onerous treatment on an offender in hopes that her aversion to undergoing such treatment again will convince her not to reoffend. Punishment with the aim of offender reform, by contrast, aims to reshape offenders’ moral motives and dispositions.

d. Sentencing

Each of these aims—deterrence, incapacitation, and reform—will have distinct implications with respect to sentencing. Punishment aimed at reducing crime through deterrence would in general need to be severe enough to provide members of the public with a significant incentive not to offend, or to provide offenders with an incentive not to reoffend. Also, as Bentham explained, the severity of sentences should reflect the relative seriousness of the crimes punished (Bentham, 1789: 168). More serious crimes should receive more severe punishments than do less serious crimes, so that prospective offenders, if they are going to commit one crime or the other, will have an incentive to choose the less serious crime.

For punishment aimed at reducing crime through incapacitation, sentences should be restrictive enough that dangerous offenders will be unable to victimize others (so, for instance, prison appears generally preferable to fines as a form of incapacitative punishment). In terms of duration, incapacitative sentences should last as long as the offender poses a genuine threat. Similarly, sentences aimed at reducing crime through offender reform should be tailored, in terms of the form, severity, and duration of punishment, in whatever ways are determined to be most conducive to this aim.

Finally, insofar as punishment itself is considered to be, in Bentham’s words, an “evil,” the consequentialist is committed to the view that sentences should be no more severe than is necessary to accomplish their aim. Thus whether she endorses deterrence, incapacitation, reform, or some other aim (or a combination of these), the consequentialist should also endorse a parsimony constraint on sentence severity (Tonry, 2011). After all, to impose sentences that are more severe than is necessary to accomplish punishment’s aim(s) would appear to be an infliction of gratuitous suffering—and so, from a consequentialist perspective, unjustified.

e. Objections and Responses

Typical consequentialist accounts of punishment contend that the practice is justified because it produces, on balance, positive consequences by helping to reduce crime, either through deterrence, incapacitation, or offender reform. Critics have objected to such consequentialist accounts on a number of grounds.

First, some have objected to deterrence accounts on grounds that punishment does not actually deter potential offenders. A key worry is that often (perhaps typically) those who commit crimes act impulsively or irrationally, rather than as efficient calculators of expected utility, and so they are not responsive to the threat of punishment. The question of whether punishment deters is an empirical one, and criminological studies on this question have come to different conclusions. In general, evidence seems to indicate that punishment does have some deterrent effect, but that the certainty of apprehension plays a greater deterrent role than does the severity of punishment (Nagin, 2013).

A similar line of objection has been raised against reform-based accounts of punishment. Criminological research in the 1970s led many scholars and practitioners to conclude that punishment did not, indeed could not, promote offender reform (the mantra “nothing works” was for many years ubiquitous in these discussions). More recent criminological work, however, has generated somewhat more optimism about the prospects for offender reform (Cullen, 2013).

Whereas critics have questioned whether punishment deters or facilitates offender reform, there is little doubt that punishment—especially incarceration—incapacitates (prisoners may still have opportunities to commit crimes, but their opportunities are at least significantly limited.) Critics have raised questions, however, about the link between incapacitation and crime reduction. For punishment to be justified on incapacitative grounds, after all, it would need to be the case not only that punishment in fact incapacitates, but that in so doing it helps to reduce crime. At least in some cases, there is reason to doubt whether the link between incapacitation and crime reduction holds. Most notably, locking up drug dealers or gang members does not appear to decrease drug- or gang-related crimes, because the incapacitated person is quickly and easily replaced by someone else (Tonry, 2006: 31-32).

Even if we accept, for argument’s sake, that punishment contributes to crime reduction, it still may not be justified on consequentialist grounds if it also generates costs that outweigh its benefits. The costs of punishment are not limited to the suffering or other burdens inflicted on offenders, although these burdens do matter from a consequentialist perspective. Scholars have also highlighted burdens associated with certain forms of punishment—in particular, incarceration—for offenders’ families and communities (Mauer and Chesney-Lind, 2002). These costs matter in consequentialist calculations. In addition, we must consider the financial costs of maintaining an institution of criminal punishment. In 2012, the Vera Institute of Justice released a study of 40 U.S. states that found that the total taxpayer cost of prisons in these states was $39 billion. Thus defenders of punishment on consequentialist grounds must show not only that punishment is beneficial, but also that its benefits are significant enough to outweigh its costs to offenders and to society generally.

Furthermore, even if punishment’s benefits outweigh its costs, consequentialists must make the case that these benefits cannot be achieved through some other, less burdensome response to crime. If there are alternatives to punishment that are equally effective in reducing crime but are less costly overall, then from a consequentialist perspective, these alternatives would be preferable (Boonin, 2008: 53, 264-67).

Suppose, however, that the benefits of punishment outweigh its harms and also that there are no alternatives to punishment that generate, on balance, better overall consequences. In this case, punishment would be justified from a consequentialist perspective. Many theorists, however, do not endorse consequentialism. Indeed, the most prominent philosophical objections to consequentialist accounts of punishment take aim specifically at supposed deficiencies of consequentialism itself.

Perhaps the most common objection to consequentialist accounts is that they are unable to provide principled grounds for ruling out punishment of the innocent. If there were ever a situation in which punishing an innocent person would promote the best consequences, then consequentialism appears committed to doing so. H. J. McCloskey imagines a case in which, in the wake of a heinous crime, a small-town sheriff must decide whether to frame and punish a person whom the townspeople believe to be guilty but the sheriff knows is innocent if doing so is the only way to prevent rioting by the townspeople (McCloskey, 1957: 468-69). If punishing the innocent person defuses the residents’ hostilities and prevents the riots—and thereby produces better overall consequences than continuing to search for the actual criminal—then it appears that the consequentialist is committed to punishing the innocent person. But knowingly punishing an innocent person strikes most of us as deeply unjust.

Consequentialists have responded to this objection in various ways. Some contend that what McCloskey describes is not actually punishment, because punishment, by definition, is a response to those guilty of crimes (or at least believed to be guilty, whereas in McCloskey’s example, the sheriff knows the person to be innocent). H. L. A. Hart refers to this response as the “definitional stop” and he suggests it is unhelpful because it seeks to define away the interesting normative questions. Setting terminology aside, the relevant questions are whether and why it is permissible to impose intended, condemnatory burdens on those (believed to be) guilty of crimes. The consequentialist’s response is that doing so produces the best consequences, but then it seems that the consequentialist should be committed to imposing such burdens on those not (believed to be) guilty of crimes when doing so produces the best consequences. Such a practice would strike many as morally wrong, however. Thus the objection arises for consequentialists regardless of definitions.

Others have responded to the objection that consequentialism would allow for punishing the innocent by suggesting that scenarios such as McCloskey suggests are so far-fetched that they are unlikely to occur in the real world. In actual cases, punishing the innocent will rarely, if ever, produce the best consequences. For instance, some contend that the sheriff in the example would likely be found out, and as a result the public would lose its trust in law enforcement officials; the long-term consequences, therefore, would be worse than if the sheriff had not punished the innocent person. As critics have pointed out, however, this response only shows that punishing the innocent will usually be ruled out by consequentialism. There might still be cases, albeit rare, in which punishing the innocent would generate the best consequences (maybe the sheriff is adept at covering up his act). At best, then, consequentialism seems only able to ground a contingent prohibition on punishing the innocent. Some consequentialists have accepted this implication, albeit reluctantly (see Smart, 1973: 69-73).

A similar objection to consequentialist accounts is that they cannot provide a principled basis for the widely held intuition that punishment should be no more severe than an offender deserves (where desert is the product of the seriousness of the offense and the offender’s culpability). On this view, it is morally wrong to subject those guilty of relatively minor crimes to harsh punishment; such punishment would be excessive. For consequentialist accounts, though, it appears that excessively harsh sentences would be permitted (indeed, required) if they produced the best overall consequences.

Jeremy Bentham contended that consequentialism does have the resources to ground relative proportionality in sentencing—that is, lesser offenses should receive less severe sentences than more serious offenses receive. His reasoning was that if sentences for minor offenses were as harsh as for more serious offenses, potential offenders would have no incentive to commit the lesser offense rather than the more serious one (Bentham, 1789: 168). If Bentham is right, then there is a consequentialist basis for punishing shoplifters, for instance, less harshly than armed robbers. But this does not rule out punishing shoplifters harshly (more harshly than most of us would think justified) and punishing armed robbers even more harshly; again, a consequentialist would seem committed to such a sentencing scheme if it promoted the best overall consequences.

Defenders of consequentialist sentencing have another response available, namely that excessively harsh sentences do not, in practice, produce the best consequences. For instance, criminological research suggests a) that stiffer sentences do not produce significant deterrent effects (it is primarily the certainty of punishment rather than its severity that deters); b) that extremely long prison terms are not justified on incapacitative grounds (for one reason, most offenders “age out” of criminal behavior anyway by their 30s or 40s); and c) that extremely harsh sentences may, on balance, have criminogenic effects (that is, they may make people more likely to reoffend). This sort of response, of course, makes the prohibition of disproportionate punishment a contingent matter; in other words, if extremely harsh sentences did help to reduce crime and this produced, on balance, the best overall consequences, then consequentialism would appear to endorse such sentences. Critics thus charge that consequentialist accounts are unappealing insofar as they are unable to ground more than a contingent prohibition on disproportionately harsh punishment.

Even if we prohibit punishment of the innocent or disproportionate punishment of the guilty, a third, Kantian objection holds that consequentialist punishment is not properly responsive to the person being punished. According to this objection, to punish offenders as a means to securing some valuable social end (namely, crime reduction) is to use them as mere means, rather than respecting them as ends in themselves (Kant, 1797: 473; Murphy, 1973).

In response to this objection, some scholars have contended that although consequentialists regard punishment as a means to an end, punishment does not treat offenders as mere means to this end. If we limit punishment to those who have been found guilty of crimes, then this treatment is arguably responsive to their choices and does not use them as mere means. Kant himself suggested that as long as we reserve punishment only for those found guilty of crimes, then it is permissible to punish with an eye toward potential benefits (Kant, 1797: 473).

A more recent objection to consequentialist systems of punishment, developed by R. A. Duff (1986, 2001), charges that consequentialist systems of punishment, with their focus on crime reduction, treat offenders as dangerous “outsiders”—as the “they” whom “we,” the law-abiding members of society, must threaten, incapacitate, or remold to ensure our safety. Such a conception of the criminal law is inappropriately exclusionary, Duff claims. The criminal law, and the institution of punishment, in a liberal polity should treat offenders inclusively, as (still) members of the community who despite having violated its values could, and should, nevertheless (re)commit to these values.

In response, one might object that systems of punishment aimed at crime reduction need not be exclusionary in the way Duff suggests. In particular, punishment that aims to deter crime might be said to treat all community members equally, namely as potential offenders. For those who have not committed crimes, deterrent punishment regards them as potential offenders and aims to provide an incentive not to offend (that is, general deterrence). For those who have committed crimes, deterrent punishment similarly regards them as potential (re)offenders and aims to provide an incentive not to (re)offend (that is, specific deterrence). In this way, punishment with a deterrent aim might be said to speak to all community members in the same terms, and thus not to be objectionably exclusionary.

4. Retributivist Accounts

As we have seen, consequentialist accounts of punishment are essentially forward-looking—punishment is said to be justified in virtue of the consequences it helps to produce. A different sort of account regards punishment as justified not because of what it brings about, but instead because it is an intrinsically appropriate response to crime. Accounts of the second sort have traditionally been described as retributivist. In general, we can say that retributivism views punishment as justified because it is deserved, although particular accounts differ about what exactly this means.

Theorists have distinguished two varieties of retributivism: positive retributivism and negative retributivism. Positive retributivism is typically characterized as the view that an offender’s desert provides a positive justifying reason for punishment; in other words, the state should punish those who are found guilty of criminal wrongdoing because they deserve it. Negative retributivism, by contrast, provides a constraint on punishment: punishment is justified only of those who deserve it. Because negative retributivism provides only a constraint on punishment, not a positive reason to punish, the negative retributive constraint has featured prominently in attempts at mixed accounts of punishment; such accounts allow punishment for consequentialist aims as long as the punishment is only of those who deserve it. On the other hand, because negative retributivism does not provide a positive justifying reason to punish, some scholars argue that it does not properly count as retributivism at all.

The distinction between retributivism and consequentialism is not always a neat one. Notice that one might endorse the claim that punishment is a deserved response to wrongdoing and then further assert that it is a valuable state of affairs when wrongdoers get the punishment they deserve—a state of affairs that therefore should be promoted. On this type of account, retribution itself essentially becomes the consequentialist aim of punishment (Moore, 1903; Zaibert, 2006). Nevertheless, in keeping with general practice, this article will treat retributivism as distinct from, and in competition with, consequentialist accounts.

a. Deserved Suffering

One common version of retributivism contends simply that wrongdoers deserve to suffer in proportion to their wrongdoing. Often this claim is made by way of appeal to intuitions about particular, usually heinous crimes: surely the unrepentant war criminal, for example, who has tortured and murdered many innocent people, deserves to suffer for what he has done. Proponents argue that retributivism is justified because it best accounts for our intuitions about particular cases such as these (Moore, 1987; Kleinig, 1973).

Justifying retributivism requires more, of course, than merely appealing to common intuitions about such cases. After all, even if many (even most) people do feel, in hearing reports of terrible crimes, that the perpetrators deserve to suffer, not everyone feels this way. And even those who do have such intuitions may not feel entirely comfortable with them. What we would like to know is whether the intuitions themselves are justified, or whether, for instance, they amount to an unhealthy desire for vengeance. Critics contend that those who rely on our intuitions about particular cases as evidence that retributivism is justified fail to provide the needed explanation of why the intuitions are justified.

There are other questions for such a view: does any sort of moral wrongdoing deserve to be met with suffering, or only some cases of wrongdoing? Which ones? And why is meting out deserved suffering for wrongdoing properly the concern of the state?

b. Fair Play

Another prominent type of retributivist account begins with a conception of society as a cooperative venture in which each member benefits when there is general compliance with the rules governing the venture. Because each of us benefits when everyone else plays by the rules, fairness dictates that we each have an obligation to reciprocate by playing by the rules, too. A criminal, like other members of society, benefits from general compliance with laws, but she fails to reciprocate by complying with the laws herself. She essentially becomes a free rider, because she counts on others to play by the rules that she violates. By failing to restrain herself appropriately, she gains an unfair advantage over others in society. The justification of punishment is that it corrects this unfair advantage by inflicting burdens on the offender proportionate to the benefit she gained by committing her crime (Morris, 1968).

On the fair play view, then, punishment is justified as a deserved response to an unfair advantage taken against members of society generally. Such an account offers a relatively straightforward answer to the question of why punishment is the state’s business. The state has an interest in assuring those who accept the burdens of compliance with the law that they will not be at a disadvantage to those who would free-ride on the system.

Critics of the fair play view have argued that it provides a counterintuitive conception of the crime to which punishment responds. It seems strange, for instance, to think of the wrong perpetrated by, say, a rapist as a sort of free-riding wrong against society in general, rather than an egregious wrong perpetrated against the victim in particular. In response to this charge, Dagger (1993) argues that crimes may be wrong in both senses: they may wrong particular victims in various ways, but they are also in every case wrongs in the sense of free riding on society generally.

c. Censure

Another influential version of retributivism begins with the claim, discussed earlier, that one of punishment’s distinctive features is that it communicates censure, or condemnation, of the offender for her offense. This retributivist account, developed most notably by R. A. Duff (1986, 2001), takes the censuring feature as the key to establishing punishment’s moral permissibility. Offenders deserve to be censured for what they have done, and punishment is justified because it delivers this censuring message.

Duff understands crimes as public wrongs, as violations of important public values. It follows on this account that the state is the appropriate agent of punishment; the state properly calls offenders to account for their violations of the political community’s shared values.

Censuring involves, in part, urging an offender to think about the wrong she has done, to repent and (re)commit herself to the values that she has violated. Thus it follows from censure accounts such as Duff’s that offender self-reform is an aim of punishment. But notice the crucial distinction between this sort of account and the variety of consequentialist account that aims at offender reform. Although offender reform is an aim of punishment on the censure account, it is not a justifying aim. In other words, on the censure view, punishment is not justified insofar as it tends to promote offender reform. Rather, punishment is justified because it communicates deserved censure. Part of what it means to censure, however, is to urge wrongdoers to repent and reform.

A common critique of the censure view asks why punishment—that is, the imposition of intended burdens—is the proper way to censure wrongdoers. It seems that the polity could communicate messages of censure to offenders without imposing intended burdens; for example, it could issue a public proclamation condemning the crime and blaming the offender. Why, then, is the hard treatment characteristic of punishment an appropriate vehicle for conveying such messages? One type of response, offered by Duff and others (see also Falls, 1987), holds that hard treatment is needed to convey adequately the polity’s condemnation of crimes. Nonpunitive censure—blaming without imposing intended hard treatment—would fail to communicate the seriousness of the wrongdoing.

Also, on Duff’s account, hard treatment can function to induce in offenders the sort of moral reflection that may lead to repentance, reform, and reconciliation (with their victims and the community more generally). Some have objected, however, that such an account implies too intrusive a role for the state. It is not a proper function of the state, critics charge, to seek to induce repentance and moral reform in offenders. Thus even some scholars who agree that punishment is justified as a form of censure nevertheless disagree about the role of the hard treatment element. For Andrew von Hirsch (1993), for instance, the intended burdens characteristic of punishment act as a sort of prudential supplement: punishment, as censure, serves to remind offenders (and community members) of the moral reasons to comply with the law. Punishment, as hard treatment, also provides a prudential threat as a sort of supplement for those of us for whom the moral message is not sufficient. One worry with such an account, however, is whether the prudential threat will tend to drown out the moral message.

d. Other Versions

Alternative versions of retributivism have been offered. Some scholars, for instance, argue that those who commit crimes violate the trust of their fellow community members. Trust, on this account, is an essential feature of a healthy community. Offenders undermine this trust when they victimize others. In such cases, punishment is a deserved response to such violations and an appropriate way to help maintain (or restore) the conditions of trust among community members (see Dimock, 1997). Advocates of this trust-based variety of retributivism must explain which violations of trust rise to the level that warrants criminalization, so that violators should be subject to punishment. Also, we might question whether such accounts are purely retributivist after all: if punishment is justified at least in part as a means of helping to maintain conditions of trust in a community, then this appears to be a consequentialist rationale. On the other hand, if punishment is justified not for what it helps to bring about but rather as an intrinsically appropriate (because deserved) response to violations of trust, then we need an explanation of why such violations deserve punishment, perhaps as opposed to some other form of response.

Another form of retributivism holds that offenders incur a moral debt to their victims, and so they deserve punishment as a way to repay this debt (McDermott, 2001). This moral debt is distinct from the material debt that an offender may incur. In other words, a person who robs from another person incurs a material debt equal to the value of whatever was stolen, but she also incurs a moral debt for violating the victim’s rights. The offender takes not only a material good from the victim but also a moral good. Repayment of material goods does not settle this moral debt, and so punishment is needed to fill this role. As Daniel McDermott characterizes it, punishment serves to deny the ill-gotten moral good to the perpetrator (McDermott, 2001: 424).

Such an account raises a host of questions: what precisely is the nature of the moral good that has been taken from the victim? How can a moral good be taken away from someone? In what sense (if at all) has the perpetrator gained this good? How does punishment deny this good to the offender, and how does this thereby make things right for the victim?

e. Sentencing

Because retributivism claims that punishment is justified as a deserved response to wrongdoing, retributivist accounts should provide some guidance about what sentences are deserved in particular cases. Typically, retributivists hold that sentences should be no more severe than is deserved. This negative retributivist constraint on sentencing corresponds with the negative retributivist constraint on punishment itself (namely, that punishment is justified only of those who deserve it). By contrast, positive retributivism holds that offenders’ sentences should be no less severe than they deserve. Some scholars find this positive retributivism unappealing because it seems to preclude the state from taking into account mercy or other considerations that might count in favor of lenient sentences. In other words, some are more comfortable with retributivism’s setting a ceiling but not a floor on sentence severity. One question, though, is whether (and if so, why) retributivists are justified in endorsing the negative retributivist constraint on sentencing without also endorsing the positive retributivist constraint.

Retributivists often discuss sentencing in terms of proportionality, where a proportionate sentence is understood as one that is deserved (or at least, on some accounts, not clearly undeserved). Sentences may be proportionate in two senses: first, they may be proportionate (or disproportionate) relative to each other. This sense of proportionality, called ordinal proportionality, holds that similarly serious offenses should receive similarly severe punishments (like cases should be treated alike); that more serious offenses should be punished more harshly than less serious offenses (murder should be punished more harshly than shoplifting, for instance); and that differences in sentence severity should reflect differences in relative seriousness of offenses (because murder is much more serious than shoplifting, murder should carry a much more severe sentence).

Some scholars have challenged the notion of ordinal proportionality constraints in sentencing, both because offenders cannot neatly be distinguished into a manageable number of desert-based groups—Michael Tonry calls this the “illusion of ‘like-situated offenders’” (Tonry, 2011)—and because individual offenders’ subjective experiences of the same sentence may vary greatly. For example, someone who is young, physically imposing, or has no children may have a much different experience of a 10-year prison term from someone who is much older, physically frail, or must leave behind her children to serve the sentence. Considerations such as these do not in themselves demonstrate that the tenets of ordinal proportionality are false (that like cases should not be treated alike, for instance, or that more serious violations should not receive harsher sentences). Rather, these considerations raise challenges to our ability in practice to implement a just sentencing scheme that reflects ordinal proportionality.

Even if sentences can be devised that satisfy ordinal proportionality, however—in other words, even if a sentencing scheme itself is internally proportionate—particular sentences may fail to be proportionate if the entire sentencing scheme is too severe (or lenient). For instance, a sentencing scheme in which even the least offenses were punished with prison terms would appear disproportionate even if sentences in the scheme were proportionate relative to each other. Thus theorists note a second sense of proportionality: cardinal, or nonrelative, proportionality. Cardinal proportionality considers whether sentences are commensurate with the crimes they punish. A prison term for jaywalking would appear to violate cardinal proportionality, because such a sentence strikes us as too severe given the offense, even if this sentence were proportionate with other sentences in a sentencing scheme—that is, even if it satisfied ordinal proportionality. Thus cardinal proportionality concerns not the relation of sentences to one another, but instead the relation of a sentence to the crime to which it is a response. Put another way, even if an entire sentencing scheme is internally (ordinally) proportionate, we need guidance in how to anchor the sentencing scheme to the crimes themselves so that offenders in particular cases receive the sentences they deserve.

In addition to addressing questions of deserved sentence severity, we would like retributivism to provide some guidance about how to determine what mode, or form, of punishment is appropriate in response to a given crime. Is prison time, community service, capital punishment, probation, or something else the deserved form of response, and why?

The implications of retributivism for sentencing will depend on the specific account’s explanation of why punishment is said to be the deserved response to offending.

Those who appeal to intuitions that the guilty deserve to suffer, for instance, can similarly appeal to intuitions that those who are guilty of more serious offenses deserve to suffer more than those who are guilty of less serious offenses. As discussed, however, we would like to know how much punishment is deserved in particular cases in nonrelative terms, and also what form the suffering should take. One well-known account of sentencing is provided by lex talionis (that is, an eye for an eye, a tooth for a tooth). Immanuel Kant famously endorsed this principle: “Accordingly, whatever undeserved evil you inflict upon another within the people, that you inflict upon yourself” (Kant, 1797: 473). As critics have noted, though, not every crime appears to have an obvious like-for-like response—what would lex talionis demand for the childless kidnapper, for instance (Shafer-Landau, 2000: 193)? And even when a like-for-like response is clearly indicated, it will not always be palatable (torturing the torturer, for example).

We might assert instead that the sentence and the offense need not be alike in kind, but that the sentence should impose an amount of suffering equal to the harm done by the offender. Still, questions arise of how to make interpersonal comparisons of suffering. And again, for the most heinous crimes, a principle of inflicting equal amounts of suffering may recommend sentences that we would find troubling.

The fair play view holds that punishment functions to remove an unfair advantage gained by an offender relative to members of society generally. Critics of this view often object, however, that it provides insufficient or counterintuitive guidance about sentencing. Put simply, there does not seem to be any advantage that an offender gains, in proportion with the seriousness of her crime, relative to community members generally. On one version of the view, the offender gains freedom from the burden of self-constraint that others accept in complying with the particular law that the offender violates. If so, then the sentence severity should be proportionate to the burden others feel in complying with that law. But compliance with laws is often not a burden for most citizens. Indeed, it is often less burdensome to comply with prohibitions on serious offenses (murder, assault, and so forth) than it is to comply with prohibitions on lesser crimes (tax evasion, jaywalking, and so forth), given that we are more often tempted to commit the lesser crimes. But if the unfair advantage that punishment aims to remove is freedom from the burden of self-constraint, and if self-constraint is often more burdensome with lesser crimes, then these less serious crimes will often appear to merit relatively more severe punishments. This is a violation of ordinal proportionality.

Similar problems arise for other versions of the fair play view. Suppose, for instance, that the unfair advantage a criminal gains is not freedom from the burden of complying with the particular law she violates, but rather freedom from complying with the rule of law in general. This general compliance, Richard Dagger writes, is a genuine burden: “there are times for almost all of us when we would like to have the best of both worlds—that is, the freedom we enjoy under the rule of law plus freedom from the burden of obeying laws” (Dagger, 1993: 483). Critics have objected, however, that on this conception of the unfair advantage all offenses become, for the purposes of punishment, the same offense. Both the murderer’s and the tax cheat’s unfair advantage is freedom from compliance with the rule of law generally. If the unfair advantage is the same, however, then removing the advantage would seem to require equal sentences. Again, such sentencing appears to violate ordinal proportionality.

For the censure view, questions arise about what form of punishment and what severity will communicate the deserved message of condemnation in particular cases. On such a view, the principles of ordinal proportionality appear to follow straightforwardly: censure should reflect the seriousness of the wrongdoing, and so if punishment is the vehicle of communicating censure, then sentences should reflect the appropriate relative degree of censure for each case.

The censure view should provide guidance not only about how severely to punish crimes relative to each other, but also how severely to punish in absolute terms, and also the appropriate mode of punishment. To say that manslaughter should be censured more severely than theft, for instance, does not actually tell us how severely to censure manslaughter or theft, or with what form of punishment. Again, the challenge is in determining how to anchor the sentencing scale to actual offenses. Should the least serious offenses receive censure in the form of a small fine, a day in jail, or a year in jail? Should the most serious offenses receive capital punishment, life imprisonment, or some less severe sentence?

Similar questions arise for accounts that characterize punishment as a deserved response to violations of trust, or as a deserved response to the incurrence of a moral debt. What form and severity of punishment is appropriate to maintain conditions of community trust in response to attempted kidnapping, or the theft of a valuable piece of art? How severe must a sentence be to resolve the moral debt that is incurred when one impersonates a police officer, or cheats on her taxes?

Indeed, questions about fixing deserved sentences in response to particular offenses arise for retributivist accounts generally. Critics have charged that retributivism is unable to provide adequate, nonarbitrary guidance about either the deserved severity or deserved form of punishment in particular cases (see Shafer-Landau, 2000).

Retributivists are, of course, aware of such objections and have sought to meet them in various ways. Nonetheless, questions about proportionate sentencing continue to be a central challenge for retributivist accounts.

5. Alternative Accounts

In part as a response to objections commonly raised against consequentialist or retributivist views, a number of theorists have sought to develop alternative accounts of punishment.

a. Rights Forfeiture

At the outset, we said that the central question of punishment’s permissibility is why (if at all) it is permissible to treat those who have committed criminal offenses in ways that typically would be impermissible. For some theorists, this question is best cast in terms of rights: why are the sorts of intended burdens characteristic of punishment, which would constitute rights violations if imposed on those who have not been convicted of criminal wrongdoing, not violations of the rights of those punished?

One way in which punishment would not violate the rights of offenders is if, in committing the crime for which they are convicted, they forfeit the relevant right(s). Because offenders forfeit their right not to be punished, the state has no corresponding duty not to punish them. As W. D. Ross writes, “the offender, by violating the life or liberty or property of another, has lost his own right to have his life, liberty, or property respected, so that the state has no prima facie duty to spare him, as it has a prima facie duty to spare the innocent” (1930: 60-61).

Notice that the forfeiture view itself does not imply any particular positive justification of punishment; it merely purports to explain why punishing offenders does not violate their rights. This is consistent with maintaining that the positive justification of punishment is that it helps reduce crime, or conversely, that wrongdoers deserve to be punished. Thus the forfeiture view does not provide a complete account of the justification of punishment. Proponents, however, take this feature to be a virtue rather than a weakness of the view.

The forfeiture claim raises a number of key questions: first, why does someone who violates the law thereby forfeit the right not to be punished? For those who are gripped by the dilemma of why punishing offenders does not violate their rights, the mere answer that offenders forfeit their rights, without some deeper account of what this forfeiture amounts to, may seem inadequate. Thus some theorists attempt to ground their forfeiture claim in a more comprehensive moral or political theory (see, for instance, Morris, 1991).

Second, what is the nature of the rights forfeited? Do offenders forfeit the same rights they violate? If so, then this raises some of the same challenges as we saw with certain forms of retributivism: what right is forfeited by a childless kidnapper, for example? Alternatively, is the forfeited right simply the right not to be punished? If every offender forfeits this same, general right, then on what basis can we distinguish what sentence is permissible for different offenders? For example, if the burglar forfeits the same right as the murderer, then what prevents us from imposing the same punishment in each case (could two offenders forfeit the same right to different degrees, as some have suggested)?

Third, how should we determine the duration of the forfeiture? Fourth, if an offender forfeits her right against punishment, then why does the state maintain an exclusive right to punish? Why are other individuals not permitted to punish?

b. Consent

Rights forfeiture theorists argue that punishment does not violate offenders’ rights because offenders forfeit the relevant rights. Another way that punishment might be said not to violate offenders’ rights is if offenders waive their rights. This is the central claim of the consent view. Defended most notably by C. S. Nino (1983), the consent view holds that when a person voluntarily commits a crime while knowing the consequences of doing so, she effectively consents to these consequences. In doing so, she waives her right not to be subject to punishment. This is not to say that she explicitly consents to being punished, but rather that by her voluntary action she tacitly consents to be subject to what she knows are the consequences.

Like the forfeiture view, the consent view does not supply a positive justification for punishment. To say that a person consents to some treatment does not by itself provide us with a reason to treat her that way. So the consent view, like the forfeiture view, is compatible with consequentialist aims or with the claim that punishment is a deserved response to offending.

One challenge for the consent view is that it does not seem to justify punishment of offenders who do not know that their acts are subject to punishment. For someone to have consented to be subject to certain consequences of an act, she must know of these consequences. What’s more, even if an offender knows she is committing a punishable act, she might not know the extent of the punishment to which she is subject. If so, then it is not clear how she can be said to consent to her punishment. It is not clear, for example, that a robber who knows that robbery is a punishable offense but does not realize the severity of the punishment to which she will be subject thereby consents to her sentence.

By contrast, other critics have charged that the consent view cannot rule out sentences that most of us would find excessive. This is because a person who voluntarily commits an action with knowledge of the legal consequences, whatever these consequences happen to be, has consented to be subject to the consequences. As Larry Alexander has put it: “If the law imposes capital punishment for overparking, then one who voluntarily overparks ‘consents’ to be executed” (Alexander, 1986).

Another difficulty for the consent view is that tacit consent typically can be overridden by explicit denials of consent. Thus it would seem to follow that one who tacitly consents to be subject to punishment could override this tacit consent by explicitly denying that she consents. But of course, we do not think that an offender should be able to avoid punishment by explicitly refusing to consent to it (Boonin, 2008).

c. Self-Defense

Another proposed justification of punishment conceives of punishment as a form of societal self-defense. First consider self-defense in the interpersonal context: When an assailant attacks me, he culpably creates a situation in which harm will occur: either harm to me if I do not effectively defend myself or harm to him if I do. In such a circumstance, I am justified in acting so that the harm falls on my attacker rather than on me. Similarly, when an offender creates a situation in which either she or her victim will be harmed, the state is permitted to use force to ensure that the harm falls on the perpetrator rather than on the victim (Montague, 1995).

So far, this view appears to justify state intervention only to stop ongoing crimes or ward off impending crimes. How does this view justify punishment as a response to past crimes? Advocates of the view claim that the state is not only justified in intervening to stop actual offenses; it is also permitted to threaten the use of force to deter such crimes. For the threat to be credible and thus effective as a deterrent, however, the state will need to follow through on the threat in cases in which offenders are not deterred. Thus punishment of offenders is permissible.

Notice that although the self-defense account views punishment as a deterrent threat, it is not a pure consequentialist account. Crucial to punishment’s permissibility on the self-defense view is the claim that an offender has culpably created the circumstance in which harm will fall either on the perpetrator or the victim. This backward-looking element is missing from pure consequentialist accounts that cite punishment’s deterrent effects in defending the practice.

Critics object that the analogy between self-defense and punishment breaks down in a number of respects. First, many self-defense theorists argue that the logic of defensive force permits the use of such force even against “innocent” threats. But we do not typically believe that, by analogy, punishment of innocent people is permitted, even if such punishment helped to maintain the credibility of a deterrent threat. Second, the degree of force that is permitted to stop an actual attack may far exceed what we intuitively believe would be permitted as punishment of an offense that has already been committed.

Third, it is one thing to follow through on a threat in order to deter the person who has just offended from offending again. It is another thing—and one might argue, more difficult to justify—to punish one person in order to maintain a credible deterrent threat against the public generally. If we believe the primary deterrent effect of punishment is as a general deterrent (rather than as a specific deterrent), then the analogy with typical accounts of self-defense seems strained. It would be as if, to deter the oncoming assailant from following through with his attack, I grab someone nearby (who has previously attacked me) and inflict the same degree of harm that I would aim to inflict on the assailant to defend myself. This might, of course, be permissible if my previous attacker had thereby acquired a duty to protect me from future harm by allowing himself to be punished as a means of maintaining a credible deterrent threat (Tadros, 2011).

d. Moral Education

The moral education view shares certain features of consequentialist accounts as well as retributivist accounts. On this view, punishment is justified as a means of teaching a moral lesson to those who commit crimes (and perhaps to community members more generally, as well).

Like standard consequentialist accounts, the education view acknowledges that part of the story of punishment’s justification involves its importance in reducing crime. But the education theorist also takes seriously the worry expressed by many retributivists that aiming to shape people’s behavior merely by issuing threats is, in G. W. F. Hegel’s words, “much the same as when one raises a cane against a dog; a man is not treated in accordance with his dignity and honour, but as a dog” (Hegel, 1821: 36). By contrast, a central feature of the moral education view is that those who commit crimes are moral agents, capable of reflecting on and responding to moral reasons. Thus moral education theorists view punishment not as a means of conditioning people to behave in certain ways, but rather of “teaching the wrongdoer that the action she did (or wants to do) is forbidden because it is morally wrong and should not be done for that reason” (Hampton, 1984).

Another way to express this difference between the education view and standard consequentialist views is that consequentialist views focus entirely on whether punishment promotes some goal. The education view, however, holds that only certain means are appropriate for pursuing this goal: namely, punishment aims to engage with the offender as a moral agent, to teach her that (and why) her behavior was morally wrong, so that she will reform herself. Thus we can even distinguish the education view from consequentialist accounts that aim at crime reduction through offender reform. For such consequentialist accounts, punishment’s justification is solely a matter of whether, on balance, it promotes these ends. The education view sets offender reform as an end, but it also grounds certain constraints on how we may appropriately pursue this end.

The education view, like the retributive censure view discussed earlier, views punishment as a communicative enterprise. Punishment communicates to offenders (indeed, to the community more generally) that what they have done is wrong. Thus on both accounts, punishment aims to encourage offenders to reform themselves. But whereas the retributive censure theorists view the message conveyed by punishment as justified insofar as it is deserved, education theorists contend that punishment is justified in virtue of what it aims to accomplish. In this respect, the education view sits more comfortably with standard consequentialist accounts than with retributivist views.

The education view conceives of punishment as aiming to confer a benefit on the offender, the benefit of moral education. This is not to say that punishment is not burdensome; as we have seen, its burdensomeness is an essential feature of punishment. But the burdens of punishment are intended to be ultimately beneficial. Thus education theorists roundly reject accounts according to which it is permissible (or even required) to inflict harm on those guilty of wrongdoing. Instead, education theorists hold, following Plato, that we should never do harm to anyone, even those who have wronged us.

Critics have raised various objections to the moral education view. Some are skeptical about whether punishment is the most effective means of moral education. Others point out that many (perhaps most) offenders are not apparently in need of moral education: many offenders realize they are doing something wrong but do so anyway. Even those who do not realize this as they are acting may recognize it soon afterward. Thus they do not seem to need moral education. Finally, some object that the education view is inappropriately paternalistic. According to the education view, after all, the state is justified in coercively restricting offenders’ liberties as a means to conferring a benefit (moral education) on them. Many liberal theorists are uncomfortable, however, with the idea that the state may coerce a person for her own benefit.

e. Hybrid Approaches

Finally, some theorists have responded to seemingly intractable disputes between consequentialists and retributivists by contending that the question of punishment’s permissibility is not actually a single question at all. Instead, establishing punishment’s permissibility involves answering a number of questions: questions about the aim of the practice, about its limits, and so on. Once we distinguish different questions that bear on punishment’s permissibility, we can then recognize that these questions may be answered by appeal to different moral considerations. What emerges is a hybrid account of punishment’s permissibility.

The most famous articulation of a hybrid view comes from H. L. A. Hart (1968), although there have been numerous attempts to develop such accounts both before and after Hart. The specifics of these accounts vary somewhat, but in general the point has been to distinguish the question of punishment’s aim (Hart called this the “general justifying aim”) from the question of how we must constrain our pursuit of that aim. The first question, about punishment’s aim, is usually answered according to consequentialist considerations, whereas the second question, about appropriate constraints, is typically answered by appeal to retributivist principles. In other words, if we are asking what reason could justify society in maintaining a system of punishment, the answer will appeal to punishment’s role in reducing crime, and thereby protecting the safety and security of community members. But if we ask how we may punish in particular cases, the answer will appeal to retributivist principles about proportionality and desert. Some have distinguished these questions in terms of the proper (consequentialist) rationale of legislators in criminalizing certain types of behaviors and the proper (retributivist) rationale of judges in imposing sentences on those who violate the criminal laws.

Although such views are sometimes described as “two-question” or “two-level” views, with the focus on consequentialist aims and retributivist constraints, there is no reason in principle why we should distinguish only two questions. As we saw earlier, punishment actually raises a host of specific normative questions, and so if we accept the general strategy of distinguishing questions and answering them by appeal to different considerations, then there is no reason in principle to stop with only a two-level hybrid theory. A hybrid view might offer distinct considerations in answer to a variety of questions: what is the positive aim of punishment? Does punishment violate offenders’ rights? How severely may we punish in particular cases? What mode of punishment is permissible in particular cases? And so on.

Also, although hybrid theories typically follow the pattern of aims and constraints, so that consequentialism provides the reason to have an institution of punishment and retributivism provides constraints on how we punish, there is no reason in principle why this could not be reversed. A hybrid theory might hold that suffering is an intrinsically appropriate (deserved) response to wrongdoing, but then endorse as a constraint, for example, that such retributive punishment should never tend to undermine offender reform.

Critics have charged hybrid accounts with being ad hoc and unstable. Although we can distinguish different questions related to punishment’s permissibility, it is a mistake to think that the answers to these questions are entirely independent of each other, so that we can answer each by appeal to entirely distinct considerations. For example, if we accept the consequentialist view that punishment’s general justifying aim is that it helps to deter crime, then why would considerations of deterrence not also play a role (even a decisive role) in how severely we punish in particular cases? Why should retributivist proportionality considerations govern in sentencing if these conflict with the pursuit of crime reduction through deterrence?

Retributivists, for their part, often argue that hybrid theories such as Hart’s, on which consequentialism supplies the justifying aim of punishment, relegate retributivism to a peripheral role. Retributivists, after all, tend to regard consequentialism as providing inappropriate reasons to punish. Characterizing retributivism’s role as providing constraints on the pursuit of consequentialist aims is thus unsatisfying to many retributivists.

6. Abolitionism

Some scholars are unpersuaded by any of the standardly articulated justifications of punishment. In fact, they conclude that punishment is morally unjustified, and thus that the practice should be abolished. An obvious question for abolitionists, of course, is what (if anything) should take the place of punishment. That is, how should society respond to those who behave in ways (committing tax fraud, burglary, assault, and so on) that currently are subject to punishment?

One option would be to endorse a model of treatment rather than punishment. On this model, an offender is viewed as manifesting some form of disease or pathology, and the appropriate response is thus to try to treat and cure the person rather than to punish her. Treatment differs from punishment, first, because it need not be burdensome. At least in principle, treatment could be pleasant. In practice, of course, treatment may often be burdensome—indeed, it may involve many of the same sorts of restrictions and burdens as we find with punishment. But even though courses of treatment may be burdensome, treatment does not typically convey the condemnation that is characteristic of punishment. After all, we generally think of those who are sick as warranting sympathy or concern, not condemnation.

Other options for abolitionists would be to endorse some model of restitutive or restorative, rather than criminal, justice. We might require that offenders make restitution to their victims, as defendants in civil lawsuits are often required to make restitution to plaintiffs (Boonin, 2008: 213-75). Or offenders might engage with victims in a process of restorative justice, one in which both offenders and victims play an active role, with aims of repairing the harms done and restoring the relationships that have been damaged (Braithwaite, 1999). Neither the restitutive nor the restorative models are centrally concerned with imposing intended, censuring burdens on offenders.

Not surprisingly, these alternative accounts are themselves subject to various objections. Critics of the treatment model, for instance, charge that it provides insufficient limits on what sort of treatment of offenders is permissible. The aim of “curing” diseased individuals might warrant quite severe treatment, both in scope and duration. Similarly, scholars have argued that the treatment model fails properly to respect offenders, as it treats them merely as patients rather than as moral agents who are responsible, and should be held responsible, for their actions (Morris, 1968).

Critics of the restitutive and restorative models may point out that some crimes do not clearly lend themselves to restitution or restoration: some crimes may seem so heinous that no victim restitution or restoration of relationships is possible. Other crimes do not have clearly specifiable victims. In addition, consequentialists may worry that practices of restitution or restoration may be inadequate as means of crime reduction if, for example, they are less effective than punishment at deterring potential offenders. Retributivists also may argue that something important is lost when we respond to wrongdoing solely with restitutive or restorative practices. Particularly for those who hold that an important function of punishment is to convey societal censure, restitution or restoration may seem inadequate as responses to crime insofar as they are not essentially concerned with censuring offenders. Alternatively, some retributivists argue that the restorative ideals can best be served by a system of retributive punishment (Duff, 2001; Bennett, 2008).

7. References and Further Reading

Alexander, Larry (1986). “Consent, Punishment, and Proportionality.” Philosophy & Public Affairs 15:2, 178-82.
Bennett, Christopher (2008). The Apology Ritual: A Philosophical Theory of Punishment. Cambridge, Cambridge University Press.
Bentham, Jeremy (1789). An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation. Reprinted in J. H. Burns and H. L. A. Hart (eds.), The Collected Works of Jeremy Bentham: An Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation. Oxford, Clarendon Press, 1996.
Boonin, David (2008). The Problem of Punishment. New York, Cambridge University Press.
Braithwaite, John (1999). “Restorative Justice: Assessing Optimistic and Pessimistic Accounts.” Crime and Justice 25, 1-127.
Cullen, Francis T. (2013). “Rehabilitation: Beyond Nothing Works.” Crime and Justice 42:1, 299-376.
Dagger, Richard (1993). “Playing Fair with Punishment.” Ethics 103, 473-88.
Dimock, Susan (1997). “Retributivism and Trust.” Law and Philosophy 16:1, 37-62.
Dolovich, Sharon (2009). “Cruelty, Prison Conditions, and the Eighth Amendment.” New York University Law Review 84:4, 881-979.
Duff, R. A. (2001). Punishment, Communication, and Community. Oxford, Oxford University Press.
Duff, R. A. (1986). Trials and Punishments. Cambridge, Cambridge University Press.
Falls, M. Margaret (1987). “Retribution, Reciprocity, and Respect for Persons.” Law and Philosophy 6, 25-51.
Feinberg, Joel (1965). “The Expressive Function of Punishment.” Monist 49:3, 397-423.
Goldman, Alan (1979). “The Paradox of Punishment.” Philosophy & Public Affairs 9:1, 42-58.
Hampton, Jean (1984). “The Moral Education Theory of Punishment.” Philosophy & Public Affairs 13, 208-38.
Hart, H. L. A. (1968). Punishment and Responsibility: Essays in the Philosophy of Law. New York, Oxford University Press.
Hegel, G. W. F. (1821). Philosophy of Right. Trans. S. W. Dyde. Reprinted by Dover Philosophical Classics, 2005.
Henrichson, Christian, and Ruth Delaney (2012). The Price of Prisons: What Incarceration Costs Taxpayers. Report of the Vera Institute of Justice, Center on Sentencing and Corrections.
Kant, Immanuel (1797). The Metaphysics of Morals. In Immanuel Kant, Practical Philosophy, trans. and ed. Mary J. Gregor. Cambridge, Cambridge University Press, 1996.
Kleinig, John (1973). Punishment and Desert. The Hague, Martinus Nijhoff.
Lippke, Richard (2001). “Criminal Offenders and Right Forfeiture.” Journal of Social Philosophy 32:1, 78-89.
Mauer, Marc, and Meda Chesney-Lind (eds.) (2002). Invisible Punishment: The Collateral Consequences of Mass Imprisonment. The New Press, 2002.
McCloskey, H. J. (1957). “An Examination of Restricted Utilitarianism.” The Philosophical Review 66:4, 466-85.
McDermott, Daniel (2001). “The Permissibility of Punishment.” Law and Philosophy 20, 403-32.
Montague, Phillip (1995). Punishment as Societal Self-Defense. Lanham, Md., Rowman & Littlefield.
Moore, G. E. (1903). Principia Ethica. Cambridge, Cambridge University Press.
Moore, Michael S. (1987). “The moral worth of retribution.” In Ferdinand Schoeman (ed.), Responsibility, Character, and the Emotions: New Essays in Moral Psychology. Cambridge, Cambridge University Press.
Morris, Christopher (1991). “Punishment and Loss of Moral Standing.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 21, 53-79.
Morris, Herbert (1968). “Persons and Punishment.” Monist 52, 475-501.
Moskos, Peter (2011). In Defense of Flogging. New York, Basic Books.
Murphy, Jeffrie G. (1973). “Marxism and Retribution.” Philosophy & Public Affairs 2:3, 217-43.
Nagin, Daniel S. (2013). “Deterrence in the Twenty-First Century.” Crime and Justice 42:1, 199-263.
Nino, C. S. (1983). “A Consensual Theory of Punishment.” Philosophy & Public Affairs 12:4, 289-306.
Plato (1997). Crito. In Plato: Complete Works Indianapolis, Hackett Publishing Company, Inc.
Reiman, Jeffrey H. (1985). “Justice, Civilization, and the Death Penalty: Answering van den Haag.” Philosophy & Public Affairs 14:2, 115-48.
Ross, W. D. (1930). The Right and the Good. Oxford, Oxford University Press.
Shafer-Landau, Russ (2000). “Retributivism and Desert.” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 81, 189-214.
Simmons, John A. (1991). “Locke and the Right to Punish.” Philosophy & Public Affairs 20:4, 311-49.
Smart, J. J. C. (1973). “An outline of a system of utilitarian ethics.” In J. J. C. Smart and Bernard Williams (eds.), Utilitarianism: For and Against. Cambridge, Cambridge University Press.
Tadros, Victor (2011). The Ends of Harm: The Moral Foundations of Criminal Law. Oxford, Oxford University Press.
Tonry, Michael (2011). “Proportionality, Parsimony, and Interchangeability of Punishments.” In Michael Tonry (ed.), Why Punish? How Much? A Reader on Punishment. Oxford, Oxford University Press.
Tonry, Michael (2006). “Purposes and Functions of Sentencing.” Crime and Justice 34:1, 1-52.
Von Hirsch, Andrew (1993). Censure and Sanctions. Oxford, Oxford University Press.
Wellman, Christopher Heath (2009). “Rights and State Punishment.” Journal of Philosophy 106:8, 419-39.
Zaibert, Leo (2006). Punishment and Retribution. Aldershot, U.K., Ashgate.

Author Information

Zachary Hoskins
Email: zachary.hoskins@nottingham.ac.uk
University of Nottingham
United Kingdom

Intentionality

If I think about a piano, something in my thought picks out a piano. If I talk about cigars, something in my speech refers to cigars. This feature of thoughts and words, whereby they pick out, refer to, or are about things, is intentionality. In a word, intentionality is aboutness.

Many mental states exhibit intentionality. If I believe that the weather is rainy today, this belief of mine is about today’s weather—that it is rainy. Desires are similarly directed at, or about things: if I desire a mosquito to buzz off, my desire is directed at the mosquito, and the possibility that it depart. Imaginings seem to be directed at particular imaginary scenarios, while regrets are directed at events or objects in the past, as are memories. And perceptions seem to be, similarly, directed at or about the objects we perceptually encounter in our environment. We call mental states that are directed at things in this way ‘intentional states’.

The major role played by intentionality in affairs of the mind led Brentano (1884) to regard intentionality as “the mark of the mental”; a necessary and sufficient condition for mentality. But some non-mental phenomena seem to display intentionality too—pictures, signposts, and words, for example. Nevertheless, the intentionality of these phenomena seems to be derived from the intentionality of the mind that produces them. A sound is only a word if it has been conferred with meaning by the intentions of a speaker or perhaps a community of speakers; while a painting, however abstract, seems only to have a subject matter insofar as its painter intends it to. Whether or not all mental phenomena are intentional, then, it certainly seems to be the case that all intentional phenomena are mental in origin.

The root of the word ‘intentionality’ reflects the notion that it expresses, deriving from the Latin intentio, meaning ‘directed at’. Intentionality has been studied since antiquity and has generated numerous debates that can be broadly categorized into three areas that are discussed in the following sections:

Section 1 concerns the intentional relation: the relation between intentional states and their objects. Here we aim to answer the question “What determines why any given intentional state is about one thing and not another?” For example, what makes a thought about a sheep about that sheep? Does the thought look like the sheep? Or does it perhaps have a causal origin in an encounter with the sheep?

Section 2 explores the nature of the objects of intentional states. Are these objects independent of us, or somehow constituted by the nature of our minds? Do they have to exist, or can we have thoughts about non-existent objects like The Grinch?

Section 3 explores the nature of intentional states themselves. For example, are intentional states essentially rational states, such that only rational creatures can have them? Or might intentional states be necessarily conscious states? And is it possible to give a naturalized theory of intentionality that appeals only to facts describable in the natural sciences?

This article explores these questions, and the dominant theories that have been designed to answer them.

The Intentional Relation
1. Formal Theories of Intentionality
2. Problems for Forms, and the Causal Alternative
Intentional Objects
Intentional States
References and Further Reading

1. The Intentional Relation

If I am thinking about horses, what is it about my thought that makes it about horses and not, say, sheep? That is, in what relation do intentional states stand to their objects? This is the question “What is the intentional relation?” There have been many answers proposed to this question, and a broad division can be discerned in the history of philosophy between what can be called ‘formal’ and ‘causal’ theories.

a. Formal Theories of Intentionality

One answer to the question is that mental states refer to the things they do because of the intrinsic features of those mental states. The earliest version of this theory is based on Plato’s theory of forms. Plato held that apart from the matter (hyle) they are composed of, all things have another aspect, which he called their ‘form’ (morphê). All horses, for example, although individually made of different material, have something in common – and this is their form. The exact meaning of Plato’s ‘form’ is a controversial issue. On one reading, two things have the same form or are ‘conformal’ if they share the same shape; on a broader interpretation, two things are conformal if there is a one-to-one mapping between the essential features of the two—as there is between a building and an architect’s blueprint for the building. Plato held that when we think about an object, we have the form of the object in our mind, so that our thought literally shares the form of the object. Aristotle further developed this theory, arguing that in perception (sensu) the form of an object perceived is transmitted from the object to the mind of the perceiver. In the Middle Ages Thomas Aquinas defended and elaborated Aristotle’s theory, and in the Early Modern period the theory finds an heir in the work of the ‘British Empiricists’ Locke and Hume. Locke and Hume argued that ‘ideas’, which they considered to be the fundamental components of thought, refer to their objects because they are images of those objects, impressed on the mind through the action of the perceptual faculties.

Although images or shapes may play a role in thought, it is generally accepted that they cannot provide a complete account of intentionality. The relation between an image and its object is a relation of resemblance. But this presents a difficulty that was first raised against the formal theory by Ockham in the Middle Ages (King, 2007). The problem is that the relation of resemblance is ambiguous in a way that the intentional relation cannot be. An image of a man walking up a hill also resembles a man walking backwards down a hill (Wittgenstein, 1953), whereas a thought about a man walking up a hill is not also a thought about a man walking backwards down a hill. Similarly, while an image of Mahatma Gandhi resembles Mahatma Gandhi, it also resembles everyone who resembles Mahatma Gandhi (Goodman, 1976). Thoughts about Mahatma Gandhi on the other hand, are not thoughts about anyone who looks like Mahatma Gandhi.

An alternative formal model that seems to avoid this problem appeals to descriptions (Frege 1892, Russell 1912). This view holds that if I am thinking about something, then I must have in mind a description that uniquely identifies that thing. Descriptions seem to avoid the problem of ambiguity faced by images. There may be many people who resemble Mahatma Gandhi, but probably only one person that satisfies the description ‘the Indian Nationalist leader assassinated on the 30^th of January 1948’. Since the ‘descriptivist’ account takes concepts to refer to their objects by describing them, so that the features of a concept somehow correspond to the features of its object, the descriptivist theory is arguably also a formal theory of intentionality.

In addition to answering the question why an intentional state refers to one object and not another, the formal approach is also helpful in explaining how thinkers understand what it is they are thinking about. One thing that we seem to be able to do when we have mental states that are directed at particular things objects is to reflect upon different aspects of those objects, reason about them, describe them, and even make reliable predictions about them. For example, if I understand what horses are, and what sheep are, I ought to be in a position to tell you about their differences, and perhaps make good predictions about their behavior. If intentional states are conformal with their objects, we have some explanation for how such understanding is possible, since the form of the object the intentional state is directed at should be available to me if I reflect upon my own thoughts.

And we have another reason still for expecting that thoughts have a formal component. Frege (1892) observed that we can have multiple thoughts about the same thing, without realizing that we are thinking of the same thing in each case. The Ancient Greeks believed that Hesperus and Phosphorus (two Greek names for Venus) were two different stars in the sky, one of which appeared in the morning, while the other appeared in the evening. As a result they believed that Hesperus rises in the evening while simultaneously believing that Phosphorus does not. Of course Hesperus and Phosphorus, as it turns out, are the same object – the planet Venus, which rises both in the morning and in the evening. And so the Ancient Greeks had two contradictory beliefs about Venus, without realizing that both beliefs were about the same thing. The upshot is that it is possible for us to have distinct concepts that pick out the same thing without our knowing.

Frege proposed as an explanation that our concepts must vary in more ways than in what they refer to. They also vary, he proposed, in what he called their ‘sense’, so that two concepts could refer to the same object while differing in sense. He described the sense as the ‘mode of presentation’ of the object that a concept picks out. It would appear that by ‘mode of presentation’ he meant something like a description of the object. So, while the reference of someone’s hesperus and phosphorus concepts might be the same, the sense of hesperus might be ‘the star that appears in the evening’, while the sense of phosphorus could be ‘the star that appears in the morning’. Since it is perfectly rational to suppose that the object that satisfies the description ‘the star that appears in the morning’ might not be the same as the object that satisfies the description ‘the star that appears in the evening’, we now have an explanation for how one could have two concepts that pick out the same thing without knowing.

Supposing that the intentional relation is one of conformality, then, allows us to explain i) why a thought refers to what it does, (ii) how we can have introspective knowledge of the things we think about, and (iii) how two or more of our concepts could pick out the same thing without our knowing. But there are problems facing the formal approach, which have lead many to look for alternatives.

b. Problems for Forms, and the Causal Alternative

The formal theory of intentionality faces two major objections.

The first objection, sometimes called ‘the problem of ignorance and error’, is that the descriptions we have at our disposal of the objects we think about might be insufficient to uniquely identify those objects. Putnam (1975) articulated this objection using a now famous thought-experiment. Suppose that you are thinking of water. If the descriptive theory is right, for example, you must have at your disposal a description that uniquely distinguishes water from all other things. For most of us – chemists aside – such a description will amount to something like ‘the clear drinkable liquid in the rivers, lakes, and taps around here’. But suppose, suggests Putnam, that there is another planet far away from here, which looks to its inhabitants just like Earth looks to us. On that planet, let’s call it Twin-Earth, there is a clear drinkable liquid that the inhabitants of the planet refer to (coincidentally) as ‘water’, but that is in fact a different chemical substance; rather than H₂O, it has a different chemical composition—let’s call it XYZ. If this were true, we should expect that the description most people here on Earth are in a position to give of what we call ‘water’ will be just the same as the description the inhabitants of the other planet give of what they call ‘water’. But, by hypothesis, when we think about water we are thinking of the substance on our planet, H₂O, and when they think of what they call ‘water’, they are thinking of a different thing—XYZ. As a result, it would seem that descriptions are not sufficient to explain what we are thinking of, since a member of either of these groups will give the same description for what they call ‘water’, even though their thoughts pick out different substances. This is the ‘ignorance’ part of the problem—we often don’t have enough descriptive knowledge of the things we think about to uniquely identify those things. The ‘error’ part is that it often turns out to be the case that our beliefs about the things we think about are false. For example, many people believe tomatoes are vegetables not fruit; and as a result, the description they will give of ‘tomato’ will include the claim that tomatoes are vegetables. If these people are indeed thinking of tomatoes, so the argument goes, it cannot be as a result of their being in possession of a description that picks out tomatoes, since no tomato truly falls under the description ‘fruit’.

The second difficulty for the formal accounts, specifically directed at the descriptive account, is that descriptions do not identify the essential nature of the things they pick out, whereas many words and concepts do (Searle 1958, Kripke 1980). The description someone might offer of Hesperus could be ‘the brightest celestial object in the evening sky’. But it is perfectly coherent to suppose that Hesperus could have existed without having been visible in the evening. It could have drifted into a different orbital pattern, or have been occluded by a belt of asteroids, and therefore never have been visible in the evening. This description does not, therefore, capture an essential feature of Hesperus. The term ‘Hesperus’ in our thoughts, on the other hand, does pick out an essential feature of Hesperus—being Hesperus. That this is an important difference can be seen when we realize that concepts and descriptions seem to behave differently in thoughts about counterfactual possibilities—or, alternative ways the world could have turned out. For example, the thought ‘Hesperus could have failed to have been the brightest celestial object in the evening sky’, is clearly true—this could have been the case had it drifted into a different orbital pattern. But the thought ‘Hesperus could have failed to have been Hesperus’, is not true: there is no way the world could have turned out such that Hesperus could have failed to have been itself. The name ‘Hesperus’ therefore identifies the essence of Hesperus—what it couldn’t fail to be; but the description does not. So now we have a further reason for thinking that concepts are not cognitively equivalent to descriptions—since they behave differently in thoughts about counterfactual possibility.

As an alternative to descriptions, images, or forms of any sort, Putnam (1975) and Kripke (1980) propose a ‘causal’ model of intentionality. On this alternative model, our concepts do not have intrinsic formal features that determine what they refer to. Rather, a concept picks out the thing that originally caused it to occur in the mind of a thinker, or the thing it is causally related to in the mind-independent world. On this view, if I have a concept that picks out horses, this concept must have initially been caused to occur in me by a physical encounter with horses. If I have a concept that picks out water, the concept must have been caused to occur in me by a causal interaction with water. And if I have a concept that picks out Hesperus, this concept must have a causal origin in my apprehension of Hesperus, perhaps by seeing it in the sky.

We can see how the causal theory can be used to address the two major objections to the formal theory. Firstly, on the causal account, the ‘water’ thoughts of those on Earth can be distinguished from the ‘water’ thoughts of those on Twin-Earth: the substance Earthlings are causally interacting with when they have ‘water’ thoughts is H₂O, while the substance that Twin-Earthlings are causally interacting with is XYZ—explaining why the thoughts of each thinker refer to different things, even though the descriptions they might offer of those things are identical. Similarly, I can causally interact with water, or tomatoes, even if I have false beliefs about these things, so the causal model allows that the descriptions I might offer of the things I think about can be false. The causal model therefore seems to handle the problem of ignorance and error. Secondly, if we reject that my hesperus concept is cognitively equivalent to a description, the worry that the description fails to identify the essence of the object simply doesn’t arise. The causal model therefore also seems to handle the problem concerning reference to essential properties (sometimes called the ‘modal problem’).

However, the causal model has trouble explaining some of the things the formal model was designed to explain (see last paragraph of Section 1a above). Firstly, the causal model has trouble explaining (ii), how we can reflect on the objects of our thoughts, and say something about them. If concepts have no formal component that somehow describes their objects this becomes mysterious. The causal model also fails to explain (iii), how we can have multiple thoughts about the same thing without realizing. While formal models can explain this by holding that different concepts can be cognitively equivalent to different descriptions of the same thing, the causal model has trouble explaining this. Since the thoughts of an Ancient Greek about hesperus, and the thoughts of an Ancient Greek about phosphorus have a causal origin in the same object, namely Venus, the causal relation that stands between these concepts and their object is identical in each case; as a result, there ought to be no difference between the concepts on the causal model.

The formal and causal models therefore each provide good explanations for one set of phenomena, but run into trouble in explaining another.

Perhaps the best account of the intentional relation will be one that draws on aspects of both theories—something that so-called ‘two-dimensional’ accounts of intentionality aim to do (Chalmers 1996, 2006, Lewis 1997, Jackson 1998). On this approach, although it is necessary to know what environment a thinker is causally connected to in order to know what her thoughts refer to, this need not rule out that her concepts also have a formal component. The trick is to find a formal component that does not run into the problems raised by the causal theorist. To deal with the problem of error, for example, it has been proposed that the formal component of a concept might be a description of the appearance of the object the concept refers to (Searle 1983). Although I can be wrong that the things my tomato concept picks out are vegetables, it would seem that I cannot be mistaken that they are apparently red shiny edible objects—since I cannot be wrong about how the world appears to me. Such content would therefore avoid the problem of error—these descriptions couldn’t turn out to be false. To deal with the problem of ignorance, where my descriptive knowledge fails to uniquely determine which thing I am thinking of, it has been proposed to write the causal origin of my experience into the formal component. So, my concept water might be cognitively equivalent not just to ‘the apparently clear drinkable liquid in the lakes and rivers’, which fails to distinguish the water on Earth from the water on Twin-Earth, but to ‘the stuff causing my current experiences of an apparently drinkable liquid in the lakes and rivers’ (Searle 1983). This description, it would seem, does indeed distinguish water from Twin-Earth water, since only water is the causal source of my experiences (because I am on Earth, not Twin-Earth). And to get descriptions to behave the same way as concepts in thoughts about counterfactual possibility, it has been proposed to include the specification ‘actual’ in the descriptive content of a concept (Davies and Humberstone 1980). Although it is true that ‘the brightest celestial object in the evening sky could have failed to have been Hesperus’, it seems not to be true that ‘the actual thing that is the brightest celestial object in the evening sky could have failed to have been Hesperus’. By including ‘actual’ in the description, we can therefore get the description to behave in the same way as the concept in counterfactual thoughts. In sum, the descriptive content of a concept like water would be something like ‘the actual stuff causing my experience of an apparently clearly drinkable liquid in the lakes and rivers’. Such content, it is hoped, can account for the phenomena formal models explain without running into the difficulties faced by earlier formal accounts. Whether these modifications really succeed in handling the problems raised by the causal theorist is, however, a topic of ongoing controversy (see Soames 2001, 2005 and Recanati 2013 for recent defenses of the causal approach; see Chalmers 2006 for a defense of the two-dimensional approach, and an advanced overview of the debate).

2. Intentional Objects

Having seen some of the layout of the debate about what determines the object of any intentional state, we can now consider issues that arise when we consider the objects themselves. Do they all have something in common that makes them appropriate as objects of intentional states? Might there be non-existent intentional objects? Do our thoughts connect directly with these objects or only indirectly, via our senses?

a. Intentional Inexistence

Franz Brentano has been mentioned already in this article, in part because his work set the tone for much of the debate over intentionality in the 20^th century. One of his claims was that the objects of intentional states have a special type of existence, which he called ‘intentional inexistence’. Whether he meant by that a special sort of existence ‘in’ the intentional, or that intentional objects do not exist, is debated. Supposing that intentionality is always directed at objects that do not exist, however, is particularly problematic, and we’ll look at the difficulties it raises in the next section. So first I’ll explore the possibility that Brentano supposed that intentional objects have a special sort of existence as objects of intentional states.

This idea had a particularly strong influence on the work of Edmund Husserl, who founded a branch of philosophy of mind known as phenomenology, which he conceived of as the study of experience. Husserl emphasizes that the objects of thought have a particular character insofar as they are objects of thought. First, they have to be related to other concepts and ideas in the mind of the thinker in a coherent way, a feature he refers to as their ‘noematic’ character. If our ideas of the objects we encounter in experience conflict too severely with the constraints that our understanding of how the world works, those ideas will disintegrate (something he calls ‘noematic explosion’). Visual illusions present a good example of this. If we are presented with an object that appears to be a cube sitting on a flat surface, we will approach the object with certain expectations, for example that if we turn our heads to one side we will see the side of the cube now out of view, if we grab a hold of it our grasp will be resisted, and so on. If the object turns out to be an image painted in such a way that it only appears as a cube from a certain angle, when we discover this by trying to pick it up, for example, the idea we are working with of the object will disintegrate. It is in this sense that Husserl at least took the objects of thought to have a special sort of existence as objects of thought (Føllesdal 1992, Mooney 2010).

Husserl (1900) proposed that we can study the nature of the constraints that the character of our mind places on the possible objects of thought through a method he calls ‘phenomenological reduction’, which involves uncovering the conditions of our awareness of objects through reflection on the nature of experience. The approach inherits a great deal from Kant’s transcendental idealism, since in both cases we are required to recognize that the nature of our minds may impose a very specific character on objects as we encounter them in experience – a character that we should not be tempted to assume is imposed on our experience by facts about the external world. The idea that the nature of our minds imposes constraints on the way we experience the world is in fact a claim that is increasingly widely accepted, and phenomenology has become an area of particular interest for the emerging field of cognitive science (see for example Varela, Thompson and Rosch 1991).

b. Thinking About Things that Do Not Exist

The second possible interpretation of Brentano’s claim – that intentional objects do not exist – is particularly problematic. Whether or not all objects of thought are non-existent, it certainly seems that many are, including those that are obviously fictitious (The Grinch, Sherlock Holmes) or likely non-existent even if many people believe in them (Faeries, Hell). But deep puzzles arise when we consider what it means to say something about a non-existent object. Can we, for example, coherently state that Santa Claus has flying reindeer? If he does not exist, how can it be true that he has flying reindeer? Can we indeed even coherently state that Santa Claus does not exist? If he does, our statement is false. But if he does not exist, then it seems that our claim is not about anything – and hence apparently meaningless. Another way of putting the puzzle involves definite descriptions. It seems reasonable to say the following:

(1) The fairy king does not exist

But upon further consideration 1) is quite puzzling, because the appearance of the definite article ‘the’ in that statement seems to presuppose that there is such a thing as the fairy king to which we refer.

Russell proposed a famous solution to this puzzle. It involves first analyzing definite descriptions to show how we can use these to express claims about things that do not exist, and second to show that most terms that we use to make negative existential claims are actually definite descriptions in disguise. The first move is accomplished by Russell’s analysis of the logical structure of definite descriptions. He takes definite descriptions to have the logical form ‘a unique thing that has the properties F and G’. So, the definite description ‘the fairy king’ in 1) on Russell’s reading is logically equivalent to the description ‘a unique thing that is both a king and a fairy’. Notably, this eliminates the term ‘the’ from the description, and with it the presupposition that there is a fairy king. And rather than being meaningless, the claim that such a thing does not exist is true, if no unique thing exists that is both a king and a fairy:

(2) There is no unique thing that is a king and a fairy

And, of course, false if there is a unique thing that is a king and a fairy. The second step of Russell’s solution is to hold that most referring terms in ordinary language are actually disguised definite descriptions. The term ‘Santa Claus’ on this view is actually a sort of shorthand for a description, perhaps ‘the man with the flying reindeer’. And this description is in turn to be analyzed as Russell proposes, so that the claim ‘Santa Claus does not exist’ in fact amounts to the denial that a unique individual that has the properties of being a man and having flying reindeer exists. And that seems to be perfectly coherent.

Are there any terms, in language or thought, on this account, that are not descriptions? Russell’s view is that the simplest terms in thought, out of which definite descriptions are composed, are not descriptions but singular terms, whose meaning is simply the object they refer to. These are demonstrative terms like ‘that’ and ‘this’, and our concepts of sensible properties like colors, sounds and smells. The meaning of these terms are fixed by what Russell called ‘acquaintance’ – they are conferred with meaning as a result of a direct interaction between the thinker and thing referred to, for example when we point at a color and simply think to ourselves ‘that’. These terms are only meaningful if in fact there are objects in the world to which they refer. Notice that on this view the second interpretation of Brentano’s claim – that in general the objects of thought do not exist – will become impossible to maintain. Since the descriptions that can pick out non-existent objects are composed of terms that are only meaningful if they refer to existing things, the objects of at least singular terms must exist for the view to make any sense.

c. Direct versus Indirect Intentionality

Even supposing that many objects of thought do exist, a further question arises as to whether the objects that we encounter in experience are products of our minds, or mind-independent objects. The view that the objects of experience are mind-dependent can be motivated by two complementary considerations. First, it seems reasonable to suppose that two different persons’ experiences in the same environment can be different. A color-blind person and a person with perfect color vision might have visually very different experiences in the same environment. Conversely, it seems that one person’s experiences in two very different environments could be the same. When I look at an oasis in the desert, I have a visual experience that might seem to be identical to the experience I have when faced with a mirage, even though these two environments are very different.

These considerations have lead many to argue that our experiences – even those of ordinary objects – are mediated by what have been called ‘sense data’. According to the sense-data theorist, what we immediately experience are not mind-independent objects, but sense-data that are produced at least partly by our minds. This allows us to explain the two puzzles considered above. If what we encounter in experience are sense data and not mind-independent objects, then two people could have very different experiences in the same mind-independent environment, and correlatively, one person could have two indistinguishable experiences in two very different mind-independent environments. Note that these sense-data may correspond very closely to the way things stand in the mind-independent world around us, so the view need not imply that our interactions with the world should be dysfunctional.

This ‘indirect’ theory of perception, however, raises worries about our knowledge of the world. When we say of the ketchup before us that it is red, are we saying this about the ketchup, or about the sense-data that we experience as a result of looking at the ketchup? If we really only experience the sense-data, this would suggest that most of the beliefs we have about the world around us are false. We believe our intentional states are directed at mind-independent objects, but the indirect theory suggests that they are not. We believe we’ve seen red ketchup, but this theory suggests that in fact we’ve only seen sense-data of red ketchup. And if we only have experience of sense-data produced by our minds, this seems to imply that we have never really had any direct experience with the world. It suggests that we’ve never seen waterfalls, smelled flowers, or heard the voices of our friends, but have only experienced sense-data of these things.

An early reply to these concerns involves jettisoning the indirect-theory of perception, and adopting the view that there are no sense-data or any other kind of representations mediating our experiences of the objects around us – a view sometimes called ‘naive realism’, and associated with Moore (1903). But on this approach, explanations of hallucinations or variations between different individuals’ experiences of the same objects are strained. An interesting middle ground is known as disjunctivism (Hinton 1967, Snowdon 1981, McDowell 1994, Martin 2002). The disjunctivist holds that the argument for the indirect theory of perception based on hallucinations is fallacious. Although the experiences of the oasis and the mirage might well be indistinguishable for the subject of the experience, this need not imply that the experiences are really the same. Rather, since one experience is the product of an encounter with an oasis, and the other is not, there is a difference between the experiences—it is just one that the subject is unable to identify. As a result, the disjunctivist holds that when we have veridical experiences, we have direct encounters with objects in the world, and when we have hallucinations, what we experience are sense-data produced by our mind. The disjunctivist view, then, at least allows us to see that we might not be forced into the indirect theory of perception by the existence of hallucinations.

3. Intentional States

So far we have looked at the question what determines the object of any given intentional state, and the question what is the nature of the objects of intentional states. What we have not examined is whether there are broad conditions for a state to count as intentional in the first place. Are only rational creatures capable of intentional states? Are intentional states essentially conscious states? Can we provide an account of intentional states in natural terms?

a. Intentionality and Reason

The centrality of reason to the intentional is an important strand in Kant’s famous Critique of Pure Reason (1787), and has informed an influential line of thinking taken up in the work of Sellars (1956), Strawson (1959) and Brandom (1996). Kant argues that in the apprehension of any object, an individual must have a range of concepts at her disposal that she can use to rationally assess the nature of the object apprehended. In order to apprehend a material object, for example, a thinker must understand what causation is. If she does not understand what causation is, she will not understand that if the material object were to be pushed, it would move. Or if it were picked up and thrown against a wall, it would not go straight through the wall or disappear, but would be caused by the solidity of the wall to bounce backward. Without having the capacity to understand any of these issues, Kant argued, it would not be true to say that an individual apprehends the material object.

The appeal to the necessity of reason for concept-possession often goes hand in hand with the claim that our intentional states are all interdependent. Since I cannot have the concept material object, without the concept cause, then the two concepts depend on one another—and this may be the case for all our concepts, leading to a view known as ‘concept holism’. This raises a puzzle, however, that many think undermines the view. The concern is that if our concepts are interdependent in this way, then if any of my concepts change, all the others change with it. If for example I can only grasp the concept horse if I have the concept animal, then if my animal concept changes in some way, my horse concept will change along with it. If we couple this with the observation that our beliefs about the world are almost constantly being updated, as our day to day experience progresses, then the worry arises that we could literally never have the same thought twice. Any time my beliefs about the world change they will change at least one of my concepts, and if all of my concepts are interdependent, then whenever any of my beliefs change, they will all change. As a result, although it might seem to me that I had thoughts about horses both yesterday and today, this would not be true since the concept that occurred in my thoughts yesterday would not be the same concept as occurred in my thoughts today. Some who think this is an intolerable result adopt the view known as ‘concept atomism’, which holds that our concepts do not stand in essential relations to one another, but only to the external objects they refer to (Fodor and Lepore 1992). Atomism, however, seems to be committed to the claim that I could possess the concept horse without knowing what an animal is, and to the holist that seems as intolerable as concept holism seems to the atomist.

b. Intentionality and Intensionality

Another feature of intentional states that is sometimes thought to be essential is what is called ‘intensionality’ (with an ‘s’). This is the phenomenon whereby the objects of thought are presented to a thinker from a certain point of view—what Frege called a ‘mode of presentation’. We already encountered one of the puzzles that motivate this idea above discussing Frege’s puzzle, where the answer to the question why two concepts can be co-referential without a thinker knowing is proposed to be the fact that a thinker’s concepts pick out an object under a particular mode of presentation.

The potentially essential connection between intentionality and intensionality can be seen when we try to describe someone’s intentional states without bearing in mind their point of view. Recall the beliefs that Lois Lane has about Superman. Lois Lane believes she loves Superman, but does not believe she loves her colleague Clark Kent, not knowing that Superman is Clark Kent. 1) seems like a true description of Lois Lane’s belief about Superman:

(1) Lois Lane believes that she loves Superman

If (1) is true, however, and Superman is Clark Kent, then we might expect that we would state exactly the same thing if we substitute the name ‘Clark Kent’ for the name ‘Superman’ in (1). That would give us (2):

(2) Lois Lane believes that she loves Clark Kent

To many, however, it seems that there is something wrong with (2). If Superman walks into the room in his Clark Kent disguise, Lois will not light up as she does when he walks in without the disguise. If Lois is told that Clark Kent is in trouble, she will not infer that the man she loves in is in trouble. A natural explanation for these facts is that the belief reported in (1) is not the same as the belief reported in (2). Since our reports about the beliefs of others may be false if we do not take into consideration the mode of presentation under which the objects of those beliefs are thought of by the holder of the belief, it seems like intensionality may be an essential feature of intentional states.

Another phenomenon that seems to tie intentionality to intensionality is shown in the fact that we cannot infer from the fact that someone has a belief about x, that x exists. This is unusual, since for most cases of predication (ascription of a property to an object), we can infer from the fact that we have ascribed a property to an object that the object exists. For example, if the claim that the sun is bright is true, it would seem to follow that there must be such a thing as the sun. That is, predication ordinarily permits existential generalization: if a property is truly predicated of an object, then some object with that property exists (Fa → ∃xFx). However, from the fact that I believe the sun is bright, it does not follow that there is such a thing as the sun. After all, I might just as easily believe, as Kant did, that phlogiston is the cause of combustion, but as we know, there is no such thing as phlogiston. If we combine these two claims we get a third claim: that neither the assertion nor the denial of a report of an intentional state entails that the proposition the intentional state is about is true or false. For example, we could truly assert that Kant believed that phlogiston causes combustion, but this does not entail that it is true that phlogiston causes combustion.

Chisholm (1956) thought that an intentional state is any state whose description has these three features: failure to preserve truth given the inter-substitution of co-referring terms (such as ‘Superman’ for ‘Clark Kent’), failure to allow existential generalization entailment (the existence of the intentional object), and failure to entail the truth of the object proposition (such as the belief ascribed to the thinker).

However, these criteria do not seem to hold up for all intentional states. While it does not follow from the fact that Kant believes phlogiston causes combustion that there is such a thing as phlogiston, or that it is true that phlogiston causes combustion, these things would seem to follow if it we held that Kant knew that phlogiston causes combustion. That is, it does not seem possible to have knowledge of things that do not exist, or of propositions that are not true, so if someone knows Fa, then an object with the property F must exist, and if someone knows that p, then p must be true. Knowledge ascriptions therefore do not satisfy the second and third conditions proposed by Chisholm, and yet they are surely intentional states. And perceptual states, which also seem to be intentional states, do not obviously satisfy any of the conditions. You cannot perceive something that does not exist, and you cannot perceive that p is the case if p is not the case, and additionally it is possible to intersubstitute co-referring terms in descriptions of perceptions. If it is true that Jimi Hendrix saw Bob Dylan at Woodstock, then it is true that Jimi Hendrix saw Robert Zimmerman at Woodstock, because Bob Dylan is Robert Zimmerman. Hendrix might not have believed that he saw Robert Zimmerman, or have known that he saw Robert Zimmerman, but nevertheless, if he saw Bob Dylan, he saw Robert Zimmerman. And perceptual states also seem quite clearly to be intentional states.

There is surely an important connection between intentionality and intensionality, then, but how it works in detail is clearly more complex than Chisholm thought.

c. Intentionality and Consciousness

A state of a creature is a conscious state if there is something it is like for the creature to be in that state. There is something it feels like for a person to have their hand pressed onto a hot grill, but there is not anything it feels like for a cheese sandwich to be pressed onto a hot grill. Do these conscious states have an essential connection to intentionality? Might intentionality depend on consciousness, or vice versa?

Some views take conscious states to be a kind of intentional state—thus holding that consciousness depends on intentionality. There are good prima facie grounds for holding this view. It is not obvious how I could be conscious of a horse being before me without my conscious state being directed at, or about, the horse. The idea that conscious states are a species of intentional state can be teased out in various ways. We might say that conscious content is simply intentional content that is available for rational evaluation, so that if I am conscious that it is raining, I have a mental state about the rain that I can reflect upon (Dennett 1991). Or we could say that conscious states always represent the world as being in such-and-such a way, so that if I am conscious that it is raining, I have a mental state that represents the world as being rainy right now (Tye 1995). Or, that conscious states are states that are naturally selected to indicate to a subject that her environment is in such and such a way, and again therefore intentional (Dretske 1995).

However the view that there are ‘raw feels’ in our conscious experience that do not say anything at all about the world also has considerable pull. For example, you might think that when you’re conscious of the warmth of the sun on your face you can indeed reflect upon the fact and judge that it is sunny where you are, but that the warm feeling itself does not tell you that it is sunny. On this view there are two things here, the warm feeling, and the subsequent judgment ‘it is sunny’, which although formed on the basis of the feeling is nevertheless distinct from it (Ryle 1949, Sellars 1956, Peacocke 1983). On this view, conscious states are not intentional in themselves, since they do not in themselves represent the world as being in any particular way, even if they can be used to make judgments about the world.

On the other hand, we might think the dependence runs the other way: that intentional states depend on consciousness. We might suppose that it is hard to make sense of the claim that we could have mental states about the world without the world feeling any way at all to us. Searle (1983), for example, thinks that our notion of the mind essentially involves the notion of consciousness, so he denies that there could be essentially unconscious mental states. To deal with the case of beliefs or desires that I am not currently consciously entertaining, he argues that these must at least have the potential to become conscious in order to be properly understood as mental states.

This dependence claim has its skeptics too, however. The position known as ‘epiphenomenalism’ holds that there is no essential role for consciousness to play in our lives: that consciousness is caused by, but itself plays no causal role in, other mental events. We may happen to have conscious experiences concurrent with some of the events in our lives (such as intentional events), and they may even stand in constant conjunction with those events, but this in itself is not evidence that a creature could not exist that carries out the same activities with no conscious experiences at all. A real life example can get this intuition going. In a phenomenon sometimes called ‘blindsight’, subjects display above chance capacity to discriminate features of their environment while at least reporting that they have no corresponding conscious experience of these features. In one experiment, a subject is shown two drawings of a house, each identical in every respect except that one house is represented as being on fire. When asked, the subjects insist that they can see no difference between the two houses (the house on fire is in the visual region that the subject is having problems with). When pressed on which house they would prefer to live in, however, the subjects show an above chance preference for the house that is not represented as being on fire. Since the subjects seem to have distinct attitudes to the two pictures, hence distinct intentional states directed at each picture, and since there is no apparent variation in conscious experience, some take such cases to motivate the claim that it is possible to have intentional states without any conscious component.

d. Naturalizing Intentionality

Whatever the essence of intentionality might be, a further question that arises is whether we can ‘naturalize’ our account of it. That is to say, whether we can give an account of intentionality that can be exhaustively described in the terms in which the laws of nature are expressed. There is a long tradition of holding that the mind is outside of space and time – that it is an immaterial substance – and on that view, since intentional states are mental states, intentionality could not be naturalized. But particularly in the 20^th century, there has been a push to reject the view that the mind is immaterial and to try to account for the mind in terms of natural processes, such as causal relations, natural selection, and any other process that can be explained in terms of the laws of the natural sciences.

The attempt faces various challenges. We have already looked at one, which is that if we take intentional states to depend on consciousness, and we hold that it is not possible to give a naturalized account of consciousness, then it follows that we cannot naturalize intentionality. But there is another particularly tricky puzzle facing the naturalization of intentionality in terms of causal relations. As we saw above (3b) at least some intentional states have the property of intensionality: it does not follow from the fact that I believe p that p is the case, and it does not follow from the fact that I do not believe p that p is not the case. Another way to put this is that our concepts do not always co-vary with the objects they represent. On the one hand we can encounter the objects our concepts refer to without our concepts triggering, for example, when Lois Lane meets Clark Kent and the thought ‘that’s Superman’ fails to occur to her. And conversely our concepts can be triggered when the object they refer to is not about, such as when I see a cow in the night and mistakenly think ‘there’s a horse’. Our concepts, in other words, can trigger when they should not, and can fail to trigger when they should. This is a problem for naturalizing intentionality, because the causal theory of intentionality (1b) is at the heart of attempts to naturalize intentionality, and the causal theory has trouble explaining intensionality. For example, the causal theory holds that a concept refers to whatever causes it to trigger. But if Lois Lane bumps into Clark Kent and her superman concept fails to trigger, this would suggest that Lois Lane’s superman concept does not refer to Clark Kent. And that’s not a good outcome, since Superman is Clark Kent. Similarly, if I see a cow in the night and my horse concept goes off, the causal account implies that my horse concept refers to cows in the night. And that’s no good either.

Dretske (1981) argues that causal relations can in fact exhibit intensionality, so that we can naturalize intentionality. A compass, he argues, indicates the location of the North Pole because the North Pole causes the compass needle to point at it. He takes a compass to be a ‘natural indicator’ of the North Pole, and so to exhibit natural intentionality. But he thinks the compass also exhibits intensionality. In addition to indicating the North Pole, the compass also indicates the location of polar bears, because there are polar bears at the North Pole. However, if the polar bears move south, the compass will not continue to indicate their location. As a result, suggests Dretske, the compass exhibits intensionality: the compass can fail to indicate the location of polar bears, even though the location of polar bears is the North Pole, just as Lois Lane’s superman concept can fail to indicate Clark Kent, even though Clark Kent is Superman. There is a problem with this account, however, because the relationship between the location of polar bears and the North Pole is very different to the relationship between Superman and Clark Kent. The location of the polar bears can fail to be where the North Pole is, but Clark Kent cannot fail to be where Superman is. That is, the kind of failure to trigger that we are concerned to explain is where a concept fails to trigger in response to what is necessarily identical to its reference – not in response to something that merely happens to be co-instantiated with its reference on some occasions.

Another attempt to allow for these cases within a causal theory appeals to the notion of a natural function or telos (Mathen and Levy 1984, Millikan 1984, Dretske 1995, Papineau 1993). If the heart has been selected by evolution to pump blood, then we can say that the natural function of the heart is to pump blood. But functions can malfunction, as we see when the heart stops, thus failing to continue to pump blood. What distinguishes the correct from the incorrect activities of the heart is whether the heart is doing what it was selected for by evolution. The teleological theory of intentionality proposes that this same mechanism distinguishes the correct and incorrect triggers of a concept. When my horse concept tokens in response to my encounter with a cow in the night, it is malfunctioning, because it was selected to alert me to the presence of horses. This account faces several objections, but the clearest is that it rules out the possibility of a creature having thoughts whose mental states did not come into being through natural selection. Although highly unlikely, it is does not seem impossible that a being formally identical to a thinking person could come into existence by chance, through the right freak coincidence of physical events (in one story it involves lightning hitting a swamp and the right chemicals instantaneously bonding to form a molecule-for-molecule match of an adult human (Davidson 1987)). If the teleological theory of intentionality were right, such a being would have no intentional states since its brain states would have no natural history, even though it would be physically and behaviorally indistinguishable from a thinking person. Many see this is as a reductio ad absurdum of the teleological account, since it seems that by hypothesis such a being would be able to perceive, form desires and beliefs about its environment, and so forth.

Another proposal still is that we can distinguish correct from incorrect triggers of a concept in terms of the relationship they stand in to one another: the incorrect triggers of a concept only cause the concept to trigger because the correct triggers do, but the correct triggers don’t trigger the concept because the incorrect ones do (Fodor 1987). To return to the cow in the night example, the proposal is that if horses didn’t cause my horse concept to trigger, cows in the night wouldn’t either: the reason cows in the night cause it to trigger is because horses cause it to trigger, and cows in the night look like horses. But the reverse is not the case: if cows in the night didn’t cause my horse concept to trigger, this needn’t mean that horses wouldn’t. Correct and incorrect triggers can therefore by identified by this ‘asymmetric dependence’ relation they have to one another. When we try to explain why the correct triggers would continue to cause a concept to token even if the incorrect triggers didn’t, however, the proposal becomes less convincing. Returning to the Twin-Earth example, if we travel to Twin-Earth our water concept will be triggered by the watery looking stuff there, presumably falsely. But since Twin-Earth water is by hypothesis ordinarily indistinguishable from Earth water, it seems wrong to say that if Twin-Earth water did not cause our water concept to trigger, Earth water still would. The reason Earth water causes our water concept to trigger, after all, is presumably because it looks, tastes and smells a certain way. But Twin-Earth water looks, tastes and smells exactly the same way, so it is far from clear why we should expect that if Twin-Earth water did not trigger our water concept Earth water still would. Fodor (1998) replies that we should discount Twin-Earth worries because Twin-Earth does not exist. But it is not clear that this helps, since we could surely discover a substance on Earth that we might not be able to distinguish from water, in which case the same worry can be raised without discussing Twin-Earth.

Needless to say there are further arguments made on behalf of these proposals, but as things stand, there is no widely accepted solution to the problem presented by intensionality for naturalizing intentionality.

4. References and Further Reading

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Brentano, F. (1874/1911/1973). Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
Chalmers, D. (1996). The Conscious Mind, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Chalmers, D. (2006). “Foundations of Two-Dimensional Semantics.” In M. Garcia-Carpintero and J. Macia (eds). Two-Dimensional Semantics: Foundations and Applications. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Chisholm, R. M. (1956). “Perceiving: a Philosophical Study,” chapter 11, selection in D. Rosenthal (ed.), The Nature of Mind, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1990.
Davidson, D. (1980). Essays on Events and Actions, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Davidson, D. (1987). “Knowing One’s Own Mind.” In Proceedings and Addresses of the American Philosophical Association, 60: 441–58.
Dennett, D.C (1991). Consciousness Explained. Boston: Little Brown.
Dretske, F. (1981). Knowledge and the Flow of Information, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
Dretske, F. (1995). Naturalizing the Mind. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
Dreyfus, H.L. (ed.) (1982). Husserl, Intentionality and Cognitive Science, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
Evans, G. (1979). “Reference and Contingency.” The Monist, 62, 2 (April, 1979), 161-189.
Fodor, J.A. (1975). The Language of Thought, New York: Crowell.
Fodor, J.A. (1987). Psychosemantics, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
Fodor, J.A. (1998). Concepts: Where Cognitive Science Went Wrong, New York: Oxford University Press.
Fodor, J. A. and Lepore, E. (1992). Holism: A Shopper’s Guide. Oxford: Blackwell.
Føllesdal, D. (1982). “Husserl’s notion of Noema,” in H.L. Dreyfus (ed.), The Nature of Mind, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Frege, G. (1892/1952). “On Sense and Reference.” In P. Geach and M. Black (eds.), Philosophical Writings of Gottlob Frege, Oxford: Blackwell, 1952.
Goodman, N. (1968). Languages of Art: An Approach to a Theory of Symbols. Indianapolis: The Bobbs-Merrill Company.
Haugeland, J. (1981). “Semantic Engines: an Introduction to Mind Design.” In J. Haugeland (ed.), Mind Design, Philosophy, Psychology, Artificial Intelligence, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1981.
Hinton, J.M., (1967). “Visual Experiences.” Mind, 76: 217–227.
Husserl, E. (1900/1970). Logical Investigations, (Engl. Transl. by Findlay, J.N.), London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
Jackson, F. (1998). From Metaphysics to Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Kaplan, D. (1979). “Dthat.” In P. French, T. Uehling, and H. Wettstein (eds.), Contemporary Perspectives in the Philosophy of Language, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
King, P. (2007). “Rethinking Representation in the Middle Ages.” In Representation and Objects of Thought in Medieval Philosophy, edited by Henrik Lagerlund, Ashgate Press: 81-100.
Kim, J. (1993). Mind and Supervenience, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Kripke, S. (1972/1980). Naming and Necessity, Oxford: Blackwell.
Martin, M.G.F. (2002). “The Transparency of Experience.” Mind and Language, 17: 376–425.
Mohan, M. & Levy, E. (1984). “Teleology, Error, and the Human Immune System.” Journal of Philosophy 81 (7):351-372.
McDowell, J. (1994). Mind and World. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
McGinn, C. (1989). Mental Content, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
McGinn, C. (1990). Problems of Consciousness, Oxford: Blackwell.
Mill, J.S. (1884). A System of Logic, Ratiocinative and Inductive: Being a Connected View of the Principles of Evidence and the Methods of Scientific Investigation, New York: Harper.
Millikan, R.G. (1984). Language, Thought and Other Biological Objects, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
Mooney, T. (2010). “Understanding and Simple Seeing in Husserl.” Husserl Studies, 26: 19-48.
Moore, G.E. (1903). “The Refutation of Idealism.” Mind 12 (1903) 433-53.
Papineau, D. (1993). Philosophical Naturalism. Oxford: Blackwell.
Peacocke, C. (1983). Sense and Content: Experience, Thought and their Relations, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Putnam, H. (1974). “The Meaning of ‘Meaning’,” in H. Putnam, Philosophical Papers, vol. II, Language, Mind and Reality, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1975.
Recanati, F. (2013). Mental Files. Oxford University Press.
Russell, B. (1905/1956). “On Denoting,” in R. Marsh (ed.), Bertrand Russell, Logic and Knowledge, Essays 1901-1950, New York: Capricorn Books, 1956.
Russell, B. (1911). The Problems of Philosophy, (New York: Holt).
Ryle, G. (1949). The Concept of Mind. Oxford University Press.
Searle, J. (1958). “Do Proper Names have Sense?” Mind 67: 166-173.
Searle, J. (1983). Intentionality, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Searle, J, (1994). “Intentionality (1),” in Guttenplan, S. (ed.) (1994) A Companion Volume to the Philosophy of Mind, Oxford: Blackwell.
Sellars, W. (1956/1997). “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind.” In Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind: with an Introduction by Richard Rorty and a Study Guide by Robert Brandom, R. Brandom (ed.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Snowdon, P.F., (1981). “Perception, Vision and Causation.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, New Series, 81: 175–92.
Soames, S. (2005). Reference and Description: The Case against Two-Dimensionalism. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
Strawson, P. (1959). The Bounds of Sense. Oxford University Press.
Tye, M. (1995). Ten Problems of Consciousness, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
Varela, F., Thompson, E., and Rosch E., (1991). The Embodied Mind: Cognitive Science and Human Experience, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
Wittgenstein, L. (1953). Philosophical Investigations. Oxford: Blackwell.

Author Information

Cathal O’Madagain
Email: cathalcom@gmail.com
Ecole Normale Superieure, Paris
France

Ethical Expressivism

Broadly speaking, the term “expressivism” refers to a family of views in the philosophy of language according to which the meanings of claims in a particular area of discourse are to be understood in terms of whatever non-cognitive mental states those claims are supposed to express. More specifically, an expressivist theory of claims in some area of discourse, D, will typically affirm both of the following theses. The first thesis—psychological non-cognitivism—states that claims in D express mental states that are characteristically non-cognitive. Non-cognitive states are often distinguished by their world-to-mind direction of fit, which contrasts with the mind-to-world direction of fit exhibited by cognitive states like beliefs. Some common examples of non-cognitive states are desires, emotions, pro- and con-attitudes, commitments, and so forth. According to the second thesis—semantic ideationalism—the meanings or semantic contents of claims in D are in some sense given by the mental states that those claims express. This is in contrast with more traditional propositional or truth-conditional approaches to meaning, according to which the meanings of claims are to be understood in terms of either their truth-conditions or the propositions that they express.

An expressivist theory of truth claims—that is, claims of the form “p is true”—might hold that (i) “p is true” expresses a certain measure of confidence in, or agreement with, p, and that (ii) whatever the relevant mental state, for example, agreement with p, that state just is the meaning of “p is true”. In other words, when we claim that p is true, we neither describe p as true nor report the fact that p is true; rather, we express some non-cognitive attitude toward p (see Strawson 1949). Similar expressivist treatments have been given to knowledge claims (Austin 1970; Chrisman 2012), probability claims (Barker 2006; Price 2011; Yalcin 2012), claims about causation (Coventry 2006; Price 2011), and even claims about what is funny (Gert 2002; Dreier 2009).

“Ethical expressivism”, then, is the name for any view according to which (i) ethical claims—that is, claims like “x is wrong”, “y is a good person”, and “z is a virtue”—express non-cognitive mental states, and (ii) these states make up the meanings of ethical claims. (I shall henceforth use the term “expressivism” to refer only to ethical expressivism, unless otherwise noted.) This article begins with a brief account of the history of expressivism, and an explanation of its main motivations. This is followed by a description of the famous Frege-Geach Problem, and of the role that it played in shaping contemporary versions of the view. While these contemporary expressivisms may avoid the problem as it was originally posed, recent work in metaethics suggests that Geach’s worries were really just symptoms of a much deeper problem, which can actually take many forms. After characterizing this deeper problem—the Continuity Problem—and some of its more noteworthy manifestations, the article explores a few recent trends in the literature on expressivism, including the advent of so-called “hybrid” expressivist views. See also “Non-Cognitivism in Ethics.”

Expressivism and Non-Cognitivism: History and Motivations
The Frege-Geach Problem and Hare’s Way Out
The Expressivist Turn
The Continuity Problem
Recent Trends
References and Further Reading

1. Expressivism and Non-Cognitivism: History and Motivations

The first and primary purpose of this section is to lay out a brief history of ethical expressivism, paying particular attention to its main motivations. In addition to this, the section will also answer a question that many have had about expressivism, namely: what is the difference between expressivism and “non-cognitivism”?

The difference is partly an historical one, such that a history of expressivism must begin with its non-cognitivist ancestry. Discussions of early non-cognitivism typically involve three figures in particular—A. J. Ayer, C. L. Stevenson, and R. M. Hare—and in that respect, this one will be no different. But rather than focusing upon the substance of their views, in this section, we will be more interested in the main considerations that motivated them to take up non-cognitivism in the first place. As we shall see, early non-cognitivist views were motivated mostly by two concerns: first, a desire to avoid unwanted ontological commitments, especially to a realm of “spooky,” irreducibly normative properties; and second, a desire to capture an apparently very close connection between sincere ethical claims and motivation.

In the case of Ayer, his motivation for defending a version of non-cognitivism was relatively clear, since he explains in the Introduction of the second edition of Language, Truth, and Logic (1946), “[I]n putting forward the theory I was concerned with maintaining the general consistency of my position [logical positivism].” As is well known, logical positivists were rather austere in their ontological accommodations, and happy to let the natural sciences decide (for the most part) what gets accommodated. In fact, a common way to interpret their verificationism is as a kind of method for avoiding unwanted ontological commitments—“unwanted” because they do not conform to what Ayer himself described as his and other positivists’ “radical empiricism.” Claims in some area of discourse are meaningful, in the ordinary sense of that term—which, for Ayer, is just to say that they express propositions—only if they are either analytic or empirically verifiable. Claims that are neither analytic nor empirically verifiable—like most religious claims, for instance—are meaningless; they might express something, but not propositions.

Ayer’s positivism could perhaps make room for moral properties as long as those properties were understood as literally nothing but the natural properties into which philosophers sometimes analyze them—for example, maximizing pleasure, since this is in principle verifiable—but it left no room at all for the irreducibly normative properties that some at the time took to be the very subject-matter of ethics (see Moore 1903). So in order to “maintain the general consistency of his position,” and to avoid any commitment to empirically unverifiable, irreducibly normative properties, Ayer’s positivism meant that he had to construe ordinary ethical claims as expressing something other than propositions. Moreover, for reasons unimportant to my purposes here, he argued that these claims express non-cognitive, motivational states of mind—in particular, emotions. It is for this reason that Ayer’s brand of non-cognitivism is often referred to as “emotivism”.

Stevenson likely shared some of Ayer’s ontological suspicions, but this pretty clearly is not what led him to non-cognitivism. Rather than being concerned to maintain the consistency of any pre-conceived philosophical principles, Stevenson begins by simply observing our ordinary practices of making ethical claims, and then he asks what kind of analysis of “good” is able to make the best sense out of these practices. For instance, in practice, he thinks ethical claims are made more to influence others than to inform them. In fact, in general, Stevenson seems especially impressed with what he called the “magnetism” of ethical claims—that is, their apparently close connection to people’s motivational states. But he thinks that other attempts to analyze “good” in terms of these motivational states have failed on two counts: (a) they make genuine ethical disagreement impossible, and (b) they compromise the autonomy of ethics, assigning ethical facts to the province of psychology, or sociology, or one of the natural sciences.

According to Stevenson, these other theories err in conceiving the connection between ethical claims and motivational states in terms of the former describing, or reporting, the latter—so that, for instance, the meaning of “Torture is wrong” consists in something like the proposition that I (the speaker) disapprove of torture. This is what led to problems (a) and (b) from above: two people who are merely describing or reporting their own attitudes toward torture cannot be genuinely disagreeing about its wrongness; and if the wrongness of torture were really just a matter of people’s attitudes toward it, then ethical inquiries could apparently be settled entirely by such means as introspection, psychoanalysis, or even just popular vote. Stevenson’s non-cognitivism, then, can be understood as an attempt to capture the relation between ethical claims and motivational states in a way that avoids these problems.

The solution, he thinks, is to allow that ethical claims have a different sort of meaning from ordinary descriptive claims. If ordinary descriptive claims have propositional meaning—that is, meaning that is a matter of the propositions they express—then ethical claims have what Stevenson called emotive meaning. “The emotive meaning of a word is a tendency of a word, arising through the history of its usage, to produce (result from) affective responses in people. It is the immediate aura of feeling which hovers about a word” (Stevenson 1937, p.23; see also Ogden and Richards 1923, 125ff). A claim like “Torture is the subject of today’s debate” may get its meaning from a proposition, but the claim “Torture is wrong” has emotive meaning, in that its meaning is somehow to be understood in terms of the motivational states that it is typically used either to express or to arouse.

If Ayer and Stevenson apparently disagreed over the meaningfulness of ethical claims, with Ayer at times insisting that such claims are meaningless, and Stevenson allowing that they have a special kind of non-propositional meaning, they were nonetheless united in affirming a negative semantic thesis, sometimes called semantic non-factualism, according to which claims in some area of discourse—in this case, ethical claims—do not express propositions, and, consequently, do not have truth-conditions. Regardless of whether or not ethical claims are meaningful in some special sense, they are not meaningful in the same way that ordinary descriptive claims are meaningful, that is, in the sense of expressing propositions. Ayer and Stevenson were also apparently united in affirming what we earlier called psychological non-cognitivism. So as the term shall be used here, ‘ethical non-cognitivism’ names any view that combines semantic non-factualism and psychological non-cognitivism, with respect to ethical claims.

According to Hare, ethical claims actually have two kinds of meaning: descriptive and prescriptive. To call a thing “good” is both (a) to say or imply that it has some context-specific set of non-moral properties; this is the claim’s descriptive meaning, and (b) to commend the thing in virtue of these properties (this is the claim’s prescriptive meaning). But importantly, the prescriptive meaning of ethical claims is primary: the set of properties that I ascribe to a thing when calling it “good” varies from context to context, but in all contexts, I use “good” for the purpose of commendation. For Hare, then, ethical claims are used not to express emotions, or to excite the emotions of others, but rather to guide actions. They do this by taking the imperative mood. That is, they are first-and-foremost prescriptions. For this reason, Hare’s view is often called “prescriptivism”.

It may be less clear than it was in the case of Ayer and Stevenson whether Hare’s prescriptivism ought to count as a version of non-cognitivism. After all, it is not uncommon to suppose that sentences in the imperative mood still have propositional content. Since he rarely goes in for talk of “expression”, it is unclear whether Hare is a psychological non-cognitivist. However, it would nonetheless be fair to say that, since prescriptions do not have truth-conditions, Hare is committed to saying that the relationship between prescriptive ethical claims and propositions is fundamentally different from that between ordinary descriptive claims and propositions; and in this sense, it does seem as if he is committed to a form of semantic non-factualism. It also seems right to think that if we do not express any sort of non-cognitive, approving attitude toward a thing when we call it “good,” then we do not really commend it. So even if he is not explicit in his adherence to it, Hare does seem to accept some form of psychological non-cognitivism as well.

Also unclear are Hare’s motivations for being an ethical non-cognitivist. By the time Hare published The Language of Morals (1952), non-cognitivism was already the dominant view in moral philosophy. So there was much less of a need for Hare to motivate the view than there was for Ayer and Stevenson a couple decades earlier. Instead, Hare’s concern was mostly to give a more thorough articulation of the view than the other non-cognitivists had, and one sophisticated enough to avoid some of the problems that had already arisen for earlier versions of the view.

One thing that does appear to have motivated Hare’s non-cognitivism, however, is its ability to explain intuitions about moral supervenience. Most philosophers agree that there is some kind of relationship between a thing’s moral status and its non-moral features, such that two things cannot have different moral statuses without also having different non-moral features. This is roughly what it means to say that a thing’s moral features supervene upon its non-moral features. For example, if it is morally wrong for Stan to lie to his teacher, but not morally wrong for Stan to lie to his mother, then there must be some non-moral difference between the two actions that underlies and explains their moral difference, for example, something to do with Stan’s reasons for lying in each case. While non-philosophers may not be familiar with the term “supervenience”, the fact that we so often hold people accountable for judging like cases suggests that we do intuitively take the moral to supervene upon the non-moral.

Those philosophers, like Moore, who believe in irreducibly normative properties must explain how it is that, despite apparently not being reducible to non-moral properties, these properties are nonetheless able to supervene upon non-moral properties, which has proven to be an especially difficult task (see Blackburn 1988b). But non-cognitivists like Hare do not shoulder this difficult metaphysical burden. Instead, they explain intuitions about moral supervenience in terms of rational consistency. If Joan commends something in virtue of its non-moral properties, but then fails to commend something else with an identical set of properties, then she is inconsistent in her commendations, and thereby betrays a certain sort of irrationality. It is this simple expectation of rational consistency, and not some complicated thesis about the ontological relations that obtain between moral and non-moral properties, that explains our intuitions about moral supervenience.

Not long after Hare’s prescriptivism hit the scene, ethical non-cognitivism would be the target of an attack from Peter Geach. Given that the attack was premised upon a point made earlier by German philosopher Gottlob Frege, it has come to be known as the Frege-Geach Problem for non-cognitivism. In the next section, we will see what the Frege-Geach Problem is. Before doing so, however, let us briefly return to the question raised at the beginning of this section: what is the difference between expressivism and non-cognitivism?

In the introduction, we saw that ethical expressivism is essentially the combination of two theses concerning ethical claims: psychological non-cognitivism and semantic ideationalism. As we will see in Sections 2 and 3, the Frege-Geach Problem pressures the non-cognitivist to say more about the meanings of ethical claims than just the non-factualist thesis that they are not comprised of truth-evaluable propositions. It is partly in response to this pressure that contemporary non-cognitivists have been moved to accept semantic ideationalism. So the difference between expressivism and non-cognitivism is historical, but it is not merely historical. Rather, the difference is substantive as well: both expressivists and non-cognitivists accept some form of psychological non-cognitivism; but whereas the earlier non-cognitivists accepted a negative thesis about the contents of ethical claims—essentially, a thesis about how ethical claims do not get their meanings—contemporary expressivists accept a positive thesis about how ethical claims do get their meanings: ethical claims mean what they do in virtue of the non-cognitive mental states they express. It should be noted, however, that there are still many philosophers who use the terms “non-cognitivism” and “expressivism” interchangeably.

2. The Frege-Geach Problem and Hare’s Way Out

Non-cognitivist theories have met with a number of objections throughout the years, but none as famous as the so-called Frege-Geach Problem. As a point of entry into the problem, observe that there are ordinary linguistic contexts in which it seems correct to say that a proposition is being asserted, and contexts in which it seems incorrect to say that a proposition is being asserted. Consider the following two sentences:

(1) It is snowing.

(2) If it is snowing, then the kids will want to play outside.

In ordinary contexts, to make claim (1) is to assert that it is snowing. That is, when a speaker utters (1), she puts forward a certain proposition—in this case, the proposition that it is snowing—as true. Accordingly, if we happen to know that it is not snowing, it could be appropriate to say that the speaker is wrong. But when a speaker utters (2), she does not thereby assert that it is snowing. Someone can coherently utter (2) without having any idea whether it is snowing, or even knowing that it is not snowing. In the event that it is not snowing, we should not then say that the speaker of (2) is wrong. However, whether “It is snowing” is being asserted or not, it surely means the same thing in the antecedent of (2) as it does in (1). Equally, while we should not say that the speaker of (2) is wrong if it happens not to be snowing, it would nonetheless be correct, in that event, to say that both (1) and the antecedent of (2) are false.

This is what Geach calls “the Frege point,” a reference to German philosopher Gottlob Frege: “A thought may have just the same content whether you assent to its truth or not; a proposition may occur in discourse now asserted, now unasserted, and yet be recognizably the same proposition” (Geach 1965, p.449). The best way to account for the facts that (a) claim (1) and the antecedent of (2) have the same semantic contents, and that (b) they are both apparently capable of truth and falsity, is to suppose that claim (1) and the antecedent of (2) both express the proposition that it is snowing. So apparently, a claim’s expressing a proposition is something wholly independent of what a speaker happens to be doing with the claim, e.g., whether asserting it or not.

Now, we should note two things about the theories of early non-cognitivists like Ayer, Stevenson, and Hare. First, they are meant only to apply to claims in the relevant area of discourse—in this case, ethical claims—and are not supposed to generalize to other sorts of claims. In other words, theirs are apparently specialized, or “local,” semantic theories. So, for instance, most ethical non-cognitivists would agree that claim (1) expresses the proposition that it is snowing, and that this accounts for the meaning of (1). Second, perhaps understandably, ethical non-cognitivists focus their theories almost entirely upon ethical claims when they are asserted. The basic question is always something like this: what really is going on when a speaker makes an assertion of the form ‘x is wrong’? Does the speaker thereby describe x as wrong? Or might it be a kind of fallacy to assume that the speaker is engaged in an act of description, based only upon the surface grammar of the sentence? Might she instead be doing something expressive or evocative? Geach observes, “Theory after theory has been put forward to the effect that predicating some term ‘P’—which is always taken to mean: predicating ‘P’ assertorically—is not describing an object as being P but some other ‘performance’; and the contrary view is labeled ‘the Descriptive Fallacy’” (Geach 1965, p.461). Little attention is paid to ethical claims in contexts where they are not being asserted.

The Frege-Geach Problem can be understood as a consequence of these two features of non-cognitivist theories. As we saw earlier with claims (1) and (2), when we embed a claim into an unasserted context, like the antecedent of a conditional, we effectively strip the claim of its assertoric force. Claim (1) is assertoric, but the antecedent of (2) is not, despite having the same semantic content. But as Geach points out, exactly the same phenomenon occurs when we take a claim at the heart of some non-cognitivist theory and embed it into an unasserted context. This is why the Frege-Geach Problem is sometimes called the Embedding Problem. For example, consider the following two claims, similar in form to claims (1) and (2):

(3) Lying is wrong.

(4) If lying is wrong, then getting your little brother to lie is wrong.

As with claims (1) and (2) above, the relationship between a speaker and claim (3) is importantly different from the relationship between a speaker and the antecedent of claim (4). At least in ordinary contexts, a speaker of (3) asserts that lying is wrong, whereas a speaker of (4) does no such thing. But, assuming “the Frege point” applies here as well, the semantic contents of (3) and the antecedent of (4) do not depend upon whether they are being asserted or not. In both cases, their contents ought to be the same; and therein lies the rub for ethical non-cognitivists.

Given that their theories are meant to apply only to ethical claims, and not to claims in other areas of discourse, non-cognitivists are apparently committed to telling a radically different story about the semantic content of (3), as compared to the propositional story they would presumably join everyone else in telling about the contents of claims like (1) and (2). But whatever story they tell about the content of (3), it is unclear how it could apply coherently to the antecedent of (4) as well. Take Ayer, for instance. According to Ayer, claim (3) is semantically no different from

(3’) Lying!!

“where the shape and thickness of the exclamation marks show, by a suitable convention, that a special sort of moral disapproval is the feeling which is being expressed” (Ayer (1946)1952, p.107). Ayer believed that speakers of claims like (3) are not engaged in acts of description, but rather acts of expressing their non-cognitive attitudes toward various things. This is how Ayer’s theory treats the contents of ethical claims when they are asserted. Now, absent some independently compelling reason for thinking that “the Frege point” should not apply here, the same analysis ought to be given to the antecedent of (4). But the same analysis cannot be given to the antecedent of (4). For, just as a speaker can sincerely and coherently utter (2) without believing that it is snowing, a speaker can sincerely and coherently utter (4) without disapproving of lying. So whatever Ayer has to say about the content of the antecedent of (4), it cannot be that it consists in the expression of “a special sort of moral disapproval,” since a speaker of (4) does not express disapproval of lying. Apparently, then, he is committed to saying, counter-intuitively, that the contents of (3) and the antecedent of (4) are different.

As Geach poses it, the problem for the ethical non-cognitivist at this point is actually two-fold (see especially Geach 1965: 462-465). First, the non-cognitivist must explain how ethical claims are able to function as premises in logical inferences in the first place, if they do not express propositions. Traditionally, inference in logic is thought to be a matter of the truth-conditional relations that hold between propositions, and logical connectives like “and”, “or”, and “if-then” are thought to be truth-preserving functions from propositions to propositions. But as we have already seen, ethical non-cognitivists deny that ethical claims are even in the business of expressing propositions. So how, Geach wonders, are we apparently able to infer

(5) Therefore, getting your little brother to lie is wrong

from (3) and (4), if the content of (3) is nothing more than an attitude of disapproval toward lying? Or consider:

(6) Lying is wrong or it isn’t.

Claim (6) can be inferred from (3) by a familiar logical principle, and in non-ethical contexts, we account for this by explaining how disjunction relates two or more propositions. But how can someone who denies that (3) expresses a proposition explain the relationship between (3) and (6)? The second part of the problem, related to the first, is that the non-cognitivist must explain why the inference from (3) and (4) to (5), for instance, is a valid one. As any introductory logic student knows well, the validity of modus ponens depends upon the minor premise and the antecedent of the major premise having the same content. Otherwise, the argument equivocates, and the inference is invalid. But as we just saw, on the theories of non-cognitivists like Ayer, claim (3) and the antecedent of (4) apparently do not have the same content. So Ayer seems committed to saying that what appears to be a straightforward instance of modus ponens is in fact an invalid argument. This is the so-called Frege-Geach Problem for non-cognitivism as Geach originally put it.

In response to an argument very much like Geach’s (see Searle 1962), Hare appears to give non-cognitivists a “way out” of the Frege-Geach Problem (Hare 1970). As Hare sees it, the matter ultimately comes down to whether or not the non-cognitivist can adequately account for the compositionality of language, that is, the way the meanings of complex sentences are composed of the meanings of their simpler parts. As has already been noted, linguists and philosophers of language have traditionally done this by telling a story about propositions and the various relations that may hold between them—the meaning of (2), for instance, is composed of (a) the proposition that it is snowing, (b) the proposition that the kids will want to play outside, and (c) the conditional function “if-then”. The challenge for the non-cognitivist is simply to find another way to account for compositionality—though, it turns out, this is no simple matter.

Hare’s own proposal was to think of the meanings of ethical claims in terms of the sorts of acts for which they are suited and not in terms of propositions or mental states. The claim “Lying is wrong,” for instance, is especially suited for a particular sort of act, namely, the act of condemning lying. Thinking of the meanings of ethical claims in this way allows Hare and other non-cognitivists to effectively concede “the Frege point,” since suitability for an act is something wholly independent of whether a claim is being asserted or not. It allows them, for instance, to say that the content of (3) is the same as the content of the antecedent of (4), which, we saw, was a problem for theories like Ayer’s. From here, accounting for the meanings of complex ethical claims, like (4) and (6), is a matter of conceiving logical connectives not as functions from propositions to propositions, but rather as functions from speech acts to speech acts. If non-cognitivists could do something like this, that is, draw up a kind of “logic of speech acts”, then they would apparently have the resources for meeting both of Geach’s challenges. They could explain how ethical claims can function as premises in logical inferences, and they could explain why some of those inferences, and not others, are valid. Unfortunately, Hare himself stopped short of working out such a logic, but his 1970 paper would nonetheless pave the way for future expressivist theories and their own responses to the Frege-Geach Problem.

3. The Expressivist Turn

Earlier, it was noted that the difference between non-cognitivism and expressivism is both historical and substantive. To repeat, ethical non-cognitivists were united in affirming the negative semantic thesis that ethical claims do not get their meanings from truth-evaluable propositions, as in semantic non-factualism. But as we have already seen with Hare, the Frege-Geach Problem pressures non-cognitivists to say something more than this, in order to account for the meanings of both simple and complex ethical claims, and to explain how some ethical claims can be inferred from others.

Contemporary ethical expressivists respond to this pressure by doing just that: while still affirming the semantic non-factualism of their non-cognitivist ancestors, expressivists nowadays add to this the thesis that was earlier called semantic ideationalism. That is, they think that the meanings of ethical claims are constituted not by propositions, but by the very non-cognitive mental states that they have long been thought to express. In other words, if non-cognitivists “removed” propositions from the contents of ethical claims, then expressivists “replace” those propositions with mental states, or “ideas”—hence, ideationalism. It is this move, made primarily in response to the Frege-Geach Problem, and by following Hare’s lead, that constitutes the historical turn from ethical non-cognitivism to ethical expressivism. Both non-cognitivists and expressivists believe that ethical claims express non-cognitive attitudes, but expressivists are distinguished in thinking of the expression relation itself as a semantic one.

Ethical expressivism is often contrasted with another theory of the meanings of ethical claims according to which those meanings are closely related with speaker’s non-cognitive states of mind, namely, ethical subjectivism. Ethical subjectivism can be understood as the view that the meanings of ethical claims are propositions, but propositions about speakers’ attitudes. So whatever the relationship between claim (1) above and the proposition that it is snowing, the same relationship holds between claim (3) and the proposition that I (the speaker) disapprove of lying. So ethical subjectivists can also, with expressivists, say that ethical claims mean what they do in virtue of the non-cognitive states that they express. But whereas the expressivist accounts for this in terms of the way the claim itself directly expresses the relevant state, the subjectivist accounts for it in terms of the speaker indirectly expressing the relevant state by expressing a proposition that refers to it.

The contrast between expressivism and subjectivism is important not only for the purpose of understanding what expressivism is, but also for seeing a significant advantage that it is supposed to have over subjectivism. Suppose Jones and Smith are engaged in a debate about the wrongness of lying, with Jones claiming that it is wrong, and Smith claiming that it is not wrong. Presumably, for this to count as a genuine disagreement, it must be the case that their claims have incompatible contents. But according to subjectivism, the contents of their claims, respectively, are the propositions that I (Jones) disapprove of lying and that I (Smith) do not disapprove of lying. Clearly, though, these two propositions are perfectly compatible with each other. Where, then, where is the disagreement? This is often thought to be a particularly devastating problem for ethical subjectivism, that is, it cannot adequately account for genuine moral disagreement, but it is apparently not a problem for expressivists. According to expressivism, the disagreement is simply a matter of Jones and Smith directly expressing incompatible states of mind. This is one of the advantages of supposing that the semantic contents of ethical claims just are mental states, and not propositions about mental states.

Now, recall the two motivations that first led people to accept ethical non-cognitivism. The first was a desire to avoid any ontological commitment to “spooky,” irreducibly normative properties. Moral realists, roughly speaking, are those who believe that properties like goodness and wrongness have every bit the ontological status as other, less controversial properties, like roundness and solidity, that is, moral properties are no less “real” than non-moral properties. But especially for those philosophers committed to a thoroughgoing metaphysical naturalism, it is hard to see how things like goodness and wrongness could have such a status. Especially when it is noted, as Mackie famously does, that moral properties as realists typically conceive them are somehow supposed to have a kind of built-in capacity to motivate those who apprehend them, to say nothing of how they are supposed to be apprehended, a capacity apparently not had by any other property (see Mackie 1977, p.38-42). Ethical expressivists avoid this problem by denying that people who make ethical claims are even engaged in the task of ascribing moral properties to things in the first place. Ontologically speaking, expressivism demands little more of the world than people’s attitudes and the speakers who express them, and so, it nicely satisfies the first of the two non-cognitivist desiderata.

The second desideratum was a desire to accommodate an apparently very close connection between ethical claims and motivation. In simple terms, motivational internalism is the view that a necessary condition for moral judgment is that the speaker be motivated to act accordingly. In other words, if Jones judges that lying is wrong, but has no motivation whatsoever to refrain from lying, or to condemn those who lie, or whatever, then internalists will typically say that Jones must not really judge lying to be wrong. Even if motivational internalism is false, though, it is surely right that we expect people’s ethical claims to be accompanied by motivations to act in certain ways; and when people who make ethical claims seem not to be motivated to act in these ways, we often assume either that they are being insincere or that something else has gone wrong. Sincere ethical claims just seem to “come with” corresponding motivations. Here, too, expressivism seems well suited to account for this feature of ethical claims, since they take ethical claims to directly express non-cognitive states of mind, for example, desires, emotions, attitudes, commitments, and these states are either capable of motivating by themselves, or at least closely tied to motivation. So while ethical expressivists distinguish themselves from earlier non-cognitivists by accepting the thesis of semantic ideationalism, they are no less capable of accommodating the very same considerations that motivated non-cognitivism in the first place.

Finally, return to the Frege-Geach Problem. As we saw in the previous section, Geach originally posed it as a kind of logical problem for non-cognitivists: by denying that claims in the relevant area of discourse express propositions, non-cognitivists take on the burden of explaining how such claims can be involved in logical inference, and why some such inferences are valid and others invalid. Hare took a first step toward meeting this challenge by proposing that we understand the contents of ethical claims in terms of speech acts, and then work out a kind of “logic” of speech acts. Contemporary expressivists, since they understand the contents of ethical claims not in terms of speech acts but in terms of mental states, are committed to doing something similar with whatever non-cognitive states they think are expressed by these claims. In other words, as it is sometimes put, expressivists owe us a kind of “logic of attitudes.”

Here, again, is our test case:

(3) Lying is wrong.

(4) If lying is wrong, then getting your little brother to lie is wrong.

(5) Therefore, getting your little brother to lie is wrong.

If the meanings of (3), (4), and (5) are to be understood solely in terms of mental states, and not in terms of propositions, how is it that we can infer (5) from (3) and (4)? And why is the inference valid?

In some of his earlier work on this, Blackburn (1984) answers these questions by suggesting that complex ethical claims like (4) express higher-order non-cognitive states, in this case, something like a commitment to disapproving of getting one’s little brother to lie upon disapproving of lying. If someone sincerely disapproves of lying, and is also committed to disapproving of getting her little brother to lie as long as she disapproves of lying—the two states expressed by (3) and (4), respectively—then she thereby commits herself to disapproving of getting her little brother to lie. This is one sense in which (5) might “follow from” (3) and (4), even if it is not exactly the entailment relation with which we are all familiar from introductory logic.

Furthermore, a familiar way to account for the validity of inferences like (3)-(5) is by saying that it is impossible for the premises to be true and for the conclusion to be false. But if the expressivist takes something like the approach under consideration here, he will presumably have to say something different, since it is certainly possible for someone to hold both of the attitudes expressed by (3) and (4) without also holding the attitude expressed by (5). So for instance, the expressivist might say something like this: while a person certainly can hold the attitudes expressed by (3) and (4) without also holding the attitude expressed by (5), such a person would nonetheless exhibit a kind of inconsistency in her attitudes—she would have what Blackburn calls a “fractured sensibility” (1984: 195). It is this inconsistency that might explain why the move from (3) and (4) to (5) is “valid,” provided that we allow for this alternative sense of validity. Recall, that this is essentially the same sort of inconsistency of attitudes that Hare thought underlies our intuitions about moral supervenience.

This is just one way in which expressivists might attempt to solve the Frege-Geach Problem. Others have attempted different sorts of “logics of attitudes,” with mixed results. In early twenty-first century discourse, the debate about whether such a thing as a “logic of attitudes” is even possible—and if so, what it should look like—is ongoing.

4. The Continuity Problem

Even if expressivists can solve, or at least avoid, the Frege-Geach Problem as Geach originally posed it, there is a deeper problem that they face, a kind of “problem behind the problem”, and that will be the subject of this section. To get a sense of the problem, consider that expressivists have taken a position that effectively pulls them in two opposing directions. On the one hand, since the earliest days of non-cognitivism, philosophers in the expressivist tradition have wanted to draw some sort of sharp contrast between claims in the relevant area of discourse and claims outside of that area of discourse, that is, between ethical and non-ethical claims. But on the other hand, and this is the deeper issue that one might think lies behind the Frege-Geach Problem, ethical claims seem to behave in all sorts of logical and semantic contexts just like their non-ethical counterparts. Ethical claims are apparently no different from non-ethical claims in being (a) embeddable into unasserted contexts, like disjunctions and the antecedents of conditionals, (b) involved in logical inferences, (c) posed as questions, (d) translated across different languages, (e) negated, (f) supported with reasons, and (g) used to articulate the objects of various states of mind, for example, we can say that Jones believes that lying is wrong, Anderson regrets that lying is wrong, and Black wonders whether lying is wrong, to name just a few. It is in accounting for the many apparent continuities between ethical and non-ethical claims that expressivists run into serious problems. So call the general problem here the Continuity Problem for expressivism.

One very significant step that expressivists have taken in order to solve the Continuity Problem is to expand their semantic ideationalism to apply to claims of all sorts, and not just to claims in the relevant area of discourse. So, in the same way that ethical claims get their meanings from non-cognitive mental states, non-ethical claims get their meanings from whatever states of mind they express. In other words, expressivists attempt to solve the Continuity Problem by swapping their “local” semantic ideationalism, that is, ideationalism specifically with respect to claims in the discourse of concern, for a more “global” ideationalist semantics intended to apply to claims in all areas of discourse. This is remarkable, as it represents a wholesale departure from the more traditional propositionalist semantics according to which sentences mean what they do in virtue of the propositions they express. Recall the earlier claims:

(1) It is snowing.

(3) Lying is wrong.

According to most contemporary expressivists, the meanings of both (1) and (3) are to be understood in terms of the mental states they express. Claim (3) expresses something like disapproval of lying, and claim (1) expresses the belief that it is snowing, as opposed to the proposition that it is snowing. So even if ethical and non-ethical claims express different kinds of states, their meanings are nonetheless accounted for in the same way, that is, in terms of whatever mental states the relevant claims are supposed to express.

If nothing else, this promises to be an important first step toward solving the Continuity Problem. But taking this step, from local to global semantic ideationalism, may prove to be more trouble than it is worth, as it appears to raise all sorts of other problems a few of which we shall consider here under the general banner of the Continuity Problem.

a. A Puzzle about Negation

Keeping in mind that expressivism now appears to hinge upon it being the case that an ideationalist approach to semantics can account for all of the same logical and linguistic phenomena that the more traditional propositional or truth-conditional approaches to semantics can account for, consider a simple case of negation:

(1) It is snowing.

(7) It is not snowing.

On an ideationalist approach to meaning, (1) gets its meaning from the belief that it is snowing, and (7) gets its meaning from either the belief that it is not snowing, or perhaps a state of disbelief that it is snowing, assuming, for now, that a state of disbelief is something different from a mere lack of belief. A claim and its negation ought to have incompatible contents, and this is apparently how an ideationalist would account for the incompatibility of (1) and (7). But now consider a case of an ethical claim and its negation:

(3) Lying is wrong.

(8) Lying is not wrong.

We saw these claims earlier, in Section 3, when discussing how expressivists are supposed to be able to account for genuine moral disagreement in a way better than ethical subjectivists. Basically, expressivists account for such disagreement by supposing that a speaker of (3) and a speaker of (8) express incompatible mental states, as is the case with (1) and (7). But if the incompatible states in the case of (1) and (7) are states of belief that p and belief that not-p (or belief and disbelief), what are the incompatible states in this case?

The non-cognitive mental state expressed by (3) is presumably something like disapproval of lying. So what is the non-cognitive state that is expressed by (8)? On the face of it, this seems like it should be an easy question to answer, but upon reflection, it turns out to be really quite puzzling. Whatever is expressed by (8), it should be something that is independently plausible as the content of such a claim, and it should be something that is somehow incompatible with the state expressed by (3). But what is it?

To see why this is puzzling, consider the following three sentences (adapted from Unwin 1999 and 2001):

(9) Jones does not think that lying is wrong.

(10) Jones thinks that not lying is wrong.

(11) Jones thinks that lying is not wrong.

These three sentences say three importantly different things about Jones. Furthermore, it seems as if the state attributed to Jones in (11) should be the very same state as the one expressed by (8) above. But again, what is that state? Let us proceed by process of elimination. It cannot be that (11) attributes to Jones a state of approval, that is, approving of lying. Presumably, for Jones to approve of lying would be for Jones to think that lying is right, or good. But that is not what (11) says; it says only that he thinks lying is not wrong. Nor can (11) attribute to Jones a lack of disapproval of lying, since that is what is attributed in (9), and as we’ve already agreed, (9) and (11) tell us different things about Jones. Moreover, (11) also cannot attribute to Jones the state of disapproval of not lying, since that is the state being attributed in (10). But at this point, it is hard to see what mental state is left to be attributed to Jones in (11), and to be the content of (8).

The expressivist does not want to say that (3) and (8) express incompatible beliefs, or states of belief and disbelief, as with (1) and (7), since beliefs are cognitive states, and we know that expressivists are psychological non-cognitivists. If (3) and (8) express beliefs, and we share with Hume the idea that beliefs by themselves are incapable of motivating, then we will apparently not have the resources for explaining the close connection between people sincerely making one of these claims and their being motivated to act accordingly. Nor does the expressivist want to say that (3) and (8) express inconsistent propositions, since that would be to abandon her semantic non-factualism. Propositions are often thought to determine truth conditions, and truth conditions are often thought to be ways the world might be. So to allow that (3) and (8) express propositions would presumably be to allow that there is a way the world might be that would make it true that lying is wrong. Furthermore, accounting for this would involve the expressivist in precisely the sort of moral metaphysical inquiries she seeks to avoid. For these reasons, it is crucial for the expressivist to find a non-cognitive mental state to be the content of (8). It must be something incompatible with the state expressed by (3), and it must be a plausible candidate for the state attributed to Jones in (11). But as we have seen, it is very difficult to articulate just what state it is.

Expressivists must show us that, even after accepting global semantic ideationalism, we are still able to account for all of the same phenomena as those accounted for by traditional propositional approaches to meaning. But here it seems they struggle even with something as simple as negation. Further, until they provide a satisfactory explanation of the contents of negated ethical claims, it will remain unclear whether they really do have a better account of moral disagreement than ethical subjectivists, as has long been claimed.

b. Making Sense of Attitude Ascriptions

Earlier, it was noted that ethical claims are no different from non-ethical claims in being able to articulate the objects of various states of mind. Let us now look closer at why expressivists may have a problem accounting for this particular point of continuity between ethical and non-ethical discourse.

(12) Frank fears that it is snowing.

(13) Wanda wonders whether it is snowing.

(14) Haddie hates that it is snowing.

Claims (12)-(14) ascribe three different attitudes to Frank, Wanda, and Haddie. Clearly, however, these three attitudes have something in common, something that can be represented by the claim from earlier

(1) It is snowing.

Traditionally, the way that philosophers of mind and language have accounted for this is by saying that (1) expresses the proposition that it is snowing, and that what all three of the attitudes ascribed to Frank, Wanda, and Haddie have in common is that they are all directed at one and the same proposition, that is, they all have the same proposition as their object.

By abandoning traditional propositional semantics, though, expressivists take on the burden of finding some other way of explaining how the contents of expressions like “fears that”, “wonders whether”, and “hates that” are supposed to relate to the content of whatever follows them. If the content of (1) is supposed to be something like the belief that it is snowing, as ideationalists suppose, and (1) is also supposed to be able to articulate the object of Frank’s fear, then the expressivist is apparently committed to thinking that Frank’s fear is actually directed at the belief that it is snowing. But, of course, Frank is not afraid of the belief that it is snowing—he is not afraid to believe that it is snowing—rather, he is afraid that it is snowing.

Things are no less problematic in the ethical case. For consider:

(15) Frank fears that lying is wrong.

(16) Wanda wonders whether lying is wrong.

(17) Haddie hates that lying is wrong.

Here again, it seems right to say that the attitudes ascribed in (15)-(17) all share something in common, something that can be represented by the claim from earlier

(3) Lying is wrong.

But if it is denied that (3) expresses a proposition, as ethical expressivists and non-cognitivists always have, it becomes unclear how (3) could be used to articulate the object of those attitudes. Focus upon (15) for a moment. Now, what are the contents of ‘fears that’ and ‘lying is wrong’, such that the latter is the object of the former? We presumably have one answer already, from the expressivist: the content of ‘lying is wrong’ in (15), like the content of (3), is an attitude of disapproval toward lying. However, on the plausible assumption that the content of “fears that” is an attitude of fear toward the content of whatever follows, we apparently get the expressivist saying that (15) ascribes to Frank a fear of disapproval of lying, or a fear of disapproving of lying. But surely that is not what (15) ascribes to Frank. He may fear these other things as well, but (15) says only that he fears that lying is wrong.

The expressivist may try to avoid this puzzle by insisting that “lying is wrong” as it appears in (15) has a content that is different from the content of (3), but this still leaves us wondering what the meanings of claims like (15)-(17) are supposed to be, according to the expressivist’s ideationalist semantics. As Schroeder explains, expressivists “owe an account of the meaning of each and every attitude verb, for example, fears that, wonders whether, and so on; just as much as they owe an account of “not”, “and”, and “if … then”. Very little progress has yet been made on how non-cognitivists [or expressivists] can treat attitude verbs, and the prospects for further progress look dim” (Schroeder 2008d, p.716).

c. Saving the Differences

One might think that a simple way to defeat any non-factualist account of ethical claims is simply to point out that we can coherently embed ethical claims into truth claims. It makes perfect sense, for instance, for someone to say, “It is true that lying is wrong.” Presumably, however, this could only make sense if whatever follows “It is true that” is the sort of thing that can be true. Of course, propositions are among the sorts of things that can be true, in fact, this is often thought to be their distinguishing characteristic. But non-factualists deny that ethical claims express propositions. So how do they account for the fact that the truth-predicate seems to apply just as well to ethical claims as it does to non-ethical claims?

If this were a devastating problem for non-cognitivists, then the non-cognitivist tradition in ethics would not have lasted for very long, since philosophers were well aware of the matter soon after Ayer first published Language, Truth, and Logic in 1936. The thought then—essentially just an application of Ramsey’s (1927) famous redundancy theory of truth—was that, in at least some cases, the truth-predicate does not actually ascribe some metaphysically robust property being true to whatever it is being predicated of. Rather, to add the truth-predicate to a claim is to do nothing more than to simply assert the claim by itself. In claiming that “It is true that lying is wrong,” on this view, a speaker expresses the very same state that is expressed by claiming only that “Lying is wrong,” and nothing more; hence, the “redundancy” of the truth predicate.

In early twenty-first century discourse, theories like Ramsey’s are referred to as deflationary or minimalist theories of truth, since they effectively “deflate” or “minimize” the ontological significance of the truth-predicate. Some ethical expressivists, in part as a way of solving the Continuity Problem, have taken to supplementing their expressivism with deflationism. The basic idea goes something like this: if we accept a deflationary theory of truth across the board, we can apparently say that ethical claims are truth-apt, in fact, every bit as truth-apt as any other sort of claim. This allows the expressivist to avoid simple versions of the objection noted at the beginning of this section. Interestingly, the deflationism need not stop with the truth-predicate. We might also deflate the notion of a proposition by insisting that a proposition is just whatever is expressed by a truth-apt claim. As long as we allow that ethical claims are truth-apt, in some deflationary sense, we may now be able to say, for instance, that

(3) Lying is wrong

expresses the proposition that lying is wrong, after all. If this is allowed, then the expressivist may now have the resources for accounting for the compositionality of ethical discourse in basically the same way in which traditional propositional semanticists would do so. The meanings of complex ethical claims are to be understood in terms of the propositions expressed by their parts. Once the notion of a proposition is deflated, we might just as well deflate the notion of belief by saying something to the effect that all it is for one to believe that p is for one to accept a claim that expresses the proposition that p. In these ways, perhaps an expressivist can “earn the right” to talk of truth, propositions, and beliefs, and perhaps also knowledge, in the ethical domain, just as they do in non-ethical domains.

This is the essence of Blackburn’s brand of expressivism, known commonly nowadays as ‘quasi-realism’. As we saw earlier, moral realists are those who believe that moral properties have every bit the ontological status as other, less controversial properties, like roundness and solidity. This allows realists to account for things like truth, propositions, beliefs, and knowledge in the ethical domain in precisely the same way that we ordinarily do in other domains, such as those that include facts about roundness and solidity. By deflating the relevant notions, however, Blackburn and other moral non-realists are nonetheless supposed to be able to say all the things that realists say about moral truth, and the like; hence, “quasi”-realism.

There are at least two problems for ethical expressivists who take this approach to solving the Continuity Problem. The first is simply that deflationism is independently a very controversial view. In his own defense of a deflationary theory of truth, Paul Horwich addresses no fewer than thirty-nine “alleged difficulties” faced by such a theory (Horwich 1998). Granted, he apparently believes that all of these difficulties can be addressed with some degree of satisfaction, but few will deny that deflationary theories of truth represent a departure from the common assumption that truth is a real property of things, and that this property consists in something like a thing’s corresponding with reality. Deflationism may help expressivists avoid the Continuity Problem, but at the cost of then burdening them to defend deflationism against its many problems.

A second and more interesting problem, though, is that taking this deflationary route may, in the end, ruin what was supposed to be so unique about expressivism all along. In other words, there is a sense in which deflationism may too good a response to the Continuity Problem. After all, at the core of ethical expressivism is the belief that there is some significant difference between ethical and non-ethical discourse. Recall again our two basic instances of each:

(1) It is snowing.

(3) Lying is wrong.

As we just saw, once deflationism is allowed to run its course, we end up saying remarkably similar things about (1) and (3). Both are truth-apt; both express propositions; both can be the objects of belief; both can be known; and so forth. But now you may be wondering: what, then, is supposed to be the significant difference that sets (3) apart from (1)? Or, another way of putting it: what would be the point of contention between an expressivist and her opponents if both parties agreed to deflate such notions as truth, proposition, and belief? This has sometimes been called the problem of “saving the differences” between ethical and non-ethical discourse.

One response to this problem might be to say that the relevant differences between ethical and non-ethical discourse actually occur at a level below the surface of the two linguistic domains. Recall that we deflated the notion of belief by saying that to believe that p is just to accept a claim that expresses the proposition that p. Using these terms, the expressivist might say that the main difference between (1) and (3) is a matter of what is involved in “accepting” the two claims. Accepting an ethical claim like (3) is something importantly different from accepting a non-ethical claim like (1), and presumably the difference has something to do with the types of mental states involved in doing so. Whether or not this sort of response will work is the subject of an ongoing debate in early twenty-first century philosophical literature.

5. Recent Trends

While the Continuity Problem remains a lively point, or collection of points, of debate between expressivists and their critics, it is certainly not the only topic with which those involved in the literature are currently occupied. Here we review a few other recent trends in expressivist thought, perhaps the most notable among them being the advent of so-called “hybrid” expressivist theories.

a. Expressivists’ Attitude Problem

There are some who would say that the Continuity Problem just is the Frege-Geach Problem, that is, that the Frege-Geach Problem ought to be understood very broadly, so as to include all of the many issues associated with the apparent logical and semantic continuities between ethical and non-ethical discourse. Even so, ethical expressivism faces other problems as well. Let us now look briefly at an issue that is receiving more and more attention these days—the so-called Moral Attitude Problem for ethical expressivism.

Recall again that expressivists often claim to have a better way of accounting for the nature of moral disagreement than the account on offer from ethical subjectivists. The idea, according to the expressivist, is supposed to be that a moral disagreement is ultimately just a disagreement in non-cognitive attitudes. Rather than expressing propositions about their opposing attitudes—which, we saw earlier, would be perfectly compatible with each other—the two disagreeing parties directly express those opposing non-cognitive attitudes. But then, in our discussion of the puzzle about negation, we saw that the expressivist may actually owe us more than this. Specifically, she owes us an explanation of what, exactly, those opposing attitudes are supposed to be. If Jones claims that lying is wrong, and Smith claims that it is not wrong, then Jones and Smith are engaged in a moral disagreement about lying. The expressivist, presumably, will say that Jones expresses something like disapproval of lying. But then what is the state that is directly expressed by Smith’s claim, such that it is disagrees, or is incompatible, with Jones’ disapproval?

According to the Moral Attitude Problem, the issue actually runs deeper than this, for there are more constraints on the expressivist’s answer than just that the state expressed by Smith be something incompatible with Jones’ disapproval of lying. In fact, Jones’ disapproval of lying may turn out to be no less mysterious than whatever sort of state is supposed to be expressed by Smith. After all, we disapprove of all sorts of things. Suppose that Jones also disapproves of Quentin Tarantino movies, but Smith does not. Presumably, this would not count as a moral disagreement, despite the fact that Jones and Smith are expressing mental states similar to those expressed in their disagreement about lying. So what is it, according to ethical expressivism, that makes the one disagreement, and not the other, a moral disagreement? This is especially puzzling given that expressivists often clarify their view by saying that moral disagreements are more like aesthetic disagreements, like a disagreement over Tarantino films; than they are like disagreements over facts, such as whether or not it is snowing.

So the Moral Attitude Problem, basically, is the problem of specifying the exact type, or types, of attitude expressed by ethical claims, such that someone expressing the relevant state counts as making an ethical claim—as opposed to an aesthetic claim, or something else entirely. Judith Thomson raises something like the Moral Attitude Problem when she writes,

The [ethical expressivist] needs to avail himself of a special kind of approval and disapproval: these have to be moral approval and moral disapproval. For presumably he does not wish to say that believing Alice ought to do a thing is having toward her doing it the same attitude of approval that I have toward the sound of her splendid new violin. (Thomson 1996, p.110)

And several years later, in a paper entitled “Some Not-Much-Discussed Problems for Non-Cognitivism in Ethics,” Michael Smith raises the same problem:

[Ethical expressivists] insist that it is analytic that when people sincerely make normative claims they thereby express desires or aversions. But which desires and aversions … , and what special feature do they possess that makes them especially suitable for expression in a normative claim? (Smith 2001, p.107)

But it is only very recently that expressivists and their opponents have begun to give the Moral Attitude Problem the attention that it deserves (see Merli 2008; Kauppinen 2010; Köhler 2013; Miller 2013, pp.39-47, pp.81-87; and Björnsson and McPherson 2014)

What can the expressivist say in response? For starters, expressivists can, and should, point out that the Moral Attitude Problem is not unique to their view. Indeed, those who think that ethical claims express cognitive states, like beliefs—namely, ethical cognitivists—face a very similar challenge: Jones believes both that lying is wrong and that Quentin Tarantino movies are bad, but only one of these counts as a moral belief; what is it, exactly, that distinguishes the moral from the non-moral belief? Cognitivists will say that the one belief has a moral proposition as its content, whereas the other belief does not. But that just pushes the question back a step: what, now, is it that distinguishes the moral from the non-moral proposition? Whether it be a matter of spelling out the difference between moral and non-moral beliefs, or that between moral and non-moral propositions, cognitivists are no less burdened to give an account of the nature of moral thinking than are ethical expressivists.

In fact, Köhler argues that expressivists can actually take what are essentially the same routes in response to the Moral Attitude Problem as those taken by cognitivists. Cognitivists, he thinks, have just two options: they can either (a) characterize the nature of moral thinking by reference to some realm of sui generis moral facts which, when they are the objects of beliefs, make those beliefs moral beliefs, or else (b) do the same, but without positing a realm of sui generis moral facts, and instead identifying moral facts with some set of non-moral facts. Similarly, it seems expressivists have two options: they can either (a) say that “the moral attitude” is some sui generis state of mind, or else (b) insist that “the moral attitude” can be analyzed in terms of non-cognitive mental states with which we are already familiar, like desires and aversions, approval and disapproval, and so forth.

The second of these options for expressivists is certainly the more popular of the two. But according to Köhler, if expressivists are to be successful in taking this approach, they ought to conceive of the identity between “the moral attitude” and other, more familiar non-cognitive states in much the same way that naturalistic moral realists conceive of the identity between moral and non-moral facts—that is, either by insisting that the identity is synthetic a posteriori, as the so-called “Cornell realists” do with moral and non-moral facts, or by insisting that the identity is conceptual, but non-obvious, an approach to conceptual analysis proposed by David Lewis, and recently taken up by a few philosophers from Canberra. Otherwise, if an expressivist is comfortable allowing for a sui generis non-cognitive mental state to hold the place of “the moral attitude,” she should get to work explaining what this state is like. Indeed, Köhler argues that this can be done without violating expressivism’s long-standing commitment to metaphysical naturalism (see Köhler 2013, pp.495-507).

b. Hybrid Theories

Perhaps the most exciting of recent trends in the expressivism literature is the advent of so-called “hybrid” expressivist theories. The idea behind hybrid theories, very basically, is that we might be able to secure all of the advantages of both expressivism and cognitivism by allowing that ethical claims express both non-cognitive and cognitive mental states. Why call them hybrid expressivist views, then, and not hybrid cognitivist views? Recall that the two central theses of ethical expressivism are psychological non-cognitivism—the thesis that ethical claims express mental states that are characteristically non-cognitive—and semantic ideationalism—the thesis that the meanings of ethical claims are to be understood in terms of the mental states that they express. Since neither of these theses state that ethical claims express only non-cognitive states, the hybrid theorist can affirm both of them whole-heartedly. For that reason, hybrid theories are generally considered to be forms of expressivism.

The idea that a single claim might express two distinct mental states is not a new one. Philosophers of language have long thought, for instance, that slurs and pejoratives are capable of doing this. Consider the term “yankee” as used by people living in the American South. In most cases, among Southerners, to call someone a “yankee” is to express a certain sort of negative attitude toward the person. But importantly, the term “yankee” cannot apply to just anyone, rather, it applies only to people who are from the North. Acordingly, when native Southerner Roy says, “Did you hear? Molly’s dating a yankee!” he expresses both (a) a belief that Molly’s partner is from the North, and (b) a negative attitude toward Molly’s partner. It seems we need to suppose that Roy has and expresses both of these states—one cognitive, the other non-cognitive—in order to make adequate sense of the meaning of his claim. In much the same way, hybrid theorists in metaethics suggest that ethical claims can express both beliefs and attitudes. Indeed, these philosophers often model their theories on an analogy to the nature of slurs and pejoratives (see Hay 2013).

Even within the expressivist tradition, the language of hybridity may be new, but the basic idea is not. Recall from earlier that Hare believed ethical claims have two sorts of meaning: descriptive meaning and prescriptive meaning. To claim that something is “good,” he thinks, is to both (a) say or imply that it has some context-specific set of non-moral properties; this is the claim’s descriptive meaning, and (b) commend the thing in virtue of these properties; this is the claim’s prescriptive meaning. This is not far off from a hybrid view according to which “good”-claims express both (a) a belief that something has some property or properties, and (b) a positive non-cognitive attitude toward the thing. Hare was apparently ahead of his time in this respect. The hybrid movement as it is now known is less than a decade old.

One of the earliest notable hybrid views is Ridge’s “ecumenical expressivism” (see Ridge 2006 and 2007). In its initial form, ecumenical expressivism is the view that ethical claims express two closely related mental states—one a belief, and the other a non-cognitive state like approval or disapproval. Furthermore, as an instance of semantic ideationalism, ecumenical expressivism adds that the literal meanings, or semantic contents, of ethical claims are to be understood solely in terms of these mental states. So, for example, the claim

(3) Lying is wrong

expresses something like these two states: (a) disapproval of things that have a certain property F, and (b) a belief that lying has property F. Notably, the view allows for a kind of subjectivity to moral judgment, since the nature of property F will differ from person to person. A utilitarian, for instance, might disapprove of behavior that fails to maximize utility; a Kantian might instead disapprove of behavior that disrespects people’s autonomy; and so on and so forth. Furthermore, Ridge’s view is supposed to be able to solve the Frege-Geach Problem by conceiving of logical inference and validity in terms of the relationships that obtain among beliefs.

(4) If lying is wrong, then getting your little brother to lie is wrong.

According to ecumenical expressivism, complex ethical claims like (4) also express two states: (a) disapproval of things that have a certain property F, and (b) the complex belief that if lying has property F, then getting one’s little brother to lie has property F as well. Coupled with an account of logical validity understood in terms of consistency of beliefs, this looks like a promising way to satisfy Geach’s two challenges. (Ridge has since updated his view so that it is no longer a semantic theory, but rather a meta-semantic theory. Thus, rather than attempting to assign literal meanings to ethical claims, Ridge means only to explain that in virtue of which ethical claims have the meanings that they do. See Ridge 2014.)

The implicature-style views defended by Copp and Finlay also fall within the hybrid camp (Copp 2001, 2009; Finlay 2004, 2005). Coined by philosopher H. Paul Grice, the term “implicature” refers to a semantic phenomenon in which a speaker means or implies one thing, while saying something else. A popular example is that of the professor who writes, “Alex has good handwriting,” in a letter of recommendation. What the professor says is that Alex has good handwriting, but what the professor means or implies is that Alex is not an especially good student. So the claim “Alex has good handwriting” has both a literal content, that Alex has good handwriting, and an implicated content, that Alex is not an especially good student.

In the same way, Copp and Finlay suggest that ethical claims have both literal and implicated contents. Once again:

(3) Lying is wrong

According to these implicature-style views, someone who sincerely utters (3) thereby communicates two things. First, she either expresses a belief, or asserts a proposition, to the effect that lying is wrong—this is the claim’s literal content. Second, she implies that she has some sort of non-cognitive attitude toward lying—this is the claim’s implicated content. It is in this way that implicature-style views are supposed to capture the virtues of both cognitivism and expressivism. Where Copp and Finlay disagree is over the matter of what it is in virtue of which the non-cognitive attitude is implicated. According to Copp, it is a matter of linguistic conventions that govern ethical discourse; whereas Finlay thinks it is a matter of the dynamics of ethical conversation. So Copp’s view is an instance of conventional implicature, while Finlay’s is an instance of conversational implicature.

There may be yet another way to “go hybrid” with one’s expressivism. Rather than hybridizing the mental state(s) expressed by ethical claims, one might instead hybridize the very notion of expression itself. This is the route taken by defenders of a view known as ‘ethical neo-expressivism’ (Bar-On and Chrisman 2009; Bar-On, Chrisman, and Sias 2014). Ethical neo-expressivism rests upon two very important distinctions. The first is a distinction between two different kinds of expression. When we say that agents express their mental states and that sentences express propositions, we refer not just to two different instances of expression, but more importantly, to two different kinds expression, which are often conflated by expressivists. To see how the two kinds of expression come apart, consider:

(18) It is so great to see you!

(19) I am so glad to see you!

Intuitively, these two sentences have different semantic contents. Setting aside complicated issues related to indexicality, sentence (18) expresses the proposition that it is so great to see you (the addressee), and sentence (19) expresses the proposition that I (the speaker) am so glad to see you (the addressee). However, these two different sentences might nonetheless function as vehicles for expressing the same mental state, that is, I might express my gladness or joy at seeing a friend by uttering either of them. Indeed, I might also do so by hugging my friend, or even just by smiling. Importantly, the neo-expressivist urges, it is not the speaker who expresses this or that proposition, but the sentences. People cannot express propositions, but sentences can, in virtue of being conventional representations of them. However, it is not the sentences that express gladness or joy, but the speaker. Sentences cannot express mental states; they are just strings of words. But people can certainly express their mental states by performing various acts, some of which involve the utterance of sentences. Call the relation between sentences and propositions semantic-expression, or s-expression; and call the relation between agents and their mental states action-expression, or a-expression.

According to neo-expressivists, most ethical expressivists, including most hybrid theorists, conflate these two senses of expression because they fail to adequately recognize a second distinction. Notice that terms like “claim”, “judgment”, and “statement” are ambiguous: they might refer either to an act or to the product of that act. So the term “ethical claim” might refer either to the act of making an ethical claim, or to the product of this act—which, presumably, is a sentence tokened either in thought or in speech. This distinction between ethical claims understood as acts and ethical claims understood as products maps nicely onto the earlier distinction between a- and s-expression. Understood as acts, ethical claims are different from non-ethical claims in that, when making an ethical claim, a speaker a-expresses some non-cognitive attitude. In this way, neo-expressivists can apparently affirm psychological non-cognitivism, and may also have the resources for “saving the differences” between ethical and non-ethical discourse. On the other hand, understood as products—that is, sentences containing ethical terms—ethical claims are just like non-ethical claims in s-expressing propositions, and not necessarily in the deflationary sense of proposition noted above. By allowing that ethical claims express propositions, the neo-expressivist may have all she needs in order to avoid the Continuity Problem.

Now, according to some, semantic ideationalism is essential to expressivism. Gibbard, for instance, writes, “The term ‘expressivism’ I mean to cover any account of meanings that follow this indirect path: to explain the meaning of a term, explain what states of mind the term can be used to express” (2003, p.7). However, ethical neo-expressivism, as we have just seen, rejects semantic ideationalism in favor of the more traditional propositional approach to meaning. In light of this, one might legitimately wonder whether neo-expressivism ought to count as an expressivist view. But as Bar-On, Chrisman, and Sias (2014) argue, neo-expressivism is perfectly capable of accommodating both of the main motivations of non-cognitivism and expressivism described in Sections 1 and 3—that is, avoiding a commitment to “spooky,” irreducibly normative properties, and accounting for the close connection between sincere ethical claims and motivation. Besides, as we saw earlier, it looks like the expressivist’s commitment to semantic ideationalism is what got her into trouble with the Continuity Problem in the first place. So even if neo-expressivism represents something of a departure from mainstream expressivist thought, it may nonetheless be a departure worth considering.

c. Recent Work in Empirical Moral Psychology

Expressivists have long recognized that it is possible to make an ethical claim without being in whatever is supposed to be the corresponding non-cognitive mental state. It is possible, for instance, to utter

(3) Lying is wrong

without, at the same time, disapproving of lying. Maybe the speaker is just reciting a line from a play; or maybe the speaker suffers from a psychological disorder that renders him incapable of ever being in the relevant non-cognitive state, and he is just repeating something that he has heard others say. These are surely possibilities, and expressivists have at times had different things to say about them, and other cases like them. Either way, though, expressivists generally assume that ethical claims are nonetheless tied to non-cognitive states in a way that justifies us in thinking that a speaker of an ethical claim, if she is being sincere, ought to be motivated to act accordingly. This is one of the two main motivations that attract people to theories in the expressivist tradition.

The assumption that sincere ethical claims in ordinary cases are accompanied by non-cognitive states is presumably one that has empirical implications. If true, for instance, one might expect to find activity in regions of the brain associated with such states as people make ethical claims sincerely. Indeed, this is precisely what researchers in empirical moral psychology have found throughout various studies conducted over the past few decades. From brain scans to behavioral experiments, tests of skin conductance to moral judgment surveys given in disgusting environments, study after study seems to confirm a view that is sometimes called “psychological sentimentalism”—that is, the view that people are prompted to make the ethical claims that they make primarily by their emotional responses to things.

Now, to be sure, the link posited by psychological sentimentalism is a causal one—our emotions cause us to make certain ethical claims—and that is importantly different from the conceptual link that expressivists generally assume exists between non-cognitive states and ethical claims. But expressivists may nonetheless benefit from exploring how recent work in empirical moral psychology can be used to support parts of their view—for example, how it is that the conceptual link is supposed to have come about. If nothing else, expressivists may find significant empirical support for the view, shared by everyone in the tradition since Ayer, that ethical claims are expressions of characteristically non-cognitive states of mind.

6. References and Further Reading

Austin, J. L. (1970). “Other Minds.” In J. O. Urmson and G. J. Warnock (eds.), Philosophical Papers. Second Edition. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Ayer, A. J. (1946/1952). Language, Truth, and Logic. New York: Dover.
Barker, S. (2006). “Truth and the Expressing in Expressivism.” In Horgan, T. and Timmons, M. (eds.). Metaethics after Moore. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Bar-On, D. and M. Chrisman (2009). “Ethical Neo-Expressivism.” In R. Shafer-Landau (ed.). Oxford Studies in Metaethics, Vol. 4. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Bar-On, D., M. Chrisman, and J. Sias (2014). “(How) Is Ethical Neo-Expressivism a Hybrid View.” In M. Ridge and G. Fletcher (eds.), Having It Both Ways: Hybrid Theories and Modern Metaethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Björnsson, G. and T. McPherson (2014). “Moral Attitudes for Non-Cognitivists: Solving the Specification Problem,” Mind,
Blackburn, S. (1984). Spreading the Word. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Blackburn, S. (1988a). “Attitudes and Contents.” Ethics 98: 501-17.
Blackburn, S. (1988b). “Supervenience Revisited.” In G. Sayre-McCord (ed.), Essays on Moral Realism. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
Blackburn, S. (1998). Ruling Passions. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Boisvert, D. (2008). “Expressive-Assertivism.” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 89(2): 169-203.
Boyd, R. (1988). “How to Be a Moral Realist.” In G. Sayre-McCord (ed.), Essays on Moral Realism. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
Brink, D. (1989). Moral Realism and the Foundations of Ethics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Chrisman, M. (2008). “Expressivism, Inferentialism, and Saving the Debate.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 77: 334-358.
Chrisman, M. (2012). “Epistemic Expressivism.” Philosophy Compass 7(2): 118-126.
Copp, D. (2001). “Realist-Expressivism: A Neglected Option for Moral Realism.” Social Philosophy and Policy 18(2): 1-43.
Copp, D. (2009). “Realist-Expressivism and Conventional Implicature.” In Shafer-Landau, R. (ed.). Oxford Studies in Metaethics, Vol. 4. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Coventry, A. (2006). Hume’s Theory of Causation: A Quasi-Realist Interpretation. London: Continuum.
Divers, J. and A. Miller (1994). “Why Expressivists About Value Should Not Love Minimalism About Truth.” Analysis 54: 12-19.
Dreier, J. (2004). “Meta-Ethics and the Problem of Creeping Minimalism.” Philosophical Perspectives 18: 23-44.
Dreier, J. (2009). “Relativism (and Expressivism) and the Problem of Disagreement.” Philosophical Perspectives 23: 79-110.
Finlay, S. (2004). “The Conversational Practicality of Value Judgment.” The Journal of Ethics 8: 205-223.
Finlay, S. (2005). “Value and Implicature.” Philosophers’ Imprint 5: 1-20.
Geach, P. (1965). “Assertion.” Philosophical Review 74: 449-465.
Gert, J. (2002). “Expressivism and Language Learning.” Ethics 112: 292-314.
Gibbard, A. (1990). Wise Choices, Apt Feelings. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Gibbard, A. (2003). Thinking How to Live. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Greene, J. D. (2008). “The Secret Joke of Kant’s Soul.” In Walter Sinnott-Armstrong (ed.), Moral Psychology, Vol. 3: The Neuroscience of Morality: Emotion, Brain Disorders, and Development. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, pp. 35-79.
Greene, J. D. and J. Haidt (2002). “How (and Where) Does Moral Judgment Work?” Trends in Cognitive Sciences 6: 517-523.
Haidt, J. (2001). “The Emotional Dog and Its Rational Tail: A Social Intuitionist Approach to Moral Judgment.” Psychological Review 108(4): 814-834.
Hare, R. M. (1952). The Language of Morals. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Hare, R. M. (1970). “Meaning and Speech Acts.” The Philosophical Review 79: 3-24.
Hay, Ryan. (2013). “Hybrid Expressivism and the Analogy between Pejoratives and Moral Language.” European Journal of Philosophy 21(3): 450-474.
Horwich, P. (1998). Truth. Second Edition. Oxford: Blackwell.
Jackson, F. (1998). From Metaphysics to Ethics. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Jackson, F. and P. Pettit (1995). “Moral Functionalism and Moral Motivation.” Philosophical Quarterly 45: 20-40.
Kauppinen, A. (2010). “What Makes a Sentiment Moral?” In R. Shafer-Landau (ed.), Oxford Studies in Metaethics, Vol. 5. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Köhler, S. (2013). “Do Expressivists Have an Attitude Problem?” Ethics 123(3): 479-507.
Lewis, D. (1970). “How to Define Theoretical Terms.” Journal of Philosophy 67: 427-446.
Lewis, D. (1972). “Psychophysical and Theoretical Identifications.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 50: 249-258.
Mackie, J. L. (1977). Ethics: Inventing Right and Wrong. London: Penguin.
Merli, D. (2008). “Expressivism and the Limits of Moral Disagreement.” Journal of Ethics 12: 25-55.
Miller, A. (2013). Contemporary Metaethics: An Introduction. Second Edition. Cambridge: Polity.
Moore, G. E. (1903). Principia Ethica. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Nichols, S. (2004). Sentimental Rules: On the Natural Foundations of Moral Judgment. New York: Oxford University Press.
Ogden, C. K. and I. A. Richards (1923). The Meaning of Meaning. New York: Harcourt Brace & Jovanovich.
Price, H. (2011). “Expressivism for Two Voices.” In J. Knowles and H. Rydenfelt (eds.). Pragmatism, Science, and Naturalism. Peter Lang.
Prinz, J. (2006). “The Emotional Basis of Moral Judgments.” Philosophical Explorations 9(1): 29-43.
Ramsey, F. P. (1927). “Facts and Propositions.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 7 (Supplementary): 153-170.
Ridge, M. (2006). “Ecumenical Expressivism: Finessing Frege.” Ethics 116: 302-336.
Ridge, M. (2007). “Ecumenical Expressivism: The Best of Both Worlds?” In Shafer-Landau, R. (ed.). Oxford Studies in Metaethics, Vol. 2. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Ridge, M. (2014). Impassioned Belief. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Ridge, M. and G. Fletcher, eds. (2014). Having It Both Ways: Hybrid Theories and Modern Metaethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Schroeder, M. (2008a). Being For: Evaluating the Semantic Program of Expressivism. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Schroeder, M. (2008b). “Expression for Expressivists.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 76(1): 86-116.
Schroeder, M. (2008c). “How Expressivists Can and Should Solve Their Problem with Negation.” Noûs 42(4): 573-599.
Schroeder, M. (2008d). “What is the Frege-Geach Problem?” Philosophy Compass 3(4): 703-720.
Schroeder, M. (2009). “Hybrid Expressivism: Virtues and Vices.” Ethics 119(2): 257-309.
Searle, J. (1962). “Meaning and Speech Acts.” Philosophical Review 71 (1962): 423-32.
Searle, J. (1969). Speech Acts: An Essay in the Philosophy of Language. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Smith, M. (1994a). The Moral Problem. Oxford: Blackwell.
Smith, M. (1994b). “Why Expressivists About Value Should Love Minimalism About Truth.” Analysis 54: 1-12.
Smith, M. (2001). “Some Not-Much-Discussed Problems for Non-Cognitivism in Ethics.” Ratio 14: 93-115.
Stevenson, C. L. (1937). “The Emotive Meaning of Ethical Terms.” Mind 46: 14-31.
Stevenson, C. L. (1944). Ethics and Language. New Haven: Yale University Press.
Strawson, P. F. (1949). “Truth.” Analysis 9: 83-97.
Thomson, J. (1996). “Moral Objectivity.” In G. Harman and J. Thomson, Moral Relativism and Moral Objectivity (Great Debates in Philosophy). Oxford: Blackwell.
Unwin, N. (1999). “Quasi-Realism, Negation and the Frege-Geach Problem.” Philosophical Quarterly 49: 337-352.
Unwin, N. (2001). “Norms and Negation: A Problem for Gibbard’s Logic.” Philosophical Quarterly 51: 60-75.
Yalcin, S. (2012). “Bayesian Expressivism.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society CXII(2): 123-160.

Author Information

James Sias
Email: siasj@dickinson.edu
Dickinson College
U. S. A.

Gottfried Leibniz: Philosophy of Mind

Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646-1716) was a true polymath: he made substantial contributions to a host of different fields such as mathematics, law, physics, theology, and most subfields of philosophy. Within the philosophy of mind, his chief innovations include his rejection of the Cartesian doctrines that all mental states are conscious and that non-human animals lack souls as well as sensation. Leibniz’s belief that non-rational animals have souls and feelings prompted him to reflect much more thoroughly than many of his predecessors on the mental capacities that distinguish human beings from lower animals. Relatedly, the acknowledgment of unconscious mental representations and motivations enabled Leibniz to provide a far more sophisticated account of human psychology. It also led Leibniz to hold that perception—rather than consciousness, as Cartesians assume—is the distinguishing mark of mentality.

The capacities that make human minds superior to animal souls, according to Leibniz, include not only their capacity for more elevated types of perceptions or mental representations, but also their capacity for more elevated types of appetitions or mental tendencies. Self-consciousness and abstract thought are examples of perceptions that are exclusive to rational souls, while reasoning and the tendency to do what one judges to be best overall are examples of appetitions of which only rational souls are capable. The mental capacity for acting freely is another feature that sets human beings apart from animals and it in fact presupposes the capacity for elevated kinds of perceptions as well as appetitions.

Another crucial contribution to the philosophy of mind is Leibniz’s frequently cited mill argument. This argument is supposed to show, through a thought experiment that involves walking into a mill, that material things such as machines or brains cannot possibly have mental states. Only immaterial things, that is, soul-like entities, are able to think or perceive. If this argument succeeds, it shows not only that our minds must be immaterial or that we must have souls, but also that we will never be able to construct a computer that can truly think or perceive.

Finally, Leibniz’s doctrine of pre-established harmony also marks an important innovation in the history of the philosophy of mind. Like occasionalists, Leibniz denies any genuine interaction between body and soul. He agrees with them that the fact that my foot moves when I decide to move it, as well as the fact that I feel pain when my body gets injured, cannot be explained by a genuine causal influence of my soul on my body, or of my body on my soul. Yet, unlike occasionalists, Leibniz also rejects the idea that God continually intervenes in order to produce the correspondence between my soul and my body. That, Leibniz thinks, would be unworthy of God. Instead, God has created my soul and my body in such a way that they naturally correspond to each other, without any interaction or divine intervention. My foot moves when I decide to move it because this motion has been programmed into it from the very beginning. Likewise, I feel pain when my body is injured because this pain was programmed into my soul. The harmony or correspondence between mental states and states of the body is therefore pre-established.

Leibnizian Minds and Mental States
1. Perceptions
  1. Consciousness, Apperception, and Reflection
  2. Abstract Thought, Concepts, and Universal Truths
2. Appetitions
Freedom
The Mill Argument
The Relation between Mind and Body
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources in English Translation
2. Secondary Sources

1. Leibnizian Minds and Mental States

Leibniz is a panpsychist: he believes that everything, including plants and inanimate objects, has a mind or something analogous to a mind. More specifically, he holds that in all things there are simple, immaterial, mind-like substances that perceive the world around them. Leibniz calls these mind-like substances ‘monads.’ While all monads have perceptions, however, only some of them are aware of what they perceive, that is, only some of them possess sensation or consciousness. Even fewer monads are capable of self-consciousness and rational perceptions. Leibniz typically refers to monads that are capable of sensation or consciousness as ‘souls,’ and to those that are also capable of self-consciousness and rational perceptions as ‘minds.’ The monads in plants, for instance, lack all sensation and consciousness and are hence neither souls nor minds; Leibniz sometimes calls this least perfect type of monad a ‘bare monad’ and compares the mental states of such monads to our states when we are in a stupor or a dreamless sleep. Animals, on the other hand, can sense and be conscious, and thus possess souls (see Animal Minds). God and the souls of human beings and angels, finally, are examples of minds because they are self-conscious and rational. As a result, even though there are mind-like things everywhere for Leibniz, minds in the stricter sense are not ubiquitous.

All monads, even those that lack consciousness altogether, have two basic types of mental states: perceptions, that is, representations of the world around them, and appetitions, or tendencies to transition from one representation to another. Hence, even though monads are similar to the minds or souls described by Descartes in some ways—after all, they are immaterial substances—consciousness is not an essential property of monads, while it is an essential property of Cartesian souls. For Leibniz, then, the distinguishing mark of mentality is perception, rather than consciousness (see Simmons 2001). In fact, even Leibnizian minds in the stricter sense, that is, monads capable of self-consciousness and reasoning, are quite different from the minds in Descartes’s system. While Cartesian minds are conscious of all their mental states, Leibnizian minds are conscious only of a small portion of their states. To us it may seem obvious that there is a host of unconscious states in our minds, but in the seventeenth century this was a radical and novel notion. This profound departure from Cartesian psychology allows Leibniz to paint a much more nuanced picture of the human mind.

One crucial aspect of Leibniz’s panpsychism is that in addition to the rational monad that is the soul of a human being, there are non-rational, bare monads everywhere in the human being’s body. Leibniz sometimes refers to the soul of a human being or animal as the central or dominant monad of the organism. The bare monads that are in an animal’s body, accordingly, are subordinate to its dominant monad or soul. Even plants, for Leibniz, have central or dominant monads, but because they lack sensation, these dominant monads cannot strictly speaking be called souls. They are merely bare monads, like the monads that are subordinate to them.

The claim that there are mind-like things everywhere in nature—in our bodies, in plants, and even in inanimate objects—strikes many readers of Leibniz as ludicrous. Yet, Leibniz thinks he has conclusive metaphysical arguments for this claim. Very roughly, he holds that a complex, divisible thing such as a body can only be real if it is made up of parts that are real. If the parts in turn have parts, those have to be real as well. The problem is, Leibniz claims, that matter is infinitely divisible: we can never reach parts that do not themselves have parts. Even if there were material atoms that we cannot actually divide, they must still be spatially extended, like all matter, and therefore have spatial parts. If something is spatially extended, after all, we can at least in thought distinguish its left half from its right half, no matter how small it is. As a result, Leibniz thinks, purely material things are not real. The reality of complex wholes depends on the reality of their parts, but with purely material things, we never get to parts that are real since we never reach an end in this quest for reality. Leibniz concludes that there must be something in nature that is not material and not divisible, and from which all things derive their reality. These immaterial, indivisible things just are monads. Because of the role they play, Leibniz sometimes describes them as “atoms of substance, that is, real unities absolutely destitute of parts, […] the first absolute principles of the composition of things, and, as it were, the final elements in the analysis of substantial things” (p. 142. For a more thorough description of monads, see Leibniz: Metaphysics, as well as the Monadology and the New System of Nature, both included in Ariew and Garber.)

a. Perceptions

As already seen, all monads have perceptions, that is, they represent the world around them. Yet, not all perceptions—not even all the perceptions of minds—are conscious. In fact, Leibniz holds that at any given time a mind has infinitely many perceptions, but is conscious only of a very small number of them. Even souls and bare monads have an infinity of perceptions. This is because Leibniz believes, for reasons that need not concern us here (but see Leibniz: Metaphysics), that each monad constantly perceives the entire universe. For instance, even though I am not aware of it at all, my mind is currently representing every single grain of sand on Mars. Even the monads in my little toe, as well as the monads in the apple I am about to eat, represent those grains of sand.

Leibniz often describes perceptions of things of which the subject is unaware and which are far removed from the subject’s body as ‘confused.’ He is fond of using the sound of the ocean as a metaphor for this kind of confusion: when I go to the beach, I do not hear the sound of each individual wave distinctly; instead, I hear a roaring sound from which I am unable to discern the sounds of the individual waves (see Principles of Nature and Grace, section 13, in Ariew and Garber, 1989). None of these individual sounds stands out. Leibniz claims that confused perceptions in monads are analogous to this confusion of sounds, except of course for the fact that monads do not have to be aware even of the confused whole. To the extent that a perception does stand out from the rest, however, Leibniz calls it ‘distinct.’ This distinctness comes in degrees, and Leibniz claims that the central monads of organisms always perceive their own bodies more distinctly than they perceive other bodies.

Bare monads are not capable of very distinct perceptions; their perceptual states are always muddled and confused to a high degree. Animal souls, on the other hand, can have much more distinct perceptions than bare monads. This is in part because they possess sense organs, such as eyes, which allow them to bundle and condense information about their surroundings (see Principles of Nature and Grace, section 4). The resulting perceptions are so distinct that the animals can remember them later, and Leibniz calls this kind of perception ‘sensation.’ The ability to remember prior perceptions is extremely useful, as a matter of fact, because it enables animals to learn from experience. For instance, a dog that remembers being beaten with a stick can learn to avoid sticks in the future (see Principles of Nature and Grace, section 5, in Ariew and Garber, 1989). Sensations are also tied to pleasure and pain: when an animal distinctly perceives some imperfection in its body, such as a bruise, this perception just is a feeling of pain. Similarly, when an animal perceives some perfection of its body, such as nourishment, this perception is pleasure. Unlike Descartes, then, Leibniz believed that animals are capable of feeling pleasure and pain.

Consequently, souls differ from bare monads in part through the distinctness of their perceptions: unlike bare monads, souls can have perceptions that are distinct enough to give rise to memory and sensation, and they can feel pleasure and pain. Rational souls, or minds, share these capacities. Yet they are additionally capable of perceptions of an even higher level. Unlike the souls of lower animals, they can reflect on their own mental states, think abstractly, and acquire knowledge of necessary truths. For instance, they are capable of understanding mathematical concepts and proofs. Moreover, they can think of themselves as substances and subjects: they have the ability to use and understand the word ‘I’ (see Monadology, section 30). These kinds of perceptions, for Leibniz, are distinctively rational perceptions, and they are exclusive to minds or rational souls.

It is clear, then, that there are different types of perceptions: some are unconscious, some are conscious, and some constitute reflection or abstract thought. What exactly distinguishes these types of perceptions, however, is a complicated question that warrants a more detailed investigation.

i. Consciousness, Apperception, and Reflection

Why are some perceptions conscious, while others are not? In one text, Leibniz explains the difference as follows: “it is good to distinguish between perception, which is the internal state of the monad representing external things, and apperception, which is consciousness, or the reflective knowledge of this internal state, something not given to all souls, nor at all times to a given soul” (Principles of Nature and Grace, section 4). This passage is interesting for several reasons: Leibniz not only equates consciousness with what he calls ‘apperception,’ and states that only some monads possess it. He also seems to claim that conscious perceptions differ from other perceptions in virtue of having different types of things as their objects: while unconscious perceptions represent external things, apperception or consciousness has perceptions, that is, internal things, as its object. Consciousness is therefore closely connected to reflection, as the term ‘reflective knowledge’ also makes clear.

The passage furthermore suggests that Leibniz understands consciousness in terms of higher-order mental states because it says that in order to be conscious of a perception, I must possess “reflective knowledge” of that perception. One way of interpreting this statement is to understand these higher-order mental states as higher-order perceptions: in order to be conscious of a first-order perception, I must additionally possess a second-order perception of that first-order perception. For example, in order to be conscious of the glass of water in front of me, I must not only perceive the glass of water, but I must also perceive my perception of the glass of water. After all, in the passage under discussion, Leibniz defines ‘consciousness’ or ‘apperception’ as the reflective knowledge of a perception. Such higher-order theories of consciousness are still endorsed by some philosophers of mind today (see Consciousness). For an alternative interpretation of Leibniz’s theory of consciousness, however, see Jorgensen 2009, 2011a, and 2011b).

There is excellent textual evidence that according to Leibniz, consciousness or apperception is not limited to minds, but is instead shared by animal souls. One passage in which Leibniz explicitly ascribes apperception to animals is from the New Essays: “beasts have no understanding … although they have the faculty for apperceiving the more conspicuous and outstanding impressions—as when a wild boar apperceives someone who is shouting at it” (p. 173). Moreover, Leibniz sometimes claims that sensation involves apperception (e.g. New Essays p. 161; p. 188), and since animals are clearly capable of sensation, they must thus possess some form of apperception. Hence, it seems that Leibniz ascribes apperception to animals, which in turn he elsewhere identifies with consciousness.

Yet, the textual evidence for animal consciousness is unfortunately anything but neat because in the New Essays—that is, in the very same text—Leibniz also suggests that there is an important difference between animals and human beings somewhere in this neighborhood. In several passages, he says that any creature with consciousness has a moral or personal identity, which in turn is something he grants only to minds. He states, for instance, that “consciousness or the sense of I proves moral or personal identity” (New Essays, p. 236). Hence, it seems clear that for Leibniz there is something in the vicinity of consciousness that animals lack and that minds possess, and which is crucial for morality.

A promising solution to this interpretive puzzle is the following: what animals lack is not consciousness generally, but only a particular type of consciousness. More specifically, while they are capable of consciously perceiving external things, they lack awareness, or at least a particular type of awareness, of the self. In the Monadology, for instance, Leibniz argues that knowledge of necessary truths distinguishes us from animals and that through this knowledge “we rise to reflexive acts, which enable us to think of that which is called ‘I’ and enable us to consider that this or that is in us” (sections 29-30). Similarly, he writes in the Principles of Nature and Grace that “minds … are capable of performing reflective acts, and capable of considering what is called ‘I’, substance, soul, mind—in brief, immaterial things and immaterial truths” (section 5). Self-knowledge, or self-consciousness, then, appears to be exclusive to rational souls. Leibniz moreover connects this consciousness of the self to personhood and moral responsibility in several texts, such as for instance in the Theodicy: “In saying that the soul of man is immortal one implies the subsistence of what makes the identity of the person, something which retains its moral qualities, conserving the consciousness, or the reflective inward feeling, of what it is: thus it is rendered susceptible to chastisement or reward” (section 89).

Based on these passages, it seems that one crucial cognitive difference between human beings and animals is that even though animals possess the kind of apperception that is involved in sensation and in an acute awareness of external objects, they lack a certain type of apperception or consciousness, namely reflective self-knowledge or self-consciousness. Especially because of the moral implications of this kind of consciousness that Leibniz posits, this difference is clearly an extremely important one. According to these texts, then, it is not consciousness or apperception tout court that distinguishes minds from animal souls, but rather a particular kind of apperception. What animals are incapable of, according to Leibniz, is self-knowledge or self-awareness, that is, an awareness not only of their perceptions, but also of the self that is having those perceptions.

Because Leibniz associates consciousness so closely with reflection, one might wonder whether the fact that animals are capable of conscious perceptions implies that they are also capable of reflection. This is another difficult interpretive question because there appears to be evidence both for a positive and for a negative answer. Reflection, according to Leibniz, is “nothing but attention to what is within us” (New Essays, p. 51). Moreover, as already seen, he argues that reflective acts enable us “to think of that which is called ‘I’ and … to consider that this or that is in us” (Monadology, section 30). Leibniz does not appear to ascribe reflection to animals explicitly, and in fact, there are several texts in which he says in no uncertain terms that they lack reflection altogether. He states for instance that “the soul of a beast has no more reflection than an atom” (Loemker, p. 588). Likewise, he defines ‘intellection’ as “a distinct perception combined with a faculty of reflection, which the beasts do not have” (New Essays, p. 173) and explains that “just as there are two sorts of perception, one simple, the other accompanied by reflections that give rise to knowledge and reasoning, so there are two kinds of souls, namely ordinary souls, whose perception is without reflection, and rational souls, which think about what they do” (Strickland, p. 84).

On the other hand, as seen, Leibniz does ascribe apperception or consciousness to animals, and consciousness in turn appears to involve higher-order mental states. This suggests that Leibnizian animals must perceive or know their own perceptions when they are conscious of something, and that in turn seems to imply that they can reflect after all. A closely related reason for ascribing reflection to animals is that Leibniz sometimes explicitly associates reflection with apperception or consciousness. In a passage already quoted above, for instance, Leibniz defines ‘consciousness’ as the reflective knowledge of a first-order perception. Hence, if animals possess consciousness it seems that they must also have some type of reflection.

We are consequently faced with an interpretive puzzle: even though there is strong indirect evidence that Leibniz attributes reflection to animals, there is also direct evidence against it. There are at least two ways of solving this puzzle. In order to make sense of passages in which Leibniz restricts reflection to rational souls, one can either deny that perceiving one’s internal states is sufficient for reflection, or one can distinguish between different types of reflection, in such a way that the most demanding type of reflection is limited to minds. One good way to deny that perception of one’s internal states is sufficient for reflection is to point out that Leibniz defines reflection as “attention to what is within us” (New Essays, p. 51), rather than as ‘perception of what is within us.’ Attention to internal states, arguably, is more demanding than mere perception of these states, and animals may well be incapable of the former. Attention might be a particularly distinct perception, for instance. Alternatively, one can argue that reflection requires a self-concept, or self-knowledge, which also goes beyond the mere perception of internal states and may be inaccessible to animals. Perceiving my internal states, on that interpretation, amounts to reflection only if I also possess knowledge of the self that is having those states. Instead of denying that perceiving one’s own states is sufficient for reflection, one can also distinguish different types of reflection and claim that while the mere perception of one’s internal states is a type of reflection, there is a more demanding type of reflection that requires attention, a self-concept, or something similar. Yet, the difference between those two responses appears to be merely terminological. Based on the textual evidence discussed above, it is clear that either reflection generally, or at least a particular type of reflection, must be exclusive to minds.

ii. Abstract Thought, Concepts, and Universal Truths

So far, we have seen that one cognitive capacity that elevates minds above animal souls is self-consciousness, which is a particular type of reflection. Before turning to appetitions, we should briefly investigate three additional, mutually related, cognitive abilities that only minds possess, namely the abilities to abstract, to form or possess concepts, and to know general truths. In what may well be Leibniz’s most intriguing discussion of abstraction, he says that some non-human animals “apparently recognize whiteness, and observe it in chalk as in snow; but it does not amount to abstraction, which requires attention to the general apart from the particular, and consequently involves knowledge of universal truths which beasts do not possess” (New Essays, p. 142). In this passage, we learn not only that beasts are incapable of abstraction, but also that abstraction involves “attention to the general apart from the particular” as well as “knowledge of universal truths.” Hence, abstraction for Leibniz seems to consist in separating out one part of a complex idea and focusing on it exclusively. Instead of thinking of different white things, one must think of whiteness in general, abstracting away from the particular instances of whiteness. In order to think about whiteness in the abstract, then, it is not enough to perceive different white things as similar to one another.

Yet, it might still seem mysterious how precisely animals should be able to observe whiteness in different objects if they are unable to abstract. One fact that makes this less mysterious, however, is that, on Leibniz’s view, while animals are unable to pay attention to whiteness in general, the idea of whiteness may nevertheless play a role in their recognition of whiteness. As Leibniz explains in the New Essays, even though human minds are aware of complex ideas and particular truths first as well as rather easily, and have to expend a lot of effort to subsequently achieve awareness of simple ideas and general principles, the order of nature is the other way around:

The truths that we start by being aware of are indeed particular ones, just as we start with the coarsest and most composite ideas. But that doesn’t alter the fact that in the order of nature the simplest comes first, and that the reasons for particular truths rest wholly on the more general ones of which they are mere instances. … The mind relies on these principles constantly; but it does not find it so easy to sort them out and to command a distinct view of each of them separately, for that requires great attention to what it is doing. (p. 83f.)

Here, Leibniz says that minds can rely on general principles, or abstract ideas, without being aware of them, and without having distinct perceptions of them separately. This might help us to explain how animals can observe whiteness in different white objects without being able to abstract: the simple idea of whiteness might play a role in their cognition, even though they are not aware of it, and are unable to pay attention to this idea.

The passage just quoted is interesting for another reason: It shows that abstracting and achieving knowledge of general truths have a lot in common and presuppose the capacity to reflect. It takes a special effort of mind to become aware of abstract ideas and general truths, that is, to separate these out from complex ideas and particular truths. It is this special effort, it seems, of which animals are incapable; while they can at times achieve relatively distinct perceptions of complex or particular things, they lack the ability to pay attention, or at least sufficient attention, to their internal states. At least part of the reason for their inability to abstract and to know general truths, then, appears to be their inability, or at least very limited ability, to reflect.

Abstraction also seems closely related to the possession or formation of concepts: arguably, what a mind gains when abstracting the idea of whiteness from the complex ideas of particular white things is what we would call a concept of whiteness. Hence, since animals cannot abstract, they do not possess such concepts. They may nevertheless, as suggested above, have confused ideas such as a confused idea of whiteness that allows them to recognize whiteness in different white things, without enabling them to pay attention to whiteness in the abstract.

An interesting question that arises in this context is the question whether having an idea of the future or thinking about a future state requires abstraction. One reason to think so is that, plausibly, in order to think about the future, for instance about future pleasures or pains, one needs to abstract from the present pleasures or pains that one can directly experience, or from past pleasures and pains that one remembers. After all, just as one can only attain the concept of whiteness by abstracting from other properties of the particular white things one has experienced, so, arguably, one can only acquire the idea of future pleasures through abstraction from particular present pleasures. It may be for this reason that Leibniz sometimes notes that animals have “neither foresight nor anxiety for the future” (Huggard, p. 414). Apparently, he does not consider animals capable of having an idea of the future or of future states.

Leibniz thinks that in addition to sensible concepts such as whiteness, we also have concepts that are not derived from the senses, that is, we possess intellectual concepts. The latter, it seems, set us apart even farther from animals because we attain them through reflective self-awareness, of which animals, as seen above, are not capable. Leibniz says, for instance, that “being is innate in us—the knowledge of being is comprised in the knowledge that we have of ourselves. Something like this holds of other general notions” (New Essays, p. 102). Similarly, he states a few pages later that “reflection enables us to find the idea of substance within ourselves, who are substances” (New Essays, p. 105). Many similar statements can be found elsewhere. The intellectual concepts that we can discover in our souls, according to Leibniz, include not only being and substance, but also unity, similarity, sameness, pleasure, cause, perception, action, duration, doubting, willing, and reasoning, to name only a few. In order to derive these concepts from our reflective self-awareness, we must apparently engage in abstraction: I am distinctly aware of myself as an agent, a substance, and a perceiver, for instance, and from this awareness I can abstract the ideas of action, substance, and perception in general. This means that animals are inferior to us among other things in the following two ways: they cannot have distinct self-awareness, and they cannot abstract. They would need both of these capacities in order to form intellectual concepts, and they would need the latter—that is, abstraction—in order to form sensible concepts.

Intellectual concepts are not the only things that minds can find in themselves: in addition, they are also able to discover eternal or general truths there, such as the axioms or principles of logic, metaphysics, ethics, and natural theology. Like the intellectual concepts just mentioned, these general truths or principles cannot be derived from the senses and can thus be classified as innate ideas. Leibniz says, for instance,

Above all, we find [in this I and in the understanding] the force of the conclusions of reasoning, which are part of what is called the natural light. … It is also by this natural light that the axioms of mathematics are recognized. … [I]t is generally true that we know [necessary truths] only by this natural light, and not at all by the experiences of the senses. (Ariew and Garber, p. 189)

Axioms and general principles, according to this passage, must come from the mind itself and cannot be acquired through sense experience. Yet, also as in the case of intellectual concepts, it is not easy for us to discover such general truths or principles in ourselves; instead, it takes effort or special attention. It again appears to require the kind of attention to what is within us of which animals are not capable. Because they lack this type of reflection, animals are “governed purely by examples from the senses” and “consequently can never arrive at necessary and general truths” (Strickland p. 84).

b. Appetitions

Monads possess not only perceptions, or representations of the world they inhabit, but also appetitions. These appetitions are the tendencies or inclinations of these monads to act, that is, to transition from one mental state to another. The most familiar examples of appetitions are conscious desires, such as my desire to have a drink of water. Having this desire means that I have some tendency to drink from the glass of water in front of me. If the desire is strong enough, and if there are no contrary tendencies or desires in my mind that are stronger—for instance, the desire to win the bet that I can refrain from drinking water for one hour—I will attempt to drink the water. This desire for water is one example of a Leibnizian appetition. Yet, just as in the case of perceptions, only a very small portion of appetitions is conscious. We are unaware of most of the tendencies that lead to changes in our perceptions. For instance, I am aware neither of perceiving my hair growing, nor of my tendencies to have those perceptions. Moreover, as in the case of perceptions, there are an infinite number of appetitions in any monad at any given time. This is because, as seen, each monad represents the entire universe. As a result, each monad constantly transitions from one infinitely complex perceptual state to another, reflecting all changes that take place in the universe. The tendency that leads to a monad’s transition from one of these infinitely complex perceptual states to another is therefore also infinitely complex, or composed of infinitely many smaller appetitions.

The three types of monads—bare monads, souls, and minds—differ not only with respect to their perceptual or cognitive capacities, but also with respect to their appetitive capacities. In fact, there are good reasons to think that three different types of appetitions correspond to the three types of perceptions mentioned above, that is, to perception, sensation, and rational perception. After all, Leibniz distinguishes between appetitions of which we can be aware and those of which we cannot be aware, which he sometimes also calls ‘insensible appetitions’ or ‘insensible inclinations.’ He appears to further divide the type of which we can be aware into rational and non-rational appetitions. This threefold division is made explicit in a passage from the New Essays:

There are insensible inclinations of which we are not aware. There are sensible ones: we are acquainted with their existence and their objects, but have no sense of how they are constituted. … Finally there are distinct inclinations which reason gives us: we have a sense both of their strength and of their constitution. (p. 194)

According to this passage, then, Leibniz acknowledges the following three types of appetitions: (a) insensible or unconscious appetitions, (b) sensible or conscious appetitions, and (c) distinct or rational appetitions.

Even though Leibniz does not say so explicitly, he furthermore believes that bare monads have only unconscious appetitions, that animal souls additionally have conscious appetitions, and that only minds have distinct or rational appetitions. Unconscious appetitions are tendencies such as the one that leads to my perception of my hair growing, or the one that prompts me unexpectedly to perceive the sound of my alarm in the morning. All appetitions in bare monads are of this type; they are not aware of any of their tendencies. An example of a sensible appetition, on the other hand, is an appetition for pleasure. My desire for a piece of chocolate, for instance, is such an appetition: I am aware that I have this desire and I know what the object of the desire is, but I do not fully understand why I have it. Animals are capable of this kind of appetition; in fact, many of their actions are motivated by their appetitions for pleasure. Finally, an example of a rational appetition is the appetition for something that my intellect has judged to be the best course of action. Leibniz appears to identify the capacity for this kind of appetition with the will, which, as we will see below, plays a crucial role in Leibniz’s theory of freedom. What is distinctive of this kind of appetition is that whenever we possess it, we are not only aware of it and of its object, but also understand why we have it. For instance, if I judge that I ought to call my mother and consequently desire to call her, Leibniz thinks, I am aware of the thought process that led me to make this judgment, and hence of the origins of my desire.

Another type of rational appetition is the type of appetition involved in reasoning. As seen, Leibniz thinks that animals, because they can remember prior perceptions, are able to learn from experience, like the dog that learns to run away from sticks. This sort of behavior, which involves a kind of inductive inference (see Deductive and Inductive Arguments), can be called a “shadow of reasoning,” Leibniz tells us (New Essays, p. 50). Yet, animals are incapable of true—that is, presumably, deductive—reasoning, which, Leibniz tells us, “depends on necessary or eternal truths, such as those of logic, numbers, and geometry, which bring about an indubitable connection of ideas and infallible consequences” (Principles of Nature and Grace, section 5, in Ariew and Garber, 1989). Only minds can reason in this stricter sense.

Some interpreters think that reasoning consists simply in very distinct perception. Yet that cannot be the whole story. First of all, reasoning must involve a special type of perception that differs from the perceptions of lower animals in kind, rather than merely in degree, namely abstract thought and the perception of eternal truths. This kind of perception is not just more distinct; it has entirely different objects than the perceptions of non-rational souls, as we saw above. Moreover, it seems more accurate to describe reasoning as a special kind of appetition or tendency than as a special kind of perception. This is because reasoning is not just one perception, but rather a series of perceptions. Leibniz for instance calls it “a chain of truths” (New Essays, p. 199) and defines it as “the linking together of truths” (Huggard, p. 73). Thus, reasoning is not the same as perceiving a certain type of object, nor as perceiving an object in a particular fashion. Rather, it consists mainly in special types of transitions between perceptions and therefore, according to Leibniz’s account of how monads transition from perception to perception, in appetitions for these transitions. What a mind needs in order to be rational, therefore, are appetitions that one could call the principles of reasoning. These appetitions or principles allow minds to transition, for instance, from the premises of an argument to its conclusion. In order to conclude ‘Socrates is mortal’ from ‘All men are mortal’ and ‘Socrates is a man,’ for example, I not only need to perceive the premises distinctly, but I also need an appetition for transitioning from premises of a particular form to conclusions of a particular form.

Leibniz states in several texts that our reasonings are based on two fundamental principles: the Principle of Contradiction and the Principle of Sufficient Reason. Human beings also have access to several additional innate truths and principles, for instance those of logic, mathematics, ethics, and theology. In virtue of these principles we have a priori knowledge of necessary connections between things, while animals can only have empirical knowledge of contingent, or merely apparent, connections. The perceptions of animals, then, are not governed by the principles on which our reasonings are based; the closest an animal can come to reasoning is, as mentioned, engaging in empirical inference or induction, which is based not on principles of reasoning, but merely on the recognition and memory of regularities in previous experience. This confirms that reasoning is a type of appetition: using, or being able to use, principles of reasoning cannot just be a matter of perceiving the world more distinctly. In fact, these principles are not something that we acquire or derive from perceptions. Instead, at least the most basic ones are innate dispositions for making certain kinds of transitions.

In connection with reasoning, it is important to note that even though Leibniz sometimes uses the term ‘thought’ for perceptions generally, he makes it clear in some texts that it strictly speaking belongs exclusively to minds because it is “perception joined with reason” (Strickland p. 66; see also New Essays, p. 210). This means that the ability to think in this sense, just like reasoning, is also something that is exclusive to minds, that is, something that distinguishes minds from animal souls. Non-rational souls neither reason nor think, strictly speaking; they do however have perceptions.

The distinctive cognitive and appetitive capacities of the three types of monads are summarized in the following table:

2. Freedom

One final capacity that sets human beings apart from non-rational animals is the capacity for acting freely. This is mainly because Leibniz closely connects free agency with rationality: acting freely requires acting in accordance with one’s rational assessment of which course of action is best. Hence, acting freely involves rational perceptions as well as rational appetitions. It requires both knowledge of, or rational judgments about, the good, as well as the tendency to act in accordance with these judgments. For Leibniz, the capacity for rational judgments is called ‘intellect,’ and the tendency to pursue what the intellect judges to be best is called ‘will.’ Non-human animals, because they do not possess intellects and wills, or the requisite type of perceptions and appetitions, lack freedom. This also means, however, that most human actions are not free, because we only sometimes reason about the best course of action and act voluntarily, on the basis of our rational judgments. Leibniz in fact stresses that in three quarters of their actions, human beings act just like animals, that is, without making use of their rationality (see Principles of Nature and Grace, section 5, in Ariew and Garber, 1989).

In addition to rationality, Leibniz claims, free actions must be self-determined and contingent (see e.g. Theodicy, section 288). An action is self-determined—or spontaneous, as Leibniz often calls it—when its source is in the agent, rather than in another agent or some other external entity. While all actions of monads are spontaneous in a general sense since, as we will see in section four, Leibniz denies all interaction among created substances, he may have a more demanding notion of spontaneity in mind when he calls it a requirement for freedom. After all, when an agent acts on the basis of her rational judgment, she is not even subject to the kind of apparent influence of her body or of other creatures that is present, for instance, when someone pinches her and she feels pain.

In order to be contingent, on the other hand, the action cannot be the result of compulsion or necessitation. This, again, is generally true for all actions of monads because Leibniz holds that all changes in the states of a creature are contingent. Yet, there may again be an especially demanding sense in which free actions are contingent for Leibniz. He often says that when a rational agent does something because she believes it to be best, the goodness she perceives, or her motives for acting, merely incline her towards action without necessitating action (see e.g. Huggard, p. 419; Fifth Letter to Clarke, sections 8-9; Ariew and Garber, p. 195; New Essays, p. 175). Hence, Leibniz may be attributing a particular kind of contingency to free actions.

Even though Leibniz holds that free actions must be contingent, that is, that they cannot be necessary, he grants that they can be determined. In fact, Leibniz vehemently rejects the notion that a world with free agents must contain genuine indeterminacy. Hence, Leibniz is what we today call a compatibilist about freedom and determinism (see Free Will). He believes that all actions, whether they are free or not, are determined by the nature and the prior states of the agent. What is special about free actions, then, is not that they are undetermined, but rather that they are determined, among other things, by rational perceptions of the good. We always do what we are most strongly inclined to do, for Leibniz, and if we are most strongly inclined by our judgment about the best course of action, we pursue that course of action freely. The ability to act contrary even to one’s best reasons or motives, Leibniz contends, is not required for freedom, nor would it be worth having. As Leibniz puts it in the New Essays, “the freedom to will contrary to all the impressions which may come from the understanding … would destroy true liberty, and reason with it, and would bring us down below the beasts” (p. 180). In fact, being determined by our rational understanding of the good, as we are in our free actions, makes us godlike, because according to Leibniz, God is similarly determined by what he judges to be best. Nothing could be more perfect and more desirable than acting in this way.

3. The Mill Argument

In several of his writings, Leibniz argues that purely material things such as brains or machines cannot possibly think or perceive. Hence, Leibniz contends that materialists like Thomas Hobbes are wrong to think that they can explain mentality in terms of the brain. This argument is without question among Leibniz’s most influential contributions to the philosophy of mind. It is relevant not only to the question whether human minds might be purely material, but also to the question whether artificial intelligence is possible. Because Leibniz’s argument against perception in material objects often employs a thought experiment involving a mill, interpreters refer to it as ‘the mill argument.’ There is considerable disagreement among recent scholars about the correct interpretation of this argument (see References and Further Reading). The present section sketches one plausible way of interpreting Leibniz’s mill argument.

The most famous version of Leibniz’s mill argument occurs in section 17 of the Monadology:

Moreover, we must confess that perception, and what depends on it, is inexplicable in terms of mechanical reasons, that is, through shapes and motions. If we imagine that there is a machine whose structure makes it think, sense, and have perceptions, we could conceive it enlarged, keeping the same proportions, so that we could enter into it, as one enters into a mill. Assuming that, when inspecting its interior, we will only find parts that push one another, and we will never find anything to explain a perception. And so, we should seek perception in the simple substance and not in the composite or in the machine.

To understand this argument, it is important to recall that Leibniz, like many of his contemporaries, views all material things as infinitely divisible. As already seen, he holds that there are no smallest or most fundamental material elements, and every material thing, no matter how small, has parts and is hence complex. Even if there were physical atoms—against which Leibniz thinks he has conclusive metaphysical arguments—they would still have to be extended, like all matter, and we would hence be able to distinguish between an atom’s left half and its right half. The only truly simple things that exist are monads, that is, unextended, immaterial, mind-like things. Based on this understanding of material objects, Leibniz argues in the mill passage that only immaterial entities are capable of perception because it is impossible to explain perception mechanically, or in terms of material parts pushing one another.

Unfortunately Leibniz does not say explicitly why exactly he thinks there cannot be a mechanical explanation of perception. Yet it becomes clear in other passages that for Leibniz perceiving has to take place in a simple thing. This assumption, in turn, straightforwardly implies that matter—which as seen is complex—is incapable of perception. This, most likely, is behind Leibniz’s mill argument. Why does Leibniz claim that perception can only take place in simple things? If he did not have good reasons for this claim, after all, it would not constitute a convincing starting point for his mill argument.

Leibniz’s reasoning appears to be the following. Material things, such as mirrors or paintings, can represent complexity. When I stand in front of a mirror, for instance, the mirror represents my body. This is an example of the representation of one complex material thing in another complex material thing. Yet, Leibniz argues, we do not call such a representation ‘perception’: the mirror does not “perceive” my body. The reason this representation falls short of perception, Leibniz contends, is that it lacks the unity that is characteristic of perceptions: the top part of the mirror represents the top part of my body, and so on. The representation of my body in the mirror is merely a collection of smaller representations, without any genuine unity. When another person perceives my body, on the other hand, her representation of my body is a unified whole. No physical thing can do better than the mirror in this respect: the only way material things can represent anything is through the arrangement or properties of their parts. As a result, any such representation will be spread out over multiple parts of the representing material object and hence lack genuine unity. It is arguably for this reason that Leibniz defines ‘perception’ as “the passing state which involves and represents a multitude in the unity or in the simple substance” (Monadology, section 14).

Leibniz’s mill argument, then, relies on a particular understanding of perception and of material objects. Because all material objects are complex and because perceptions require unity, material objects cannot possibly perceive. Any representation a machine, or a material object, could produce would lack the unity required for perception. The mill example is supposed to illustrate this: even an extremely small machine, if it is purely material, works only in virtue of the arrangement of its parts. Hence, it is always possible, at least in principle, to enlarge the machine. When we imagine the machine thus enlarged, that is, when we imagine being able to distinguish the machine’s parts as we can distinguish the parts of a mill, we will realize that the machine cannot possibly have genuine perceptions.

Yet the basic idea behind Leibniz’s mill argument can be appealing even to those of us who do not share Leibniz’s assumptions about perception and material objects. In fact, it appears to be a more general version of what is today called “the hard problem of consciousness,” that is, the problem of explaining how something physical could explain, or give rise to, consciousness. While Leibniz’s mill argument is about perception generally, rather than conscious perception in particular, the underlying structure of the argument appears to be similar: mental states have characteristics—such as their unity or their phenomenal properties—that, it seems, cannot even in principle be explained physically. There is an explanatory gap between the physical and the mental.

4. The Relation between Mind and Body

The mind-body problem is a central issue in the philosophy of mind. It is, roughly, the problem of explaining how mind and body can causally interact. That they interact seems exceedingly obvious: my mental states, such as for instance my desire for a cold drink, do seem capable of producing changes in my body, such as the bodily motions required for walking to the fridge and retrieving a bottle of water. Likewise, certain physical states seem capable of producing changes in my mind: when I stub my toe on my way to the fridge, for instance, this event in my body appears to cause me pain, which is a mental state. For Descartes and his followers, it is notoriously difficult to explain how mind and body causally interact. After all, Cartesians are substance dualists: they believe that mind and body are substances of a radically different type (see Descartes: Mind-Body Distinction). How could a mental state such as a desire cause a physical state such as a bodily motion, or vice versa, if mind and body have absolutely nothing in common? This is the version of the mind-body problem that Cartesians face.

For Leibniz, the mind-body problem does not arise in exactly the way it arises for Descartes and his followers, because Leibniz is not a substance dualist. We have already seen that, according to Leibniz, an animal or human being has a central monad, which constitutes its soul, as well as subordinate monads that are everywhere in its body. In fact, Leibniz appears to hold that the body just is the collection of these subordinate monads and their perceptions (see e.g. Principles of Nature and Grace section 3), or that bodies result from monads (Ariew and Garber, p. 179). After all, as already seen, he holds that purely material, extended things would not only be incapable of perception, but would also not be real because of their infinite divisibility. The only truly real things, for Leibniz, are monads, that is, immaterial and indivisible substances. This means that Leibniz, unlike Descartes, does not believe that there are two fundamentally different kinds of substances, namely physical and mental substances. Instead, for Leibniz, all substances are of the same general type. As a result, the mind-body problem may seem more tractable for Leibniz: if bodies have a semi-mental nature, there are fewer obvious obstacles to claiming that bodies and minds can interact with one another.

Yet, for complicated reasons that are beyond the scope of this article (but see Leibniz: Causation), Leibniz held that human minds and their bodies—as well as any created substances, in fact—cannot causally interact. In this, he agrees with occasionalists such as Nicolas Malebranche. Leibniz departs from occasionalists, however, in his positive account of the relation between mental and corresponding bodily events. Occasionalists hold that God needs to intervene in nature constantly to establish this correspondence. When I decide to move my foot, for instance, God intervenes and moves my foot accordingly, occasioned by my decision. Leibniz, however, thinks that such interventions would constitute perpetual miracles and be unworthy of a God who always acts in the most perfect manner. God arranged things so perfectly, Leibniz contends, that there is no need for these divine interventions. Even though he endorses the traditional theological doctrine that God continually conserves all creatures in existence and concurs with their actions (see Leibniz: Causation), Leibniz stresses that all natural events in the created world are caused and made intelligible by the natures of created things. In other words, Leibniz rejects the occasionalist doctrine that God is the only active, efficient cause, and that the laws of nature that govern natural events are merely God’s intentions to move his creatures around in a particular way. Instead for Leibniz these laws, or God’s decrees about the ways in which created things should behave, are written into the natures of these creatures. God not only decided how creatures should act, but also gave them natures and natural powers from which these actions follow. To understand the regularities and events in nature, we do not need to look beyond the natures of creatures. This, Leibniz claims, is much more worthy of a perfect God than the occasionalist world, in which natural events are not internally intelligible.

How, then, does Leibniz explain the correspondence between mental and bodily states if he denies that there is genuine causal interaction among finite things and also denies that God brings about the correspondence by constantly intervening? Consider again the example in which I decide to get a drink from the fridge and my body executes that decision. It may seem that unless there is a fairly direct link between my decision and the action—either a link supplied by God’s intervention, or by the power of my mind to cause bodily motion—it would be an enormous coincidence that my body carries out my decision. Yet, Leibniz thinks there is a third option, which he calls ‘pre-established harmony.’ On this view, God created my body and my mind in such a way that they naturally, but without any direct causal links, correspond to one another. God knew, before he created my body, that I would decide to get a cold drink, and hence made my body in such a way that it will, in virtue of its own nature, walk to the fridge and get a bottle of water right after my mind makes that decision.

In one text, Leibniz provides a helpful analogy for his doctrine of pre-established harmony. Imagine two pendulum clocks that are in perfect agreement for a long period of time. There are three ways to ensure this kind of correspondence between them: (a) establishing a causal link, such as a connection between the pendulums of these clocks, (b) asking a person constantly to synchronize the two clocks, and (c) designing and constructing these clocks so perfectly that they will remain perfectly synchronized without any causal links or adjustments (see Ariew and Garber, pp. 147-148). Option (c), Leibniz contends, is superior to the other two options, and it is in this way that God ensures that the states of my mind correspond to the states of my body, or in fact, that the perceptions of any created substance harmonize with the perceptions of any other. The world is arranged and designed so perfectly that events in one substance correspond to events in another substance even though they do not causally interact, and even though God does not intervene to adjust one to the other. Because of his infinite wisdom and foreknowledge, God was able to pre-establish this mutual correspondence or harmony when he created the world, analogously to the way a skilled clockmaker can construct two clocks that perfectly correspond to one another for a period of time.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources in English Translation

Ariew, Roger and Daniel Garber, eds. Philosophical Essays. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1989.
- Contains translations of many of Leibniz’s most important shorter writings such as the Monadology, the Principles of Nature and Grace, the Discourse on Metaphysics, and excerpts from Leibniz’s correspondence, to name just a few.
Ariew, Roger, ed. Correspondence [between Leibniz and Clarke]. Indianapolis: Hackett, 2000.
- A translation of Leibniz’s correspondence with Samuel Clarke, which touches on many important topics in metaphysics and philosophy of mind.
Francks, Richard and Roger S. Woolhouse, eds. Leibniz’s ‘New System’ and Associated Contemporary Texts. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1997.
- Contains English translations of additional short texts.
Francks, Richard and Roger S. Woolhouse, eds. Philosophical Texts. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998.
- Contains English translations of additional short texts.
Huggard, E. M., ed. Theodicy: Essays on the Goodness of God, the Freedom of Man and the Origin of Evil. La Salle: Open Court, 1985.
- Translation of the only philosophical monograph Leibniz published in his lifetime, which contains many important discussions of free will.
Lodge, Paul, ed. The Leibniz–De Volder Correspondence: With Selections from the Correspondence between Leibniz and Johann Bernoulli. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2013.
- An edition, with English translations, of Leibniz’s correspondence with De Volder, which is a very important source of information about Leibniz’s mature metaphysics.
Loemker, Leroy E., ed. Philosophical Papers and Letters. Dordrecht: D. Reidel, 1970.
- Contains English translations of additional short texts.
Look, Brandon and Donald Rutherford, eds. The Leibniz–Des Bosses Correspondence. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2007.
- An edition, with English translations, of Leibniz’s correspondence with Des Bosses, which is another important source of information about Leibniz’s mature metaphysics.
Parkinson, George Henry Radcliffe and Mary Morris, eds. Philosophical Writings. London: Everyman, 1973.
- Contains English translations of additional short texts.
Remnant, Peter and Jonathan Francis Bennett, eds. New Essays on Human Understanding. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
- Translation of Leibniz’s section-by-section response to Locke’s Essay Concerning Human Understanding, written in the form of a dialogue between the two fictional characters Philalethes and Theophilus, who represent Locke’s and Leibniz’s views, respectively.
Rescher, Nicholas, ed. G.W. Leibniz’s Monadology: An Edition for Students. Pittsburgh: University of Pittsburgh Press, 1991.
- An edition, with English translation, of the Monadology, with commentary and a useful collection of parallel passages from other Leibniz texts.
Strickland, Lloyd H., ed. The Shorter Leibniz Texts: A Collection of New Translations. London: Continuum, 2006.
- Contains English translations of additional short texts.

b. Secondary Sources

Adams, Robert Merrihew. Leibniz: Determinist, Theist, Idealist. New York: Oxford University Press, 1994.
- One of the most influential and rigorous works on Leibniz’s metaphysics.
Borst, Clive. “Leibniz and the Compatibilist Account of Free Will.” Studia Leibnitiana 24.1 (1992): 49-58.
- About Leibniz’s views on free will.
Brandom, Robert. “Leibniz and Degrees of Perception.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 19 (1981): 447-79.
- About Leibniz’s views on perception and perceptual distinctness.
Davidson, Jack. “Imitators of God: Leibniz on Human Freedom.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 36.3 (1998): 387-412.
- Another helpful article about Leibniz’s views on free will and on the ways in which human freedom resembles divine freedom.
Davidson, Jack. “Leibniz on Free Will.” The Continuum Companion to Leibniz. Ed. Brandon Look. London: Continuum, 2011. 208-222.
- Accessible general introduction to Leibniz’s views on freedom of the will.
Duncan, Stewart. “Leibniz’s Mill Argument Against Materialism.” Philosophical Quarterly 62.247 (2011): 250-72.
- Helpful discussion of Leibniz’s mill argument.
Garber, Daniel. Leibniz: Body, Substance, Monad. New York: Oxford University Press, 2009.
- A thorough study of the development of Leibniz’s metaphysical views.
Gennaro, Rocco J. “Leibniz on Consciousness and Self-Consciousness.” New Essays on the Rationalists. Eds. Rocco J. Gennaro and C. Huenemann. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999. 353-371.
- Discusses Leibniz’s views on consciousness and highlights the advantages of reading Leibniz as endorsing a higher-order thought theory of consciousness.
Jolley, Nicholas. Leibniz. London; New York: Routledge, 2005.
- Good general introduction to Leibniz’s philosophy; includes chapters on the mind and freedom.
Jorgensen, Larry M. “Leibniz on Memory and Consciousness.” British Journal for the History of Philosophy 19.5 (2011a): 887-916.
- Elaborates on Jorgensen (2009) and discusses the role of memory in Leibniz’s theory of consciousness.
Jorgensen, Larry M. “Mind the Gap: Reflection and Consciousness in Leibniz.” Studia Leibnitiana 43.2 (2011b): 179-95.
- About Leibniz’s account of reflection and reasoning.
Jorgensen, Larry M. “The Principle of Continuity and Leibniz’s Theory of Consciousness.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 47.2 (2009): 223-48.
- Argues against ascribing a higher-order theory of consciousness to Leibniz.
Kulstad, Mark. Leibniz on Apperception, Consciousness, and Reflection. Munich: Philosophia, 1991.
- Influential, meticulous study of Leibniz’s views on consciousness.
Kulstad, Mark. “Leibniz, Animals, and Apperception.” Studia Leibnitiana 13 (1981): 25-60.
- A shorter discussion of some of the issues in Kulstad (1991).
Lodge, Paul, and Marc E. Bobro. “Stepping Back Inside Leibniz’s Mill.” The Monist 81.4 (1998): 553-72.
- Discusses Leibniz’s mill argument.
Lodge, Paul. “Leibniz’s Mill Argument Against Mechanical Materialism Revisited.” Ergo (2014).
- Further discussion of Leibniz’s mill argument.
McRae, Robert. Leibniz: Perception, Apperception, and Thought. Toronto: University of Toronto Press, 1976.
- An important and still helpful, even if somewhat dated, study of Leibniz’s philosophy of mind.
Murray, Michael J. “Spontaneity and Freedom in Leibniz.” Leibniz: Nature and Freedom. Eds. Donald Rutherford and Jan A. Cover. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2005. 194-216.
- Discusses Leibniz’s views on free will and self-determination, or spontaneity.
Phemister, Pauline. “Leibniz, Freedom of Will and Rationality.” Studia Leibnitiana 26.1 (1991): 25-39.
- Explores the connections between rationality and freedom in Leibniz.
Rozemond, Marleen. “Leibniz on the Union of Body and Soul.” Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie 79.2 (1997): 150-78.
- About the mind-body problem and pre-established harmony in Leibniz.
Rozemond, Marleen. “Mills Can’t Think: Leibniz’s Approach to the Mind-Body Problem.” Res Philosophica 91.1 (2014): 1-28.
- Another helpful discussion of the mill argument.
Savile, Anthony. Routledge Philosophy Guidebook to Leibniz and the Monadology. New York: Routledge, 2000.
- Very accessible introduction to Leibniz’s Monadology.
Simmons, Alison. “Changing the Cartesian Mind: Leibniz on Sensation, Representation and Consciousness.” The Philosophical Review 110.1 (2001): 31-75.
- Insightful discussion of the ways in which Leibniz’s philosophy of mind differs from the Cartesian view; also argues that Leibnizian consciousness consists in higher-order perceptions.
Sotnak, Eric. “The Range of Leibnizian Compatibilism.” New Essays on the Rationalists. Eds. Rocco J. Gennaro and C. Huenemann. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999. 200-223.
- About Leibniz’s theory of freedom.
Swoyer, Chris. “Leibnizian Expression.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 33 (1995): 65-99.
- About Leibnizian perception.
Wilson, Margaret Dauler. “Confused Vs. Distinct Perception in Leibniz: Consciousness, Representation, and God’s Mind.” Ideas and Mechanism: Essays on Early Modern Philosophy. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1999. 336-352.
- About Leibnizian perception as well as perceptual distinctness.

Author Information

Julia Jorati
Email: jorati.1@osu.edu
The Ohio State University
U. S. A.

Kwasi Wiredu (1931—2022)

Kwasi Wiredu was a philosopher from Ghana, who had for decades been involved with a project he termed “conceptual decolonization” in contemporary African systems of thought. By conceptual decolonization, Wiredu advocated a re-examination of current African epistemic formations in order to accomplish two aims. First, he wished to subvert unsavory aspects of tribal culture embedded in modern African thought so as to make that thought more viable. Second, he intended to dislodge unnecessary Western epistemologies that are to be found in African philosophical practices.

In previously colonized regions of the world, decolonization has remained a topical issue both at the highest theoretical levels and also at the basic level of everyday existence. After African countries attained political liberation, decolonization became an immediate and overwhelming preoccupation. A broad spectrum of academic disciplines took up the conceptual challenges of decolonization in a variety of ways. The disciplines of anthropology, history, political science, literature, and philosophy all grappled with the practical and academic conundrums of decolonization.

A central purpose in this article is to examine the contributions and limitations of African philosophy in relation to the history of the debate on decolonization. In this light, it sometimes appears that African philosophy has been quite limited in defining the horizons of the debate when compared with the achievements of academic specialties such as literature and cultural studies. Thus, decolonization has been rightly conceived as a vast, global, and trans-disciplinary enterprise.

This analysis involves an examination of both the limitations and immense possibilities of Wiredu’s theory of conceptual decolonization. First, the article offers a close reading of the theory itself and then locates it within the broader movement of modern African thought. In several instances, Wiredu’s theory has proved seminal to the advancement of contemporary African philosophical practices. It is also necessary to be aware of current imperatives of globalization, nationality, and territoriality and how they affect the agency of a theory such as ideological/conceptual decolonization. Indeed, the notion of decolonization is far more complex than is often assumed. Consequently, the epistemological resources by which it can be apprehended as a concept, ideology, or process are multiple and diverse. Lastly, this article, as a whole, represents a reflection on the diversity of the dimensions of decolonization.

Introduction
Early Beginnings
Decolonization as Epistemological Practice
Tradition, Modernity and the Challenges of Development
An African Reading of Karl Marx
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

As one of Africa’s foremost philosophers, Kwasi Wiredu has done a great deal to establish the discipline of philosophy, in its contemporary shape, as a credible area of intellection in most parts of the African continent and beyond. In order to appreciate the conceptual and historical contexts of his work, it is necessary to possess some familiarity with relevant discourses in African studies and history, anthropology, literature and postcolonial theory, particularly those advanced by Edward W. Said, Gayatri Spivak, Homi Bhabha, Abiola Irele and Biodun Jeyifo. Wiredu’s contribution to the making of modern African thought provides an interesting insight into the processes involved in the formation of postcolonial disciplines and discourses, and it can also be conceived as a counter-articulation to the hegemonic discourses of imperial domination.

Wiredu, for many decades, was involved with a project he termed conceptual decolonization in contemporary African systems of thought. This term entailed, for Wiredu, a re-examination of current African epistemic foundations in order to accomplish two main objectives. First, he intended to undermine counter-productive facets of tribal cultures embedded in modern African, thought so as to make this body of thought both more sustainable and more rational. Second, he intended to deconstruct the unnecessary Western epistemologies which may be found in African philosophical practices.

A broad spectrum of academic disciplines took up the conceptual challenges of decolonization in a variety of ways. In particular, the disciplines of anthropology, history, political science, literature and philosophy all grappled with the practical and academic challenges inherent to decolonization.

It is usually profitable to examine the contributions and limitations of African philosophers comparatively (along with other African thinkers who are not professional philosophers) in relation to the history of the debate on decolonization. In addition to the scholars noted above, the discourse of decolonialization has benefitted from many valuable contributions made by intellectuals such as Frantz Fanon, Leopold Sedar Senghor, Cheikh Anta Diop, and Ngugi wa Thiongo. In this light, it would appear that African philosophy has been, at certain moments, limited in defining the horizons of the debate when compared with the achievements of academic specialties such as literature, postcolonial theory and cultural studies. Thus, decolonization, as Ngugi wa Thiongo, the Kenyan cultural theorist and novelist, notes, must be conceived as a broad, transcontinental, and multidisciplinary venture.

Within the Anglophone contingent of African philosophy, the analytic tradition of British philosophy continues to be dominant. This discursive hegemony had led an evident degree of parochialism, according to Wiredu. This in turn has led to the neglect of many other important intellectual traditions. For instance, within this Anglophonic sphere, there is not always a systematic interrogation of the limits, excesses and uses of colonialist anthropology in formulating the problematic of identity. In this regard, the problematic of identity does not only refer to the question of personal agency but more broadly, the challenges of discursive identity. This shortcoming is not as evident in Francophone traditions of African philosophy, which usually highlight the foundational discursive interactions between anthropology and modern African thought. Thus, in this instance, there is an opening to other discursive formations necessary for the nurturing a vibrant philosophical practice. Also, within Anglophone African philosophy, a stringent critique of imperialism and contemporary globalization does not always figure is not always significantly in the substance of the discourse, thereby further underlining the drawbacks of parochialism. As such, it is necessary for critiques of Wiredu’s corpus to move beyond its ostensible frame to include critiques and discussions of traditions of philosophical practice outside the Anglophone divide of modern African thought (Osha, 2005). Accordingly, such critiques ought not merely be a celebration of post-structuralist discourses to the detriment of African intellectual traditions. Instead, they should be, among other things, an exploration of the discursive intimacies between the Anglophone and Francophone traditions of African philosophy. In addition, an interrogation of other borders of philosophy is required to observe the gains that might accrue to the Anglophone movement of contemporary African philosophy, which, in many ways, has reached a discursive dead-end due to its inability to surmount the intractable problematic of identity, and its endless preoccupation with the question of its origins. These are the sort of interrogations that readings of Wiredu’s work necessitate. Furthermore, a study of Wiredu’s corpus (Osha, 2005) identifies—if only obliquely—the necessity to re-assess the importance of other discourses such as colonialist anthropology and various philosophies of black subjectivity in the formation of the modern African subject. These are some of the central concerns which appear in Kwasi Wiredu and Beyond: The Text, Writing and Thought in Africa (2005).

2. Early Beginnings

Kwasi Wiredu was born in 1931 in Ghana and had his first exposure to philosophy quite early in life. He read his first couple of books of philosophy in school around 1947 in Kumasi, the capital of Ashanti. These books were Bernard Bosanquet’s The Essentials of Logic and C.E.M. Joad’s Teach Yourself Philosophy. Logic, as a branch of philosophy attracted Wiredu because of its affinities to grammar, which he enjoyed. He was also fond of practical psychology during the formative years of his life. In 1950, whilst vacationing with his aunt in Accra, the capital of Ghana, he came across another philosophical text which influenced him tremendously. The text was The Last Days of Socrates which had the following four dialogues by Plato: The Apology, Euthyphro, Meno and Crito. These dialogues were to influence, in a significant way, the final chapter of his first groundbreaking philosophical text, Philosophy and an African Culture (1980) which is also dialogic in structure.

He was admitted into the University of Ghana, Legon in 1952, to read philosophy, but before attending he started to study the thought of John Dewey on his own. However, mention must be made of the fact that C. E. M. Joad’s philosophy had a particularly powerful effect on him. Indeed, he employed the name J. E. Joad as his pen-name for a series of political articles he wrote for a national newspaper, The Ashanti Sentinel between 1950 and1951. At the University of Ghana, he was instructed mainly in Western philosophy and he came to find out about African traditions of thought more or less through his own individual efforts. He was later to admit that the character of his undergraduate education was to leave his mind a virtual tabula rasa, as far as African philosophy was concerned. In other words, he had to develop and maintain his interests in African philosophy on his own. One of the first texts of African philosophy that he read was J. B. Danquah’s Akan Doctrine of God: A Fragment of Gold Coast Ethics and Religion. Undoubtedly, his best friend William Abraham, who went a year before him to Oxford University, must have also influenced the direction of his philosophical research towards African thought. A passage from an interview explains the issue of his institutional relation to African philosophy:

Prior to 1985, when I was in Africa, I devoted most of my time in almost equal proportions to research in African philosophy and in other areas of philosophy, such as the philosophy of logic, in which not much has, or is generally known to have, been done in African philosophy. I did not have always to be teaching African philosophy or giving public lectures in African philosophy. There were others who were also competent to teach the subject and give talks in our Department of Philosophy. But since I came to the United States, I have often been called upon to teach or talk about African philosophy. I have therefore spent much more time than before researching in that area. This does not mean that I have altogether ignored my earlier interests, for indeed, I continue to teach subjects like (Western) logic and epistemology (Wiredu in Oladiop 2002: 332).

Wiredu began publishing relatively late, but has been exceedingly prolific ever since he started. During the early to mid 1970s, he often published as many as six major papers per year on topics ranging from logic, to epistemology, to African systems of thought, in reputable international journals. His first major book, Philosophy and an African Culture (1980) is truly remarkable for its eclectic range of interests. Paulin Hountondji, Wiredu’s great contemporary from the Republic of Benin, for many years had to deal with charges that his philosophically impressive corpus lacked ideological content and therefore merit from critics such as Olabiyi Yai (1977). Hountondji (1983; 2002) in those times of extreme ideologizing, never avoided the required measure of socialist posturing. Wiredu, on the other hand, not only avoided the lure of socialism but went on to denounce it as an unfit ideology. Within the context of the socio-political moment of that era, it seemed a reactionary—even injurious—posture to adopt. Nonetheless, he had not only laid the foundations of his project of conceptual decolonization at the theoretical level but had also begun to explore its various practical implications by his analyses of concepts such as “truth,” and also by his focused critique of some of the more counter-productive impacts of both colonialism and traditional culture.

By conceptual decolonization, Wiredu advocates a re-examination of current African epistemic formations in order to accomplish two objectives. First, he wishes to subvert unsavoury aspects of indigenous traditions embedded in modern African thought so as to make it more viable. Second, he intends to undermine the unhelpful Western epistemologies to be found in African philosophical traditions. On this important formulation of his he states:

By this I mean the purging of African philosophical thinking of all uncritical assimilation of Western ways of thinking. That, of course, would be only part of the battle won. The other desiderata are the careful study of our own traditional philosophies and the synthesising of any insights obtained from that source with any other insights that might be gained from the intellectual resources of the modern world. In my opinion, it is only by such a reflective integration of the traditional and the modern that contemporary African philosophers can contribute to the flourishing of our peoples and, ultimately, all other peoples. (Oladipo, 2002: 328)

In spite of his invaluable contributions to modern African thought, it can be argued that Wiredu’s schema falls short as a feasible long term epistemic project. Due to the hybridity of the postcolonial condition, projects seeking to retrieve the precolonial heritage are bound to be marred at several levels. It would be an error for Wiredu or advocates of his project of conceptual decolonization to attempt to universalize his theory since, as Ngugi wa Thiongo argues, decolonization is a vast, global enterprise. Rather, it is safer to read Wiredu’s project as a way of articulating theoretical presence for the de-agentialized and deterritorialized contemporary African subject. In many ways, his project resembles those of Ngugi wa Thiongo and Cheikh Anta Diop. Ngugi wa Thiongo advocates cultural and linguistic decolonization on a global scale and his theory has undergone very little transformation since its formulation in the 1960s. Diop advances a similar set of ideas to Wiredu on the subject of vibrant modern African identities. Wiredu’s project is linked in conceptual terms to the broader project of political decolonization as advanced by liberationist African leaders such as Julius Nyerere, Jomo Kenyatta, Kwame Nkrumah, and Nnamdi Azikiwe. But what distinguishes the particular complexion of his theory is its links with the Anglo-Saxon analytic tradition. This dimension is important in differentiating his project from those of his equally illustrious contemporaries such as V. Y. Mudimbe and Paulin Hountondji. In fact, it can be argued that Wiredu’s theory of conceptual decolonization has more similarities with Ngugi wa Thiongo’s ideas regarding African cultural and linguistic agency than Mudimbe’s archeological excavations of African traces in Western historical and anthropological texts.

3. Decolonization as Epistemological Practice

In all previously colonized regions of the world, decolonization remains a topic of considerable academic interest. Wiredu’s theory of conceptual decolonization is essentially what defines his attitudes and gestures towards the content of contemporary African thought. Also it is an insight that is inflected by years of immersion into British analytic philosophy. Wiredu began his reflections of the nature, legitimate aims, and possible orientations in contemporary African thought not as a result of any particular awareness of the trauma or violence of colonialism or imperialism but by a confrontation with the dilemma of modernity by the reflective (post)colonial African consciousness. This dialectic origin can be contrasted with those of his contemporaries such as Paulin Hountondji and V. Y. Mudimbe.

Despite criticisms regarding some aspects of his work, in terms of founding a tradition for the practice of modern African philosophy, Wiredu’s contributions have been pivotal. He has also been very consistent in his output and the quality of his reflections regardless of some of their more obvious limitations.

As noted earlier, Wiredu was trained in a particular tradition of Western philosophy: the analytic tradition. This fact is reflected in his corpus. A major charge held against him is that his contributions could be made even richer if he had grappled with other relevant discourses: postcolonial theory, African feminisms, contemporary Afrocentric discourses and the global dimensions of projects and discourses of decolonization.

Kwasi Wiredu’s interests and philosophical importance are certainly not limited to conceptual decolonization alone. He has offered some useful insights on Marxism, mysticism, metaphysics, and the general nature of the philosophical enterprise itself. Although his latter text, Cultural Universals and Particulars has a more Africa-centred orientation, his first book, Philosophy and an African Culture presents a wider range of discursive interests: a vigorous critique of Marxism, reflections on the phenomenon of ideology, analyses of truth and the philosophy of language, among other preoccupations. It is interesting to see how Wiredu weaves together these different preoccupations and also to observe how some of them have endured while others have not.

The volume Conceptual Decolonisation in African Philosophy is an apt summation of Wiredu’s philosophical interests with a decidedly African problematic while his landmark philosophical work, Philosophy and an African Culture, published first in 1980, should serve as a fertile source for more detailed elucidation.

In the second essay of Conceptual Decolonisation in African Philosophy entitled “The Need for Conceptual Decolonisation in African Philosophy”, Wiredu writes that “with an even greater sense of urgency the intervening decade does not seem to have brought any indications of a widespread realization of the need for conceptual decolonisation in African philosophy” (Wiredu, 1995: 23). The intention at this juncture is to examine some of the ways in which Wiredu has been involved in the daunting task of conceptual decolonization. Decolonization itself is a problematic exercise because it necessitates the jettisoning of certain conceptual attitudes that inform one’s worldviews. Secondly, it usually entails an attempt at the retrieval of a more or less fragmented historical heritage. Decolonization in Fanon’s conception entails this necessity for all colonized peoples and, in addition, it is “a programme of complete disorder” (Fanon, 1963:20). This understanding is purely political and has therefore, a practical import. This is not to say that Fanon had no plan for the project of decolonization in the intellectual sphere. Also associated with this project as it was then conceived was a struggle for the mental liberation of the colonized African peoples. It was indeed a program of violence in more senses than one.

However, with Wiredu, there isn’t an outright endorsement of violence, as decolonization in this instance amounts to conceptual subversion. As a logical consequence, it is necessary to stress the difference between Fanon’s conception of decolonization and Wiredu’s. Fanon is sometimes regarded as belonging to the same philosophical persuasion that harbours figures like Nkrumah, Senghor, Nyerere and Sekou Toure, “the philosopher-kings of early post-independence Africa” (Wiredu,1995:14), as Wiredu calls them. This is so because they had to live out the various dramas of existence and the struggles for self and collective identity at more or less the same colonial/postcolonial moment. Those “spiritual uncles” of professional African philosophers were engaged, as Wiredu states, in a strictly political struggle, and whatever philosophical insight they possessed was put at the disposal of this struggle, instead of a merely theoretical endeavour. Obviously, Fanon was the most astute theoretician of decolonization of the lot. In addition, for Fanon and the so-called philosopher-kings, decolonization was invested with a pan-African mandate and political appeal. This crucial difference should be noted alongside what shall soon be demonstrated to be the Wiredu conception of decolonization. Africans, generally, will have to continue to ponder the entire issue of decolonization as long as unsolved questions of identity remain and the challenges of collective development linger. This type of challenge was foreseen by Fanon.

The end of colonialism in Africa and other Third World countries did not entail the end of imperialism and the dominance of the metropolitan countries. Instead, the dynamics of dominance assumed a more complex, if subtle, form. African economic systems floundered alongside African political institutions, and, as a result, various crises have compounded the seemingly perennial issue of underdevelopment.

A significant portion of post-colonial theory involves the entry of Third World scholars into the Western archive, as it were, with the intention of dislodging the erroneous epistemological assumptions and structures regarding their peoples. This, arguably, is another variant of decolonization. Wiredu partakes of this type of activity, but sometimes he carries the program even further. Accordingly, he affirms:

Until Africa can have a lingua franca, we will have to communicate suitable parts of our work in our multifarious vernaculars, and in other forms of popular discourse, while using the metropolitan languages for international communication. (Wiredu, 1995:20)

This conviction has been a guiding principle with Wiredu for several years. In fact, it is not merely a conviction; there are several instances within the broad spectrum of his philosophical corpus where he tries to put it into practice. Two of such attempts are his essays “The Concept of Truth in the Akan Language” and “The Akan Concept of Mind.” In the first of these articles, Wiredu states “there is no one word in Akan for truth” (Wiredu, 1985:46). Similarly, he writes, “another linguistic contrast between Akan and English is that there is no word “fact” (Ibid.). It is necessary to cite the central thesis of the essay; Wiredu writes that he wants “to make a metadoctrinal point which reflection on the African language enables us to see, which is that a theory of truth is not of any real universal significance unless it offers some account of the notion of being so” (Ibid.).

Wiredu’s argument here, needs to be firmer. In many respects, he is only comparing component parts of the English language with the Akan language and not always with a view to drawing out “any real universal significance” as he says. The entire approach seems to be irrevocably restrictive. This is the distinction that lies between an oral culture and a textual one. Most African intellectuals usually gloss over this difference, even though they may acknowledge it. The difference is indeed very significant, because of the numerous imponderables that come into play. Abiola Irele has been able to demonstrate the tremendous significance of orality in the constitution of modern African forms of literary expression.

However, Wiredu is more convincing in his essay “Democracy and Consensus in African Traditional Politics: A Plea for a Non-Party Polity”. In this essay, Wiredu argues that the:

Ashanti system was a consensual democracy. It was a democracy because government was by the consent, and subject to the control, of the people as expressed through the representatives. It was consensual because, at least, as a rule, that consent was negotiated on the principle of consensus. (By contrast, the majoritarian system might be said to be, in principle, based on consent without consensus.) (Ibid. pp58-59)

When Wiredu broaches the issue of politics and its present and future contexts in postcolonial Africa, then we are compelled to visit a whole range of debates and discourses especially in the social sciences in Africa. These arearguably more directly concerned with questions pertaining to governance, democracy, and the challenges of contemporary globalization.

Another essay by Wiredu, entitled “The Akan Concept of Mind” is also an attempt of conceptual recontextualization. Wiredu begins by stating that he is restricting himself to a study of the Akans of Ghana in order “to keep the discussion within reasonable anthropological bounds” (Wiredu, 1983:113). His objective is a modest but nevertheless important one, since it fits quite well with his entire philosophical project which, as noted, is concerned with ironing out philosophical issues “on independent grounds” and possibly in one’s own language and the metropolitan language bequeathed by the colonial heritage.

It is therefore appropriate to proceed gradually, traversing the problematic interfaces between various languages in search of satisfactory structures of meaning. The immediate effect is a radical diminishing of the entire concept of African philosophy, a term which under these circumstances would become even more problematic. The consequence of Wiredu’s position is that to arrive at the essence of African philosophy, it would be necessary to dismantle its monolithic structure to make it more context-bound. First, Africa as a spatial entity would require further re-drawing of its often problematic geography. Second, a new thematics to mediate between the general and the particular would have to be found. Third, the critique of unanimism and ethnophilosophy would be driven into more contested terrains. These are some of the likely challenges posed by Wiredu’s approach.

Furthermore, in dealing with the traditional Akan conceptual system, or any other, for that matter, it should be borne in mind that what is in contention is “a folk philosophy, a body of originally unwritten ideas preserved in the oral traditions, customs and usages of a people” (Ibid.)_.

It would be appropriate to examine more closely his article “The Akan Concept of Mind”. Here, Wiredu enumerates the ways in which the English conception of mind differs markedly from that of the Akan, due in a large part to certain fundamental linguistic dissimilarities. He also makes the point that “the Akans most certainly do not regard mind as one of the entities that go to constitute a person” (Ibid. 121). It is significant to note this, but at the same time, it is difficult to imagine the ultimate viability of this approach. Indeed after reformulating traditional Western philosophical problems to suit African conditions, it remains to be seen how African epistemological claims can be substantiated using the natural and logical procedures available to African systems of thought. As such, it is possible to argue that this conceptual manoeuvre would eventually degenerate into a dead-end of epistemic nativism. These are the kinds of issues raised by Wiredu’s project.

As such, inherent in the thrust for complete decolonization is the presence of colonial violence itself. In addition, there is essentially a latent desire for epistemic violence, as well as difficulties concerning the negotiation of linguistic divides. In the following quotation, for example, Wiredu attempts to demonstrate the significance of some of those differences:

By comparison with the conflation of concepts of mind and soul prevalent in Western philosophy, the Akan separation of the “Okra” from “adwene” suggests a more analytical awareness of the sanctification of human personality. (Ibid.128)

It is necessary to substantiate more rigorously claims such as this because we may also be committing an error in establishing certain troublesome linguistic or philosophical correspondences between two disparate cultures and traditions.

Another crucial, if distressing, feature of decolonization as advanced by Wiredu is that it always has to measure itself up with the colonizing Other, that is, it finds it almost impossible to create its own image so to speak by the employment of autochthonous strategies. This is not to assert that decolonization always has to avail itself of indigenous procedures, but the very concept of decolonization is in fact concerned with breaking away from imperial structures of dominance in order to express a will to self-identity or presence. To be sure, the Other is always present, defacing all claims to full presence of the decolonizing subject. This is a contradictory but inevitable trope within the postcolonial condition. The Other is always there to present the criteria by which self-identity is adjudged either favourably or unfavourably. There is no getting around the Other as it is introduced in its own latent and covert violence, in the hesitant counter-violence of the decolonizing subject and invariably in the counter-articulations of all projects of decolonization.

4. Tradition, Modernity and the Challenges of Development

Wiredu’s later attempts at conceptual decolonization have been quite interesting. An example of such an attempt is the essay “Custom and Morality: A Comparative Analysis of some African and Western Conceptions of Morals.” He is able to explore at greater length some of the conceptual confusions that arise as a result of the transplantation of Western ideas within an African frame of reference. This wholesale transference of foreign ideas and conceptual models has caused the occurrence of severe cases of identity crises and, to borrow a more apposite term, colonial mentality. Indeed, one of the aims of Wiredu’s efforts at conceptual decolonization is to indicate instances of colonial mentality and determine strategies by which they can be minimized. Accordingly he is quite convincing when he argues that polygamy in a traditional setting amounts to efficient social thinking but is most inappropriate within a modern framework. In this way, Wiredu is offering a critique of a certain traditional practice that ought to be discarded on account of the demands and realities of a modern economy.

On another level, it appears that Wiredu has not sufficiently interrogated the distance between orality and textuality. If indeed he has done so, he would be rather more skeptical about the manner in which he thinks he can dislodge certain Western philosophical structures embedded in the African consciousness.

Wiredu has always believed that traditional modes of thought and folk philosophies should be interpreted, clarified, analyzed and subjected to critical evaluation and assimilation (Wiredu, 1980: x). Also, at the beginning of his philosophical reflections, he puts forth the crucial formulation that there is no reason why the African philosopher “in his philosophical meditations […] should not test formulations in those against intuitions in his own language” (Wiredu, 1980: xi). And, rather than merely discussing the possibilities for evolving modern traditions in African philosophy, African philosophers should actually begin to do so (Hountondji, 1983). In carrying out this task, the African philosopher has a few available methodological approaches. First, he is urged to “acquaint himself with the different philosophies of the different cultures of the world, not to be encylopaedic or eclectic, but with the aim of trying to see how far issues and concepts of universal relevance can be disentangled from the contingencies of culture” (Wiredu, 1980: 31). He also adds that “the African philosopher has no choice but to conduct his philosophical inquiries in relation to the philosophical writings of other peoples, for his ancestors left him no heritage of philosophical writings” (Wiredu, 1980: 48). For Wiredu, the use of translations is a fundamental aspect of contemporary African philosophical practices. However, on the dilemmas of translation in the current age of neoliberalism, it has been noted: “translations are [..] put ‘out of joint.’ However correct or legitimate they may be, and whatever right one may acknowledge them to have, they are all disadjusted, as it were unjust in the gap that affects them. This gap is within them, to be sure, because their meanings remain necessarily equivocal; next it is in the relation among them and thus their multiplicity, and finally or first of all in the irreducible inadequation to the other language and to the stroke of genius of the event that makes the law, to all the virtualities of the original” (Derrida, 1994:19). Wiredu does not contemplate the implications of this kind of indictment in his formulations of an approach to African philosophy. Perhaps the task at hand is simply too important and demanding to cater to such philosophical niceties. In relation to the kind of philosophical heritage at the disposal of the African philosopher, Wiredu identifies three main strands; “a folk philosophy, a written traditional philosophy and a modern philosophy” (Wiredu, 1980:46). Wiredu’s approach to questions of this sort is embedded in his general theoretical stance: “It is a function, indeed a duty, of philosophy in any society to examine the intellectual foundations of its culture. For any such examination to be of any real use, it should take the form of reasoned criticism and, where possible, reconstruction. No other way to philosophical progress is known than through criticism and adaptation” (Wiredu, 1980: 20).

The drive to attain progress is not limited to philosophical discourse alone. Entire communities and cultures usually aim to improve upon their institutions and practices in order to remain relevant. Societies can lose the momentum of growth and “various habits of thought and practice can become anachronistic within the context of the development of a given society; but an entire society too can become anachronistic within the context of the whole world if the ways of life within it are predominantly anachronistic. In the latter case, of course, there is no discarding society; what you do is to modernize it” (Wiredu, 1980:1). The theme of modernization occurs frequently in Wiredu’s corpus. He does not fully conceptualize it nor relate it to the various ideological histories it has encountered in the domains of social science, where it became a fully fledged discipline. Modernization, for him, is based on an uncomplicated pragmatism that owes much to Deweyan thought.

This kind of posture, that is, the consistent critique of the retrogression inherent in tradition and its proclivity for the fossilization of culture, is directed at Leopold Sedar Senghor. On Senghor, he writes, “it is almost as if he has been trying to exemplify in his own thought and discourse the lack of the analytical habit which he has attributed to the biology of the African. Most seriously of all, Senghor has celebrated the fact our (traditional) mind is of a non-analytical bent; which is very unfortunate, seeing that this mental attribute is more of a limitation than anything else” (Wiredu, 1980:12). Wiredu’s main criticism of Senghor is one that is always leveled against the latter. Apart from that charge that Senghor essentializes the concept and ideologies of blackness, he is also charged with defeatism that undermines struggles for liberation and decolonization. However, Paul Gilroy has unearthed a more sympathetic context in which to read and situate Senghorian thought. In Gilroy’s reading, an acceptable ideology of blackness emerges from Senghor’s work. And in this way, Wiredu’s critique loses some of its originality.

Senghor is cast as a traditionalist and tradition itself is the subject of a much broader critique. On some of the drawbacks of tradition Wiredu writes,

it is as true in Africa as anywhere else that logical, mathematical, analytical, experimental procedures are essential in the quest for the knowledge of, and control over, nature and therefore, in any endeavour to improve the condition of man. Our traditional culture was somewhat wanting in this respect and this is largely responsible for the weaknesses of traditional technology, warfare, architecture, medicine….” (Wiredu, 1980: 12) (italics mine)

Sometimes, Wiredu carries his critique of tradition too far as when he advances the view that “traditional medicine is terribly weak in diagnosis and weaker still in pharmacology” (Wiredu, 1980: 12). In recent times, a major part of Hountondji’s project is to demonstrate that traditional knowledges are not only useful and viable but also the necessity to situate them in appropriate modern contexts. Hountondji’s latest gesture is curious since both he and Wiredu are supposed to belong to the same philosophic tendency as described by Bodunrin under the rubric of West-led universalism. However, Wiredu’s attack on tradition is vitiated by his project of conceptual decolonization which, in order to work, requires the recuperation of vital elements in traditional culture.

Wiredu’s stance in relation to modernization and tradition gets refined by his condemnation of some aspects of urban existence which exhibit a manifestation of postmodern environmentalism. First, he writes, “it is quite clear to me that unrestricted industrial urbanization is contrary to any humane culture; it is certainly contrary to our own” (Wiredu, 1980:22). Also, “one of the powerful strains on our extended family system is the very extensive poverty which oppresses out rural populations. Owing to this, people working in the towns and cities are constantly burdened with the financial needs of rural relatives which they usually cannot entirely satisfy”(Wiredu, 1980:22). Contemporary anthropological studies dealing with Africa have dwelt extensively on this phenomenon. The point is, in Africa, forms of sociality exists that can no longer be found in the North Atlantic civilization. If this civilization (the North Atlantic) is characterized by extreme individualism, African forms of social existence on the other hand tend towards the gregarious in which conceptions of generosity, corruption, gratitude, philanthropy, ethnicity and even justice take on different slightly forms from what obtains within the vastly different North Atlantic context.

Also problematic is Wiredu’s reading of colonialism which is very similar to those of authors such as Ngugi wa Thiongo, Walter Rodney or even Chinua Achebe. In this reading, the colonized is abused, brutalized, silenced and reconstructed against her/his own will. Colonialism causes the destruction of agency. On de-agentialization, Wiredu states, “any human arrangement is authoritarian if it entails any person being made to do or suffer something against his will, or if it leads to any person being hindered in the development of his own will” (Wiredu, 1980:2). Homi Bhabha advances the notion of ambivalence to highlight the cultural reciprocities inherent in the entire colonial encounter and structure. This kind of reading of the colonial event has led to a rethinking of colonial theory. But Wiredu’s reading of the colonial encounter is infected by the radical persuasion of early African theorists of decolonization: “The period of colonial struggle was […] a period of cultural affirmation. It was necessary to restore in ourselves our previous confidence which had been so seriously eroded by colonialism. We are still, admittedly, even in post-colonial times, in an era of cultural self-affirmation” (Ibid.59).

5. An African Reading of Karl Marx

Marxist theory and discourse generally provided many African intellectuals with a platform on which to conduct many sociopolitical struggles. In fact, for many African scholars, it served as the only ideological tool. But not all scholars found Marxism acceptable. Wiredu was one of the scholars who has deep reservations about it. But he is not in doubt about the philosophical significance of Marx: “I regard Karl Marx as one of the great philosophers” (Wiredu, 1980:63). Derrida is even more forthcoming on the depth of this significance: “It will always be a fault not to read and reread and discuss Marx- which is to say also a few others- and to go beyond scholarly “reading” or “discussion.” It will be more and more a fault, a failing of theoretical, philosophical, political responsibility” (Derrida, 1994:13). Again, he writes, “the Marxist inheritance was- and still remains, and so it will remain- absolutely and thoroughly determinate. One need not be a Marxist or a communist in order to accept this obvious fact. We all live in a world, some would say a culture, that bears, at an incalculable depth, the mark of this inheritance, whether in a directly visible fashion or not”(Ibid.).

Marxism during era of the Cold War was the major ideological issue and in the present age of neoliberalism it continues to haunt (Derrida’s precise phrase is hauntology) us with its multiple legacies. Wiredu’s critique of Marx and Engels is located within the epoch of the Cold War. But from it, we get a glimpse of not only his political orientation but also his philosophical predilections. For instance, at a point, he claims “the food one eats, the hairstyle one adopts, the amount of money one has, the power one wields- all these and such circumstances are irrelevant from an epistemological point of view” (Wiredu, 1980:66). But Foucault-style analyses have demonstrated that these seemingly marginal activities have a tremendous impact on knowledge/power configurations that are often difficult to ignore. Michel de Certeau has demonstrated these so-called inconsequential acts become significant as gestures of resistance for the benefit of the weak and politically powerless. In his words, “the weak must continually turn to their own ends forces alien to them” (de Certeau 1984: xix). On those specific acts of the weak, he writes, “many everyday practices (talking, reading, moving about, shopping, cooking, etc.) are tactical in character. And so are, more generally, many “ways of operating”: victories of the “weak” over the “strong” (whether the strength be that of powerful people or the violence of things or of an imposed order, etc.), clever tricks, knowing how to get away with things, “hunter’s cunning,” maneuvers, polymorphic simulations, joyful discoveries, poetic as well as warlike. The Greeks called these “ways of operating” metis (Ibid.). This reading gives an entirely different perspective on acts and themes of resistance as panoptical surveillance in the age of global neoliberalism becomes more totalitarian in nature at specific moments.

As a philosopher versed in analytic philosophy, truth is a primary concern of Wiredu and this concern is incorporated into his analysis of Marxist philosophy. Hence, he identifies the following points, “the cognition of truth is recognized by Engels as the business of philosophy; (2) What is denied is absolute truth, not truth as such; (3) The belief, so finely expressed, in the progressive character of truth; (4) Engels speaks of this process of cognition as the ‘development of science.’ (5) That a consciousness of limitation is a necessary element in all acquired knowledge” (Wiredu,1980:64-65). Wiredu explains that these various Marxian assertions on truth are no different from those of the logician, C. S. Peirce who had expounded them under a formulation he called “fallibilism.” John Dewey also expounded them under the concept of ‘pragmatism’(Ibid.67). So the point here is that some of the main Marxist propositions on truth have parallels in analytic philosophy. Nonetheless, this raises an unsettling question about Marxism and its relation to truth: “How is it that a philosophy which advocates such an admirable doctrine as the humanistic conception of truth tends so often to lead in practice to the suppression of freedom of thought and expression? Is it by accident that this comes to be so? Or is it due to causes internal to the philosophy of Marx and Engels”(Ibid.68). Wiredu demonstrates strong reservations about what Ernest Wamba dia Wamba calls ‘bureaucratic socialism.” Derrida on his part, urges us to distinguish between Marx as a philosopher and the innumerable specters of Marx. In other words, there is a difference between “the dogma machine and the “Marxist” ideological apparatuses (States, parties, cells, unions, and other places of doctrinal production)”(Derrida,1994:13) and the necessity to treat Marx as a great philosopher. We need to “try to play Marx off against Marxism so as to neutralize, or at any rate muffle the political imperative in the untroubled exegesis of classified work” (Ibid.31). We also need to remember that “he doesn’t belong to the communists, to the Marxists, to the parties, he ought to figure within our great canon of […] political philosophy” (Ibid.31).

Wiredu’s reading of Marxism generally is quite damaging. First, he states, “Engels himself, never perfectly consistent, already compromises his conception of truth with some concessions to absolute truth in Anti-Duhring” (Wiredu, 1980:68). He then makes an even more damaging accusation that a form of authoritarianism lies at the heart of conception of philosophy propagated by Marx and Engels. On what he considers to a deep-seated confusion in their work, he writes, “Engels recognizes the cognition of truth to be a legitimate business of philosophy and makes a number of excellent points about truth. As soon, however, as one tries to find out what he and Marx conceived philosophy to be like, one is faced with a deep obscurity. The problem resolves round what one may describe as Marx’s conception of philosophy as ideology” (Ibid.70). Here, Wiredu makes the crucial distinction between Marx as a philosopher and the effects of his numerous spectralities and for this reason he offers his most important criticism of his general critique of Marxism. He also accuses Marx of instances of “carelessness in the use of cardinal terms” which he says “may be symptomatic of deep inadequacies of thought”(Ibid.74). This charge, which relates to Marx’s conception of consciousness is indeed serious since it borders on the question of conceptual clarification as advanced by the canon of analytic philosophy. Wiredu argues that Marx and Engels are unclear about their employment of the concept of ideology: “Marx and Engels are […] on the horns of a dilemma. If all philosophical thinking is ideological, then their thinking is ideological and, by their hypothesis, false”(Ibid.76). Wiredu’s insights are very important here: “He and Engels simply assumed for themselves the privilege of exempting their own philosophizing from the ideological theory of ideas”(Ibid.77). Consequently, Marx commits a grave error “in his conception of ideology and its bearing upon philosophy”(Ibid.81).

Another area Wiredu finds Marx and Engels wanting is moral philosophy. In other words, Marx “confused moral philosophy with moralism and assumed rather than argued a moral standpoint”(Ibid.79). Furthermore, he had precious little to say on the nature of the relationship between philosophy and morality. Engels does better on this score as there is a treatment of morality in Anti-Duhring. Nonetheless, Engels is charged with giving “no guidance on the conceptual problems that have perplexed moral philosophers” (Ibi.80). Henceforth, Wiredu becomes increasing dismissive of Marx, Marxism and its followers. First, he writes, “the run-of the-mill Marxists, even less enamoured of philosophical accuracy than their masters, have made the ideological conception of philosophy a battle cry”(Ibid.80). And then he singles out ‘scientific socialism’ which he regards as being unclear in its elaboration and which he typifies as “an amalgam of factual and evaluative elements blended together without regard to categorical stratification”(Ibid.85). In one of his most damaging assessments of Marxism, he declares: “Ideology is the death of philosophy. To the extent to which Marxism, by its own internal incoherences, tends to be transformed into an ideology, to that extent Marxism is a science of the unscientific and a philosophy of the unphilosophic” (Ibid.87).

In sum, Wiredu general attitude towards Marxism is one of condemnation. However, in the contemporary re-evaluations of Marxism a few discursive elements need to be clarified; the inclusion of the demarcation of Cold War and post Cold War assessments of Marxism ought to be employed as an analytical yardstick and also the necessity to sift through the various specters and legacies of Marx as distinct from those of Marxism. This is the kind of reading that Derrida urges us to do and it is also one to which we shall now turn our attention.

Derrida states it is imperative to distinguish between the legacies of Marx and the various spectralities of Marxism. In addition to this distinction we might add another crucial one: analyses of Marxism before and after the fall of the former Soviet Union. Wiredu’s critique is based on the pre-Soviet debacle whilst Derrida’s draws some of his reflections based on the post-Soviet fall. In these two different critiques, we must be careful to always strive to isolate the theoretical elements and insights that bypass short-lived discursive trends and political interests which often tend to vitiate the more profound effects of the works of Karl Marx and those that do not.

The debacle of the former Soviet Union and the apparent hegemony of neoliberal ideology have generated discourses associated with the “ends” of discourse. But Derrida points out that there is nothing new in the contemporary proclamations affirming the end of discourses which are in fact anachronistic when compared to the earlier versions of the same discursive orientation that emerged in the 1950s and which in a vital sense owed a great deal to a certain spirit of Marx: “the eschatological themes of the “end of history,” of the “end of Marxism,” of the “end of philosophy,” of the “ends of man,” of the “last man” and so forth were, in the ‘50s, that is, forty years ago our daily bread. We had this bread of apocalypse in our mouths naturally, already, just as naturally as that which I nicknamed after the fact, in 1980, the “apocalyptic tone in philosophy” (Derrida, 1994:14-15). In a way, in fact the contemporary discourses of endism that draw from the spirit of neoliberal triumphalism, without acknowledging it, are greatly indebted to Marxism and the more constructive critiques of it. Deconstruction, in part, emerged from the necessity to critique the various forms of statist Stalinism, the numerous socio-economic failings of Soviet bureaucracy and the political repression in Hungary. In other words, it emerged partly from the need to organize critiques for degraded forms of socialism.

In speaking about the inheritance of Marx, Derrida also reflects on the injunction associated with it. The task of reflecting on this inheritance and the injunction to which it gives rise is demanding: … “one must filter, sift, criticize, one must sort out several different possibles that inhabit the same injunction. And inhabit it in a contradictory fashion around a secret. If the readability of a legacy were given, natural, transparent, univocal, if it did not call for and at the same time defy interpretation, we would never have anything to inherit from it” (Ibid.16). Derrida’s employment of terms and phrases such “inheritance,” “injunction,” and the “spectrality of the specter” in relation to the legacies of Marx has to do with the question of the genius of Marx: “Whether evil or not, a genius operates, it always resists and defies after the fashion of a spectral thing. The animated work becomes that thing, the Thing that, like an elusive specter, engineers [s’ingenie] a habitation without proper inhabiting, call it is a haunting, of both memory and translation” (Ibid.18).

A work of genius, a masterpiece in addition to giving rise to spectralities also generates legions of imitators and followers. Of the Marxists who came after Marx, Wiredu writes; “I find that Marxists are especially prone to confuse factual with ideological issues. Undoubtedly, the great majority of those who call themselves Marxists do not share the ideology of Marx”(Wiredu,1980:94). In order to transcend the violence and confusion of Marxists who misread Marx, we need “to play Marx off against Marxism so as to neutralize, or at any rate muffle the political imperative in the untroubled exegesis of a classified work”(Derrida,1994:31). The work of re-reading Marx, of re-establishing his philosophical value and importance is a task needs to be performed in universities, conferences, colloquia and also in less academic sites and fora.

Within the contemporary cultural moment, new configurations have arisen that were not present during Marx’s day. Indeed, “a set of transformations of all sorts (in particular, techno-scientific-economic-media) exceeds both the traditional givens of the Marxist discourse and those of the liberal discourse opposed to it”(Ibid.70). Also,

Electoral representativity or parliamentary life is not only distorted, as was always the case, by a great number of socio-economic mechanisms, but it is exercised with more and more difficulty in a public space profoundly upset by techno-tele-media apparatuses and by new rhythms of information and communication, by the devices and the speed of forces represented by the latter, but also and consequently by the new modes of appropriation they put to work, by the new structure of the event and of its spectrality that they produce.” (Ibid.79)

Here, the instructive point is that the new information technologies have radically transformed the possibilities of the event and the modes of its production, reception and also interpretation. But there is a far more radical change that has occurred and which signals a profound crisis of global capitalism and the neoliberal ideology that underpins it: “For what must be cried out, at a time when some have the audacity to neo-evangelize in the name of the ideal of liberal democracy that has finally realized itself as the ideal of human history: never have violence, inequality, exclusion, famine, and thus economic oppression affected as many human beings in the history of the earth and of humanity”(Ibid.85). Also, “never have so many men, women, and children been subjugated, starved, or exterminated on the earth.” (Ibid.)

So Derrida identifies a few new factors that need to be included in the critique of Marxism in the contemporary moment namely the phenomenon of spectralization caused by techno-science and digitalization, the weakening of the practice of liberal democracy and also the crises and multiple contradictions inherent in global capitalism. It is necessary to include another element into the present configuration which is the rise of political Islam as an alternative ideology, its subsequent fervent politicization and its Western reconstruction into an ideology of terror.

Wiredu’s reading of Marx focuses on the conceptual infelicities in the latter’s theorizations of notions such as “ideology,” “consciousness,” and “truth.” Wiredu also criticizes Marx’s project of moral philosophy or in fact the lack of it. On the whole, his reading isn’t complementary. Indeed, it amounts to a dismissal of Marx in spite of the attempt to read him without the obfuscations of innumerable legacies.

6. Conclusion

Arguably, Wiredu’s particular contribution to the debate on the origins, status, problematic and future of contemporary African philosophy resides in his formulations regarding his theory of conceptual decolonization. His approach in formulating this theory of discursive agency and more specifically philosophical practice involves the incorporation of a form bi-culturalism. In other words, his approach entails analyses of the canon of Western philosophy and also the manifestations of tribal cultures as a way of attaining a conceptual synthesis. Indeed, this schema involves a forceful element of bi-culturalism as a matter of logical consequence as well as a high level of [multi] bi-lingual competence. As such, it not only an exercise in conceptual synthesis but it is also a project involving comparative linguistics.

In Anglophone parts of Africa, Wiredu’s experience and research in teaching African philosophy has had a tremendous significance. The positive aspect of this is that the study of African philosophical thought has in positive moments transcended the problematic of identity or what has been termed as the problematic of origins. The less complimentary dimension of this equation is that Wiredu’s discoveries have given rise to (most undoubtedly unwittingly) a somewhat hegemonic school of disciples that is fostering a delimiting academicism and which is contrary to his essential spirit of conceptual inventiveness. As such, it might become necessary not only to critique Wiredu’s corpus but perhaps also Wiredu’s school of disciples which rather than appreciate the originality of his formulations fall instead for the pitfalls of over-ideologization.

Undoubtedly, Wiredu discovered a challenging path in modern African thought in which he sometimes takes the meaning of the existence of African philosophy for granted. In addition, it has been observed that also lacking at some moments in his oeuvre is an attempt to de-totalize and hence particularize the components of what he regards of the foundations of African philosophy. In other words, African philosophy finds its form, shape and also its conceptual moorings above the discursive platform provided by Western philosophy. In addition, the theoretical space made available for its articulation is derived from the same Western-donated pool of unanimism. Part of recent interrogations of Wiredu’s work includes a questioning of the legitimacy of that space as the only site on which to construct an entire philosophical practice for the alienated, hybrid African consciousness. Oftentimes the question is posed, what are the ways by which the space can be broadened?

Indeed, terms such as reflective integration and due reflection offer the critical spaces for the theoretical articulation of something whose existence has not yet been concretely conceived. So in Wiredu’s corpus we see the very familiar problematic involving the tradition/modernity dichotomy being played out. Finally, it can be argued that this tension is not quite resolved but fortunately it is also a tension that never jeopardizes his philosophical inventiveness. Rather, it seems to animate his reflections in unprecedented ways.

7. References and Further Reading

Cronon, D. E. 1955. Black Moses: The Story of Marcus Garvey and the Universal Negro Improvement Association, Wisconsin: University of Wisconsin Press.
Cummings, Robert. 1986. “Africa between the Ages” in African Studies Review, Vol. 29, No. 3, September.
Diop, Cheikh, Anta, 1974. The African Origin of Civilization: Myth or Reality? Trans. M. Cook, Westport, Conn.: Lawrence Hill.
Doortmont, Michel R. 2005 The Pen-Pictures of Modern Africans and African Celebrities by Charles Francis Hutchison, Leiden and Boston: Brill.
Dubow, Saul. 2000 The African National Congress, Johannesburg: Jonathan Ball.
Derrida, Jacques. 1994. Specters of Marx: the state of the debt, the work of mourning, & the new international, trans. Peggy Kamuf, New York: Routledge.
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Author Information

Sanya Osha
Email: babaosha@yahoo.com
Tshwane University of Technology
South Africa

The Problem of the Criterion

The Problem of the Criterion is considered by many to be a fundamental problem of epistemology. In fact, Chisholm (1973, 1) claims that the Problem of the Criterion is “one of the most important and one of the most difficult of all the problems of philosophy.” A popular form of the Problem of the Criterion can be raised by asking two seemingly innocent questions: What do we know? How are we to decide in any particular case whether we have knowledge? One quickly realizes how troubling the Problem of the Criterion is because it seems that before we can answer the first question we must already have an answer to the second question, but it also seems that before we can answer the second question we must already have an answer to the first question. That is, it seems that before we can determine what we know we must first have a method or criterion for distinguishing cases of knowledge from cases that are not knowledge. Yet, it seems that before we can determine the appropriate criterion of knowledge we must first know which particular instances are in fact knowledge. So, we seem to be stuck going around a circle without any way of getting our epistemological theorizing started. Although there are various ways of responding to the Problem of the Criterion, the problem is difficult precisely because it seems that each response comes at a cost. This article examines the nature of the Problem and the costs associated with the most promising responses to the Problem.

The Problem
Chisholm on the Problem of the Criterion
Other Responses to the Problem of the Criterion
1. Explanationist Responses
2. Dissolution
The Problem of the Criterion’s Relation to Other Philosophical Problems
References and Further Reading

1. The Problem

The Problem of the Criterion is the ancient problem of the “wheel” or the “diallelus”. It comes to us from Book 2 of Sextus Empiricus’ Outlines of Pyrrhonism. Sextus presents the Problem of the Criterion as a major issue in the debate between the Academic Skeptics and the Stoics. After Sextus’ presentation though, philosophers largely seemed to lose interest in the Problem of the Criterion until the modern period. The problem resurfaced in the late 1500’s with Michael De Montaigne’s “Apology for Raymond Sebond” and it again had a significant influence. Following the modern period, however, the Problem of the Criterion largely disappeared until the early 19^th century when G.W.F. Hegel (1807) presented the problem and, arguably, put forward one of the first coherentist responses to the Problem of the Criterion (Rockmore (2006) and Aikin (2010)). In the late 19^th and early 20^th centuries Cardinal D.J. Mercier (1884) and his student P. Coffey (1917) again reminded the world of the problem. In the late 20^th century the Problem of the Criterion played an important role in the work of two philosophers: Roderick Chisholm and Nicholas Rescher. In fact, it is primarily due to the work of Roderick Chisholm that the Problem of the Criterion is discussed by contemporary epistemologists at all. (See Amico (1993) and Popkin (2003) for further discussion of the historical development of the Problem of the Criterion).

In light of Chisholm’s enormous influence on contemporary discussions of the Problem of the Criterion his presentation of the problem is a fitting place to begin getting clear on things. Chisholm (1973, 12) often introduces the Problem of the Criterion with the following pairs of questions:

(A) What do we know? What is the extent of our knowledge?

(B) How are we to decide whether we know? What are the criteria of knowledge?

However, Chisholm also speaks approvingly of Montaigne’s presentation of the Problem of the Criterion, which is in terms of true/false appearances rather than knowledge. Further, there is some ambiguity in Chisholm’s own discussions of the Problem of the Criterion as to whether the problem presented by the Problem of the Criterion is the meta-epistemological problem of determining when we have knowledge or the epistemological problem of determining what is true. So, there is a difficulty in determining exactly what problem the Problem of the Criterion is supposed to pose.

The fact that Chisholm’s discussion oscillates between these two versions of the Problem of the Criterion and the fact that he seems to be aware of the two versions of the problem help make it clear that perhaps there is no such thing as the Problem of the Criterion. Perhaps the Problem of the Criterion is rather a set of related problems. This is something that many philosophers since Chisholm, and Chisholm himself (see his 1977), have noted. For instance, Robert Amico (1993) argues that Chisholm mistakenly takes himself to be discussing the same problem as Sextus Empiricus when he considers the Problem of the Criterion. Richard Fumerton (2008) points out that there are at least two versions of the Problem of the Criterion. The first is a methodological problem of trying to identify sources of knowledge or justified belief (this, he claims, is the version of the problem that Chisholm focuses on). The second is the problem of trying to identify the necessary and sufficient conditions for correctly applying concepts such as ‘knowledge’ or ‘justification’. Michael DePaul (1988, 70) expresses a version of the Problem of the Criterion limited to moral discourse in terms of two questions: “Which of our actions are morally right?” and “What are the criteria of right action?”

Since there are many versions of the Problem of the Criterion, one might worry that it will be nearly impossible to formulate the Problem of the Criterion precisely. Fortunately, this is not the case. Although there are many particular instances of the Problem of the Criterion, they all seem to be questions of epistemic priority. In other words, the various versions of the Problem of the Criterion are focused on trying to answer the question “how is it possible to theorize in epistemology without taking anything epistemic for granted?” (Conee 2004, 17). More generally: how is it possible to theorize at all without making arbitrary assumptions? Hence, perhaps the best way to formulate the Problem of the Criterion in its most general form is with the following pair of questions (Cling (1994) and McCain and Rowley (2014)):

(1) Which propositions are true?

(2) How can we tell which propositions are true?

Plausibly, all the various formulations of particular versions of the Problem of the Criterion can be understood as instances of the problem one faces when trying to answer these general questions.

Before moving on it is important to be clear about the nature of (1) and (2). These are not questions about the nature of truth itself. Rather, these are epistemological questions concerning which propositions we should think are true and what the correct criteria are for determining whether a proposition should be accepted as true or false. It is possible that one could have answers to these questions without possessing any particular theory of truth, or even taking a stand at all as to the correct theory of truth. Additionally, it is possible to have a well-developed theory of the nature of truth without having an answer to either (1) or (2). So, the issue at the heart of the Problem of the Criterion is how to start our epistemological theorizing in the correct way, not how to discover a theory of the nature of truth.

Most would admit that it is important to start our epistemological theorizing in an appropriate way by not taking anything epistemic for granted, if possible. However, this desire to start theorizing in the right way coupled with the questions of the Problem of the Criterion does not yield a problem—it is merely a desire we have and questions we need to answer. The problem yielded by the Problem of the Criterion arises because one might plausibly think that we cannot answer (1) until we have an answer to (2), but we cannot answer (2) until we have an answer to (1). So, at least initially, consideration of the Problem of the Criterion makes it seem that we cannot get our theorizing started at all. This seems to land us in a pretty extreme form of skepticism—we cannot even begin the project of trying to determine which propositions to accept as true.

Of course, there are anti-skeptical ways to respond to the Problem of the Criterion. According to Chisholm, these anti-skeptical responses are question-begging. In light of this one might think that extreme skepticism is inevitable. However, this might not be correct. The extreme skepticism threatened by the Problem of the Criterion itself seems guilty of begging the question. This is why Chisholm (1973, 37) claims “we can deal with the problem only by begging the question.”

2. Chisholm on the Problem of the Criterion

According to Chisholm, there are only three responses to the Problem of the Criterion: particularism, methodism, and skepticism. The particularist assumes an answer to (1) and then uses that to answer (2), whereas the methodist assumes an answer to (2) and then uses that to answer (1). The skeptic claims that you cannot answer (1) without first having an answer to (2) and you cannot answer (2) without first having an answer to (1), and so you cannot answer either. Chisholm claims that, unfortunately, regardless of which of these responses to the Problem of the Criterion we adopt we are forced to beg the question. It will be worth examining each of the responses to the Problem of the Criterion that Chisholm considers and how each begs the question against the others.

The particularist assumes an answer to (1) that does not epistemically depend on an answer to (2) and uses her answer to (1) to answer (2). More precisely, the particularist response to the Problem of the Criterion is:

Particularism Assume an answer to (1) (accept some set of propositions as true) that does not depend on an answer to (2) and use the answer to (1) to answer (2).

What is the epistemic status of the particularist’s answer to (1)? Chisholm (1973, 37) seems to take it that its status is weak, being nothing more than an assumption:

But in all of this I have presupposed the approach I have called “particularism.” The “methodist” and the “skeptic” will tell us that we have started in the wrong place. If now we try to reason with them, then, I am afraid, we will be back on the wheel.

One might think that the question-begging only occurs if the particularist tries to reason with her methodist or skeptical interlocutors. So, one might think the problem for particularism is simply a lack of reasons in support of particularism that advocates of methodism or skepticism would accept.

However, things are worse than this. The real problem with particularism is not simply the dialectical problem of providing grounds that methodists and skeptics will accept; rather it is an epistemic problem. The problem with particularism is that the particularist’s starting point is an unfounded assumption. Particularism starts with a set of particular propositions and works from there. If the particularist goes beyond that set of particular propositions to provide reasons for accepting them, she abandons that particularist response and either picks a new set of particular propositions to assume (a new particularist response) or picks something other than simply a new set of only particular propositions to assume and ceases to be a particularist. So, the problem for the particularist response is much deeper than a dialectical problem that arises only when trying to deal with opposing views. The particularist cannot offer reasons for particularism beyond the unfounded assumption of a set of particular propositions. By simply assuming an answer to (1), the particularist begs the question against both the methodists and the skeptics.

Particularism is not unique in begging the question though. It seems that methodism begs the question too. The methodist response to the Problem of the Criterion is:

Methodism Assume an answer to (2) (accept some criterion to be a correct criterion of truth – one that successfully discriminates true propositions from false ones) that does not depend on an answer to (1) and use the answer to (2) to answer (1).

Since methodism begins by assuming that some criterion is a correct criterion of truth without providing any epistemic reason to prefer this response to the alternatives, it begs the question against particularism and skepticism.

The skeptical response to the Problem of the Criterion assumes that both particularism and methodism are mistaken. That is, the skeptical response to the Problem of the Criterion assumes that there is no answer to (1) that does not depend on an answer to (2) and there is no answer to (2) that does not depend on an answer to (1). As Chisholm (1973, 14) explains the response:

And so we can formulate the position of the skeptic on these matters. He will say: ‘You cannot answer question 1 until you answer question 2. And you cannot answer question 2 until you answer question 1. Therefore, you cannot answer either question. You cannot know what, if anything, you know, and there is no possible way for you to decide in any particular case.’

(The names of the questions have been changed from Chisholm’s “A” and “B” to “1” and “2”, respectively, in this quote in order to maintain continuity with the present discussion)

A bit more succinctly:

Skepticism Assume that (i) there is no independent answer to (1) or (2), and (ii) if (1) and (2) cannot be answered independently, they cannot be answered at all.

According to Chisholm, the skeptical response has no more to recommend it that particularism or methodism. The reason for this is that skepticism, as a response to the Problem of the Criterion, is question-begging. The skeptic simply assumes that there is no independent answer to (1) or (2) and though both the particularist and the methodist deny this assumption, they can only respond by appealing to assumptions of their own. The skeptic has no reasons to support the assumption that there is no independent answer to (1) or (2). The conflict between the three responses that Chisholm considers comes down to ungrounded assumptions. It is because of this fact that Chisholm claims when facing the Problem of the Criterion we have no choice but to beg the question. Since all responses beg the question, skepticism is no better off than any other response to the Problem of the Criterion.

At this point it is worth getting clear on two further points about the skeptical response. First, it should be noted that the skeptical response is not the only response that might lead to a thoroughgoing skepticism. For instance, one might be a methodist who assumes the criterion for distinguishing true from false propositions is absolute certainty. That is, a methodist might think that the only way to tell whether a proposition is true is for the truth of the proposition to be absolutely certain for her. Pretty clearly this sort of methodism will lead to a fairly extreme skepticism. One of the lessons of Cartesian skepticism is that it is implausible to think that we can be absolutely certain about the truth of any proposition about the external world.

Second, one might think that the skeptical response to the Problem of the Criterion really is better off than particularism or methodism. One might think that the skeptical response simply emerges from consideration of the problems facing both particularism and methodism, and so does not have to make any assumptions of its own.

Although the skeptical response may arise in this way, it does not absolve skepticism of begging the question. As Chisholm notes, the skeptical response has nothing in itself that makes it better than particularism or methodism. The skeptical resolution of the Problem of the Criterion has nothing to appeal to other than unfounded assumptions in order to motivate it over its alternatives. Without something more than unfounded assumptions there does not seem to be any reason to prefer the skeptic’s response. Given this, accepting the skeptical response would still beg the question because there is no more reason to accept it than there is to accept any of the other positions. Since the skeptical response has nothing more to recommend it in itself than the other responses, there is no more reason to accept the skeptical response because of the problems for particularism and methodism than there is to accept particularism because of the problems with the other responses, or to accept methodism for the same reason. All three options seem to be on equal footing when it comes to having reason to pick them over their rivals and they all beg the question.

Each of these responses to the Problem of the Criterion begins with an unfounded assumption, one that is unsupported by reasons, and so begs the question in an epistemic sense against the other two. Despite this and his emphasis on the fact that all three responses are unappealing because of their question-begging, Chisholm famously argues in support of particularism. His argument in support of particularism, which he sometimes refers to as “commonsensism”, involves criticizing the other two responses and giving some reasons for preferring particularism.

Concerning methodism, Chisholm offers two objections. First, he objects that the criterion that methodism starts with will be “very broad and far-reaching and at the same time completely arbitrary” (1973, 17). Essentially, he thinks that there can be no good reason for starting with a broad criterion. Second, he objects that methodism (at least of the empiricist variety that he considers in detail) will lead to skepticism. When we adopt the methodist’s broad criterion it will turn out that many of the things we commonsensically take ourselves to know do not count as knowledge. Chisholm finds this unacceptable.

Chisholm’s case against the skeptical response to the Problem of the Criterion seems also to come down to two things. The first is quite plain. If methodism is flawed because it will lead to skepticism concerning many areas where we take ourselves to have knowledge, it is no surprise that Chisholm finds the skeptical response to the Problem of the Criterion to be unacceptable. It too has this result. In fact, the skeptical response is in a sense doubly skeptical. It not only holds that we lack knowledge in areas that we typically take ourselves to have knowledge, it holds that we cannot even begin the process of determining what we do know. The second problem Chisholm seems to have with skepticism is simply that it has no more to recommend it that either of the other views. Admittedly, this does not seem to be much of a criticism, especially since he grants that all three responses make unfounded assumptions.

Unfortunately, Chisholm’s positive support for particularism is very sparse. In fact in his Aquinas Lectures he only claims, “in favor of our approach [particularism] there is the fact that we do know many things, after all” (1973, 38). But, of course, this seems to merely be a statement of the assumption made by particularism, not a defense of it. As a solution to the Problem of the Criterion, Chisholm’s particularism seems to be lacking. In fact, Robert Amico (1988b) argues that Chisholm’s “solution” is clearly unacceptable because Chisholm does not give us good independent reasons to reject either methodism or skepticism, he does not provide good reasons to prefer particularism to the other responses, and, as Chisholm himself admits, particularism begs the question.

Given the very weak argument in support of his preferred view, one might wonder what Chisholm is really up to when he discusses the Problem of the Criterion. Throughout the many works in which he discusses the Problem of the Criterion Chisholm consistently favors particularism, but he also makes it clear that all responses to the Problem of the Criterion are unappealing and his own view must, just like its rivals, beg the question. In responses to Amico’s criticisms Chisholm claims that particularism is superior to methodism and skepticism because by being a particularist one can give a reasonable account of knowledge, but one cannot make progress in epistemology by taking a methodist or skeptical approach.

A few further points about Chisholm’s take on the Problem of the Criterion that are often overlooked are worth mentioning here. First, he claims that we should remain open to the possibility of one day discovering a version of methodism that fares better than the empiricist version he criticizes. Second, Chisholm is adamant that in supporting particularism he is not trying to solve the Problem of the Criterion because “the problem of the criterion has no solution” (1988, 234). So, Chisholm thinks that particularism is simply the best of a set of bad options—the options are bad because they beg the question; particularism is best because it allows us to make progress in epistemology.

3. Other Responses to the Problem of the Criterion

Chisholm claimed that there are only three responses to the Problem of the Criterion and that there is no solution to this problem. Many philosophers disagree with Chisholm on both points. In fact, Andrew Cling (1994) argues that there are eight non-skeptical responses to the Problem of the Criterion. Importantly, Cling does not consider two of the non-skeptical responses that we will consider below, so it seems that if Cling is correct concerning the eight non-skeptical approaches he mentions and the two additional approaches discussed below are distinct responses, there are at least eleven (ten non-skeptical and one skeptical) responses to the Problem of the Criterion. While there are many possible responses to the Problem of the Criterion the focus here will be limited to those that have been defended in the literature.

a. Explanationist Responses

As noted above, there are a number of responses to the Problem of the Criterion beyond the three kinds that Chisholm considers. The employment of explanatory reasoning offers promising alternatives to the responses Chisholm considers. These explanationist responses share a commitment to explanatory reasoning—they all involve attempting to answer (1) and (2) in a way that yields the most satisfactory explanatory picture. A helpful way of understanding explanationist responses is as employing the method of reflective equilibrium to respond to the Problem of the Criterion. Roughly, the method of reflective equilibrium involves starting with a set of data (beliefs, intuitions, etc.) and making revisions to that set—giving up some of the data, adding new data to the set, giving more/less weight to some of the data, and so on—so as to create the best explanatory picture overall. Reaching this equilibrium state of maximized explanatory coherence of the remaining data is thought to make accepting whatever data remains, whether this includes any of one’s initial data or not, reasonable (see coherentism and John Rawls for more on reflective equilibrium). Of course, there have been criticisms of the viability of reflective equilibrium as a method of reasoning; however, for current purposes these can be set aside because the ultimate concern here is simply the sort of responses that can be generated by employing reflective equilibrium.

There are a variety of ways that one might attempt to respond to the Problem of the Criterion by using the method of reflective equilibrium. The variation in these responses is largely a result of what one includes in the set of data that will form the basis for one’s reflection. It is worth considering some of the more promising varieties of this response that have been put forward in the literature.

i. Explanatory Particularism

Although the explanatory particularism defended by Paul Moser (1989) is a kind of particularism, its explanationist elements warrant discussing it as a separate variety of response. Moser’s (1989, 261) explanatory particularism begins with one’s “considered, but revisable, judgments” concerning particular propositions. This is importantly different from the sort of particularism that Chisholm describes because explanatory particularism allows that the beliefs about the truth of particular propositions are revisable whereas particularism as Chisholm describes it does not clearly allow for this. It is because of this that Moser claims that explanatory particularism does not beg the question against skeptics by ruling out skepticism from the start. Importantly, the kind of skepticism Moser is discussing here is not the skeptical response to the Problem of the Criterion, but rather the sort of skepticism that grants that we can get started in epistemological theorizing while claiming that ultimately we will end up lacking knowledge in a wide range of cases. External world skepticism is an example of this sort of skepticism; it grants that we are aware of what is required for knowledge, but claims that we simply fail to have knowledge of the world around us. Like Chisholm’s particularism, explanatory particularism uses this initial set of propositions (i.e. this answer to (1)) to develop epistemic principles or criteria for truth (i.e. to answer (2)). The initial set of propositions and criteria are both continually revised until a state of maximal explanatory coherence is reached.

Moser claims that explanatory particularism avoids begging the question in the way that Chisholm’s particularism or methodism does. The reason for this is that Moser claims that the beliefs that explanatory particularism starts with are revisable. Despite this and Moser’s claim that explanatory particularism does not beg the question against the skeptic, it is not clear that it avoids begging the question against the skeptical response to the Problem of the Criterion. After all, explanatory particularism assumes an independent answer to (1)—revisable or not it is still an answer—and then uses that to answer (2). So, it at least seems that explanatory particularism begs the question against the skeptical response by denying the skeptic’s assumption that there is no independent answer to (1) or (2).

Ernest Sosa (2009) also defends a view that we might call explanatory particularism. On Sosa’s view we begin with particular items of knowledge. That is, we start with particular propositions that we know to be true. According to Sosa, we know these propositions because our beliefs with respect to these propositions satisfy a correct general criterion of knowledge (they are formed by sufficiently reliable cognitive faculties). Although we have knowledge of these propositions, we merely have what he terms “animal knowledge”. Our knowledge of these propositions when we begin is only animal knowledge because we lack a higher-order perspective on these beliefs. That is to say, we lack “reflective knowledge” of the fact that these first-order beliefs satisfy the proper criterion of knowledge. However, on Sosa’s view we use our animal knowledge to develop a perspective on our epistemic situation that offers us an explanatory picture about how or why our first-order beliefs really do constitute knowledge, i.e. we develop reflective knowledge as to how our particular pieces of animal knowledge satisfy the proper criterion for knowledge. This explanatory perspective yields reflective knowledge and it strengthens our animal knowledge. A significant component of this picture is that we use our starting animal knowledge to come to answer both (1) and (2) from a reflective standpoint. So, we begin with an answer to (1) in terms of animal knowledge and we use that answer to develop a perspective that gives us an answer to (2) with respect to both animal and reflective knowledge and an answer to (1) in terms of reflective knowledge. Sosa’s explanatory response to the Problem of the Criterion relies on a mixture of levels.

Although Sosa’s explanatory particularism with its multiple levels seems more complex that Moser’s, one might think that it begs the question in the same way that Moser’s response does. Namely, Sosa’s response, like Moser’s, assumes an independent answer to (1). Sosa’s assumed answer is only in terms of animal knowledge, however, it is still an answer. His response then requires using that answer to develop an explanatory perspective that provides an answer to (2). Thus, one might think that Sosa’s response seems to beg the question against the skeptical response in the same way that Moser’s response seems to: by denying the skeptic’s assumption (i) that there is no independent answer to (1) or (2).

ii. Coherentism

Coherentism responds to the Problem of the Criterion by starting with both beliefs about which propositions are true and beliefs about the correct method or methods for telling which beliefs are true. It then uses these beliefs to attempt to answer both (1) and (2) at the same time (DePaul 1988 & 2009, Cling 1994, and Poston 2011). As Andrew Cling (1994, 274) explains:

To be a coherentist is to reject the epistemic priority of beliefs and criteria of truth. Instead, coherentists recommend balancing beliefs against criteria and criteria against beliefs until they all form a consistent, mutually supporting system.

The coherentist does not simply assume that the criterion of truth is to balance “beliefs against criteria and criteria against beliefs.” To understand coherentism in this way would simply make it a variety of methodism, and so fail to appreciate the importance of its employment of reflective equilibrium. Instead, the coherentist response involves starting with both beliefs about criteria of truth and also beliefs that particular propositions are true and then makes adjustments to beliefs of either kind in an attempt to reach a state of reflective equilibrium. Once this equilibrium state has been reached the coherentist uses it to complete her answers to (1) and (2).

On one understanding of coherentism (Cling’s 1994 and Poston’s 2011) the coherentist accepts one of the skeptic’s assumptions, but denies the other. In particular, this version of coherentism shares the skeptic’s assumption of (i) (there is no independent answer to (1) or (2)), but denies (ii) (if (1) and (2) cannot be answered independently, they cannot be answered at all). More precisely, on this way of understanding coherentism it involves accepting (i) of Skepticism and adding to it the further assumptions that: (a) a particular criterion is correct (namely, explanatory goodness), (b) a set of particular propositions are true, and (c) the criterion and the set of propositions are not independent of each other. However, it seems that if one begins with beliefs about which propositions are true and beliefs about the correct criteria for telling which beliefs are true along with the assumption that there is no independent answer to (1) or (2), this version of coherentism will beg the question for reasons similar to why Skepticism begs the question. That is to say, the coherentist’s assumption of (i) begs the question against particularism and methodism. After all, (i) is a groundless assumption with which the coherentist starts. It may be awareness of this feature that helped lead Cling (2009) to ultimately abandon his coherentist response in favor of a skeptical stance with respect to the Problem of the Criterion.

Another way of understanding this approach is as Michael DePaul (1988 & 2009) depicts it. According to this way of understanding coherentism, the coherentist starts with beliefs about which particular propositions are true and about the correct criteria for telling which beliefs are true, but she does not assume (i). This version of coherentism seems to avoid begging the question against both particularists and methodists because it does not assume that we can answer (1) prior to (2) or that we can answer (2) prior to (1) nor does it assume that they cannot be answered independently. Instead, this kind of coherentism merely applies reflective equilibrium to the coherentist’s starting set of beliefs without taking a stand on (i) at all. Now it might turn out that after the application of reflective equilibrium the coherentist is committed to a particular position with respect to (i), but this kind of coherentism does not have to take a stand on (i) from the start. So, in some respects this way of understanding coherentism may seem superior to the previous version of coherentism. However, its use of beliefs in the relevant data set seems to beg the question against the skeptic because starting with beliefs about which propositions are true assumes that we can answer and in fact already have an answer to (1). Likewise, a belief about which criteria are successful for telling which beliefs are true assumes that we can answer and have an answer to (2). In other words, this version of coherentism seems to beg the question against skepticism by assuming that (ii) is false. Thus, applying reflective equilibrium to a set of beliefs appears to beg the question by assuming that one of the assumptions of skepticism is false from the outset. This may be why DePaul (2009) accepts Chisholm’s position that all responses to the Problem of the Criterion end up begging the question.

A final coherentist response is Nicholas Rescher’s “systems-theoretic approach”. Rescher’s development of this approach takes place over several books (1973a, 1973b, 1977, and 1980). Although Rescher’s systems-theoretic approach is complex, the relevant details for the present discussion of the Problem of the Criterion are relatively straightforward. Rescher’s response begins by appealing to pragmatic considerations. It starts with a method and a goal, applies the method and checks to see whether the results satisfy the goal. So, with respect to the Problem of the Criterion the idea is that our goal is to come to believe true propositions and we start with some criterion for distinguishing true propositions from false. We apply our criterion and then see if it helps us achieve our goal. Assuming that the criterion does help us achieve our goal, we have completed the first step in Rescher’s process. The second step in this process involves showing that a pragmatically successful criterion/method is connected to the truth. Here Rescher (1977, 107) claims that “only when all the pieces fit together” do we have justification for the criterion. Further, he is clear that coherence is central to this process. It is because of this that Robert Amico (1993) argues that Rescher’s view, though complex, is simply a coherentist version of methodism—Rescher ultimately assumes that coherence is the appropriate criterion of truth. This is so despite the fact that the criterion/method that Rescher starts with may not be coherence because ultimately his way of establishing that any criterion that one starts with is actually a correct criterion is by appeal to coherence. Since Rescher assumes this role for coherence from the outset, his approach seems to be a form of methodism. Although Rescher’s approach is a kind of methodism with a significant explanatory element and one that may make more progress in epistemology than the sort that Chisholm criticizes, it seems to be vulnerable to the same charge of question-begging that Chisholm leveled at other forms of methodism—something Rescher may accept since he does not believe the Problem of the Criterion can be solved, but it is at best something that one can “meet and overcome” (1980, 13).

iii. Applied Evidentialism

A final explanationist response to the Problem of the Criterion is what Earl Conee (2004) calls “Applied Evidentialism” (McCain and Rowley (2014) call it the “Seeming Intuition Response”). This explanationist response differs from the previous ways of using reflective equilibrium to respond to the Problem of the Criterion in that it does not start with a set of beliefs. Rather, Applied Evidentialism begins with one’s evidence. In particular, when Conee defends this view he suggests beginning with the set of intuitions or what seems true to us about various propositions. That is to say, Applied Evidentialism begins with what seems true to us both with respect to propositions about particular items of fact and with respect to criteria for determining when propositions are true. According to Applied Evidentialism, the way to respond to the Problem of the Criterion is to start with these intuitions and then make modifications—give up some intuitions, form different intuitions, rank some intuitions as more/less important than others, and so on— until a state of equilibrium has been reached. Once such an equilibrium state has been reached the data from that state can be used to answer (1) and (2).

Like the other ways of using reflective equilibrium to respond to the Problem of the Criterion, Applied Evidentialism does not seem to beg the question against particularism or methodism because it does not assume that there can be no independent answer to (1) or (2). Additionally, Applied Evidentialism does not seem to beg the question against the skeptic because it refrains from assuming an answer to (1) or (2) at the outset. Further, Applied Evidentialism does not assume from the start that the equilibrium state that we end up with will be anti-skeptical. It is consistent with Applied Evidentialism that reflection on our initial intuitions will in the end lead us to the conclusion that we are unaware of which propositions are true or that we lack an appropriate criterion for discovering this information. In other words, Applied Evidentialism does not assume that we will have an answer to (1) or (2) when we reach our end equilibrium state. After all, it could be that our equilibrium state is one in which no method appears to be correct and our best position with respect to each proposition seems to be to suspend judgment concerning its truth. So, Applied Evidentialism does not seem to beg any questions against the skeptical response to the Problem of the Criterion or other kinds of skepticism, such as Cartesian skepticism.

One might worry that Applied Evidentialism is really a form of methodism, and hence, open to the same charge of question begging as other kinds of methodism. After all, Applied Evidentialism suggests that using the method of reflective equilibrium on one’s intuitions can provide a response to the Problem of the Criterion.

Upon reflection, however, it seems that Applied Evidentialism is not a kind of methodism. Plausibly, someone can employ a method without having any beliefs about, or even conscious awareness of, the method at all. Kevin McCain and William Rowley (2014) argue that methods are analogous to rules in this sense. They maintain that someone might behave in accordance with a rule without intending to obey the rule or even being aware that there is such a rule at all. For example, one can act in accordance with a rule of not driving faster than 50mph by simply not driving over 50mph. She does not need to know that this is a rule or even have an intention to follow rules concerning speed limits. Ignorance of a rule does not mean that one fails to act in accordance with a rule. Likewise, McCain and Rowley claim, one can employ the method of reflective equilibrium without accepting or even being aware of the method being used. So, Applied Evidentialism does not seem to be a kind of methodism.

McCain and Rowley further argue that Applied Evidentialism does not beg the question by assuming that reflective equilibrium is the correct criterion or method at the outset. They maintain that this is not to say that one cannot be aware that reflective equilibrium is a good method from the outset. Rather, they claim that the important point is that Applied Evidentialism does not take the goodness of reflective equilibrium as a starting assumption—perhaps one has the intuition that reflective equilibrium is a good method to employ, perhaps not. The key, they argue, is that unlike methodism Applied Evidentialism does not require one to have beliefs about, or even awareness of, reflective equilibrium to begin to respond to the Problem of the Criterion. So, they argue Applied Evidentialism is not a form of methodism. And thus, Applied Evidentialism does not beg the questions that methodism does.

Even if one accepts that Applied Evidentialism does not beg the question, it may have other problems. It seems that in order to avoid begging the question Applied Evidentialism requires being able to employ reflective equilibrium in responding to the Problem of the Criterion without needing reasons to think that reflective equilibrium is a good method from the start. This, however, seems to commit the supporter of Applied Evidentialism to accepting that certain kinds of circular reasoning can provide one with good reasons. More precisely, if Applied Evidentialism is to avoid being a form of methodism, and the question begging that comes with methodism, then it seems that Applied Evidentialism requires that one can have good reasons to believe the results of employing reflective equilibrium without first having good reasons to accept reflective equilibrium as a good method. But, this allows for epistemic circularity because it can be the case that the claim that reflective equilibrium is a good method is itself one of the results that is produced in the final equilibrium state. The heart of this worry is that Applied Evidentialism allows someone to use reflective equilibrium to come to reasonably believe that reflective equilibrium is a good method for determining true propositions. This is a kind of rule-circularity that occurs when a rule or method is employed to establish that that very rule or method is acceptable. The status of rule-circularity is contentious. Several authors argue that it is benign (for example, Braithwaite (1953), Conee (2004), Matheson (2012), Sosa (2009), and Van Cleve (1984)), but others argue that it is vicious circularity (e.g., Cling (2003) and Vogel (2008)). Depending on whether this circularity is benign or vicious, Applied Evidentialism is a promising or problematic response to the Problem of the Criterion (for more on this issue see epistemic circularity).

b. Dissolution

Robert Amico (1988a, 1993, and 1996) offers a very different response to the Problem of the Criterion. Rather than attempting to solve the Problem of the Criterion, Amico attempts to “dissolve” it. According to Amico, a philosophical problem is a question that can only be answered theoretically—it cannot be answered by purely empirical investigation. Further, a philosophical problem is such that there is rational doubt as to the correct answer to the question asked by the problem. He explains rational doubt as simply being such that withholding belief in a particular answer is the justified doxastic attitude to take. Since he explicates philosophical problems in terms of rational doubt and rational doubt is relative to a person, Amico maintains that problems are always relative to particular people. A particular question poses a problem for someone when that question generates rational doubt for her.

It is because of the role of rational doubt that Amico distinguishes between solutions to problems and dissolutions of problems. A solution to a problem is a set of true statements that answer the question that generates the problem and removes the rational doubt concerning the answer to the question. Dissolution occurs when the rational doubt is removed, not by an answer to the question, but rather by recognition that it is impossible to adequately answer the question. For example, Amico claims that the problem of how to square a circle is dissolved as soon as one recognizes that it is impossible to make a circular square. Once someone sees that it is impossible to make a circular square, the question “How do you square a circle?” does not generate any rational doubt for her. Without rational doubt, Amico claims that the problem has been dissolved and there is no need to look for a solution.

Like all problems, Amico claims that the Problem of the Criterion is only a problem for a particular person when its question raises rational doubt for the person. When we first consider the questions posed by the Problem of the Criterion Amico claims that we may have rational doubt about how to answer the questions in such a way that that answer can be justified to the skeptic. So, we face a problem. However, Amico argues that consideration of the failure of other responses—in particular their tendency to be question begging— and consideration of the nature of the problem itself allows one to recognize that it is in fact impossible to answer the questions of the Problem of the Criterion in a way that can be justified to the skeptic. Once one recognizes that it is impossible to answer the skeptic’s questions Amico alleges that the rational doubt generated by the Problem of the Criterion is removed. Thus, he claims that the Problem of the Criterion is at that point dissolved. Since it has been dissolved, we should not be troubled by the Problem of the Criterion at all.

There are three major challenges to Amico’s purported dissolution of the Problem of the Criterion. The first, as Sharon Ryan (1996) argues, is that it does not seem that the problem has been dissolved, but instead it seems that Amico has simply accepted that the skeptic is correct. Amico responds by claiming that the skeptical position is not a solution to the problem because that position cannot be justified to the particularist or the methodist. Since none of the three positions can justify their position to the others, he claims that the problem is dissolved. It is not clear that this adequately responds to Ryan’s criticism because one might think that claiming that there is no acceptable answer to the questions of the Problem of the Criterion is exactly what the skeptic had in mind all along.

The second major challenge to Amico’s view comes from the various responses to the Problem of the Criterion. Although he does discuss several responses, Amico does not argue that all of the responses mentioned above fail to provide answers that remove the rational doubt raised by the Problem of the Criterion. Insofar as one thinks that some of these responses to the Problem of the Criterion provide a solution to the problem, one will rightly be skeptical of Amico’s proffered dissolution.

The third major challenge to Amico’s view arises because he seems to rest his dissolution on what can and cannot be said in response to a skeptic. Andrew Cling argues that the Problem of the Criterion does not require skeptical interlocutors at all. Rather, Cling maintains that the difficulty illuminated by the Problem of the Criterion is that anti-skeptics have commitments that seem plausible when considered individually, but they are jointly inconsistent. The inconsistency among these commitments is present whether or not there are skeptics. Thus, Cling contends that arguing that the Problem of the Criterion is constituted by questions that cannot be answered does not dissolve the problem; it brings the problem to light.

4. The Problem of the Criterion’s Relation to Other Philosophical Problems

The Problem of the Criterion is a significant philosophical issue in its own right—if Chisholm is correct, it is one of the most fundamental of all philosophical problems. However, according to many philosophers, there are additional reasons to study this problem. They claim that the Problem of the Criterion is closely related to several other perennial problems of philosophy. It is worth briefly noting some of the philosophical problems thought to be closely related to the Problem of the Criterion.

First, James Van Cleve (1979) and Ernest Sosa (2007) maintain that the Cartesian Circle is in fact just a special instance of the Problem of the Criterion (See Descartes for more on the Cartesian Circle). Sosa also argues that the problem of easy knowledge is closely related to the Problem of the Criterion—something that Stewart Cohen (2002) and Andrew Cling note as well. In places Sosa seems to go so far as to suggest that the problem of easy knowledge and the Problem of the Criterion are the same problem. (See epistemic circularity for more on the problem of easy knowledge).

Next, Ruth Weintraub (1995) argues that Hume’s attack on induction is simply a special case of the Problem of the Criterion. She claims that Hume essentially applies the Problem of the Criterion to induction rather than applying the problem in a general fashion (For more on Humean inductive skepticism see confirmation and induction, epistemology, and Hume: causation).

According to Bryson Brown (2006), the challenge of responding to skepticism about the past is just a version of the Problem of the Criterion. He claims that debunking Bertrand Russell’s five-minute old universe hypothesis, for example, involves providing a criterion for trusting memory. This, he argues, requires satisfactorily responding to the Problem of the Criterion.

Andrew Cling (2009) and (2014) maintains that the Problem of the Criterion and the regress argument for skepticism are closely related. In fact, he argues that they are both instances of a more general problem that he calls the “paradox of reasons”. Cling argues that this paradox arises because it seems that it is possible to have reasons for a belief, it seems that reasons themselves must be supported by reasons, and it seems that if an endless sequence of reasons—either in the form of an infinite regress or a circle of reasons—is necessary for having reasons for a belief, then it is impossible to have reasons for a belief. According to Cling, these three commitments are inconsistent. The important point for the current purpose is that Cling maintains that the Problem of the Criterion and the regress argument for skepticism are both instances of the paradox of reasons (See infinitism in epistemology for more on regress arguments).

Finally, Howard Sankey (2010, 2011, and 2012) argues that the Problem of the Criterion provides one of the primary, if not the primary, argument in support of epistemic relativism. Relativists take the Problem of the Criterion to show that it is not possible to provide a justification for choosing one criterion over another. However, rather than opting for skepticism, which claims that no criterion is justified, relativists respond to the Problem of the Criterion by holding that all criteria are equally rational to adopt—one’s choice is determined simply by the context in which one finds oneself. Sankey argues that a clear understanding of the Problem of the Criterion is key to responding to the threat of epistemic relativism (For more on epistemic relativism see relativism).

The Problem of the Criterion is a significant philosophical problem in its own right. However, if these philosophers are correct in claiming that the Problem of the Criterion is related to all of these various philosophical problems in important ways, close study of this problem and its responses could yield insights that are very far-ranging.

5. References and Further Reading

Aikin, S.F. “The Problem of the Criterion and a Hegelian Model for Epistemic Infinitism.” History of Philosophy Quarterly 27 (2010): 379-88.
- Puts forward the view that Hegel proposes what is arguably a coherentist response to the Problem of the Criterion.
Amico, R. P. “Reply to Chisholm on the Problem of the Criterion.” Philosophical Papers 17 (1988a): 235-36.
- Presents a very brief formulation of his dissolution of the Problem of the Criterion.
Amico, R. P. “Roderick Chisholm and the Problem of the Criterion.” Philosophical Papers 17 (1988b): 217-29.
- Argues that Chisholm’s particularist response to the Problem of the Criterion is unsatisfactory.
Amico, R. P. The Problem of the Criterion. Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, Inc., 1993.
- The only book-length treatment of the Problem of the Criterion. Includes a helpful discussion of the history of the Problem of the Criterion, critiques of major responses to the Problem of the Criterion, and the full formulation of Amico’s proposed dissolution.
Amico, R. P. “Skepticism and the Problem of the Criterion.” In K. G. Lucey (ed.), On Knowing and the Known. Amherst, NY: Prometheus Books, 1996. 132-41.
- Argues against the skeptical response to the Problem of the Criterion in favor of his dissolution of the problem.
Braithwaite, R.B. Scientific Explanation. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1953.
- Argues that the sort of rule-circularity present in inductive arguments in support of induction is not always vicious.
Brown, B. “Skepticism About the Past and the Problem of the Criterion.” Croatian Journal of Philosophy 6 (2006): 291-306.
- Argues that skepticism about the past is in essence a limited form of the Problem of the Criterion.
Chisholm, R.M. Perceiving. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1957.
- Chisholm’s earliest discussion of the Problem of the Criterion appears in this work.
Chisholm, R.M. The Problem of the Criterion. Milwaukee, WI: Marquette University Press, 1973.
- The Aquinas Lecture on the Problem of the Criterion by one of the most influential epistemologists of the twentieth century. Arguably, this is the most important contemporary work on the Problem of the Criterion.
Chisholm, R.M. Theory of Knowledge. Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice Hall, 2^nd Edition, 1977; 3^rd Edition, 1989.
- Chisholm’s famous and widely used epistemology textbook; contains brief discussions of the Problem of the Criterion in both of its later editions.
Chisholm, R.M. The Foundations of Knowing. Minneapolis, MN: University of Minnesota Press, 1982.
- Contains a reprint of Chisholm’s 1973 Aquinas Lecture.
Chisholm, R.M. “Reply to Amico on the Problem of the Criterion.” Philosophical Papers 17 (1988): 231-34.
- Responds to Amico’s criticisms of his particularist response to the Problem of the Criterion. Claims that the Problem of the Criterion cannot be solved.
Cling, A.D. “Posing the Problem of the Criterion.” Philosophical Studies 75 (1994): 261-92.
- Argues that there are many more options for responding to the Problem of the Criterion than Chisholm considers. Presents his coherentist response to the Problem of the Criterion.
Cling, A.D. “Epistemic Levels and the Problem of the Criterion.” Philosophical Studies 88 (1997): 109-40.
- Presents the Problem of the Criterion as an argument for skepticism. Argues that both Chisholm and Van Cleve fail to solve the problem.
Cling, A.D. “Self-Supporting Arguments.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 66 (2003): 279-303.
- Evaluates the strength of self-supporting arguments in deductive and inductive logic. Argues that rule-circularity is a kind of vicious circularity.
Cling, A.D. “Reasons, Regresses, and Tragedy: The Epistemic Regress Problem and the Problem of the Criterion.” American Philosophical Quarterly 46 (2009): 333-46.
- Argues that the Problem of the Criterion and the regress argument for skepticism are both species of a more general problem, the “paradox of reasons”
Cling, A.D. “The Epistemic Regress Problem, the Problem of the Criterion, and the Value of Reasons.” Metaphilosophy 45 (2014): 161-71.
- Further develops the idea that the Problem of the Criterion and the regress argument for skepticism are both species of a more general problem, the “paradox of reasons”. Also, includes a discussion of the kinds of reasons that this problem reveals we can and cannot have.
Coffey, P. Epistemology or Theory of Knowledge. London: Longmans, Green, 1917.
- This work by D.J. Mercier’s pupil is largely responsible for ushering discussion of the Problem of the Criterion into the 20^th century.
Cohen, S. “Basic Knowledge and the Problem of Easy Knowledge.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 65 (2002): 309-29.
- Presents the problem of easy knowledge and notes its relevance to the Problem of the Criterion.
Conee, E. “First Things First.” In E. Conee and R. Feldman, Evidentialism. New York: Oxford University Press, 2004. 11-36.
- Presents and defends “Applied Evidentialism” as a response to the Problem of the Criterion.
DePaul, M. “The Problem of the Criterion and Coherence Methods in Ethics.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 18 (1988): 67-86.
- Presents a version of the Problem of the Criterion in terms of moral theories and describes his coherentist response to the Problem of the Criterion.
DePaul, M. “Pyrrhonian Moral Skepticism and the Problem of the Criterion.” Philosophical Issues 19 (2009), 38-56.
- Claims, like Chisholm, that all responses to the Problem of the Criterion—including the skeptical response—beg the question.
DePaul, M. “Sosa, Certainty and the Problem of the Criterion.” Philosophical Papers 40 (2011), 287-304.
- Suggests that Chisholm’s own particularist response to the Problem of the Criterion may have included some subtle methodism. Also, provides a discussion of Sosa’s recent work on the Problem of the Criterion.
Fumerton, R. “The Problem of the Criterion.” In J. Greco (ed.), The Oxford Handbook of Skepticism. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2008. 34-52.
- Claims there are at least two distinct problems often called the “Problem of the Criterion”. Also, discusses some responses to the Problem of the Criterion.
Greco, J. “Epistemic Circularity: Vicious, Virtuous and Benign.” International Journal for the Study of Skepticism 1 (2011): 1-8.
- Provides a nice summary of Sosa’s most recent work on the Problem of the Criterion.
Hegel, G.W.F. Phenomenology of Spirit. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1979.
- Helped draw attention back to the Problem of the Criterion in the 19^th century. Presents the Problem of the Criterion as a crisis for Spirit, and (arguably) proposes a coherentist response to the problem.
Lemos, Noah. Commonsense: A Contemporary Defense. New York: Cambridge University Press, 2004.
- Defends Chisholm’s particularist response to the Problem of the Criterion.
Matheson, J. “Epistemic Relativism.” In A. Cullison (ed.), Continuum Companion to Epistemology. New York: Continuum, 2012. 161-79.
- Argues against epistemic relativism and offers considerations for thinking that at least some kinds of epistemic circularity are not vicious.
Mercier, D.J. Criteriologie 8^th Edition. Paris: Felix Alcan, 1923.
- Helped draw attention back to the Problem of the Criterion in the 19^th century. Also, Chisholm cites Mercier’s conditions for what a satisfying criterion would have to look like.
McCain, K. and Rowley, W. “Pick Your Poison: Beg the Question or Embrace Circularity.” International Journal for the Study of Skepticism (2014): 125-40.
- Explains why the three responses to the Problem of the Criterion that Chisholm considers each beg the question. Also, argues that it is possible to respond to the Problem of the Criterion without begging the question, but doing so requires a commitment to certain forms of circularity as epistemically acceptable.
Montaigne, M. de. “Apology for Raymond Sebond.” In J. Zeitlin (trans.), Essays of Michael De Montaigne, New York: Knopf, 1935.
- The Problem of the Criterion appears to have resurfaced in the modern period with this work.
Moser, P.K. Knowledge and Evidence. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1989.
- Presents and defends his explanatory particularist response to the Problem of the Criterion.
Popkin, R.H. The History of Sceptism: From Savonarola to Bayle (Revised and Expanded Edition). New York: Oxford University Press, 2003.
- Discusses the historical development of skepticism. Of particular interest is the discussion of the influence that the Problem of the Criterion had on philosophy during the modern period.
Poston, T. “Explanationist Plasticity & The Problem of the Criterion.” Philosophical Papers 40 (2011): 395-419.
- Defends a coherentist response to the Problem of the Criterion.
Rescher, N. The Coherence Theory of Truth. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1973a.
- Part of the series of books in which Rescher’s “systems-theoretic approach” to the Problem of the Criterion is developed.
Rescher, N. The Primacy of Practice. Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1973b.
- Part of the series of books in which Rescher’s “systems-theoretic approach” to the Problem of the Criterion is developed.
Rescher, N. Methodological Pragmatism. Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1977.
- Part of the series of books in which Rescher’s “systems-theoretic approach” to the Problem of the Criterion is developed.
Rescher, N. Scepticism. Totowa, N.J.: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, 1980.
- Part of the series of books in which Rescher’s “systems-theoretic approach” to the Problem of the Criterion is developed.
Rockmore, T. “Hegel and Epistemological Constructivism.” Idealistic Studies 36 (2006): 183-90.
- Argues that Hegel proposes a coherentist response to the Problem of the Criterion.
Ryan, S. “Reply to Amico on Skepticism and the Problem of the Criterion.” In K. G. Lucey (ed.), On Knowing and the Known. Amherst, NY: Prometheus Books, 1996. 142-48.
- Argues that Amico’s dissolution of the Problem of the Criterion really amounts to accepting the skeptical response to the Problem of the Criterion.
Sankey, H. “Witchcraft, Relativism and the Problem of the Criterion.” Erkenntnis 72 (2010): 1-16.
- Explores the relationship between epistemic relativism and the Problem of the Criterion.
Sankey, H. “Epistemic Relativism and the Problem of the Criterion.” Studies in the History and Philosophy of Science 42 (2011): 562-70.
- Explores the relationship between epistemic relativism and the Problem of the Criterion.
Sankey, H. “Scepticism, Relativism, and the Argument from the Criterion.” Studies in the History and Philosophy of Science 43 (2012): 182-90.
- Explores the relationship between epistemic relativism and the Problem of the Criterion.
Sextus Empiricus. The Skeptic Way: Sextus Empiricus’s Outlines of Pyrrhonism, (trans.) B. Mates. New York: Oxford University Press, 1996.
- The original presentation of the Problem of the Criterion.
Sosa, E. A Virtue Epistemology: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge, Volume I. New York: Oxford University Press, 2007.
- Argues that the Cartesian Circle is a version of the Problem of the Criterion.
Sosa, E. Reflective Knowledge: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge, Volume II. New York: Oxford University Press, 2009.
- Develops Sosa’s response to the Problem of the Criterion. Argues that the problem of easy knowledge is a version of the Problem of the Criterion.
Van Cleve, J. “Foundationalism, Epistemic Principles, and the Cartesian Circle.” The Philosophical Review 88 (1979): 55-91.
- Argues that the Cartesian Circle is simply a special case of the Problem of the Criterion.
Van Cleve, J. “Reliability, Justification, and the Problem of Induction.” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 9 (1984): 555-67.
- Presents an inductive argument in support of induction and argues that the rule-circularity involved in such an argument is not vicious.
Van Cleve, J. “Sosa on Easy Knowledge and the Problem of the Criterion.” Philosophical Studies 153 (2011): 19-28.
- Discusses Sosa’s response to the Problem of the Criterion and the related, according to Sosa, problem of easy knowledge.
Vogel, J. “Epistemic Bootstrapping.” Journal of Philosophy 105 (2008): 518-39.
- Argues that many forms of epistemic circularity are viciously circular.
Weintraub, R. “What Was Hume’s Contribution to the Problem of Induction?” Philosophical Quarterly 45 (1995): 460-70.
- Argues that the problem of induction is simply a special case of the Problem of the Criterion.

Author Information

Kevin McCain
Email: mccain@uab.edu
University of Alabama at Birmingham
U. S. A.

Multiculturalism

Cultural diversity has been present in societies for a very long time. In Ancient Greece, there were various small regions with different costumes, traditions, dialects and identities, for example, those from Aetolia, Locris, Doris and Epirus. In the Ottoman Empire, Muslims were the majority, but there were also Christians, Jews, pagan Arabs, and other religious groups. In the 21^st century, societies remain culturally diverse, with most countries having a mixture of individuals from different races, linguistic backgrounds, religious affiliations, and so forth. Contemporary political theorists have labeled this phenomenon of the coexistence of different cultures in the same geographical space multiculturalism. That is, one of the meanings of multiculturalism is the coexistence of different cultures.

The term ‘multiculturalism’, however, has not been used only to describe a culturally diverse society, but also to refer to a kind of policy that aims at protecting cultural diversity. Although multiculturalism is a phenomenon with a long history and there have been countries historically that did adopt multicultural policies, like the Ottoman Empire, the systematic study of multiculturalism in philosophy has only flourished in the late twentieth century, when it began to receive special attention, especially from liberal philosophers. The philosophers who initially dedicated more time to the topic were mainly Canadian, but in the 21^st century it is a widespread topic in contemporary political philosophy. Before multiculturalism became a topic in political philosophy, most literature in this area focused on topics related to the fair redistribution of resources; conversely, the topic of multiculturalism in the realm of political philosophy highlights the idea that cultural identities are also normatively relevant and that policies ought to take these identities into consideration.

To understand the discussion of multiculturalism in contemporary political philosophy, there are four key topics that should be taken into consideration; these are the meaning of the concept of ‘culture’, the meaning of the concept of ‘multiculturalism’, the debate about justice between cultural groups and the discussion regarding the practical implications of multicultural practices.

The Concepts of Culture in Contemporary Political Theory
The Concept of Multiculturalism
1. Multiculturalism as a Describing Concept for Society
2. Multiculturalism as a Policy
  1. Multicultural Citizenship
  2. Negative Universalism
    1. Barry’s Liberal Egalitarianism
    2. Kukathas’ Libertarianism
The Second Wave of Writings on Multiculturalism
Animals and Multiculturalism
References and Further Reading

1. The Concepts of Culture in Contemporary Political Theory

Multiculturalism is before anything else a theory about culture and its value. Hence, to understand what multiculturalism is it is indispensable that the meaning of culture is clarified. In this section, five concepts of culture that are predominant in contemporary political philosophy are outlined: semiotic, normative, societal, economic/rational choice and the anti-essentialist cosmopolitanism conceptions of culture. As Festenstein (2005) points out, these are not competing conceptions of culture, where each selects a distinct set of necessary and sufficient conditions for the right application of the predicate. Contrastingly, all these conceptions of culture defend, even though in slightly different ways, the idea that culture is constitutive of personal identity. Therefore, it is possible to simultaneously defend, say, a semiotic conception of culture and admit that a culture may have normative, societal, economic and cosmopolitan features.

a. The Semiotic Perspective

The semiotic conception of culture was very popular in the 1960s, and has its roots in classic social anthropology. Social anthropologists like Margaret Mead, Levi-Straus and Malinowski considered culture as a set of social systems, symbols, representations and practices of signification held by a certain group. Thus, from this perspective, a culture is defined as a system of ideals or structures of symbolic meaning. Put differently, according to this view, culture should be understood as a symbolic system which in turn is a way of communication which represents the world. This form of communication is based on symbols, underlying structures and beliefs or ideological principles. One of the philosophers endorsing this perspective of culture is Parekh (2005). According to Parekh (2005, p. 139), human life is organized by a historically created system of meaning and significance and in turn this is what we call culture.

Taylor (1994b) who contends that human beings are self-interpreting animals, that is, human beings’ identities depend on the way each individual sees them self, also endorses this viewpoint. These self-understandings necessarily have to have meaning. Hence, the thesis that human beings are self-interpreting animals presupposes that human existence is constituted by meaning. In turn, this implies that human beings are also language animals. By language, what is meant are all modes of expression (music, spoken language, art and so forth) (Taylor, 1994b). To be language animals means that individuals are capable of creating value and meaning, and in Taylor’s view, these meanings have their origins in each individual’s cultural community. That is to say, language is, at least primarily, a result of the interaction of individuals with their own cultural community (Taylor, 1974; 1994b). More precisely, linguistic meanings and self-interpretations have their origins in individuals’ linguistic communities. Thus, culture is a system of symbolic meaning.

Bearing this in mind, it can be argued that the study of culture from the semiotic perspective is the analysis or elucidation of meaning. As in hermeneutics, where the reader has to interpret the meaning of a text, in culture one has to interpret its internal logic (Festenstein, 2005). An example of interpreting the internal logic of a culture could be given by the story told by Quine (1960) regarding the native who says ‘Gavagai!’ whenever he sees a rabbit. Quine (1960) suggests that there may be multiple meanings associated with this actions; it may mean ‘rabbit’, ‘food’, ‘an undetached rabbit-part’, ‘there will be a storm tonight’ (if the native is superstitious) and so forth. The symbolism, sign process or system of meaning underlying this action is what, according to the point of view of semiotics, culture is, and this is what should be studied. In short, it is the study of culture’s autonomous logic.

b. The Normative Conception

The normative conception of culture is usually adopted by communitarians. From this point of view, culture is important because it is what provides beliefs, norms and moral reasons, prompting individuals to act. Hence, part of what a person is includes their moral commitments; their practical identity is made up of these moral commitments, while their reasons to act are motivated by their moral commitments. In other words, according to the normative conception of culture, the term ‘culture’ refers to a group of norms and beliefs that are distinctive and which constitute the practical identity of a group of individuals; thereby, people’s values and commitments result, in part, from culture (Festenstein, 2005, p. 14). By way of illustration, part of what a Christian, a Muslim and a Jew are is constituted by the fact they abide or follow the moral teachings of the Bible, the Quran and the Torah, respectively. Therefore, understanding who one is is about understanding one’s moral commitments and therefore culture is norm-providing. Shachar (2001a, p. 2) is one of the philosophers who endorses this conception of culture. According to her, culture is a world view, both comprehensive and distinguishable, whereby community law is able to be created. To minority groups that have a culture, Shachar (2001a, p.2) attaches the label ‘nomoi communities’. According to her, this term can apply to religious, ethnic, racial, tribal and national groups, for all these groups exhibit the normative dimension required to be classified as a ‘nomoi community’.

The normative conception of culture is usually associated with the semiotic, in the sense that one does not contradict the other; in fact, they may be complementary. For instance, Taylor endorses both perspectives of culture. However, this is not necessary because the system of meaning and significance does not need to provide moral reasons in order to motivate action. From the semiotic perspective, what someone is is not necessarily his or her moral commitments; it can be anything within the system. That is, the system of meaning may be based on anything while, according to the normative conception of culture, culture is strong source of one’s moral commitments.

To explain how the semiotic and normative conceptions of culture can be compatible, consider Taylor’s conception of culture. Taylor considers that individuals are self-interpreting animals. The fact that individuals are thus entails that human existence is constituted by meanings. From the normative point of view, these meanings are moral evaluations/strong evaluations. This refers to the distinctions of worth that individuals make regarding objects of desire. In other words, it is a background of distinctions between things that individuals consider important or worthy and those things which are considered less valuable. From the normative perspective of culture, individuals direct their lives and purposes towards what they consider morally worthwhile. In short, these strong evaluations or moral frameworks are what indicate to individuals what is meaningful and rewarding. That is, they are motivated by these evaluations (Taylor, 1974). Therefore, the self has a moral dimension, in the sense that rationality and identity refer to moral evaluations. Identity is connected with morality because what individuals are is constituted by their self-interpretations, which are ultimately provided by strong evaluations (Taylor, 1974). These moral beliefs or strong evaluations are in turn provided by an individual’s culture–that is why this can be considered a normative conception of culture.

c. The Societal Conception

The societal conception of culture is a concept mainly used by the Canadian philosopher Kymlicka. In order to understand this, it is helpful to consider Kymlicka’s dual typology of the sources of diversity that exist in contemporary societies; for Kymlicka there are two kinds of diversity: polyethnic minorities and national minorities.

Kymlicka uses the term polyethnicity to refer to the kind of diversity resulting from immigration. Polyethnic minorities refer to what is commonly defined as ethnic groups. According to him, polyethnic groups are usually not territorially concentrated; rather they are dispersed around the country to which they migrated. Furthermore, Kymlicka affirms that they do not usually want to be segregated from the culture of the majority; rather they want to integrate with it, demanding policies that give them equal citizenship. For instance, these groups demand language rights, voting rights, places in parliament and so forth. However, even though this demand for equal citizenship is usually what polyethnic groups aspire to, this is not always the case. Kymlicka contends that polyethnic groups can be sub-divided into liberal and illiberal groups (Kymlicka, 2001, pp. 55-58). Liberal polyethnic groups have aspirations that do not go against liberal values, usually aspiring to be integrated into society, demanding policies for equal citizenship. As an example, Kymlicka usually refers to Latin-American immigrants living in the United States, who, in broad terms, make demands for language rights, such as an education curriculum in Spanish.

On the other hand, for Kymlicka, illiberal polyethnic groups are those where the culture and the demands to the state are not in accordance with liberal values. For example, some religious minority ethnic groups advocate the death penalty for gays within their groups; others have gendered and discriminatory norms in relation to divorce and marriage. Some of these groups have demands that are more similar to the ones of national minorities but Kymlicka contends that these cases are the exception, not the rule (Kymlicka, 1995, pp. 11-26, 97-99).

Polyethnic groups are not, in Kymlicka’s view, considered a culture; according to him, only nations are a culture. Kymlicka (1995, p. 18) uses the term nation interchangeably with the terms culture, people and societal culture, for example, “I am using ‘a culture’ as synonymous with ‘a nation’ or ‘a people’—that is, as an intergenerational community, more or less institutionally complete, occupying a given territory or homeland, sharing a distinct language and history”. In Kymlicka’s view, national minorities are a group in a society with a societal culture and a smaller number of members than the majority. Hence, a national minority is a societal culture where the amount of members is smaller in number than the amount of members of the majority. For Kymlicka (1995, p. 76) a societal culture is a kind of social setting that provides individuals with meaningful ways of life, both in the public and private sphere. These societal cultures are important mainly because they give individuals the groundwork from which they can make choices. More precisely for Kymlicka (1995, p. 76) due to the fact that societal cultures provide meaningful ways of life, they provide the social context that individuals need in order to make their own choices (that is, to be autonomous). Kymlicka’s rationale is that autonomy is only possible in certain social contexts and that social context is set up by societal cultures.

From Kymlicka’s point of view, national minorities or minority societal cultures usually share a number of characteristics. First, national minorities have settled in the country long ago. For example, most of the Amish communities in Pennsylvania settled there in the eighteenth century, as a result of religious persecution in Europe. Aborigines in Australia and many Native American groups in the USA have lived in that territory for a long period. Second, from Kymlicka’s point of view, these groups are often territorially concentrated; for example, Quebec and Catalonia are situated in specific geographic areas of Canada and Spain, respectively. In India, Sikhs are geographically concentrated mostly in the Punjab region. Third, according to Kymlicka, the institutions and practices of these groups provide a full range of human activities; this means that nations are embodied in common economic, political and educational institutions. These institutions are not based only on shared meanings, memories and values but include common practices and procedures. Put differently, nations are institutionally complete in the sense that they encompass a wide institutional elaboration that encompasses a variety of areas of life; they have their own governments, laws, schools and so forth. In Kymlicka’s view, the fourth characteristic that national minorities have in common is that they usually aspire to either total or partial segregation from the larger society. That is, these groups wish to be a totally or partially separate society, with a different state, governed by their own laws and institutions. Hence, national minorities, in Kymlicka’s view, do not want to integrate in the larger society; rather they wish to be able to have a certain degree of autonomy. For example, many Quebecois want to be able to have their own government institutions, run in the way they wish, like schools run in French. Often, the Amish want to be left alone, without intervention from the state in their internal affairs. More precisely, one of the demands of some Amish communities is that they are exempt from the basic educational requirements that other citizens of the USA have to abide by, namely, the minimum literacy requirements. This, as will be explained later on, relates to other set of normative questions about what groups can and cannot impose to their members. In order to address this problem, Kymlicka draws a distinction between practices that can be imposed (external protections) and practices that cannot be imposed (internal restrictions).

From Kymlicka’s point of view, national minorities can further be sub-divided into liberal and illiberal minorities. The former are those whose demands are compatible with liberal values, that is, their demands do not violate individuals’ rights and liberties. Under the concept of liberal national minorities are examples like Quebecois and Catalonians; these national minorities usually demand the right to use a different language in schools and their other institutions, and this does not necessarily violate any liberal value. The concept of illiberal national minorities refers to groups that wish to endorse illiberal values, like the death penalty for gays and lesbians.

d. The Economic/Rational Choice Approach

Rational choice is a theory that aims to explain and predict social behavior. From the viewpoint of rational choice, individuals act self-interestedly when they take into consideration their preferences and the information available. Self-interest means that individuals tend to maximize what is valuable for them. In other words, human behavior is goal-oriented. It is goal oriented by its preferences, that is, individuals act according to their preferences. For instance, if an individual prefers a hot chocolate to a vanilla milkshake or a strawberry milkshake and all the options are available, he will choose hot chocolate (other things being equal).

According to the rational choice view, the information available strongly affects behavior. By way of illustration, if an individual does not know that hot chocolate is available he will not choose it. Thus individuals act according to their self-interest, information and preferences. If a certain person’s preference is to buy the tastiest hot chocolate and this person has the information that the tastiest hot chocolate is sold in a particular store, then this person will act in order to achieve her/his own interest, that is, by going to that store and purchasing it there. Obviously, these actions are limited by the options available and by the actions of others. Therefore, if there is no hot chocolate on the market, this person will not be able to buy it–the option is not available because the suppliers decided not to offer hot chocolate. In this sense, an individual’s are dependent on their circumstances and on the actions of others.

With these premises in mind, a possible definition of culture from a rational choice perspective is provided by Laitin (2007, p. 64), whereby culture is:

an equilibrium in a well-defined set of circumstances in which members of a group sharing in common descent, symbolic practices and/or high levels of interaction—and thereby becoming a cultural group—are able to condition their behavior on common knowledge beliefs about the behavior of all members of the group.

Therefore, there are four key features of this conception of culture. First, a cultural group is a group in which individuals share a certain number of characteristics that differentiate them from other individuals–for example, language or religion. Second, all these individuals share a high degree of common knowledge. What common knowledge means in this context is that the members of a certain culture have shared information and mutual expectations about the actions and beliefs of others in the group. Third, there is a cultural equilibrium when the incentive to act or the self-interest to act is according to the beliefs of his or her own culture. More precisely, a cultural equilibrium occurs when individuals’ have an interest in acting in accordance with the norms and practices of their culture. These norms and practices can be any, but Laitin (2007) provides an insightful example with respect to the old Chinese tradition of foot binding. Laitin explains that it was very difficult for Chinese women to marry a man if they did not engage in the foot binding tradition. In this case, most Chinese parents forced their daughters to engage in this practice owing to the fact that their interest in finding a husband to their daughters was in accordance with the cultural practice of foot binding. Finally, a well-defined set of circumstances can be described as a kind of situation where the type of interactions that members have with each other are ones of coordination and not conflict. That is, individuals’ actions are ones that are arranged in a way that match or complement each other, rather than being in conflict.

e. Anti-Essentialism and Cosmopolitanism

The concepts of culture mentioned above have been strongly criticized by some political theorists. Some of these, who direct their criticisms mostly to the semiotic, normative and societal conceptions of culture, argue that these conceptions are essentialist views of culture that inaccurately describe social reality. However, as Festenstein (2005) has pointed out, these criticisms are sometimes misplaced, that is, these conceptions of culture do not necessarily need to be essentialist.

In general terms, from an essentialist point of view, there is a distinction between the essential and accidental properties that the different kinds of objects and subjects may have. Accidental properties are properties that are not necessarily present in all members of a certain group of objects or subjects. Essential properties are those that define the objects or subjects, that is, objects or subjects necessarily need to have these properties in order to be members of a certain group. Furthermore, members of other groups do not have this property or set of properties; otherwise they too would belong to this group. By way of illustration, a bookshelf in order to be a bookshelf has to necessarily be constructed in a way that makes it possible to hold books–this is its essential property. The fact that a specific bookshelf is brown, black or blue is an accidental property–it does not change what the object is and it is indifferent to its definition. These properties are necessary and sufficient not only to include a certain object or subject in the group but also to exclude any object or subject which does not share these properties. Bearing this in mind, it can be concluded that essences are given by differences and similarities; for what defines a subject is what it has in common with the subjects of the same group, which in turn is a characteristic that other groups do not have.

In terms of what this means to culture, it means identifying the social characteristics or attributes that make the group what it is, and that all members of that group necessarily share. Moreover, these characteristics are what differentiate members of that group from others and clearly exclude others (Young, 2000a, p. 87). For example, for an essentialist, to classify Muslims as Muslims means to identify a certain characteristic, like shared practices and beliefs, common to all of the individuals who identify as Muslims. Thus, essentialism applied to culture would be that a certain culture means having a certain characteristic or set of characteristics that all members share, and which no one outside the group does. Hence, from this point of view, the identity of the group is constituted by the set of properties or attributes which are essential to this particular group (Young, 2000a).

According to the critics of essentialism, this theory necessarily makes two wrong assumptions about culture. First, the critics state that essentialists wrongly affirm that cultures are clearly demarcated wholes and their practices and beliefs do not overlap with other cultures. Thus, according to this argument, essentialists wrongly affirm that beliefs and practices are exclusive to each culture. This premise is necessary for defending essentialism because from an essentialist point of view; different groups cannot share the same essential properties; otherwise they would belong to the same group. Second, essentialists, according to these critics, wrongly picture cultures as internally uniform or homogeneous. Put differently, essentialists consider that individuals with the same culture all agree and interpret practices in the same way. Furthermore, they all place the same value on the practices of the group. This second premise is necessary for essentialist thinking owing to the fact that a group has to have a property or a set of properties that is predicated of all individuals in order for them to be members of this group.

This essentialist perspective of culture has however been widely contested. The general argument is that essentialism stereotypes and makes abusive generalizations of what groups are. That is to say, according to the critics, essentialism is descriptively inaccurate. Criticism of this perspective contends that the first premise lacks empirical evidence. There is no evidence that there is any exclusivity in terms of practices and beliefs, in fact, evidence suggests the opposite; cultures borrow practices and beliefs in order to increase their fitness. Cultures are not bounded, owing to the fact that culture is constantly changing, influenced by local, national and global resources (Phillips, 2007a; 2010). Hence, according to this view, it is not possible to clearly demarcate the boundaries of cultures because they share a number of practices and beliefs. There is significant overlapping of cultures, especially in neighboring cultures. The distinction between cultures is, therefore, overemphasized–the boundaries between cultures not being clearly demarcated (Benhabib, 2002; Phillips, 2007a).

With regards to the second premise, the criticism contends that it is false to say that there is internal homogeneity inside a group in terms of needs, interests and beliefs. Rather, the social actors of cultural groups have different needs, interests and interpretations about the beliefs and practices of groups. Furthermore, in many cases, they consider these practices and beliefs quite contestable, discussable and open to different interpretations. Therefore, there is wide disagreement about cultural meaning (Benhabib, 2002). Anti-essentialists contend that there are too many exceptions to make essentialist claims. Therefore, there are a considerable number of counter-examples to this generalization (Phillips, 2007a; 2010; Schachar, 2001a). As a consequence, some anti-essentialists usually argue that these categories should be substituted by thinner categories. Thus, rather than speaking about women, one should speak about black women, or lesbian Muslim women.

Taking this into consideration, different, more flexible conceptions of culture have been suggested; perhaps the most well-known being the cosmopolitan conception of culture, defended by Waldron. In Waldron’s view, cultures are dynamic and in continuous creation and interchange (Waldron, 1991). Consequently, cultures overlap with each other, making it impossible to attribute exclusive properties to one single culture and to differentiate between them. In other words, according to this view, there is a mélange of cultures because people move between cultures by enjoying the opportunities that each provides. Hence, individuals live in a kaleidoscope of cultures, within which they enjoy and borrow practices (Waldron, 1996).

A question that arises is whether this criticism entails that any attempt to define culture is mistaken. Some anti-essentialists like Narayan (1998) contend that this is not the case. Rather, she contends that cultures can be defined if two points are taken into consideration. First, cultures are fluid and constantly changing; hence, any definition of culture should consider that cultures are always in flux. Second, broader categories should be substituted by thinner categories. This means that rather than using terms like ‘African Culture’, one should use terms like ’Tutsi culture in Rwanda’.

2. The Concept of Multiculturalism

In general terms, within contemporary political philosophy, the concept of multiculturalism has been defined in two different ways. Sometimes the term ‘multiculturalism’ is used as a descriptive concept; other times it is defined as a kind of policy for responding to cultural diversity. In the next section, the definition of multiculturalism as a descriptive concept will be explained, followed by a clarification of what it means to use the term ‘multiculturalism’ as a policy.

a. Multiculturalism as a Describing Concept for Society

The term ‘multiculturalism’ is sometimes used to describe a condition of society; more precisely, it is used to describe a society where a variety of different cultures coexist. Many countries in the world are culturally diverse. Canada is just one example, including a variety of cultures such as English Canadians, Quebecois, Native Americans, Amish, Hutterites and Chinese immigrants. China is another country that can also be considered culturally diverse. In contemporary China, there are 56 officially recognized ethnic groups, and 55 of these groups are ethnic minorities who make up approximately 8.41 percent of China’s overall population. The other ethnic group is that of Han Chinese, which holds majority status (Han, 2013; He, 2006).

There are a variety of ways whereby societies can be diverse, for example, culture can come in many forms (Gurr, 1993, p. 3). Perhaps the chief ways in which a country can be culturally diverse is by having different religious groups, different linguistic groups, groups that define themselves by their territorial identity and variant racial groups.

Religious diversity is a widespread phenomenon in many countries. India can be given as an example of a country which is religiously diverse, including citizens who are Sikhs, Hindus, Buddhists, among other religious groups. The US is also religiously diverse, including Mormons, Amish, Hutterites, Catholics, Jews and so forth. These groups differentiate from each other via a variety of factors. Some of these are the Gods worshiped, the public holidays, the religious festivals and the dress codes.

Linguistic diversity is also widespread. In the 21^st century, there are more than 200 countries in the world and around 6000 spoken languages (Laitin, 2007). Linguistic diversity usually results from two kinds of groups. First, it results from immigrants who move to a country where the language spoken is not their native language (Kymlicka, 1995). This is the case for those Cubans and Puerto Ricans who immigrated to the United States; it is also the case for Ukrainian immigrants who moved to Portugal.

The second set of groups that are understood as a form of linguistic diversity are national minorities. The term ‘national minorities’ routinely refers to groups that have settled in the country for a long time, but do not share the same language with the majority. Some examples include Quebecois in Canada, Catalans and Basques in Spain, and the Welsh in the UK. Usually, these linguistic groups are territorially concentrated; furthermore, minority groups that fall into this category usually demand a high degree of autonomy. In particular, minority groups usually demand that they have the regional power to self-govern, that is, to run their territory as if it was an independent country or to succeed and become a different country.

A third kind of group diversity can results from distinct territory location. This territory location does not necessary mean that members of distinct cultures are, in fact, different. That is, it is not necessary that habits, traditions, customs, and so forth are significantly different. However, these distinct groups identify themselves as different from others because of the specific geographical area in which they are located. Possibly, in the UK, this is what distinguishes Scots from English. Even though there are historical differences between Scots and English, if one assumes that these two groups have little to distinguish themselves from each other, other than their geographical location, they would fit this third kind of group diversity. As mentioned above, these differences are conceptual and, in practice, cultural groups are characterized by a variety of features and not just one.

The fourth kind of group diversity is race. Races are groups whose physical characteristics are imbued with social significance. In other words, race is a socially constructed concept in the sense that it is the result of individuals giving social significance to a set of characteristics they consider that stand out in a person’s physical appearance, such as skin color, eye color, hair color, bone/jaw structure and so forth. However, the mere existence of different physical characteristics does not mean that there is a multicultural environment/society. For instance, it cannot be affirmed that Sweden is multicultural because there are Swedes with blue eyes and others with green. Physical characteristics create a multicultural environment only when these physical characteristics mean that groups strongly identify with their physical characteristics and where these physical characteristics are socially perceived as something that strongly differentiates them from other groups. That is, racial cultural diversity is not simply the existence of different physical characteristics. Rather, these different physical characteristics must entail a sense of common identity which, in turn, are socially perceived as something that differentiates the members of that group to others. However, many times this idea of common identity is exaggerated, as Waldron’s argument suggests. For instance, even though there is the idea that a black culture exists in the United States, Appiah (1996) denies that such black culture exists, since there is no common identity among blacks in the United States. An example of a physical difference that is considered socially significant and, therefore, creates a multicultural society/environment can be seen in the Tutsis and Hutus of Rwanda. In general terms, Tutsis and Hutus are very similar, due to the fact that they speak the same language, share the same territory and follow the same traditions. Nevertheless, Tutsis are usually taller and thinner than Hutus. The social significance given to these physical differences are sufficient for members of both groups, broadly speaking, to identify as members of one group or the other, and subsequently oppose to each other.

Obviously, groups are not, most of the time, identified only by being linguistically different, territorially concentrated or religiously distinct. In fact, most groups have more than one of these characteristics. For instance, Sikhs in India, besides being religiously different, are also characterized, in general terms, by their geographical location. Namely, they are localized in the Punjab region of India. The Uyghur, from China, have a different language, are usually Muslims and are usually located in Xinjiang. Thus, the classification is helpful for understanding the characteristics of each group, but does not mean that these groups are simply defined by that characteristic.

b. Multiculturalism as a Policy

The term ‘multiculturalism’ can also be used to refer to a kind of policy. This kind of policy has two main characteristics. First, it aims at addressing the different demands of cultural groups. That is, it is a kind of policy that refers to the different normative challenges (ethnic conflict, internal illiberalism, federal autonomy, and so forth) that arise as a result of cultural diversity. For example, these are policies that aim at addressing the different normative challenges that arise from minority groups, like Quebecois, wishing to have their own institutions in a different language from the rest of Canada. To contrast with redistributive policies, multicultural policies are not primarily about distributive justice, that is, who gets what share of resources, although multicultural policies may refer to redistribution accidentally (Fraser, 2001). Multicultural policies aim at correcting the kind of disadvantages that some individuals are victims of, and that result from these individuals’ cultural identity. For instance, these are policies that aim at correcting a disadvantage that may result from someone being a member of a certain religion. In the case of some Muslims, this can mean addressing the problem of Muslims living in a Christian country and demanding different public holidays than the majority to celebrate their own festivals such as Eid-al-Fitr.

Second, multicultural policies are policies that aim at providing groups the means by which individuals can pursue their cultural differences. Put differently, multicultural policies have as their objectives, the preservation, allowance or celebration of differences between different groups. Consequently, multicultural policies contrast with assimilation. That is, according to the assimilationist view, it is acceptable that people are different, but the final goal of policies should be to make the minority group become part of the majority group, that is, to be accepted by those in the majority group, and to somehow find a consensus position between different cultures. Contrastingly, multiculturalism acknowledges that people have different ways of life and, in general terms, the state ought not to assimilate these groups but to give them the tools for pursuing their own ways of life or culture. That is, from a multiculturalist point of view, the final objective of policies is neither the standardization of cultural forms nor any form of uniformity or homogeneity; rather, its objective is to allow and give the means for groups to pursue their differences.

According to Kymlicka, in the context of contemporary liberal political philosophy, there have been two waves of writings on multiculturalism (Kymlicka, 1999a). This discussion of what policies ought to be undertaken in order to protect minority cultures is included in what Kymlicka called the first wave of the wave of writings on multiculturalism. In his view (1999a, p. 112), the first wave of writing focused on assessing to what extent it is just, from a liberal point of view, to give rights to groups so that they can pursue their cultural differences. In this first wave of writings, contemporary liberal political philosophers have discussed what kind of inequalities exist between majorities and minorities, and how these should be addressed. In other words, the discussion has been about what kind of intergroup inequalities exist, and what the state should do about them. In general terms, contemporary liberal political philosophers who have written about this topic have taken two different stands. On the one hand, some liberal political philosophers defend that state institutions should be blind to difference and that individuals should be given a uniform set of rights and liberties. In these authors’ views, cultural diversity, religious freedom and so forth are sufficiently protected by these sets of rights and liberties, especially by freedom of association and conscience. Therefore, those who stand for a uniform set of rights and liberties contend that ascribing rights on the basis of membership in a group is a discriminatory and immoral policy that creates citizenship hierarchies that are undesirable and unjust (Kymlicka, 1999a, pp. 112-113). Thus, in the view of these contemporary liberal philosophers, involvement in the cultural character of society is something that the state is under the duty to not do.

On the other hand, some philosophers have taken the opposite view on this matter. For example, there are some contemporary liberal political philosophers who are more sympathetic to the idea of ascribing rights to groups and have defended difference-sensitive policies. As Kymlicka (1999a, p. 112) points out, these contemporary liberal political philosophers have tried to show that difference-sensitive rules are not inherently unjust. In general terms, these contemporary political philosophers argue that a regime of difference-sensitive policies does not necessarily entail a hierarchization of citizenship and unfair privileges for some groups. Rather, they argue that difference-sensitive policies aim at correcting intergroup inequalities and disadvantages in the cultural market. Moreover, some of these philosophers contend that difference-blind policies favor the needs, interests and identities of the majority (Kymlicka, 1999a, pp. 112-114). These philosophers who consider that groups are entitled to special rights can be classified as a form of multicultural citizenship.

Those who defend special rights for groups have suggested a variety of policies. In his book The Multiculturalism of Fear, Levy (2000, pp. 125-160) systematically exposed the kinds of difference-sensitive policies that are usually discussed in the literature. According to him, difference-sensitive policies can be divided into eight categories: exemptions, assistance, symbolic claims, recognition/enforcement, special representation, self-government, external rules and internal rules.

Exemptions to laws are usually rights based on a negative liberty of non-interference from the state in a specific affair, which would cause a significant burden to a certain group. Or, to put it another way, exemptions to the law happen when the state abstains from interfering with or obliging a certain group who desire to practice something in order to diminish their burden. Exemptions can also be a limitation of someone else’s liberty to impose some costs on a certain group. Imagine that there is a general law that decrees corporations have the right to impose a dress code upon their employees. However, having this general law would burden those groups for whom dressing in a certain manner (that is, different from the one required by the company) is a very important value. For example, for many Sikh men and Muslim women it is very important to wear turbans and headscarves, respectively. Hence, it can be claimed that giving these individuals the option of either finding another job or rejecting their dress code can be a significant burden to them; given that the choice of dressing in a certain way is sometimes much harder for Sikh men and Muslim women than for a Westerner, and that it would undermine their identity, an exemption may be justified (Levy, 2000, pp. 128-133). Hence, these groups would be able to engage in practices that are not allowable for the majority of citizens.

Assistance rights aim to aid individuals in overcoming the obstacles they face because they belong to a certain group. In other words, assistance rights aim to rectify disadvantages experienced by certain individuals, as a result of their membership of a certain group, when compared to the majority. This can mean funding individuals to pursue their goals or using positive discrimination to help them in a variety of ways. Language rights are an example of this approach. Suppose that some individuals from Catalonia cannot speak Spanish. An assistance measure would be having people speak both Spanish and Catalan at public institutions, so that they can serve people from the minority as well the minority language group. Another example would be awarding subsidies to help groups preserve their cohesion by maintaining their practices and beliefs, and by allowing individuals from a minority to participate in public institutions as full citizens. Most of these practices are temporary, but they do not need to be (language rights, for example, are often not temporary) (Levy, 2000, pp. 133-137).

Symbolic claims refer to problems which do not affect individuals’ lives directly or seriously, but which may make the relations between individuals from different groups better. In a multicultural country, where there are multiple religions, ethnicities and ways of life, it may not make sense to have certain symbols that represent only a specific culture. Symbolic claims are ones that require, on the grounds of equality, the inclusion of all the cultures in a specific country in that country’s symbols. An example would be including Catholic, Sikh, Muslim, Protestant, Welsh, Northern Irish, Scottish, and English symbols on both the British flag and in the national anthem. Not integrating minority symbols may be considered as dispensing a lack of respect and unequal treatment to minorities.

Recognition is a demand for integrating a specific law or cultural practice into the larger society. If individuals want to integrate a specific law, they can ask for the law to become part of the major legal system. Hence, Sharia law could form part of divorce law for Muslims, while Aboriginal law could run in conjunction with Australian property rights law. It could also be a requirement to include certain groups in the history books used in schools–for example, to include the history of Indian and Pakistani immigrants in British history textbooks. Failing to integrate this law may bring a substantive burden to bear on individuals’ identity. In the Muslim case, because family law is of crucial importance to their identity, they may be considerably burdened by having to abide by a Western perspective of divorce. With regards to Aboriginal law, because hunting is essential for their way of life, if other individuals own the(ir) land this may undermine the Aboriginal culture.

Special representation rights are designed to protect groups which have been systematically unrepresented and disadvantaged in the larger society. Minority groups may be under-represented in the institutions of a society, and in order to place them in a position of equal bargaining power, it is necessary to provide special rights to the members of these groups. Hence, these rights aim to defend individuals’ interests in a more equal manner by guaranteeing some privileges or preventing discrimination. One way to achieve this is by setting aside extra seats for minorities in parliament (Kymlicka, 1995, pp. 131-152; Levy, 2000, pp. 150-154).

Self-government rights are usually what are claimed by national minorities (for example, Pueblo Indians and Quebecois) and they usually demand some degree of autonomy and self-determination. This sometimes implies demands for exclusive occupation of land and territorial jurisdiction. The reason groups sometimes may need these rights is that the kind of autonomy they give is a necessary condition by which individuals can develop their cultures, which is in the best interest of a culture’s members. More precisely, a specific educational curriculum, language right or jurisdiction over a territory may be a necessary requirement for the survival and prosperity of a particular culture and its members. This is compatible with both freedom and equality; it is compatible with freedom because it allows individuals access to their culture and to make their own choices; it is consistent with equality because it places individuals on an equal footing in terms of cultural access (Kymlicka, 1995, pp. 27-30; Levy, 2000, pp. 137- 138).

What Levy classifies as external rules can be considered as kinds of rights for self-government. They involve restricting other people’s freedom in order to preserve a certain culture. Hence, Aborigines in Australia employ external safeguards to protect their land. For example, freedom of movement is limited to outsiders who circulate in Aboriginal territory; furthermore, outsiders do not have the right to buy Aboriginal land. Demands that groups make for internal rules are those demands that aim at restricting individuals’ behavior within the group. Stigmatizing, ostracizing or excommunicating individuals from groups because they have not abided by the rules is what is usually meant by internal rules. Thus, this is the power given to groups to treat their members in a way that is not acceptable for the rest of society. An example can be if a certain individual marries someone from another group, which may then mean he is expelled from his own group. Another case is that of the Amish who want their children to withdraw from school earlier than the rest of society. In contrast to external rules, the restrictions on freedom apply to members of the group and not to outsiders. It is controversial whether internal rules are compatible with liberal values or not. On the one hand, authors like Kymlicka affirm they are not, because they undermine individuals’ autonomy, which is, in his view, a central liberal value. On the other hand, philosophers like Kukathas contend that liberals are committed to tolerance and, thereby, should accept some internal restrictions.

i. Multicultural Citizenship

Generally speaking, the philosophy of those authors who defend a multicultural citizenship, have five points in common. Firstly, they all contend that the state has the duty to support laws which defend the basic legal, civil and political rights of its citizens. Secondly, they argue that the state should participate in the construction of societal cultural character, thus its laws and policies should aim to protect culture. Thirdly, these philosophers contend that the character of culture is normative. Consequently, and this is the fourth common feature, individuals’ interest in culture is sufficiently strong enough that it needs to be supported by the state. Fifth, they both defend difference-sensitive/multicultural citizenship policies for protecting culture. Some of the philosophers who defend a multicultural citizenship are Taylor, Kymlicka and Shachar.

1. Taylor’s Politics of Recognition

According to Taylor, there are two forms of recognition; intimate recognition and public recognition. Taylor (1994b, p. 37) mainly discusses the idea of public recognition or recognition in the public sphere. This form of recognition is about respect and esteem for one’s identity in the public realm; being misrecognized in the public realm means to have one’s identity disrespected in a way whereby one is treated as a second-class citizen. Being misrecognized, in this sense, is to have an unequal citizenship status in virtue of one’s identity. Hence, someone is misrecognized in the public sphere if one has a legal disadvantage that results from one’s identity. To have respect and esteem for someone in the public sphere means to have citizenship rights that do not disadvantage one’s identity. In Taylor’s view, misrecognition can potentially be a form of oppression and helps to create self-hating images in those who are misrecognized. Bearing this in mind, recognition is a vital human need because the relation between recognition and identity (the way people understand who they are) is relatively strong; hence, misrecognition or non-recognition may have a serious harmful effect on individuals

In order to discuss the best way to achieve recognition in the public realm, Taylor draws a distinction between procedural and non-procedural forms of liberalism. He affirms that, according to the procedural version of liberalism, a just society is one where all individuals have a uniform set of rights and freedoms, and having different rights for different people creates distinctions between first-class and second-class citizens: this liberalism is only committed to individual rights and rejects the idea of collective rights. The state, according to this version of liberalism, should not be involved in the cultural character of society and the procedures of this society must be independent of any particular set of values held by the citizens of that polity. In other words, the state should be neutral and independent of any conception of the good life.

In Taylor’s (1994b, p. 60) view, procedural liberalism is inhospitable to difference and is unable to accommodate different cultures. Taylor believes that, in some cases, collective goals need to be aided so that they can be achieved. Sometimes cultural communities need to have power over certain jurisdictions so that they can promote their own culture; this is something that a procedural liberalism does not offer, according to Taylor. Due to the fact that Taylor considers recognition as important, this kind of liberalism that is inhospitable to difference should be rejected; rather, in Taylor’s view, a non-procedural liberalism that is involved in the cultural character of society in a way that enhances cultural diversity and is not hostile to difference is the kind of liberalism that should be endorsed. From Taylor’s point of view, this non-procedural liberalism is not neutral between different ways of life and it is grounded in judgments of what the good life is. According to Taylor, this liberalism takes into account differences between individuals and groups and by taking these into account it creates an environment that is not hostile to the flourishing of different cultures. Engaging in policies that promote culture is, in Taylor’s view, extremely important; cultural communities deserve protection owing to the fact that they provide members with the basis of their identities. The language of cultures provides the framework for the question of who one is. Taylor believes that identity is strongly influenced by culture; therefore, there is a moral and social framework given by the language of one’s culture that individuals need in order to make sense of their lives. Therefore, recognition and protection of individuals’ cultural communities is required for respecting and preserving one’s identity. However, in Taylor’s view, this commitment to promoting difference is acceptable only if the measures taken to promote difference are constant with what he considers to be fundamental rights. Taylor specifically mentions the rights to life, liberty, due process, free speech and free practice of religion.

From Taylor’s point of view, this non-procedural liberalism has implications for public policy. It means that there should be decentralized power so that communities can flourish. However, what this decentralization and non-procedural liberalism imply in practice depends on the context; in different countries with different kinds of minorities there may be different implications. Taylor mostly writes about the Canadian context and he believes that in this context the best policy is a form of federalism. In his view, Quebec should be given self-government rights so that it has power over a certain number of policies. In particular, Taylor affirms that it should have sovereign power over art, technology, economy, labor, communications, agriculture, and fisheries. In the case of language policies, Taylor contends that in some cases it is justified to violate liberal values, like freedom of expression, in order to protect the language of a community. For instance, in the case of Quebec, communications in English can be restricted by the state in order to promote the French language. Another example is that offspring of French parents do not have the option of choosing a language of instruction that is not French. Moreover, it should have shared power with the majority in immigration, industrial policy and environmental policy. Control over defense, external affairs and currency is given to the federal government. It is important to emphasize that, in Taylor’s view, federalism is not a necessary implication of non-procedural liberalism. Federalism is not at the core of the recognition idea; rather, federalism is a kind of system that Taylor considers is the adequate option in the Canadian context, which does not mean it is a good option in all contexts.

2. Kymlicka’s Multicultural Liberalism

Kymlicka believes that group rights are compatible and promote the liberal values of freedom and equality. As a result, Kymlicka offers arguments that relate freedom and equality with group rights. The argument based on freedom is strongly related to his idea of societal culture. In Kymlicka’s perspective (1995, p. 80), societal cultures promote freedom. From Kymlicka’s point of view, the reason why societal cultures are important for freedom is because they give individuals the groundwork from which they can make choices. In particular, according to Kymlicka, because societal cultures provide a framework with meaningful ways of life, then they provide the social conditions that are necessary for individuals to make autonomous choices. Autonomy, in turn, is only possible if and only if these social conditions are the ones of individuals’ societal cultures.

Taking this on board, Kymlicka’s argument is that societal cultures ought to be protected because they promote the liberal value of autonomy; they promote this value because societal cultures give, in Kymlicka’s perspective, a context of choice that is necessary for individuals to exercise their freedom. Put differently, from Kymlicka’s point of view, individuals’ own cultures provide the groundwork that individuals need in order to make free choices. Consequently, if liberals are committed to this value, they are committed to protecting the conditions (societal cultures) to achieve it. This means that if group rights are necessary for protecting this context of choice, then they are justified from a liberal point of view; for if group rights can protect the context of choice, then they are promoting autonomy. As mentioned above, from the three sources of diversity only national minorities have societal cultures. Hence, this argument only justifies group rights for national minorities in order to protect their societal cultures. In Kymlicka’s view, the context of choice is given by the access to one’s own culture, not just to any culture. So according to this view, for someone from Quebec, the societal culture of Catalonia does not provide a context of choice; likewise, for someone from an Amish community, the societal culture of Sikhs in India does not provide this Amish individual with a context of choice.

The three arguments based on equality that Kymlicka offers for defending group rights rely on a different line of reasoning. The first argument starts by observing that there is an inevitable involvement in the cultural character of society by the state and it is impossible to be completely neutral. Kymlicka affirms that the decisions made by governments, like what public holidays to have, unavoidably promote a certain cultural identity. Consequently, those individuals who do not share the culture promoted by the state are disadvantaged. In other words, they are in an unequal position. More precisely, by observing the unequal treatment that results from the inevitable involvement in the cultural character of society by the state, Kymlicka contends that uniform laws giving the same rights to all individuals from different cultures treat individuals unequally. To take the example of public holidays, the establishment of Christian public holidays disadvantages Muslims because their main festival, Eid-al-Fitr, occurs at a time of the year when there are no public holidays. Bearing this in mind, Kymlicka argues that if liberals are committed to equality, then they should endorse a kind of public policy that does not advantage some individuals over others; this, in turn, means that in order to equalize the status of different groups, the state ought to entitle different groups to different rights.

In Kymlicka’s view, group rights can correct these inequalities by providing the necessary and sufficient means by which individuals can pursue their culture. Although the argument for autonomy only applies to national minorities, this argument based on equality refers to national minorities and polyethnic groups. Inequalities between majorities and national minorities can take many shapes, but an example that Kymlicka likes to use is language rights inequalities. From his point of view, national linguistic minorities like those of Quebec and Catalonia would be treated unequally if they did not have the right to have their own institutions in their national language. The debate about Christian and Muslim holidays is an example of inequalities between majorities and polyethnic groups. Taking this on board, it is Kymlicka’s (1995) conviction that the two kinds of diversity can potentially be treated unequally by a set of uniform laws. As a result, any of these three kinds of diversity are entitled to group rights on grounds of promoting equality between groups within a liberal state.

Kymlicka’s second argument based on equality is that if it is the case that all individuals in society should have it, then the state is committed to promote a variety of cultures so that individuals have more options relating to choice. This argument, however, is not directed at minorities but rather at majorities, and it does not refer to a need of the minority; instead, it refers to how culture can make individuals’ lives better in general, by providing more options. Furthermore, Kymlicka (1995, p. 121) considers that because it is difficult to change one’s culture, this would not be a very attractive choice for everyone.

The third argument is that, according to Kymlicka, liberals should respect historical agreements. In Kymlicka’s view, many of the rights that minority cultures have in the early 21^st century are the result of historical agreements. If the state is to treat individuals from different cultures with equal respect, then it should respect these agreements.

3. Shachar’s Transformative Accommodation

Shachar is another philosopher who has defended a kind of multicultural citizenship. Shachar endorses a joint governance model that she calls transformative accommodation. According to Shachar, this model relies on four assumptions. First, individuals have a multiplicity of identities. For example, Malcolm X was a Muslim, a male, an African-American, and a heterosexual. Hence, individuals have a multiplicity of affiliations that play a role in their identities. The second assumption is that both the group and the state have normative and legal reasons to shape behavior. There may be a variety of reasons for this, but at least one of them is that individuals have a strong interest both in preserving their cultures and protecting their individual rights. Third, both what the state and the group do impact on each other. For instance, the laws that the state makes about same-sex marriage has an impact on heterosexist minority groups; the heterosexism of minority groups, like the hate speech of the Westboro Baptist Church, also impacts on the state. Fourth, both the state and the group have an interest in supporting their members (Shachar, 2001a, p. 118).

On top of these four assumptions, transformative accommodation is based on three core principles; sub-matter allocation of authority, no monopoly, and the clear establishment of delineated options (Shachar, 2001a, pp. 118-119). According to the sub-matters allocation of authority principle, the holistic view that contested social arenas (family law, criminal law, employment law and so forth) are indivisible is incorrect. According to this principle, these social arenas can be divisible into sub-matters, that is, into multiple separable components that are complementary (Shachar, 2001a, pp. 51-54). In practice, this means that norms and decisions about disputed social matters can be determined separately. In other words, in each area of law, there are sub-areas and these sub-areas are partially independent; as a result, a decision made in a sub-area can be made independently of a decision made in another sub-area. In Shachar’s view, family law, for example, can be divided into demarcating and distributive sub-matters or sub-areas. In her (2001a, pp. 119-120) view, the demarcating sub-matter of family law is where group membership boundaries are defined. That is, it is in this sub-matter that the necessary and sufficient attributes (biological, ethnical, territorial, ideological and so forth) for membership are decided. The distributive sub-matter refers to the distribution of resources. For instance, it would be in the demarcating sub-matter where it would be decided who gets what after divorce.

To illustrate how this principle would work in practice, Shachar routinely uses a legal dispute that occurred with a Native-American tribe and one of their members. This is the case of Julia Martinez; Julia Martinez, was a member of the Santa Clara Pueblo tribe whose daughter’s membership of the group was rejected, a rejection leading to tragic consequences. In 1941, Julia Martinez, who was a daughter of members of the Santa Clara Pueblo tribe married a man from outside the group. With this man, she had a daughter, who was raised in the Pueblo reservation, subsequently participating in and learning the norms and practices of the tribe. However, according to this tribe’s law, only the offspring of male members are considered members; hence, although Julia Martinez’ daughter was raised on the reservation, she was not, in the eyes of the tribe leaders, a tribe member. When Julia Martinez’s daughter got ill, she had to go to the emergency section of the Indian Health Services. Nevertheless, she was refused emergency treatment on grounds of not being a member of the tribe; a refusal that later caused her death (Shachar, 2001a, pp. 18-20). According to the sub-matters principle, in the case of the Santa Clara Pueblo tribe, it would be the legislators in the demarcation sub-matter who would determine whether Julia Martinez’s daughter was a member of the tribe or not (Shachar, 2001a, pp. 52-54). Contrastingly, it would be in the distributive sub-matter would that her entitlement or not to use the Indian Health Services would be decided.

By establishing the second principle, the no monopoly rule, Shachar defends that jurisdictional powers should be divided between the state and the group. According to this principle, neither the state nor the group should hold absolute power over the contested social arenas. More precisely, the group should hold power over one sub-matter while the state should hold power over another. Consequently, legal decisions would result from an interdependent and cooperative relationship between the group and the state (Shachar, 2001a, pp. 120-122). In the case of family law, if there is a divorce dispute, the state could take control of distribution (for example, property division after divorce) and the group, demarcation (for example, who can request divorce and why) or vice-versa.

The third principle defended by Shachar is the definition of clearly delineated options. According to this principle, individuals should have clear options between choosing to abide by the state or the group jurisdiction. In particular, this means that individuals can either decide to abide by a jurisdiction or they can refuse to abide by it and exit that jurisdiction at predefined reversal points. These predefined reversal points are an agreement made between the state and the group, where it is decided when individuals can exit the group and in what circumstances.

ii. Negative Universalism

The other approach to the philosophical discussion about justice between groups can be called negative universalism (Festenstein, 2005). Two philosophers who endorse this approach are, according to Festenstein (2005), Barry and Kukathas. Despite the fact that the philosophies of Barry and Kukathas are different, as negative universalists, they have four features in common.

Firstly, both defend the neutrality of the state among different conceptions of the good. That is, individuals should be free to pursue their own conceptions of the good. Secondly, this impartiality does not have the same impact on all citizens’ lives, that is, some will be better-off than others. Nevertheless, this is not, according to these philosophers, a counter-argument against the liberal value of neutrality, because equality of impact is not a realistic goal. Thirdly, principles of liberal theory adopt ‘basic civil and political rights’ with differentiations that may be justified through fundamental basic rights such as freedom of thought and association. However, basic civil and political rights and justified deviations differ substantially when both are permitted simultaneously. Fourth, negative universalists are skeptical concerning the normative value of culture and about providing differentiated rights to individuals (Festenstein, 2005, pp. 91-92).

1. Barry’s Liberal Egalitarianism

Barry’s view is that liberal egalitarianism is the philosophical doctrine that offers the most coherent and just approach to protect these interests. In addition, from his viewpoint, liberal egalitarianism offers the normative groundwork for the challenges that illiberal and heterosexist cultural groups raise. His liberal egalitarian approach, in particular, has as core values neutrality, freedom and equality.

According to Barry, neutrality means that states are under the duty of not promoting or favoring some conceptions of the good over others. In general terms, this means that state policy should not promote the survival and flourishing of a conception of the good, a language, a religion and so forth. Rather, neutrality requires that states be committed to individual rights without any sort of collective goal, besides those that correspond to universal basic interests. When the state favors a specific conception of the good by assisting it, it is violating neutrality (Barry, 2001, pp. 28, 29, 122). In Barry’s version of liberal neutrality, conceptions of the good are a private extra-political matter, which refer to personal affairs (Barry, 1995, p. 118). Hence, non-secular states, like Iran or Saudi Arabia, violate neutrality in Barry’s sense because they promote a specific religion.

The other important value for Barry, freedom, means not having paternalistic restrictions on pursuing one’s own conception of the good. This implies that individuals should be provided with a considerable amount of independence to pursue their own conceptions of the good. According to Barry, all individuals should be given the means for this pursuit. In practice, this means that all individuals are entitled to freedoms that enable them to pursue their own conceptions of the good and lifestyles; in particular, Barry considers that freedom of association and conscience play a fundamental role in enabling individuals in this pursuit. Individuals may choose to live a lifestyle that liberals may disapprove of; however, Barry (2001, p. 161) considers that bad choices are something that individuals in a liberal society are entitled to make.

Barry’s third commitment, the one to equality, translates into two core ideas. First, treating people equally means to furnish individuals with an equal set of basic legal, political and civil rights. That is, equality requires endorsing a unitary conception of citizenship. Second, the commitment to equality entails that the state has the duty to promote equality of opportunity. For Barry, there is an equal opportunity when uniform rules generate the same set of choices to all individuals (Barry, 2005). This means that there is equality of opportunity if and only if, in a specific situation, different individuals have the capacity to make the choice that is needed to achieve their aims. For example, imagine that Sam and John want both to be medical doctors; imagine that Sam is from a working class family and John from an upper class family. Sam does not have the economic resources to study, but John has. In such a situation, assuming that the economic factor is the only relevant factor for equalizing choice, in order to achieve equality of opportunity, Sam should be given a similar amount of economic resources to John, so that he has the same capacity to make the choice of a career in medicine. Therefore, equality of opportunity requires that individuals be treated according to their needs. Barry also argues that equality of opportunity entails that the state is under the duty of equalizing choice sets, not equalizing the outcomes that result from the decisions people make in those choice sets.

Taking this normative groundwork on board, Barry offers six arguments against giving rights to cultural groups. Four of these are a result of his liberal theory; the other two are independent arguments not related to his theory.

The first argument against difference-sensitive policies for cultural groups presented by Barry is that this would be a violation of neutrality. For Barry, neutrality requires that there is no or little involvement in the cultural character of society; hence, if the state privileged a group either by promoting this group’s culture or by empowering the group with different rights from other groups, then the state would be violating neutrality. Barry believes that liberals are committed to non-interference in the cultural character of society; as a result, liberalism is incompatible with difference-sensitive policies. In practice, what this implies for multicultural demands is that any kind of exemption, recognition, assistance or any other kind of group right should be denied on the grounds of neutrality. For example, in Barry’s view, if a certain state does not criminalize homosexuality and the governing body of a minority religious group asks recognition of its religious courts that convict its gay members for same-sex acts, the state should not concede this recognition because doing so would be giving a different right to a different group and, therefore, it would be a violation of neutrality.

The second argument provided by Barry against group rights is that the unequal impact of policies on cultures is not an interference with freedom to pursue one’s own conception of the good. In Barry’s view, laws have the aim of protecting some interests against others; the fact that they have a different impact on a specific culture is not a sign of unfairness; rather, it is just a side effect of having laws (Barry, 2001, p. 34).

Third, in Barry’s view, the only group rights conceded, especially those exemptions to the law, are cultural practices that overlap with universal human interests. In other words, if the group right and, in particular the exemption to the law, promotes a universal human interest, then it is acceptable (Barry, 2001, pp. 48-50). For instance, Muslim girls cannot be refused education on the grounds of a minor issue such as dress codes, because education is a universal human interest.

Fourth, Barry contends that because neither culture nor cultural demands are a universal interest per se, then the unequal treatment that is acceptable for universal interests does not apply to these (Barry, 2001, pp. 12-13, 16). To recall, Barry’s conception of equality of opportunity entails that individuals can be treated unequally so that their choice sets are equalized. However, Barry affirms that these choice sets should be equalized only if these are choice sets about universal interests, which culture is not. In short, exemptions can and should be guaranteed for universal or higher-order interests but not for particular interests.

These four arguments are dependent on Barry’s liberal theory; they depend on his conception of freedom, neutrality and equality. To these arguments, he adds two ad hoc arguments. First, that difference-sensitive rights that aim to protect economic resources are temporary, while cultural rights are permanent. This means that those who need economic resources to equalize their choice sets only need this aid temporarily (Barry, 2001, pp. 12-13). Contrastingly, according to Barry, group rights to protect culture are required permanently. Like the case of the Sikh, a permanent law that exempted Sikhs from wearing helmets would be necessary. The other ad hoc argument is that when there is a reasonable argument it should be applied without exception. If there is a case for exception, then the rule should be abandoned. According to him, it is philosophically incoherent to provide a universal justification for a rule and then relativize the reason just given (Barry, 2001, pp. 32-50).

2. Kukathas’ Libertarianism

Kukathas’ approach to multiculturalism is, broadly speaking, based on two ideas: these ideas are what he considers to be human beings’ most fundamental interest and his theory of freedom of association. Kukathas considers that human beings have only one fundamental interest: the interest in living according to their conscience. In his opinion, the reason for this is, in part, that human beings are primarily moral beings and, consequently, are disposed to direct their lives/purposes towards what they consider to be morally worthwhile. Consequently, from Kukathas’ point of view, individuals find it difficult to act against their conscience. This tendency to govern one’s own conduct primarily by conscience and the difficulty to act against one’s moral beliefs can, in Kukathas’ (2003b, p. 53) view, be observed and has empirical support. An additional reason why acting according to one’s own conscience is a fundamental interest is because, according to Kukathas, the meaning of life is given by conscience (Kukathas, 2003b, p. 55). Hence, Kukathas considers that identity is connected with morality because what individuals are is their self-interpretation, which ultimately is provided by moral evaluation. It is important to notice that this says nothing about what each person’s morality is. A human rights activist and a terrorist can be both acting according to their conscience even if they are doing opposite things. Owing to the fact that conscience is a fundamental interest, Kukathas contends that the state is under the duty to protect this interest.

The second important aspect of Kukathas’ philosophy is his defense of freedom of association. According to Kukathas, freedom of association is primarily defined as the right to exit groups, that is, freedom of association exists when individuals have the freedom to leave or dissociate from a group they are part of. In other words, essential to this version of freedom of association is the idea that individuals should not be forced to remain members of communities they do not wish to associate with. Therefore, according to this definition, freedom of association is not about the freedom of entering a specific group; rather, it is about the freedom to leave those groups that individuals want to dissociate from (Kukathas, 2003b, p. 95).

According to Kukathas, there are two necessary and jointly sufficient conditions for individuals to have the freedom to exit. These conditions are that individuals are not physically barred from leaving, and that there is a place similar to a market society where they can exit. From Kukathas’ point of view, a place to go is a necessary requirement for exit because it would not be credible to think that individuals had a right to exit if all communities were organized on a basis of kinship, for the options available would be either conformity to the rules or loneliness.

According to this theory of freedom, the functions of the state are quite limited. In Kukathas’ style of freedom of association, the state is not duty bound to secure individuals’ access to healthcare, education, and so forth. These forms of welfare should be provided by associations, if those associations wish to provide them. According to Kukathas’ theory, the state should only intervene to guarantee the right to exit, preserving the ongoing order of society by guaranteeing the safety and security of its citizens and preventing civil war. In practice, this means that the state has two functions. First, the state has to guarantee that there is no violation of freedom of association, that is, that individuals within associations are not being forced to remain members by being physically barred from leaving. Second, it means that the state should regulate so that there is no aggression between associations. So, even though associations can endorse practices that are extremely aggressive towards their members, it is a requirement for Kukathas that there is mutual toleration between associations. Societies cannot commit acts of aggression towards each other and, if they do, the state can, in his view, legitimately intervene to stop this aggression.

Bearing in mind the functions of the state and the internal structure of associations, this society would be a society of societies. Each society or group would have its own legislation, that is, they would have jurisdictional independence (Kukathas, 2003b, p. 97). In Kukathas’ view, the validity of the laws of communities only have local recognition, that is, the state would not recognize same-sex marriage and so forth; rather the state would be indifferent to the way individuals associate.

From Kukathas’ point of view, this version of freedom of association is compatible with the imposition of high costs of exit/dissociation and membership due to the fact that the magnitude of costs in a choice are not related to freedom (Kukathas, 2003b, pp. 107-109). In his view, this model of freedom of association is the best way to protect individuals’ freedom of conscience because it gives few restrictions to what individuals can do and consequently allows a wide variety of practices. For instance, an ethnic community where the members, generally speaking, believe that female genital mutilation is an important practice and that it is immoral not to engage in this practice, would be, in Kukathas’ view, better off if they had the possibility to form their own association where the practice would be accepted, then if they were part of a larger community with regulations against such practice.

3. The Second Wave of Writings on Multiculturalism

Taking this on board, in this first wave of writings on multiculturalism, the debate has centered on discussing the justice of difference-sensitive policies in the liberal context. On the whole, there are two difference positions taken by contemporary liberal political philosophers who have written on multiculturalism; some defend that difference-sensitive policies are justified, whereas others argue that they are a deviation from the core values of liberalism.

More recently, a second wave of writings on multiculturalism has appeared. In this, contemporary liberal political philosophers have not focused so much on debates about justice between different groups; rather, they have focused on justice within groups. Thus, the debate has changed to the analysis of the potentially perverse effects of policies to protect minority cultural groups with regard to the members of these minority cultural groups. Contemporary liberal political philosophers have now switched to discussing the practical implications that those that aimed at correcting inter-group equality could have for the members of those groups that the policies are directed to. In particular, the worry is that the policies for enabling members of minority groups to pursue their culture could favor some members of minority groups over others. That is, this new debate is about the risks that those policies for protecting cultural groups could have in undermining the status of the weaker members of these groups. The reason why philosophers worry about this is because the policies for multiculturalism may give the leaders of cultural groups’ power for making decisions and institutionalizing practices that facilitate the persecution of internal minorities. In other words, those policies may give group leaders all kinds of power that reinforce or facilitate cruelty and discrimination within the group (Phillips, 2007a, pp. 13-14; Reich, 2005, pp. 209-210; Shachar, 2001a, pp. 3, 4, 15-16).

Three kinds of internal minorities have received special attention from contemporary political philosophers: these are bisexuals, gays and lesbians, women and children.

a. Gays, Lesbians and Bisexuals

Some philosophers are concerned about how policies meant to protect minority cultural groups can potentially impose serious threats and harm the interests and rights of lesbian, gay and bisexual individuals. In some minority cultural groups, lesbian, gay and bisexuals within minorities are very disadvantaged by the unintended consequences of multicultural politics (Levy, 2005; Swaine, 2005, pp. 44-45). Heterosexism is a cross-cutting issue in minority cultural groups (and society in general), covering diverse areas of life, ranging from basic freedoms and rights, employment, education, family life, economic and welfare rights, sexual freedom, physical and psychological integrity, safety, and so forth. In general terms, it can be affirmed that lesbian, gay and bisexual individuals have an interest in bodily and psychological integrity, sexual freedom, participation in cultural and political life, family life, basic civil and political rights, economic and employment equality and access to welfare provision.

Sometimes, lesbian, gay and bisexual individuals have their freedom of association, opinion, expression, assembly, and thought limited (European Union Agency for Fundamental Rights, 2009, pp. 50-55). Minority cultural groups can jeopardize these interests due to hierarchies of power within groups. Some groups use a variety of norms of social control. Also in some groups, participation in political decisions and freedom of expression is culturally determined.

In some minority cultural groups, lesbian, gay and bisexual individuals’ interest in being free from murder, torture, and other cruel, inhuman and degrading treatment is also sometimes violated (European Union Agency for Fundamental Rights, 2009, pp. 13-16). Many lesbian, gay and bisexual individuals are victims of physical and psychological harassment, murder, hate speech, hate crimes, brutal sexual conversion therapies, and corrective rape, among other kinds of physical and psychological violence.

Some minority cultural groups also sometimes undermine lesbian, gay and bisexual individuals’ interests in economic and welfare rights. In the case of employment, this refers to anti-discrimination law in the workplace and in admission for jobs. In some cases, lesbian, gay and bisexual individuals’ freedom and the right to join the armed forces, to work with children, to employment benefits and health insurance for same-sex families are denied. Although not many religious groups have armed forces, this example could apply to the Swiss Army that protects the Vatican.

Bearing this in mind, some contemporary political philosophers have discussed to what extent giving special rights to groups can potentially facilitate the imposition of such unequal and cruel practices.

b. Women

Some philosophers, especially liberal feminist philosophers, have raised concerns about the implications of providing special rights to groups for women. Okin has contended that most cultures in the world are patriarchal and gendered and, consequently, providing rights to groups may help with reinforcing oppressive gendered and patriarchal practices. Some of the practices that may jeopardize women’s rights are female genital mutilation, polygamy, the use of headscarves, and a lesser valuation of the career and education of women.

Female genital mutilation, a practice that some communities engage in, is considered by some feminists to be a cruel practice that undermines the sexual health of women and aims at controlling their bodies. Polygamy is a practice that some communities follow, with some feminists contending that this practice is deeply disrespectful to women, and a clear way of treating women unequally. The use of headscarves is considered by some feminists to be a way of controlling women’s bodies and showing submission to males. Taking this on board, the concern expressed by some feminists is that empowering groups with special rights may reinforce female oppression. For example, if some communities are exempt from the health practices of the majority of society, this may help them to perpetuate and spread the practice of female genital mutilation.

Nevertheless, it is important to emphasize that the view that cultures are necessarily patriarchal, gendered and oppressive for women is not a unanimous position among feminists. Indeed, Volpp (2001) and Phillips (2007a), for instance, have defended the position that many feminists take an ethnocentric point of view when analyzing minority practices and misunderstand the true meaning of practices. Furthermore, Volpp and Phillips contend that many women in minority cultures are agents capable of making their own choices; therefore some of those practices that can be considered oppressive from a Western point of view should not be banned.

c. Children

The implications of special rights to children who are members of minority cultures is also a topic that has received some attention from contemporary political philosophers (Reich, 2005). The concerns with respect to children are especially with regards to physical and psychological abuse and lack of education. With respect to physical and psychological abuse, some groups may have practices that are harmful for children. For example, some groups practice shunning, a practice that consists of ostracizing those who do not follow their norms or who have done something that is disapproved of by the community. The traditional scarification of children that some African communities practice is also a practice that may be considered to entail physical abuse. With respect to education, there are groups who wish to take their children out of school at an earlier age. Some may argue that removing children from school earlier than their peers may strongly disadvantage these children because they will potentially not acquire the minimum skills necessary to find a job, and will not receive enough education to make autonomous choices. Other groups consider that education should be mainly about the study of the religious scripture, and they sometimes disregard other kinds of education.

Owing to the fact that schools are a central vehicle of autonomy and cultural transmission and because children are at a formative age and, thereby, much more likely to be influenced by the way they are brought up, some political philosophers have shown concern about the impact of giving special rights to groups that may treat children inappropriately, indoctrinate them, and maybe disadvantage them when compared with children who are not members of those groups.

It is important to emphasize, however, that this is not to say that providing special rights to minority groups entails that children, women and gays, lesbians and bisexuals will be disadvantaged. Many postcolonial philosophers, like Mookherjee (2005), have contended that even though there may be worries about internal oppression, sometimes these worries are misplaced. Routinely, members of minority cultures see value in their cultural practices and wish to endorse them, despite the fact that these practices may look oppressive for outsiders. Furthermore, sometimes practices may seem illiberal to an outsider, but because their social meaning differs from the one given by the outsider, the practice is not illiberal (Horton, 2003).

4. Animals and Multiculturalism

Another topic that has not been explored very much is how multicultural policies can have perverse effects on non-human sentient animals. If a thin conception of non-human sentient animals’ interests is endorsed, it can be understood how animals’ interests may be violated by multicultural policies. Assume that animals have three kinds of interests. First, they have the interest in not having gross suffering inflicted upon them (Casal, 2003; Cochrane, 2007). Second, non-human sentient animals have an interest in some degree of negative freedom: they have an interest in not being physically restricted in cages or forced to undertake hard labor. Third, non-human sentient animals have an interest in having access to resources for their well-being; in particular, non-human sentient animals have an interest in receiving veterinary care and in not being malnourished or denied food. With this modest assumption that animals have an interest in not being treated with cruelty and instead wish to pursue a healthy life, some philosophers have contended that animals’ interests are at risk when giving special rights to groups. There are cultural groups which have practices that interfere with the interests of non-human sentient animals and in terms of multiculturalism these policies may give cultural groups powers that may facilitate animal cruelty. Some cultural groups engage in particular animal slaughtering practices because their religion imposes that meat is cut in a specific way before it is eaten. An example of how multicultural policies can be damaging for non-human sentient animals is if the exemption of minority groups from state laws on animal cruelty could lead to the facilitation of inflicting these harmful practices on animals. In particular, if those groups who practice certain types of animal slaughtering are exempt from animal cruelty laws, then this may facilitate the violation of animals’ interests in not having gross suffering inflicted upon them.

This topic raises also a problem of legitimacy. Most majority societies fail to treat animals with respect and do not usually protect the interests of non-human sentient animals. As a result, a philosophical question that may arise is whether intervention in the practices of minorities mistreat non-human sentient animals would be legitimate, given the fact that majorities themselves fail to treat animals with respect. The topic of the treatment of animals within minorities has been more recently debated with respect to racism. Sometimes policies for the protection of animals’ welfare and rights are motivated or perpetuate racial hierarchies. Arguably, there is a double standard when deciding which animal practices ought to be allowed which, routinely, privileges white majority practices.

5. References and Further Reading

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Barry, B. (2002). Second thoughts–and some first thoughts revived. In P. Kelly, (Ed). Multiculturalism reconsidered: culture and equality and its critics. Cambridge: Polity Press, pp. 204-238.
Barry, B. (2005). Why social justice matters. Cambridge: Polity Press.
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Cochrane, A. (2007). Animal rights and animal experiments. An interest-based approach. Res publica, 13 (3), 293 – 318
Cochrane, A. (2010). An introduction to animals and political theory. Hampshire: Palgarve Macmillan
European Union Agency for Fundamental Rights (2009). Homophobia and discrimination on grounds of sexual orientation and gender identity in the EU member states: part ii – the social situation.
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Fraser, N. (2001). Recognition without ethics? Theory, culture & society, 18(2-3), 21-42.
Gurr, T.R. (1993). Minorities at risk: a global view of ethnopolitical conflicts. Michigan: United States Institute of Peace Press.
Han, E. (2013). Contestation and adaptation: The politics of national identity in China. New York: Oxford University Press.
He, B. (2006). Minority rights with Chinese characteristics. In He, B. and Kymlicka, W. (Ed). Multiculturalism in Asia. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Horton, J. (2003). Liberalism and multiculturalism: once more unto the breach. In B. Haddock, and P. Sutch, (Eds). Multiculturalism, identity, and rights. Routledge innovations in political theory. London and New York: Routledge, pp. 25-41.
Kukathas, C. (2001). Can a liberal society tolerate illiberal elements? Policy, 17(2), 39-44.
Kukathas, C. (2002a). Equality and diversity. Politics, Philosophy & Economics, 1(2), 185-212.
Kukathas, C. (2002b). The life of Brian, or now something completely difference-blind. In P. Kelly, (Ed). Multiculturalism reconsidered: culture and equality and its critics. Cambridge: Polity Press, pp. 184-203.
Kukathas, C. (2003a). Responsibility for past injustice: how to shift the burden. Politics, Philosophy & Economics, 2(2), 165-190.
Kukathas, C. (2003b). The liberal archipelago: a theory of diversity and freedom. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Kymlicka, W. (1995). Multicultural citizenship: a liberal theory of minority rights. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
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Author Information

Luís Cordeiro Rodrigues
Email: lccmr1984@gmail.com
University of York
United Kingdom

Xenophon (430—354 B.C.E.)

Xenophon was a Greek philosopher, soldier, historian, memoirist, and the author of numerous practical treatises on subjects ranging from horsemanship to taxation. While best known in the contemporary philosophical world as the author of a series of sketches of Socrates in conversation, known by their Latin title Memorabilia, Xenophon also wrote a Symposium and an Apology which present a set of vivid and intriguing portraits of Socrates and display some sharp contrasts to the better known portraits in the works of Xenophon’s contemporary, Plato. Xenophon’s influence in Antiquity, the Middle Ages, and in Early Modern intellectual circles was considerable; he was a pioneer in several literary genres including the first-person military memoir (Anabasis), the biographical novel (Education of Cyrus), and the continued history (Hellenica). The range of his areas of expertise and the glancing charm of his down-to-earth writing style continue to fascinate and repay our study. For one example of his work in moral philosophy, he emphasized the importance of self-control, which comprises one of the cardinal virtues of Greek popular morality. This is highlighted by Xenophon in many ways. Socrates is often said by Xenophon to have exemplified it in the very highest degree. Cyrus displays it when he is invited to look upon the most beautiful woman in Asia, who happens to be his prisoner of war. He firmly declines this temptation; but his general Araspas stares at her endlessly, falls in lust, insults her honor, and ignites a chain of events described by Xenophon that ends in her suicide over her husband’s corpse.

Life and Times
Xenophon’s Socrates
Political Philosophy
Moral Philosophy
Practical Treatises
References and Further Reading

1. Life and Times

Xenophon was born during the early years of the Peloponnesian War, in the outlying deme (suburb) of Athens called Erchia. Located in the fertile plain known as “Mesogeia” (literally “middle earth”) and overlooked by the beautiful mountains Hymettus and Penteli, Erchia was about 20 kilometers (12 miles) from the bustling center of Athens–about a three hour walk or one hour brisk horseback ride. His father Gryllus owned and supervised an estate whose income derived chiefly from farming. Thus, Xenophon grew up surrounded by a combination of small hold-farming and urban influences. Coming of an age in turbulent political times, Xenophon is thought to have been in Athens and personally present at the return of Alcibiades (408), the trial of the Generals, and the overthrow of the 30 Tyrants, all signal events in the rough history of Athenian civic life.

Little else is known about Xenophon’s earliest years. From his later writings it can be safely inferred that he received a good basic education and military training as befitted a young member of the Equestrian class, that he was able to ride and hunt extensively, and that in his formative years he observed the careful work needed to keep a modest farm maintained and productive.

In 401. B.C.E at the age of 29, Xenophon was invited by his friend Proxenus to join him on a mercenary military venture to Persia, ostensibly to protect the territory of a minor satrap who was under threat. In fact, though this was not known to Xenophon or Proxenus, the campaign was rather more ambitious than that: it was a game of thrones, nothing less than an assault on the claim of the Persian king Artaxerxes II, by his brother Cyrus the Younger. The unfolding of this journey into foreign territory, with its adventures and mortal hazards, was a formative event in Xenophon’s life. In the very first engagement, Cyrus was himself killed. In a peace parley that followed, the generals of the expeditionary force were executed by treachery, leaving the army stranded, leaderless and surrounded by hostile peoples whose languages they did not speak, and winter was coming. Xenophon eventually assumed leadership of this stranded and confused army, and led the survivors to safety. The book which Xenophon later wrote about their harrowing travels ‘up country’, Anabasis, is a hair-raising and brutally graphic soldier’s journal, of which more is said below.

Upon his return to Greece, Xenophon continued his mercenary work under a Spartan general named Agesilaus. He even went fighting, with Agesilaus’ “10,000” soldiers who returned from the battle of Coroneia in Persia, against a combined Athenian and Theban force. Athens issued a decree of exile against Xenophon as a result. . Even though it is possible that his banishment was revoked in later years, Xenophon never returned to Athens.

In gratitude for his service in this decisive Lacedaimonian victory, the Spartans gave Xenophon an estate in Elis, about 2 miles from Olympia—a region of the Peloponnese which was known for its unparalleled beauty and richness. Here in Elis over the next 23 years, Xenophon would live a life of semi-retirement and quiet rural pursuits. Here also he would write the bulk of his works, raise a family, and keep a distanced and reflective historical eye on the political fortunes of Athens. Nothing is known of his wife beyond her name: Philesia. He had two sons, Gryllus and Diodorus. The Former was killed in the battle of Mantinea in 362 B.C., and Xenophon received many carefully written eulogies, a testament to his prominence in his own time.

When his adoptive city of Sparta was defeated in the Battle of Leuctra in 371 B.C., Elians drove Xenophon from his rural retreat and confiscated it. Xenophon then moved to “flowery Corinth” where he ended his days.

2. Xenophon’s Socrates

Xenophon’s portrait of Socrates in four loosely topic-organized books is known as Memorabilia. Any reader who comes across of this work after even a minimal exposure to the better-known Socrates of Plato’s dialogues is in for a shock. One rare reader who encountered Xenophon’s Socrates first was John Stuart Mill, who refers to it in the context of a description of Mill’s own father:

My father’s moral convictions, wholly dissevered from religion, were very much of the character of those of the Greek philosophers; and were delivered with the force and decision which characterized all that came from him. Even at the very early age at which I read with him the Memorabilia of Xenophon, I imbibed from that work and from his comments a deep respect for the character of Socrates; who stood in my mind as a model of ideal excellence: and I well remember how my father at that time impressed upon me the lesson of the “Choice of Hercules.” At a somewhat later period the lofty moral standard exhibited in the writings of Plato operated upon me with great force. (Autobiography, ch.2.)

Xenophon’s Socrates is shown in conversation with various people from a wide variety of walks of life and with quite starkly different moral characters; one of his conversation partners is a famous prostitute, another is an aspiring young politician who knows little about life, another is a son of Pericles, and yet another is a grump; the colorful list goes on. The individual books of the “Memorabilia” each contain many different conversational vignettes and set pieces, yet they consistently show a Socrates who is above all committed to helping people improve their lives in all practical dimensions; “Socrates was so useful in all circumstances and in all ways…” Memorabilia IV.i.1). In contrast to Plato’s Socrates, who is committed to “follow the argument wherever, like a wind, it may lead us” (Plato, Republic 394D), Xenophon’s Socrates strives always to send his conversation partners away with some nuggets of practical advice which they may put to use right away.

A brief and selective thematic summary of each book follows:

Memorabilia I: The book begins with a defense of Socrates against the legal charges which led to his execution, in a long initial section narrated by the author in his own voice. Socrates enjoined piety and respect for divination, which should be consulted before every momentous life-choice. He avoided speculation about the nature of the cosmos; “…(h)is own conversation was ever of human things. The problems he discussed were: what is godly; what is ungodly; what is just, what is unjust; what is prudence; what is madness; what is courage, what is cowardice; what is a state, what is a statesman; what is government, and what is a governor;—these, and others like them…” (Memorabilia.I.1.16). In a conversation with Aristodemus, Socrates presents an extended ‘argument from design’ to strengthen religious faith; the concept of God here manifested is strikingly monotheistic and is also woven throughout the natural world (Memorabilia I.iv.3-19). To the charge of corrupting the youth, Xenophon writes, “…in control of his own passions and appetites he was the strictest of men” (Memorabilia II.ii.1). (The theme of self-control, both in the sense of restraint of the appetites and in that of autonomy, is strong throughout the Memorabilia.) Socrates “led men up” to self-control, motivated by his love of humanity (Memorabilia I.v, I.2.60).

Memorabilia II: The theme of self-control is here pursued, and the famous set-piece called “Choice of Herakles” (Memorabilia II.i.21-33) is presented in a version ascribed to Prodicus. Here, while meditating in a quiet place, the young Herakles is approached by two women who represent the lives of Virtue and Vice respectively. Each lady tries to persuade Herakles to choose her way, with Vice offering a life of pleasures and self-indulgence, and Virtue offering the rigors of self-control which she argues will lead to true happiness. (Oddly, the anecdote ends before Herakles chooses.) There then follows a series of forays into the topic of human relationships as components of the good life; parents give selflessly to their children (a poignant passage describes the tireless work of mothers in particular in Memorabilia II.ii.5); friends are “more useful than any possession”, and are humorously described as being ‘hunted’ and ‘seduced by Siren song’ into one’s life, but the bottom line is that friendship is a good thing based on goodness (Memorabilia II.ii.x). The value of work as a component of the good life is underscored by a lengthy discussion between Socrates and Aristarchus (Memorabilia II.vii), who has 14 female relatives living under his roof. Socrates advises him to start a home textile business putting these ladies to work. They’ll be happier, and work makes for virtue. This scheme is represented as successful. (The importance of toil, work, even rough manual labor, to virtue is a continuing theme for Xenophon, and a topic on which his views run counter to the aristocratic mentality of his time.)

Memorabilia III: Here Socrates offers practical advice to several different individuals concerning military leadership and what it takes to become a successful general. The end goal, he maintains, is to make the soldiers better human beings. Thus the type of knowledge and expertise required is rather generally found in many different pursuits; even in business (for which one conversation partner has expressed contempt), the goal is the betterment of all individuals concerned; “Don’t look down on business”, Socrates warns (Memorabilia III.iv). (The idea that there are very general skills which lead to success in a huge variety of human endeavors is a strong theme in Xenophon’s works elsewhere as well.) Socrates says general knowledge about human nature and how to be a good leader should combine with the requisite practical knowledge about one’s chosen field, and in all fields moderation and self-control are crucially valuable traits. Eupraxia, being a good and good-oriented practitioner, is valuable in every field, whether one is a farmer, physician, or politician (Memorabilia III.ix). In a long set-piece, Socrates is shown visiting a beautiful and famous prostitute named Theodote, and conversing with her about friendship and how to treat one’s friends. This highly interesting passage, unique in ancient philosophy in presenting a conversation between a working woman (of dubious social standing even!) and a well-known male philosopher, is full of humor and double-entendre but ends with Socrates inviting Theodote to come philosophize with him and his ‘girlfriends’ any time (Memorabilia III.xi). Finally, Socrates is here something of a fitness guru, advising Epigenes to get out and get some exercise; “…(t)here is no kind of struggle, apart from war, and no undertaking in which you will be worse off by keeping your body in better fettle” (Memorabilia III.xii.5). (An emphasis on physical fitness achieved through vigorous exercise is a very significant theme throughout Xenophon’s works.)

Memorabilia IV: The importance of self-control to success in every field of endeavor is again underscored and argued for; talented youths and high-bred horses alike need careful training and structure in order to avoid running off the rails with maturity. The moral quality of sophrosyne, moderation, prudence, and good habits combined, is said to be most needful in our behavior toward the gods. For the gods are such benefactors to us that it is asked: How is it possible to be grateful enough? Socrates offers a translation of the Delphic oracle’s inscription, “Know thyself”, as follows: a person should “…consider what sort of a creature he is for human use and get to know his own powers” (Memorabilia IV.ii.25). Socrates is described as having the mission of making his companions more law-abiding, more efficacious in their chosen work, more prudent or moderate, and more self-controlled. Self-control is integral to that precious quality freedom, because no one is free who is ruled by bodily pleasure (Memorabilia IV.v). This book ends with a beautiful encomium to Socrates spoken in what seems to be Xenophon’s own most authentic voice (Memorabilia IV.viii.11):

All who knew what manner of man Socrates was and who seek after virtue continue to this day to miss him beyond all others, as the chief of helpers in the quest for virtue. For myself, I have described him as he was: so religious that he did nothing without counsel from the gods; so just that he did no injury, however small, to any man, but conferred the greatest benefits on all who dealt with him…To me then he seemed to be all that a truly good and happy man must be.

In addition to the Memorabilia, Xenophon also wrote a Symposium and an Apology.

Xenophon’s Symposium depicts an avowedly lighthearted group of friends attending a spontaneous dinner-party in honor of young Autolycus’ victory in an Olympic event. Entertainment is provided by young talent dancing, singing, and performing feats of agility, while the conversation turns on each guest explaining what he values most about himself: beauty, wealth, poverty, friends, and traits of character are all offered and discussed. Socrates presents his central attribute as the ability to be a “procurer” (essentially, a pimp); he explains that he is able to improve people and make them better, more useful, more valuable to the city, and is in this analogous to a successful pimp who is able to bring out the best in his stable of prostitutes. In a more serious vein, Socrates explains the superior value of spiritual love over physical love, and the centrality of virtue to genuine love. “(T)he greatest blessing that befalls the man who yearns to render his favorite a good friend is the necessity of himself making virtue his habitual practice” (Symposium viii.27). Weirdly, the evening ends with a demonstration of smooching between two of the young musicians which is so hot that everyone rushes off home to his wife (if he has one) or professes the intention to acquire a wife as soon as possible, if he is still single.

Xenophon’s Apology begins with Socrates explaining to his friend Hermogenes why he has not been working on his defense speech: he has been hindered by his divine sign, and moreover is quite ready to die. Socrates justifies his readiness by noting the evils of old age that he will avoid, and the blamelessness of his life. When at trial, he defends himself from the charge of impiety by noting his regular participation in all sacrifices and other public religious rituals. Against the charge of corrupting the youth, he notes that through the oracle at Delphi, “…Apollo answered that no man was more free than I, or more just, or more prudent” (Apology 14). After his condemnation to death, Socrates comforts his tearful friends with a Stoic-sounding thought: “Have you not known all along that, from the moment of my birth, nature had condemned me to death?” (Apology 27). Xenophon concludes in his own voice (Apology 34):

And so, in contemplating the man’s wisdom and nobility of character, I find it beyond my power to forget him or, in remembering him, to refrain from praising him. And, if among those who make virtue their aim any one has ever been brought into contact with a person more helpful than Socrates, I count that man worthy to be called most blessed.

3. Political Philosophy

Xenophon’s political philosophy is a matter of interpretation and some controversy. Did his relationship with Sparta incline him away from Athenian democratic values? Was his evident admiration for Persian kings indicative of an allegiance to absolute monarchy? The main works examined in an effort to reconstruct this aspect of his thought are The Education of Cyrus (also known as Cyropaedia;) a partial biography of a Persian king building an empire, the Anabasis (account of the ill-fated Greek mercenary expedition in Persia), Hiero (a conversation about tyranny), Agesilaus (biography of a Spartan general), the Constitution of the Lacedaimonians (description of the system of laws and social practices of Sparta), and Hellenica (history of Greece from 411 to 362 B.C.E., taking up where Thucydides ends). One thing is clear and beyond controversy: Xenophon has an abiding interest in describing leadership, the constellation of qualities that enables a person to function as a leader in groups, whether military, civic, or familial.

That Xenophon admires the Spartan system and the individuals it produces is evident from both the portrait of Agesilaus and the description of the Spartan political system developed by the legendary Lycurgus (Constitution of the Lacedaimonians). Agesilaus is a ferocious military tactician and fighter who waged campaigns in Persia and on Greek soil. Xenophon gives minute descriptions of the strategies Ageilaus used against the deceptive Persian general Tissaphernes, the successes of which resulted in the latter losing his head (literally). It is thought that Xenophon was among the soldiers serving under Agesilaus at the battle of Coronea, judging from the immediacy of descriptions like the following word picture of the aftermath of this particularly gruesome clash (Agesilaus II.14):

Now that the fighting was at an end, a weird spectacle met the eye, as one surveyed the scene of the conflict—the earth stained with blood, friend and foe lying dead side by side, shields smashed to pieces, spears snapped in two, daggers bared of their sheaths, some on the ground, some embedded in the bodies, some yet gripped by the hand.

What Xenophon admires most about Agesilaus though is the way his character shines through in his leadership (Agesliaus II. 8).

(H)e took care to render his men capable of meeting all calls on their endurance; he filled their hearts with confidence that they were able to withstand any and every enemy; he inspired them all with an eager determination to out-do one another in valour; and lastly he filled all with anticipation that many good things would befall them, if only they proved good men. For he believed that men so prepared fight with all their might; nor in point of fact did he deceive himself.

Here is a general who eats with the common soldiers, fights as hard as they do or harder, sleeps on the rudest bed in the battalion, and is tireless in care for their welfare. Here, too, we find Xenophon noting the Spartan’ general’s “love of toil” (he is philoponos, AgesilausIX.3), and the fact that he had fortified his soul “against all the assaults of lucre, of pleasure, and of fear” (Agesilaus VIII.8). Thanks to all of this and more, the Spartan remained a formidable and gnarly opponent into his eighties, and left behind him the best type of monument: the admiration of all who had known him or known of him.

The Constitution of the Lacedaimonians draws a mostly admiring portrait of the creation of distinctively Spartan social customs and military might, by a (probably mythical) genius social engineer named Lycurgus. Like the inscription over the ant-colony entrance in T. H. White’s The Sword in the Stone, (White 1938, ch.13) “EVERYTHING NOT FORBIDDEN IS COMPULSORY,” Spartan society is legislated down to the most personal details (where men are allowed to eat supper, how much female children get fed, whether an unused horse can be borrowed, and so forth) to produce an efficient warrior-making machine in which accumulations of wealth and private property were rendered impossible and the famous “equality’ which made Sparta so stable (in Xenophon’s apparent view at any rate) was forged. Spartan soldiers were required by law to practice gymnastics while out on campaign, “…and the result is that they take more pride in themselves and have a more dignified appearance than other men” (Constitution of the Lacedaimonians XII.5). Extreme measures are taken with young boys, to ensure that they will develop the proper level of discipline and collectivist thinking that will produce obedient and happily equal adult citizens: they are taken from their homes at age 7 and from thenceforth live in military-like barracks, subject to discipline by any adult male who might see them transgress in any way.

Should we infer that Xenophon endorses this radical social engineering program and its collectivist political philosophy, or only that he finds it a fascinating and impressive experiment which did in fact make Sparta the most feared military force in the Greek world of its time? Whichever interpretation we choose, it is clear at the end of the treatise that the experiment was not a lasting and unambiguous success; Xenophon writes that Spartan citizens have in fact gone over to the accumulation of individual wealth, have grown fond of wielding power over remote cities, and have lost that unanimity which was Lycurgus’ energetically-sought goal.

Did Xenophon provide an answer to the question about an Ideal Polis, a most desirable form of political organization? Some scholars have argued that we can look for glimmerings of this in the Anabasis, where the Greek army in its struggle to reach the sea can be viewed as a “polis on the move” (Waterfield 2006, p.147). As the shattered mercenary troops struggle to stay organized and to survive their pitiless march through the foodless deserts of Assyria and the freezing mountains of Armenia, various forms of political organization surface at various times. While an army is most naturally understood as an oligarchy, with orders coming from a few and being followed by the many, there are also moments of democracy: soldiers hold general assemblies and agree upon resolutions which they will represent to their commanding officers. Xenophon himself is elected by popular acclaim early in the march. As leader, he keeps his eye on the welfare of the troops: defusing anarchy, strategically seeking out food and safety, and making the tough decisions necessary for the good of all, such as abandoning the camp followers and horses in deep mountain snow when it became clear they were a mortal liability. During its course, Xenophon emphasizes the importance of piety and ritual which bind a polis together in homonoia or like-mindedness. At the climactic moment when the lead troops crest a rise and spot the sea, immediately after dancing for joy and famously shouting, “Thalatta! Thalatta!” (the sea, the sea), they build a cairn of stones to honor the gods.

The political philosophies which can be discerned in Xenophon’s largest and perhaps strangest work, The Education of Cyrus, are a matter of great controversy. Some paradoxical aspects of the work fuel the arguments about how it should be interpreted. Cyrus is undoubtedly a terrific leader and a daunting empire-builder, but he is seen to have some off-putting traits such as arrogance, a tendency to fear his own sensuality, and questionable judgment from time to time. Does this mean Xenophon is implicitly criticizing the Persian model of monarchy? Yet he takes pains, in this massive book, to show Cyrus’ uncanny ability to mobilize support and suppress resistance, and his dedication to both recognizing and rewarding nobility and virtue. Cyrus is repeatedly seen to emphasize that the best army consists of soldiers serving of their own free will, being rewarded for their merits, and feeling respect and gratitude to their leaders.

They came not from compulsion but from their own free will, and out of gratitude. (Cyropaedia IV.iii.11)

Perhaps we should conclude that Xenophon’s political theory is flexible, and that the most key element of any polis revolves around the leadership skills of those in charge, alongside their self-control and devotion to the good of the whole.

4. Moral Philosophy

As seen above in the discussion of Xenophon’s Socrates and of the ideal leader, certain themes recur in Xenophon’s moral reflections. Some of the most frequently recurring ideas are:

The importance of self-control: Sophrosyne, self-control, moderation, restraint of appetite, and balance, comprises one of the cardinal virtues of Greek popular morality, and it is highlighted by Xenophon in many ways. Socrates is often said to have exemplified it in the highest degree. Cyrus displays it when (Cyropaedia V.i-VII.iii) he is invited to look upon the most beautiful woman in Asia, who happens to be his prisoner of war. He firmly declines this temptation; his general Araspas by contrast stares at her endlessly, falls in lust, insults her honor and ignites a chain of events that ends in her suicide over her husband’s corpse.
A demanding work-ethic: Hard work makes for virtue in several ways. It conduces to health, it results in earned rewards, it keeps us off the streets of temptation, and builds character. In the Oeconomicus, a treatise on household management, Xenophon tells the story of a visit paid by a Greek ambassador to Cyrus the Persian king in his royal gardens. Cyrus astounds the Greek by stating that he himself laid out the garden plan and works in it regularly. Cyrus continues (Oeconomicus IV.24),” I never yet sat down to dinner when in sound health, without first working hard at some task of war or agriculture, or exerting myself somehow.”
The Greek replies, “I think you deserve your happiness, Cyrus, for you earn it by your virtue”.
An ideal of service: It is impossible to miss this emphasis in Xenophon’s remembrances of Socrates, “…so useful in all circumstances and in all ways” (Memorabilia IV.i.1). Socrates can frequently be seen offering practical help, life advice, and moral guidance to friends and total strangers. Indeed Xenophon’s Socrates resembles an uncompensated life-coach in marked ways. Do you have lots of ‘friends’ but suspect they just want something from you? Be more discerning and take better care of your real friends; then friendships will be on a more solid footing (advice to a prostitute; MemorabiliaII.xi). Do you over-react to other peoples’ rudeness? Adjust your attitude; it’s not always about you (MemorabiliaIII.xiii). Feuding with your brother? Study the natural world and observe that animals reared together feel a yearning for each other’s company; love between brothers is more natural than discord (Memorabilia II.iii.4).
A certain utilitarianism: The best actions are the most practically beneficial for all. In Xenophon there is nothing of the soul’s solitary winged journey toward fulfillment in transcendence. Goodness is good for the here and now, and good for the city, or the army, or the whole farm. Eupraxia, doing well and doing things beneficially, is of the highest value.
A certain egalitarianism: Although Xenophon was no feminist, he does present the idea that the wife who is a full partner in household management contributes as much to the welfare of the estate as does her husband (Oeconomicus III.15). Wives and husbands should be co-workers in the household (Oeconomicus III.x). And he gives to Socrates these memorable lines about how hard it is to be a mother of small children, a passage unique in classical literature (Memorabilia II.ii.5):

The woman conceives and bears her burden in travail, risking her life, and giving of her own food; and, with much labor, having endured to the end and brought forth her child, she rears and cares for it, although she has not received any good thing, and the babe neither recognizes its benefactress nor can make its wants known to her; still she guesses what is good for it, and what it likes, and seeks to supply these things, and rears it for a long season, enduring toil day and night, not knowing what return she will get.

He writes admiringly of the general who eats with his men and eats the same food, of the king who works in his garden, of Socrates chatting with a prostitute, and of the virtue of Panthea and her noble death (Cyropaedia VII.iii.14). He admires the Spartan ideal of equality and laments its erosion.

5. Practical Treatises

Xenophon’s collected works include several shorter dialogues and essays in which he (like his Socrates) provides useful and practically applicable advice on topics such as choosing and training a war-horse (On Horsemanship), being a cavalry commander (The Cavalry Commander), hunting (On Hunting), taxation (Ways and Means), and home economics (Oeconomicus). These treatises are not flatly how-to manuals but also are infused with a distinctive world-view and a definite value-scheme.

So, for example, in the treatise on horsemanship, Xenophon presents a definite equine psychology and a training ethic; the training should not be harsh, because “…nothing forced can ever be beautiful”. The horse:

must follow the indication of the aids to display of his own free will all the most beautiful and brilliant qualities (On Horsemanship XI.6).

Xenophon stresses commonalities between horses and humans. Old maxims apply equally to horses and to humans, as in the following text concerning the length of galloping sets: “In excess of the proper limit, nothing whatsoever is enjoyable, either to a horse or a man” (X.14). It is noticeable that Xenophon does not simply say that running a horse ragged is counterproductive in training. His point differs from this claim in two ways: he stresses again the commonality between horse and human; and he places the emphasis of the training advice upon what is pleasing (‘edu) to the horse. Thus the horse is conceived as a partner, rather than an object, in the training project, and a partner whose willing and appreciative participation in the project is essential to its success.

So, also, in the Oeconomicus, there is not simply practical instruction about running a successful small farm, but a general theme of praise for engagement, orderliness, and system that has sometimes a definite political ring, as in the following passage (Oeconomicus V.i):

For the pursuit of (farming) is in some sense a luxury as well as a means of increasing one’s estate and of training the body in all that a free man should be able to do.

Sometimes however it just sounds quaint; “What a beautiful sight is afforded by boots of all sorts arranged in rows!” (Oeconomicus VIII.19).

Thus, Xenophon’s philosophical projects were infused with a commitment to practical usefulness just as his practical treatises convey a philosophy that is still of interest today, with its emphasis on engagement in the world, on knowing who we are and how we can help. Recall Socrates’ translation of the Delphic oracle’s inscription, “Know thyself”: a person should “…consider what sort of a creature he is for human use and get to know his own powers” (Memorabilia IV.ii.25).

6. References and Further Reading

Anderson, J.K., 2001, Xenophon, Bristol, U.K.: Bristol Classical.
Brickhouse, T., 2002, The Trial and Execution of Socrates: Sources and Controversies, New York : Oxford University Press.
Bruell, C., “Xenophon”, in History of Political Philosophy, ed. L. Strauss and J. Cropsey, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1987, 89-117.
Buzzetti, E., 2001, “The Rhetoric of Xenophon and the Treatment of Justice in the Memorabilia”, in Interpretation 29.1: 3-35.
Cooper, J., 1999, “Notes on Xenophon’s Socrates”, in Cooper, J., Reason and Emotion: Essays on Ancient Moral Psychology and Ethical Theory, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press: 3-28.
Danzig, G. 2005, “Intra-Socratic Polemics: The Symposia of Plato and Xenophon”, in Greek, Roman, and Byzantine Studies 45: 331-357.
Dillery, John, 1995, Xenophon and the History of his Times, New York: Routledge.
Dorion, Louis-Andre, 2010, “The Straussian Exegesis of Xenophon: The Paradigmatic Case of Memorabilia IV 4”, in V. Gray. (ed.) Xenophon: Oxford Readings in Classical Studies, New York and Oxford: Oxford University Press, 283-323.
Fox, R.L. (ed.), 2004, The Long March: Xenophon and the Ten Thousand, New Haven: Yale University Press.
Gray, V., 1998, The Framing of Socrates: The Literary Interpretation of Xenophon’s Memorabilia, Stuttgart: Franz Steiner Verlag.
Gray, V. (ed.), 2010, Xenophon: Oxford Readings in Classical Studies, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Higgins, W. 1977, Xenophon the Athenian: the problem of the individual and the society of the polis, Albany: State University of New York Press.
Howland, J., 2000, “Xenophon’s Philosophical Odyssey: On the Anabasis and Plato’s Republic”, in American Political Science Review, 94.4: 875-889.
Johnson, D. , 2003, “Xenophon’s Socrates on Justice and the Law”, in Ancient Philosophy, 23: 255-281.
Judson, L. and Karasmanis, V. (edd.), 2006, Remembering Socrates, Oxford: Clarendon Press; New York : Oxford University Press
Nadon, C., 2001, Xenophon’s Prince: Republic and Empire in the Cyropaedia, Berkeley, CA: University of California Press.
O’Connor, David K., 1994, “The Erotic Self-Sufficiency of Socrates: A Reading of Xenophon’s Memorabilia”, in The Socratic Movement ed. P. A. Vander Waerdt; Ithaca NY: Cornell University Press, 150-180.
Pangle, T.L., 1994, “Socrates in the Context of Xenophon’s Political Writings”, in P. A. Van Der Waerdt (ed.) , The Socratic Movement, Ithaca and London: Cornell University Press, 2004: 127-150.
Pomeroy, S. 1994, Xenophon: Oeconomicus, A Social and Historical Commentary, Oxford: Clarendon.
Sandridge, Norman B., 2012, Loving Humanity, Learning, and Being Honored: The Foundations of Leadership in Xenophon’s Education of Cyrus, Washington D.C.: Center for Hellenic Studies.
Sandridge, Norman B., 2012: webmaster for an online commentary on Cyropaedia (an international and ongoing collaborative scholarly project) at www.cyropaedia.org
Seager, R., 2001, “Xenophon and Athenian Democratic Ideology”, in Classical Quarterly, 51.2: 385-397.
Strauss, L., 1948, On Tyranny, Glencoe, IL: The Free Press.
Tatum, J., 1989, Xenophon’s Imperial Fiction, Princeton NJ: Princeton University Press.
Tuplin, C. (ed.), 2004, Xenophon and his World, Stuttgart: Franz Steiner Verlag.
Van Der Waerdt, P. A. ed.1994, The Socratic Movement, Ithaca and London: Cornell University Press.
Vlastos, G, 1991, “The Evidence of Aristotle and Xenophon” In Vlastos, Socrates: Ironist and Moral Philosopher, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 81-106.
Waterfield, R. , 2006, Xenophon’s Retreat: Greece, Persia, and the End of the Golden Age, London: Faber and Faber.
Waterfield, R., 2004, “Xenophon’s Socratic Mission” in Chirstopher Tuplin (ed.) Xenophon and His World, Stuttgart: Franz Steiner Verlag, 79-113.

Author Information

Eve A. Browning
Email: ebrownin@d.umn.edu
University of Minnesota Duluth
U. S. A.

Alasdair Chalmers MacIntyre (1929— )

Alasdair MacIntyre is a Scottish born, British educated, moral and political philosopher who has worked in the United States since 1970. His work in ethics and politics reaches across disciplines, drawing on sociology and philosophy of the social sciences as well as Greek and Latin classical literature.

MacIntyre began his career as a Marxist, but in the late 1950s, he started working to develop a Marxist ethics that could rationally justify the moral condemnation of Stalinism. That project eventually led him to reject Marxism along with every other form of “modern liberal individualism” and to propose Aristotle’s ethics as a more effective way to renew moral agency and practical rationality through small-scale moral formation within communities.

MacIntyre’s best known book, After Virtue (1981), is the product of this long ethical project. After Virtue diagnoses contemporary society as a “culture of emotivism” in which moral language is used pragmatically to manipulate attitudes, choices, and decisions, so that contemporary moral culture is a theater of illusions in which objective moral rhetoric masks arbitrary choices. MacIntyre followed After Virtue with two books examining the role that traditions play in judgments about truth and falsity, Whose Justice? Which Rationality? (1988) and Three Rival Versions of Moral Enquiry (1990). MacIntyre’s next major work, Dependent Rational Animals: Why Human Beings Need the Virtues (1999), investigates the social needs and social debts of human agents, and the role that a community plays in the formation of an independent practical reasoner. The remainder of MacIntyre’s mature work extends and supplements the arguments of these four major works.

MacIntyre’s philosophy is important to the fields of virtue ethics and communitarian politics, but MacIntyre has denied belonging to either school of thought. MacIntyre has identified himself as a Thomist since 1984, but some Thomists question his Thomism because he emphasizes Thomas Aquinas’s treatment of human agency but rejects the neo-Thomist project of a creating a Thomist moral epistemology based on the metaphysics of human nature. MacIntyre continues to point out the irrelevance of conventional business ethics, conceived as an application of modern moral theories to business decision making, but some scholars in the field of business ethics have begun to apply MacIntyre’s Aristotelian account of agency and virtue to the study of organizational systems, to develop ways of renewing moral agency and practical rationality within companies. MacIntyre has played an important role in the renewal of Aristotelian ethics and politics in the last three decades, and has made a valued contribution to the advancement of Thomistic philosophy.

Life
Prefatory Comment on “Modern Liberal Individualism”
Development since 1951
1. The influence of Marx’s Theses on Feuerbach in MacIntyre’s Moral and Political Work
2. Three Phases in MacIntyre’s Career
Major works since 1977
The Main Themes of MacIntyre’s Philosophy
1. The Ethics and Politics of Human Agency
2. Ethics and Politics
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Works
2. Secondary Works

1. Life

Alasdair MacIntyre was born January 12, 1929 in Glasgow, Scotland. His parents, both of which were physicians, were born and raised in the West of Scotland. Though Educated in England, he learned Scots Gaelic from one of his aunts. MacIntyre grew up in and around the city of London. He earned a bachelor’s degree in classics from Queen Mary College in the University of London in the city’s East End in 1949. MacIntyre attended graduate school at Manchester University, a provincial “red brick” university in the North West of England, earning his MA in Philosophy in 1951.

MacIntyre’s family had distant ties to County Donegal, in the North of Ireland, and his knowledge of Gaelic helped MacIntyre to make connections to the people there. He has remained close to the cultural and political concerns of Ireland for many years. MacIntyre “has an intimate and extensive knowledge of Irish literature, both in English and in Irish” (O’Rourke, p. 3). An academic conference celebrating MacIntyre’s eightieth birthday, held at the University College Dublin in 2009, acknowledged and celebrated his ties to the Irish community.

Alasdair MacIntyre’s philosophy builds on an unusual foundation. His early life was shaped by two conflicting systems of values. One was “a Gaelic oral culture of farmers and fishermen, poets and storytellers.” The other was modernity, “The modern world was a culture of theories rather than stories” (MacIntyre Reader, p. 255). MacIntyre embraced both value systems, and carried those divergent worldviews into his undergraduate education.

As a classics major at Queen Mary College in the University of London (1945-1949), MacIntyre read the Greek texts of Plato and Aristotle, but his studies were not limited to the grammars of ancient languages. He also examined the ethical theories of Immanuel Kant and John Stuart Mill. He attended the lectures of analytic philosopher A. J. Ayer and of philosopher of science Karl Popper. He read Ludwig Wittgenstein’s Tractatus Logico Philosophicus, Jean-Paul Sartre’s L’existentialisme est un humanisme, and Marx’s Eighteenth Brumaire of Napoleon Bonaparte (What happened, pp. 17-18). MacIntyre met the sociologist Franz Steiner, who helped direct him toward approaching moralities substantively (interview with Giovanna Borradori, p. 259). MacIntyre’s mature work continues to bridge across conventional disciplinary borders.

MacIntyre’s mature writings also continue to criticize the social and economic orders of modern life. This work also began during his time at Queen Mary College, growing out of his solidarity with the poor and working classes who filled the East End of London where Queen Mary College is located. MacIntyre’s first encounter with the Marxist critiques of liberalism and capitalism (Kinesis Interview, p. 48) drew MacIntyre into two decades of participation in Marxist organizations (Alasdair MacIntyre’s Engagement with Marxism, pp. xiii-l). MacIntyre’s first encounter with the Thomist critique of English social and political life made a strong impression on MacIntyre, but he would not identify himself as a Thomist until 1984 (What happened, p. 17).

From Marxism, MacIntyre learned to see liberalism as a destructive ideology that undermines communities in the name of individual liberty and consequently undermines the moral formation of human agents (interview with Giovanna Borradori, p. 258; Kinesis Interview , p. 47). MacIntyre still acknowledges the insights of The Eighteenth Brumaire of Napoleon Bonaparte (What happened, pp. 20, 483), a book that strips the ideological pretensions from mid-nineteenth century French political rhetoric. For MacIntyre, Marx’s way of seeing through the empty justifications of arbitrary choices to consider the real goals and consequences of political actions in economic and social terms would remain the principal insight of Marxism. MacIntyre found the predictive theories of Marxist social science less convincing. His first book, Marxism: An Interpretation, (1953), criticizes Marx’s turn to social science; similar critiques appear in nearly all of MacIntyre’s major works.

MacIntyre began his teaching career at the University of Manchester as a Lecturer in the Philosophy of Religion in 1951, and held that post until 1957. In a 1956 essay, “Manchester: The Modern University and the English Tradition,” MacIntyre writes with pride about the role of the provincial universities as centers of professional education that are tied in service to the people of their cities, as places that had traditionally been homes to radical politics and non-conformist and minority (Agnostic, Roman Catholic, and Jewish) religion. Marxism: An Interpretation, is similarly an expression of radical politics and non-conformist religion directed to the service of people’s needs. After Manchester, MacIntyre became a member of Britain’s New Left (Alasdair MacIntyre’s Engagement with Marxism, pp. xxii-xxxii, 86-93) and moved through teaching, research, and administrative positions at other British universities before emigrating from Britain to the United States in 1970, where his research interests drew him to teaching posts at Brandeis, Boston University, Vanderbilt, Notre Dame, and Duke. MacIntyre returned to Notre Dame in 2000 as the Senior Research Professor in the Notre Dame Center for Ethics and Culture until his retirement in 2010.

MacIntyre began his career as a Marxist Protestant Christian philosopher of religion, basing his work on the fideism of Karl Barth and Wittgenstein’s concept of a form of life (interview with Giovanna Borradori, p. 257). By 1960 he had stopped writing on that subject, and he wrote as an atheist through the sixties and seventies. MacIntyre’s emigration from Great Britain roughly coincides with his break from organized Marxism. In 1968, MacIntyre published a heavily revised version of Marxism: An Interpretation as Marxism and Christianity, and noted in the preface to the new book that he had become skeptical of both. That skepticism remains in Against the Self-Images of the Age (1971).

During the years 1977 through 1984 MacIntyre transitioned to an Aristotelian worldview, returned to the Christian faith and turned from Aristotle to Thomas Aquinas. MacIntyre explains in the preface to The Tasks of Philosophy (2006) that the article “Epistemological Crises, Dramatic Narrative, and the Philosophy of Science” (hereafter EC, 1977) marks the beginning of this transition.

After his retirement from teaching, MacIntyre has continued his work of promoting a renewal of human agency through an examination of the virtues demanded by practices, integrated human lives, and responsible engagement with community life. He is currently affiliated with the Centre for Contemporary Aristotelian Studies in Ethics and Politics (CASEP) at London Metropolitan University.

Alasdair MacIntyre has authored 19 books and edited five others. His most important book, After Virtue (hereafter AV, 1981), has been called one of the most influential works of moral philosophy of the late 20^th century. AV and his other major works, including Marxism: An Interpretation (hereafter MI, 1953), A Short History of Ethics (hereafter SHE, 1966), Marxism and Christianity (hereafter M&C, 1968), Against the Self-Images of the Age (hereafter ASIA, 1971), Whose Justice? Which Rationality? (hereafter WJWR, 1988), Three Rival Versions of Moral Enquiry (hereafter 3RV, 1990), and Dependent Rational Animals (Hereafter DRA, 1999) have shaped academic moral philosophy for six decades. SHE served as a standard text for college courses in the history of moral philosophy for many years; AV remains a widely used ethics textbook in undergraduate and graduate education. MacIntyre has published about two hundred journal articles and roughly one hundred book reviews, addressing concerns in ethics, politics, the philosophy of the social sciences, Marxist theory, Marxist political practice, the Aristotelian notion of excellence or virtue in human agency, and the interpretation of Thomistic metaphysics, epistemology, and ethics.

MacIntyre’s mature work, initiated by the 1977 essay, “Epistemological Crises, Dramatic Narrative, and the Philosophy of Science” (hereafter EC), draws upon the study of traditions, and the examination of the narratives that inform traditions of scientific, philosophical, and social practice, as a philosophical method. AV and the whole body of work that follows it employ this philosophical method in the study of moral and political philosophy.

2. Prefatory Comment on “Modern Liberal Individualism”

AV rejects the view of “modern liberal individualism” in which autonomous individuals use abstract moral principles to determine what they ought to do. The critique of modern normative ethics in the first half of AV rejects modern moral reasoning for its failure to justify its premises, and criticizes the frequent use of the rhetoric of objective morality and scientific necessity to manipulate people to accept arbitrary decisions. The critical argument gives examples of such manipulative moral rhetoric in ordinary speech, in philosophical ethics, and in the political use of the social sciences. The second half of AV proposes a conception of practice and practical reasoning and the notion of excellence as a human agent as an alternative to modern moral philosophy, presenting what MacIntyre has called “an historicist defense of Aristotle” (AV, p. 277).

MacIntyre’s use of the term “modern liberal individualism” in philosophy is not equivalent to “liberalism” in contemporary politics. Some readers interpreted MacIntyre’s rejection of “modern liberal individualism” to mean that he is a political conservative (AV, 3^rd ed., p. xv), but MacIntyre uses “modern liberal individualism” to name a much broader category that includes both liberals and conservatives in contemporary American political parlance, as well as some Marxists and anarchists (See ASIA, pp. 280-284). Conservatism, liberalism, Marxism, and anarchism all present the autonomous individual as the unit of civil society (see “The Theses on Feuerbach: A Road Not Taken.”); none of these political theories can provide a well-developed conception of the common good; and none of them can adequately explain or justify any shared pursuit of any common good.

The sources of modern liberal individualism—Hobbes, Locke, and Rousseau—assert that human life is solitary by nature and social by habituation and convention. MacIntyre’s Aristotelian tradition holds, on the contrary, that human life is social by nature. Modern liberal individualism seeks to justify the moral authority of various universal, impersonal moral principles to enable autonomous individuals to make morally correct decisions. But modern moral philosophers use those principles to establish the authority of universal moral norms, and modern autonomous individuals set aside the pursuit of their own goods and goals when they obey these principles and norms in order to judge and act morally. MacIntyre rejects this modern project as incoherent. MacIntyre identifies moral excellence with effective human agency, and seeks a political environment that will help to liberate human agents to recognize and seek their own goods, as components of the common goods of their communities, more effectively. For MacIntyre therefore, ethics and politics are bound together.

3. Development since 1951

Alasdair MacIntyre’s career in moral and political philosophy has passed through many changes, but two themes have remained constant. The first is his critique of modern normative ethics. The second is his approach to moral philosophy as a study of moral formation that strengthens rational human agency and helps to develop a political community of rational agents. The critique of modern normative ethics draws on two sources, the philosophy of Karl Marx, and the emotivism of early twentieth-century logical positivists, including A. J. Ayer and C. L. Stevenson. The search for a truthful ethics and politics of agents in communities draws on action theory, sociology, the philosophy of science and the theme of “revolutionary practice” drawn from Karl Marx’s Theses on Feuerbach.

a. The influence of Marx’s Theses on Feuerbach in MacIntyre’s Moral and Political Work

MacIntyre has cited the third of Marx’s Theses on Feuerbach, throughout his career (See MI, p. 61; M&C, p. 59, AV, p. 84); he explains the significance of the Theses on Feuerbach in detail in “The Theses on Feuerbach: A Road Not Taken” (hereafter ToF:RNT), published in 1994. Macintyre reads The Theses on Feuerbach as “a genuinely transitional text” (ToF:RNT, p. 224),” marking the end of Marx’s philosophical work with Hegel and Feuerbach, but “pointing in a direction which Marx did not in fact take” (ToF:RNT, p. 226). Hegel and Feuerbach had been critics of “the standpoint of civil society”; which is effectively the standpoint of “modern liberal individualism.” Feuerbach had criticized objects of religious belief as projections of human thought. But Marx found that the theoretical objects of Feuerbach’s philosophy were susceptible to the same critique. In the Theses on Feuerbach, Marx proposed a philosophy that sets aside the contemplation of theoretical objects in order to examine and transform human activity and practice (ToF:RNT, pp. 227-8; see Marx, fourth and first theses).

In the third thesis, Marx complained that Feuerbach and other materialist social theorists invented a determinist theory of human behavior, but applied it as if it did not encompass their own free agency, as if they were superior to society (ToF:RNT, p. 229-30; see also AV, p. 84). Rejecting this implicit distinction between society and those superior to it, Marx insisted that the leaders and followers of the revolution can only act together, discovering together the ends and methods of the revolution (ToF:RNT, p. 230-1). Marx made this proposal, but did not pursue it. Later Marxist revivals of philosophy have followed two main roads of research, “the dialectical and historical materialism of Plekhanov . . . or . . . the rational voluntarism of the young Lukács” (ToF:RNT, p. 232). For MacIntyre, even at the beginning of his career, The Theses on Feuerbach offered a less traveled road for the recovery of Marxist philosophy that would become essential to MacIntyre’s contributions to moral and political philosophy.

b. Three Phases in MacIntyre’s Career

Discussing his career in an interview for the journal Cogito in 1991, MacIntyre identified three distinct phases in his development. During the first period, from 1949 to 1971, MacIntyre published in the philosophy of religion, ethics, the philosophy of the social sciences, and Marxist political and ethical theory without integrating these studies into a unified world view. During the second period, from 1971 to 1977, MacIntyre worked toward the integration of his philosophy. In the third period, from 1977 forward, MacIntyre has been working on “a single project, to which AV, WJWR and 3RV are all central” (Interview for Cogito, in The MacIntyre Reader, p. 269)

i. Early Career (1949-1971)

In his early career, MacIntyre investigated the rational justification of theories and beliefs, and published books and articles in the philosophy of religion, the philosophy of the social sciences, and moral theory. This survey of his early career will take each of these fields in turn.

1. Philosophy of Religion

In the philosophy of religion, the young MacIntyre did not try to justify religious belief rationally; rather he tried to show that religious belief should be exempted from rational examination. The theory he developed in the 1950s was a defensive structure devised to separate MacIntyre’s religious beliefs from the rest of his academic work. MacIntyre’s early fideist philosophy of religion was influenced by the philosophy of Ludwig Wittgenstein and the theology of Karl Barth. For the fideist, religious belief is not, and cannot be rational; its only basis is the acceptance of religious authority. MacIntyre’s Barthian-Wittgensteinian philosophy of religion is nothing more than a rational compartmentalization of religious belief.

The key statement of MacIntyre’s early fideist philosophy of religion is his 1957 essay, “The Logical Status of Religious Belief,” published in the book Metaphysical Beliefs. This essay faced strong criticism from the atheist Antony Flew and the Christian theologian Basil Mitchell. In a 1958 book review, Flew pointed out that traditional Christianity had a closer connection to empirical facts than MacIntyre allowed, and that even if facts about the world could not verify religious belief, it was nonetheless possible for internal incoherence to demonstrate the falsehood of doctrine. Mitchell published a fourteen page critique of MacIntyre’s fideism in 1961 entitled, “The Justification of Religious Belief.” When Metaphysical Beliefs was republished in 1970, MacIntyre added a new preface in which he thanked Flew and Mitchell, along with his colleague Ronald Hepburn, for their criticism, and rejected the essay’s “irrationalism as both false and dangerous” (“Preface to the 1970 Edition,” pp. x–xi).

From the early 1960s through the late 1970s, MacIntyre wrote as an avowed atheist. Three publications in the 1960s, “God and the Theologians,” The Religious Significance of Atheism, and Secularization and Moral Change, express MacIntyre’s atheist convictions.

The reasoning behind MacIntyre’s rejection of his early fideism continues to inform his approach to theism. MacIntyre’s 2010 lecture, “On Being a Theistic Philosopher in a Secularized Culture” does not treat theistic belief as an isolable metaphysical doctrine about the origin and fate of human life. For the mature MacIntyre, theism plays a central role in the interpretation of the world. MacIntyre’s mature theism is not a return to his early fideism; it belongs to a rational worldview that challenges “secular fideists” on the same grounds that it challenges religious ones (WJWR, p. 5).

2. Philosophy of the Social Sciences

MacIntyre’s early work in the philosophy of the social sciences is related to the rational justification of Marxist theory, and to distinguishing the more promising elements of Marx’s early philosophical work from the more pseudoscientific elements of later Marxist and Stalinist theory. Within Marxism, which presented itself through most of the twentieth century as a social science, MacIntyre directed his critique against the crude determinism of Stalinism. More broadly, MacIntyre has questioned the rational justification of any social theory that does not give a central place to the beliefs, intentions, and choices of human agents.

In his unpublished master’s thesis, The Significance of Moral Judgements (hereafter SMJ, 1951), MacIntyre cites Steven Toulmin, “The Logical Status of Psycho-Analysis,” Antony Flew, “Psycho-Analytic Explanation,” and Richard Peters, “Cause, Cure, and Motive,” to criticize Sigmund Freud’s apparent reduction of the moral account of a person’s actions to a causal account of that person’s psychological condition.

MacIntyre remained an outspoken critic of determinist social science throughout the early period of his career. Marxism: An Interpretation criticizes Marx’s turn to determinist social science in The German Ideology (MI, pp. 68-78). M&C, revises this criticism, directing the blame toward Friedrich Engels (M&C, pp.70-74). In the article, “Determinism,” MacIntyre admitted that successful predictions about human behavior from the social sciences made it difficult to dismiss determinism, but given the kinds of interpretative choices required to defend determinism, he found “it difficult to see how determinism could ever be verified or falsified” (pp. 39-40).

3. Ethics and Politics

MacIntyre’s critique of modern normative ethics, if understood as a critique of the normative ethics characteristic of liberal modernity, is rooted partly in the work of Karl Marx. While still a student, MacIntyre had accepted much of the Marxist critique of modern liberal politics as an ideology that sets the individual against the interests of the community. Marx dismissed the notion of “natural rights” as a residue of feudal society in the book review, “On The Jewish Question.” For Marx, “rights” could arise only from laws made by governments. Marx held that “natural rights” or the “rights of man,” as used in nineteenth century liberal politics, served only to protect the individual from the society to which he belonged, and thus threatened both the society and the individual.

MacIntyre’s early Marxism led him to reject every form of modern liberal individualism, “including the liberalism of contemporary American and English conservatives, as well as that of American and European radicals, and even the liberalism of the self-proclaimed liberals.” For these ideological stances, by their constructions of civil society as a response of the individual to universal standards of reason and behavior, “impose a certain kind of unacknowledged domination, and one which in the long run tends to dissolve traditional human ties and to impoverish social and cultural relationships” (Borradori interview, p. 258)

MacIntyre’s critique of modern normative ethics is also influenced by the theory of emotivism. C. L. Stevenson and other emotivists held that moral judgments signify only the subjective interests of their authors, rather than any objective characteristic of the agents and actions they judge. SMJ takes issue with the reductivism of Stevenson’s theory of the meaning of moral judgments, but MacIntyre agrees with most points of Stevenson’s emotivist critique of modern normative ethics, and in this way MacIntyre joins Stevenson’s critique of the intuitionism of G. E. Moore.

Moore had argued in Principia Ethica (1903) that the fundamental task of philosophical ethics was to investigate “assertions about that property of things which is denoted by the term ‘good,’ and the converse property denoted by the term ‘bad’” (Principia Ethica, §23) Moore asserted that “good” must name some specific quality that all good things share, but he found it impossible to define “good” in any adequate way (Principia Ethica, §10). Moore therefore described “good” as a simple, indefinable, non-natural quality.

Logical positivists, including A. J. Ayer (Language Truth and Logic, ch. 6) and C. L. Stevenson could find nothing objective in the “good” that Moore described, and concluded that “good” and “bad” are not objective qualities. Stevenson held that valuations, like “this is a good car” or “that is a good house,” and moral valuations, like “he is a good man,” or “theft is wrong,” are not statements of fact. For Stevenson, evaluative words like “good” and “evil” carry, “emotive meaning” which Stevenson defines as “a tendency of a word, arising through the history of its usage, to produce (result from) affective responses to people” (“The Emotive Meaning of Ethical Terms” p. 23) Emotive terms are used to influence people. Thus the true meaning of any valuation, and particularly of any moral valuation—the significance of moral judgments—is either the speaker’s subjective approval and recommendation, or the speaker’s subjective rejection and proscription. In short, the emotivists held that moral judgments communicate neither facts nor beliefs; they communicate only the emotional interests of their authors.

MacIntyre criticized the reductivism of Stevenson’s conclusions in his MA thesis, but MacIntyre did not criticize Stevenson’s rejection of Moore. MacIntyre explains, “This is not to deny the emotive character of the moral judgment: it is to suggest that when we have said of moral judgments that they are emotive we have left a great deal unsaid—and even the emotive may have a logic to be mapped” (SMJ, p. 89.) MacIntyre’s 1951 assessment of emotivism accepts Stevenson’s critique of the referential meaning of moral judgments (SMJ, p. 74), and with it, the general rejection of “traditional moral philosophy” as a study that uses principles to assess facts (SMJ, p. 81).

For MacIntyre ethics is not an application of principles to facts, but a study of moral action. Moral action, free human action, involves decisions to do things in pursuit of goals, and it involves the understanding of the implications of one’s actions for the whole variety of goals that human agents seek. In this sense, “To act morally is to know how to act” (SMJ, p. 56). “Morality is not a ‘knowing that’ but a ‘knowing how’” (SMJ, p. 89). If human action is a ‘knowing how,’ then ethics must also consider how one learns ‘how.’ Like other forms of ‘knowing how,’ MacIntyre finds that one learns how to act morally within a community whose language and shared standards shape our judgment (SMJ, pp. 68-72). MacIntyre had concluded that ethics is not an abstract exercise in the assessment of facts; it is a study of free human action and of the conditions that enable rational human agency.

Human agency remains a central theme in MacIntyre’s first published book, Marxism: An Interpretation (1953). The book praises those forms of M&C that enable human agency, and criticizes those that inhibit human agency. MacIntyre traces a history from Protestant theology and practice, through the philosophies of Hegel and Feuerbach, to the work of Marx to argue that Marxism is a transformation of Christianity. MacIntyre gives Marx credit for concluding in the third of the Theses on Feuerbach, that the only way to change society is to change ourselves, and that “The coincidence of the changing of human activity or self-changing can only be comprehended and rationally understood as revolutionary practice” (Marx, Theses on Feuerbach, quoted in MI, p. 61). MacIntyre criticizes Marx’s subsequent turn to determinist social science and concludes that “Marx’s transition from prophecy to prediction” transforms Marxism into an alienating myth that divides human beings between “the good who accept Marxism, [and] the wicked who reject it” (MI, p. 89).

The book also examines some shortcomings of Protestant theology and practice, showing how the demands of the gospel inform the ideals of Feuerbach and, through Feuerbach, Marx. MacIntyre distinguishes “religion which is an opiate for the people from religion which is not” (MI, p. 83). He condemns forms of religion that justify social inequities and encourage passivity. He argues that authentic Christian teaching criticizes social structures and encourages action (MI, pp. 119-22).

The MA thesis and MI combine to chart MacIntyre’s initial reply to the emotivist critique of modern normative ethics. They also prefigure MacIntyre’s conflict with R. M. Hare’s response to emotivism. Hare sought to defend modern normative ethics from the emotivist challenge with an alternative account of the meaning of moral judgments. A central claim of Hare’s The Language of Morals (1952), renewed in Freedom and Reason (1963), is that moral judgments are descriptive—not merely emotive—because they are both universalizable and prescriptive. For Hare, universalizability stems from an agent’s commitment to use terms and judgments consistently. For example, “If a person says that a thing is red, he is committed to the view that anything which was like it in the relevant respects would likewise be red” (Freedom and Reason, I 2.2). Thus the prescriptive judgments that agents make are universalizable, insofar as those agents are committed to judging similar things similarly; and it is the universalizability of these prescriptive judgments that gives them descriptive meaning. In short, moral judgments are descriptive because they describe the values chosen by their authors.

MacIntyre rejected Hare’s defense of modern normative ethics in his 1957 essay, “What Morality Is Not.” MacIntyre focuses on Hare’s theory: “It is widely held that it is of the essence of moral valuations that they are universalizable and prescriptive. This is the contention which I wish to deny.” “What Morality is Not” explores the variety of meanings and intentions carried by moral judgments. MacIntyre lists six kinds of moral valuations that are neither universalizable nor prescriptive and concludes that the theory of universal prescriptivism is inadequate for the same reason that emotivism is inadequate; it is reductive. Universal prescriptivism simply fails to give a complete account of the meaning of moral judgments.

“What Morality is Not” also argues that the procedures of modern moral philosophy are superfluous to real moral practice. Where “moral philosophy textbooks” discuss the kinds of maxims that should guide “promise-keeping, truth-telling, and the like,” moral maxims do not guide real agents in real life at all. “They do not guide us because we do not need to be guided. We know what to do” (ASIA, p. 106). Sometimes we do this without any maxims at all, or even against all the maxims we know. MacIntyre Illustrates his point with Huckleberry Finn’s decision to help Jim, Miss Watson’s escaped slave, to make his way to freedom (ASIA, p. 107). Once again, morality is not a “knowing that” but a “knowing how,” and the use of this “knowing how” cannot be reduced to making universalizable prescriptive judgments. MacIntyre’s rejection of Hare’s universal prescriptivism renewed his critique of modern normative ethics, and carried lasting consequences for the Marxist MacIntyre’s response to the moral challenge of Stalinism.

In the late 1950s Marxists throughout the world discovered the hidden atrocities of the Stalinist regime in the Soviet Union, and witnessed the violent suppression of the Hungarian revolution of 1956 (See Virtue and Politics, pp. 134-151). The crimes of the Stalinist regime, including mass murder, mass deportation, and the execution of the intellectual, political, cultural, and ecclesial leadership of subject national communities, demanded condemnation. Yet the moral criticism of Stalinist policies presented a problem to committed Marxist atheists, including MacIntyre, who had rejected theistic notions of divine law as well as modern secular notions of “natural rights.”

MacIntyre discussed the moral condemnation of Stalinism in “Notes from the Moral Wilderness” I & II, (1958 and 59). For MacIntyre, it appeared difficult to condemn Stalinism with any real authority, because any appeal to modern secular liberal moral principle seems to be essentially arbitrary. The ex-communist, liberal critic of Stalinism “can only condemn in the name of his own choice” (The MacIntyre Reader, p. 34). MacIntyre’s description of the moral perplexity of these critics of Stalinism resembles his description of Huck Finn a year earlier (ASIA, p. 106); they judged the crimes of Stalin well, but lacked any adequate way to justify their judgments rationally. In “Notes From the Moral Wilderness II,” MacIntyre proposed a new Marxist ethics of human action. Rather than divorcing “the ‘ought’ of morality” from “the ‘is’ of desire” (The MacIntyre Reader, p. 41), MacIntyre’s Marxist ethics would look to “the fact of human solidarity which comes to light in the discovery of what we want” (The MacIntyre Reader, p. 48).

MacIntyre’s Marxist writings of the early 1960s develop his ethical project. “Communism and British Intellectuals” (1960) argues that the Communist Party of Great Britain is no longer Marxist because it has abandoned Marx’s insight from the third of the Theses on Feuerbach. “Classical Marxism . . . wants to transform the vast mass of mankind from victims and puppets into agents who are masters of their own lives,” but Stalinism had transformed Marxism into the doctrine that scientists should use “the objective and unchangeable laws of history” to manage the behavior of society (Alasdair MacIntyre’s Engagement with Marxism, p. 119). “Freedom and Revolution” (1960) discusses “human initiative” in terms of “desire, intention, and choice” (Alasdair MacIntyre’s Engagement with Marxism, p. 124), and sees the full development of human freedom to require participation in the life of a community: “The problem of freedom is not the problem of the individual against society but the problem of what sort of society we want, and what sort of individuals we want to be” (Alasdair MacIntyre’s Engagement with Marxism, p. 129). The individual should not seek liberation from society, but through society. Morality has to do with one’s participation in the life of one’s community.

MacIntyre develops the ideas that morality emerges from history, and that morality organizes the common life of a community in SHE (1966). The book concludes that the concepts of morality are neither timeless nor ahistorical, and that understanding the historical development of ethical concepts can liberate us “from any false absolutist claims” (SHE, p. 269). Yet this conclusion need not imply that morality is essentially arbitrary or that one could achieve freedom by liberating oneself from the morality of one’s society. In his comments on Plato’s Gorgias in chapter 4, MacIntyre rejects Callicles’ claims that breaking social rules can be liberating. “For a man whose behavior was not rule-governed in any way would have ceased to participate as an intelligible agent in human society” (SHE, p. 32). Elements of SHE return in the histories of AV (1981) and WJWR (1988).

ii. Interim (1971-1977)

The publication of ASIA in 1971 marks the end of the “heterogeneous, badly organized, sometimes fragmented and often frustrating and messy enquiries” (The MacIntyre Reader, p. 268) that made up the first part of MacIntyre’s career, and the beginning of “an interim period of sometimes painfully self-critical reflection” that would end with the publication of EC in 1977.

ASIA is a collection of short essays criticizing ideology, contemporary religious practice, Marxist theory and hagiography, modern moral philosophy, reductive approaches to the social sciences, and modern liberal individualism. The essays in the book address most of the issues that would appear a decade later in AV, but they are not synthesized into a single coherent narrative “because,” MacIntyre explains in the preface, “to rescue them from their form as reviews or essays written at a particular time or place would require that I should know how to tie these arguments together into a substantive whole. This I do not yet know how to do. . .” (ASIA, p. x). As MacIntyre himself reports, he spent the interim period from 1971 to 1977 working to bring unity to his philosophical writing (The MacIntyre Reader, p. 268-9). ASIA is a valuable companion to AV because some issues that are treated obscurely in the latter, for example Trotsky’s assessment of the Russian Revolution, are treated in detail in the former (AV, p. 262; ASIA, pp. 52-59).

ASIA’s final essay, “Political and Philosophical Epilogue: A View of The Poverty of Liberalism by Robert Paul Wolff,” introduces some of the most characteristic claims of AV: Various forms of modern liberalism appeal to different theories and principles for their justification. The theories that are used to justify liberal principles may serve as ideological masks that enable “those who profess the principles to deceive not only others but also themselves as to the character of their political action” (ASIA, p. 282). “American conservatism,” “American liberalism,” and “American radicalism” are all forms of modern liberalism, thus “To free ourselves from liberalism, radicalism is the wrong remedy.” Marxism cannot fulfill its promise to teach us how to transform society, but “we can at least learn from it where not to begin” (ASIA, p. 284).

In the Cogito interview, MacIntyre says that by 1971 he had begun to look to Aristotle as the right place to begin to study society in order to understand it and transform it. He “set out to rethink the problems of ethics in a systematic way, taking seriously for the first time the possibility that the history both of modern morality and of modern moral philosophy could only be written adequately from an Aristotelian point of view” (The MacIntyre Reader, p. 268).

For MacIntyre, “an Aristotelian point of view” sees teleology inherent in the natures of things, interprets deliberate human activity as voluntary action—not as caused behavior, and finds the human person to be naturally social. From this “Aristotelian point of view,” “modern morality” begins to go awry when moral norms are separated from the pursuit of human goods and moral behavior is treated as an end in itself. This separation characterizes Christian divine command ethics since the fourteenth century and has remained essential to secularized modern morality since the eighteenth century. From MacIntyre’s “Aristotelian point of view,” the autonomy granted to the human agent by modern moral philosophy breaks down natural human communities and isolates the individual from the kinds of formative relationships that are necessary to shape the agent into an independent practical reasoner.

iii. Mature Work (1977- )

In the Preface to The Tasks of Philosophy (2006), MacIntyre explains that the discontinuities of ASIA left him with the question, “How then was I to proceed philosophically?” MacIntyre’s answer came in the 1977 essay “Epistemological Crises, Dramatic Narrative, and the Philosophy of Science” (Hereafter EC). This essay, MacIntyre reports, “marks a major turning-point in my thought in the 1970s” (The Tasks of Philosophy, p. vii) EC may be described fairly as MacIntyre’s discourse on method, and as the title suggests, it presents three general points on the method for philosophy.

First, Philosophy makes progress through the resolution of problems. These problems arise when the theories, histories, doctrines and other narratives that help us to organize our experience of the world fail us, leaving us in “epistemological crises.” Epistemological crises are the aftermath of events that undermine the ways that we interpret our world. Epistemological crises may be deeply personal, triggered by unexpected betrayal or by the loss of religious faith or ideological commitment, or they may be highly speculative, brought on by the failure of trusted theories to explain our experience. To live in an epistemological crisis is to be aware that one does not know what one thought one knew about some particular subject and to be anxious to recover certainty about that subject.

To resolve an epistemological crisis it is not enough to impose some new way of interpreting our experience, we also need to understand why we were wrong before: “When an epistemological crisis is resolved, it is by the construction of a new narrative which enables the agent to understand both how he or she could intelligibly have held his or her original beliefs and how he or she could have been so drastically misled by them” (EC, in The Tasks of Philosophy, p. 5). The resolution of the crisis may lead one to recognize that human understanding is always incomplete and that progress in enquiry is therefore open ended. For MacIntyre, the resolution of an epistemological crisis cannot promise the neat clarity of a shift from a failed body of theory to a truthful one.

To illustrate his position on the open-endedness of enquiry, MacIntyre compares the title characters of Shakespeare’s Hamlet and Jane Austen’s Emma. When Emma finds that she is deeply misled in her beliefs about the other characters in her story, Mr. Knightly helps her to learn the truth and the story comes to a happy ending (p. 6). Hamlet, by contrast, finds no pat answers to his questions; rival interpretations remain throughout the play, so that directors who would stage the play have to impose their own interpretations on the script (p. 5). MacIntyre notes, “Philosophers have customarily been Emmas and not Hamlets” (p. 6); that is, philosophers have treated their conclusions as accomplished truths, rather than as “more adequate narratives” (p. 7) that remain open to further improvement.

The second point of EC addresses the relationship between narratives, truth, and education. The traditional education of children begins in myth, and as children mature they learn to distinguish the lessons of these stories from the fictional events, the truths from the myths. In the course of this education, however, the student grows to respect the myths as bearers of truth. The student who grows through this kind of education to become a scholar “may become . . . a Vico or a Hamann” (p. 8. Johann Georg Hamaan (1730-1788), Giambattista Vico (1668-1744)). Another approach to education is the method of Descartes, who begins by rejecting everything that is not clearly and distinctly true as unreliable and false in order to rebuild his understanding of the world on a foundation of undeniable truth.

Ironically, in the process of rejecting myth, Descartes creates a narrative that is not only mythical but profoundly false. Rather than identifying specific areas of crisis in which he had lost confidence in his understanding of the world and situating himself within the tradition that has formed his understanding and his enquiry, Descartes presents himself as willfully rejecting everything he had believed, and ignores his obvious debts to the Scholastic tradition, even as he argues his case in French and Latin. For MacIntyre, seeking epistemological certainty through universal doubt as a precondition for enquiry is a mistake: “it is an invitation not to philosophy but to mental breakdown, or rather to philosophy as a means of mental breakdown.” David Hume’s cry of pain in his Treatise of Human Nature is the outcome of this kind of philosophical practice (EC, pp. 10-11). MacIntyre contrasts Descartes’ descent into mythical isolation with Galileo, who was able to make progress in astronomy and physics by struggling with the apparently insoluble questions of late medieval astronomy and physics, and radically reinterpreting the issues that constituted those questions.

To make progress in philosophy one must sort through the narratives that inform one’s understanding, struggle with the questions that those narratives raise, and on occasion, reject, replace, or reinterpret portions of those narratives and propose those changes to the rest of one’s community for assessment. Human enquiry is always situated within the history and life of a community. There is no alternative ahistorical, non-traditional way to make progress in human enquiry. MacIntyre returns to this theme in WJWR (chapters 17, 18, 19), in 3RV, and in his Aquinas Lecture, “First Principles, Final Ends, and Contemporary Philosophical Issues” (1990).

The third point of EC is that we can learn about progress in philosophy from the philosophy of science. In particular, “Kuhn’s work criticized provides an illuminating application for the ideas which I have been defending” (EC, p. 15) Kuhn’s The Structure of Scientific Revolutions had argued that scientists practice normal science according to the norms of paradigms or “disciplinary matrices.” Scientific revolutions occur when scientists abandon one paradigm for another. Kuhn’s “paradigm shifts,” however, are unlike MacIntyre’s resolutions of epistemological crises in two ways. First they are not rational responses to specific problems. Kuhn compares paradigm shifts to religious conversions (pp. 150, 151, 158), stressing that they are not guided by rational norms and he claims that the “mopping up” phase of a paradigm shift is a matter of convention in the training of new scientists and attrition among the holdouts of the previous paradigm (Kuhn, pp. 152, 159). Second, the new paradigm is treated as a closed system of belief that regulates a new period of “normal science”; Kuhn’s revolutionary scientists are Emmas, not Hamlets.

MacIntyre takes Kuhn’s position as a restatement of Michael Polyani’s theory that “reason operates only within traditions and communities,” so that transitions between traditions or reconstructions of failed traditions must be irrational (EC, p. 16). On Kuhn’s account, “scientific revolutions are epistemological crises understood in a Cartesian way. Everything is put in question simultaneously” (EC, p. 17).

MacIntyre proposes elements of Imre Lakatos’ philosophy of science as correctives to Kuhn’s. While Lakatos has his own shortcomings, his general account of the methodologies of scientific research programs recognizes the role of reason in the transitions between theories and between research programs (Lakatos’ analog to Kuhn’s paradigms or disciplinary matrices). Lakatos presents science as an open ended enquiry, in which every theory may eventually be replaced by more adequate theories. For Lakatos, unlike Kuhn, rational scientific progress occurs when a new theory can account both for the apparent promise and for the actual failure of the theory it replaces. The third conclusion of MacIntyre’s essay is that decisions to support some theories over others may be justified rationally to the extent that those theories allow us to understand our experience and our history, including the history of the failures of inadequate theories. EC answers the question that arose from ASIA of how to proceed philosophically. All of MacIntyre’s mature work uses and develops the methodology presented in this essay.

4. Major works since 1977

a. After Virtue

AV (1981, 2^nd ed. 1984, 3^rd ed. 2007) applies the methodology of EC to many of the same issues addressed in ASIA and in SHE, but interprets the history of ethics and the failure of modern moral philosophy in Aristotelian terms. For Aristotle, moral philosophy is a study of practical reasoning, and the excellences or virtues that Aristotle recommends in the Nicomachean Ethics are the intellectual and moral excellences that make a moral agent effective as an independent practical reasoner. AV criticizes modern liberal individualism and scientific determinism for separating practical reasoning from morality and political life; it proposes instead a return to Aristotelian ethics and politics.

i. Critical Argument of AV

The critical argument of AV, which makes up the first half of the book, begins by examining the current condition of secular moral and political discourse. MacIntyre finds contending parties defending their decisions by appealing to abstract moral principles, but he finds their appeals eclectic, inconsistent, and incoherent. MacIntyre also finds that the contending parties have little interest in the rational justification of the principles they use. The language of moral philosophy has become a kind of moral rhetoric to be used to manipulate others in defense of the arbitrary choices of its users. What Stevenson had said incorrectly about the meaning of moral judgments has come to be true of the use of moral judgments. MacIntyre reinterprets “emotivism,” Stevenson’s “false theory of meaning” as a “cogent theory of use,” and he names the culture that uses moral rhetoric pragmatically and syncretically “the culture of emotivism.”

MacIntyre traces the lineage of the culture of emotivism to the secularized Protestant cultures of northern Europe (AV, p. 37). These cultures had abandoned any connection between an agent’s natural telos, personal desires, or pursuit of goods and that same agent’s moral duties when they had adopted the divine command moralities of fourteenth, fifteenth, and sixteenth century Christian moral theology. The secular moral philosophers of the eighteenth and nineteenth centuries shared strong and extensive agreements about the content of morality (AV, p. 51) and believed that their moral philosophy could justify the demands of their morality rationally, free from religious authority.

Modern moral philosophy had thus set for itself an incoherent goal. It was to vindicate both the moral autonomy of the individual and the objectivity, necessity, and categorical character of the rules of morality (AV, p. 62). MacIntyre surveys the best efforts to achieve the goals of modern moral philosophy but dismisses each one as a moral fiction.

Given the failure of modern moral philosophy, MacIntyre turns to an apparent alternative, the pragmatic expertise of professional managers. Managers are expected to appeal to the facts to make their decisions on the objective basis of effectiveness, and their authority to do this is based on their knowledge of the social sciences. An examination of the social sciences reveals, however, that many of the facts to which managers appeal depend on sociological theories that lack scientific status. Thus, the predictions and demands of bureaucratic managers are no less liable to ideological manipulation than the determinations of modern moral philosophers.

If modern morality has been revealed to be “a theater of illusions,” then we must reject it, and this rejection can take two forms. Either we follow Nietzsche and defend the autonomy of the individual against the arbitrary demands of conventional moral reasoning, or we reject both moral autonomy and arbitrary conventional moral reasoning to follow Aristotle and investigate practical reason and the role of moral formation in preparing the human agent to succeed as an independent practical reasoner.

The critical argument of AV raises serious questions about the rational justification of modern moral philosophy, and it also proposes an explanation for the rational failure of modern moral philosophy: Modern moral philosophy separates moral reasoning about duties and obligations from practical reasoning about ends and practical deliberation about the means to one’s ends, and in doing so it separates morality from practice. Kant separates moral and practical reasoning explicitly in The Critique of Pure Reason (Critique of Pure Reason, A800/B828–A819/B847) and in The Foundations of the Metaphysics of Morals (First Section, pp. 393-405.); Mill makes the same separation in Utilitarianism (chapter 2).

MacIntyre compares the separation of morality from practice or the separation of moral reasoning from practical reasoning in modern moral philosophy to the separation of morality from practice in Polynesian taboo. The Polynesians had lost the practical justifications for their well-established moral customs by the time they first made contact with European explorers; so when they told these visitors that certain practices were forbidden because those practices were “taboo,” they were unable to explain why these practices were forbidden or what, precisely, “taboo” meant. Many Europeans also lost the practical justifications for their moral norms as they approached modernity; for these Europeans, claiming that certain practices are “immoral,” and invoking Kant’s categorical imperative or Mill’s principle of utility to explain why those practices are immoral, seems no more adequate than the Polynesian appeal to taboo. The comparison between modern morality and taboo is a recurring theme in MacIntyre’s ethical work.

MacIntyre’s critique of the separation of morality from practice also draws on his criticism of determinist social science. Practice involves free and deliberate human action, while morality divorced from practice regulates only outward human behavior. Determinist social scientists, notably Stalinists but also behaviorists like W.V. Quine, viewed human behaviors as determined responses to various kinds of causal factors, and refused to examine the things people do in terms of “intentions, purposes, and reasons for action” (Quine, quoted in AV, p. 83). Instead, determinist social scientists sought “law-like generalizations” about the connections of these causes to their behavioral effects, which would enable them to predict human behavior, and bring scientific understanding to the work of organizational management (AV, pp. 88–91).

ii. The Constructive Argument of AV

In the second half of AV, MacIntyre explores the moral tradition that examines human judgment, human weakness, and excellence in human action. The constructive argument of the second half of the book begins with traditional accounts of the excellences or virtues of practical reasoning and practical rationality rather than virtues of moral reasoning or morality. These traditional accounts define virtue as arête, as excellence, and all of the definitions offered in the second half of AV describe the excellence of the human agent who judges well and acts effectively in pursuit of desired ends. MacIntyre sifts these definitions and then gives his own definition of virtue, as excellence in human agency, in terms of practices, whole human lives, and traditions in chapters 14 and 15 of AV.

In the most often quoted sentence of AV, MacIntyre defines a practice as (1) a complex social activity that (2) enables participants to gain goods internal to the practice. (3) Participants achieve excellence in practices by gaining the internal goods. When participants achieve excellence, (4) the social understandings of excellence in the practice, of the goods of the practice, and of the possibility of achieving excellence in the practice “are systematically extended” (AV, p. 187).

Practices, like chess, medicine, architecture, mechanical engineering, football, or politics, offer their practitioners a variety of goods both internal and external to these practices. The goods internal to practices include forms of understanding or physical abilities that can be acquired only by pursuing excellence in the associated practice. Goods external to practices include wealth, fame, prestige, and power; there are many ways to gain these external goods. They can be earned or purchased, either honestly or through deception; thus the pursuit of these external goods may conflict with the pursuit of the goods internal to practices.

MacIntyre illustrates the conflict between the pursuits of internal and external goods in the parable of the chess playing child. An intelligent child is given the opportunity to win candy by learning to play chess. As long as the child plays chess only to win candy, he has every reason to cheat if by doing so he can win more candy. If the child begins to desire and pursue the goods internal to chess, however, cheating becomes irrational, because it is impossible to gain the goods internal to chess or any other practice except through an honest pursuit of excellence. Goods external to practices may nevertheless remain tempting to the practitioner.

Practices are supported by institutions like chess clubs, hospitals, universities, industrial corporations, sports leagues, and political organizations. Practices exist in tension with these institutions, since the institutions tend to be oriented to goods external to practices. Universities, hospitals, and scholarly societies may value prestige, profitability, or relations with political interest groups above excellence in the practices they are said to support.

Personal desires and institutional pressures to pursue external goods may threaten to derail practitioners’ pursuits of the goods internal to practices. MacIntyre defines virtue initially as the quality of character that enables an agent to overcome these temptations: “A virtue is an acquired human quality the possession and exercise of which tends to enable us to achieve those goods which are internal to practices and the lack of which effectively prevents us from achieving any such goods” (AV, p. 191).

MacIntyre finds that this first level definition is inadequate to describe an excellent human agent. It is not enough to be an excellent navigator, physician, or builder; the excellent human agent lives an excellent life. Excellence as a human agent cannot be reduced to excellence in a particular practice (See AV, pp. 204–205, and Ethics and Politics, pp. 196–7). MacIntyre therefore adds a second level to his definition of virtue.

The virtues therefore are to be understood as those dispositions which will not only sustain practices and enable us to achieve the goods internal to practices, but which will also sustain us in the relevant kind of quest for the good, by enabling us to overcome the harms, dangers, temptations, and distractions which we encounter, and which will furnish us with increasing self-knowledge and increasing knowledge of the good (AV, p. 219).

The excellent human agent has the moral qualities to seek what is good and best both in practices and in life as a whole.

The second level definition is still inadequate, however, because it does not take into account the individual’s response to the life and legacy of her or his community. MacIntyre rejects individualism and insists that we view human beings as members of communities who bear specific debts and responsibilities because of our social identities. The responsibilities one may inherit as a member of a community include debts to one’s forbearers that one can only repay to people in the present and future. These responsibilities also include debts incurred by the unjust actions of ones’ predecessors.

MacIntyre acknowledges that contemporary individualism insists that “the self is detachable from its social and historical roles and statuses” (AV, p. 221), but he illustrates his counterpoint point with three national communities in which contemporary citizens continue to bear the debts of their predecessors. The enslavement and oppression of black Americans, the subjugation of Ireland, and the genocide of the Jews in Europe remained quite relevant to the responsibilities of citizens of the United States, England, and Germany in 1981, as they still do today. Thus an American who said “I never owned any slaves,” “the Englishman who says ‘I never did any wrong to Ireland,’” or “the young German who believes that being born after 1945 means that what Nazis did to Jews has no moral relevance to his relationship to his Jewish contemporaries” all exhibit a kind of intellectual and moral failure. “I am born with a past, and to cut myself off from that past in the individualist mode, is to deform my present relationships” (p. 221). For MacIntyre, there is no moral identity for the abstract individual; “The self has to find its moral identity in and through its membership in communities” (p. 221).

Since MacIntyre finds social identity necessary for the individual, MacIntyre’s definition of the excellence or virtue of the human agent needs a social dimension:

The virtues find their point and purpose not only in sustaining those relationships necessary if the variety of goods internal to practices are to be achieved and not only in sustaining the form of an individual life in which that individual may seek out his or her good as the good of his or her whole life, but also in sustaining those traditions which provide both practices and individual lives with their necessary historical context (AV, p. 223).

This third, social, level completes MacIntyre’s account of the excellence of the human agent in AV.

iii. Aristotelian Critique of Modern Ethics and Politics

The remaining chapters of AV contrast MacIntyre’s Aristotelian notion of the virtues as excellences of character from modern notions of virtue as the quality of a person who obeys moral rules. These chapters also lay out some of the practical implications of MacIntyre’s Aristotelian project for contemporary ethics and politics. The loss of teleology makes morality appear arbitrary (AV, p. 236), separates moral reason from practical and political reasoning (AV, p. 236), and removes the notion of what one deserves from modern notions of justice (AV, p. 249). MacIntyre concludes that “modern systematic politics . . . expresses in its institutional forms a systematic rejection” of the Aristotelian tradition of the virtues and therefore “has to be rejected” by those who commit themselves to the tradition of the virtues (AV, p. 255). In other words, those who approach moral and political philosophy in terms of the development of the human agent and the advancement of practical reasoning in the context of the life of a community cannot succeed in their task if they compromise their work by committing themselves to the arbitrary goals, methods, and language of modern politics.

At the end of the argument of AV, MacIntyre returns to the ultimatum of chapter 10, “Nietzsche or Aristotle.” Where Nietzsche intended his work as a critique of modern morality, Nietzsche in fact becomes the ultimate embodiment of the moral isolation and arbitrariness of modern liberal individualism. This fault remains invisible from a modern viewpoint, but when viewed from the perspective of the Aristotelian tradition of the virtues, it is quite clear (AV, pp. 258-259).

Since “goods, and with them the only grounds for the authority of laws and virtues, can only be discovered by entering into those relationships which constitute communities whose central bond is a shared vision of and understanding of goods” (AV, p. 258), any hope for the transformation and renewal of society depends on the development and maintenance of such communities. Revolution cannot be imposed (AV, p. 238), although it may be cultivated. To wait “for another—doubtless very different—St. Benedict,” is to await a person who can unify communities that encourage moral formation in judgment and action.

iv. Criticism of AV

MacIntyre’s Aristotelian approach to ethics as a study of human action distinguishes him from post-Kantian moral philosophers who approach ethics as a means of determining the demands of objective, impersonal, universal morality. This modern approach may be described as moral epistemology. Modern moral philosophy pretends to free the individual to determine for her- or himself what she or he must do in a given situation, irrespective of her or his own desires; it pretends to give knowledge of universal moral laws. MacIntyre rejects modern ethical theories as deceptive and self-deceiving masks for conventional morality and for arbitrary interventions against traditions. For MacIntyre, the freedom of self-determination is the freedom to recognize and pursue one’s good, and moral philosophy liberates the agent, in part, by helping the human agent to desire what is good and best, and to choose what is good and best.

MacIntyre’s ethics of human action also distinguishes his later Thomistic work from the efforts of some twentieth-century neo-Thomists to craft a moral epistemology out of Thomas Aquinas’s metaphysics and natural law. AV argues that an Aristotelian ethics of virtue may remain possible, without appealing to Aristotle’s metaphysics of nature. This claim remains controversial for two different, but closely related reasons.

Many of those who rejected MacIntyre’s turn to Aristotle define “virtue” primarily along moral lines, as obedience to law or adherence to some kind of natural norm. For these critics, “virtuous” appears synonymous with “morally correct;” their resistance to MacIntyre’s appeal to virtue stems from their difficulties either with what they take to be the shortcomings of MacIntyre’s account of moral correctness or with the notion of moral correctness altogether. Thus one group of critics rejects MacIntyre’s Aristotelianism because they hold that any Aristotelian account of the virtues must first account for the truth about virtue in terms of Aristotle’s philosophy of nature, which MacIntyre had dismissed in AV as “metaphysical biology” (AV, pp. 162, 179). Aristotelian metaphysicians, particularly Thomists who define virtue in terms of the perfection of nature, rejected MacIntyre’s contention that an adequate Aristotelian account of virtue as excellence in practical reasoning and human action need not appeal to Aristotelian metaphysics. Another group of critics, including materialists, dismissed MacIntyre’s attempt to recover an Aristotelian account of the virtues because they took those virtues to presuppose an indefensible metaphysical doctrine of nature.

A few years after the publication of AV, MacIntyre became a Thomist and accepted that the teleology of human action flowed from a metaphysical foundation in the nature of the human person (WJWR, ch. 10; AV, 3^rd ed., p. xi). Nonetheless, MacIntyre has the main points of his ethics and politics of human action have remained the same. MacIntyre continues to argue toward an Aristotelian account of practical reasoning through the investigation of practice. Even though he has accepted Thomistic metaphysics, he seldom argues from metaphysical premises, and when pressed to explain the metaphysical foundations of his ethics, he has demurred. MacIntyre continues to argue from the experience of practical reasoning to the demands of moral education. MacIntyre’s work in WJWR, DRA, The Tasks of Philosophy, Ethics and Politics, and God, Philosophy, University continue to exemplify the phenomenological approach to moral education that MacIntyre took in After Virtue.

Contemporary scholars have defended MacIntyre’s unconventional Aristotelianism by challenging the conventions that MacIntyre is said to violate. Christopher Stephen Lutz examined some of the reasons for rejecting “Aristotle’s metaphysical biology” and assessed the compatibility of MacIntyre’s philosophy with that of Thomas Aquinas in Tradition in the Ethics of Alasdair MacIntyre (2004, pp. 133-140). Kelvin Knight took a broader approach in Aristotelian Philosophy: Ethics and Politics from Aristotle to MacIntyre (2007). Knight examined the ethics and politics of human action found in Aristotle and traced the development of that project through medieval and modern thought to MacIntyre. Knight distinguishes Aristotle’s ethics of human action from his metaphysics and shows how it is possible for MacIntyre to retrieve Aristotle’s ethics of human action without first defending Aristotle’s metaphysical account of nature.

b. Two Books on Rationality: WJWR and 3RV

For MacIntyre, “rationality” comprises all the intellectual resources, both formal and substantive, that we use to judge truth and falsity in propositions, and to determine choice-worthiness in courses of action. Rationality in this sense is not universal; it differs from community to community and from person to person, and may both develop and regress over the course of a person’s life or a community’s history. MacIntyre describes this culturally relative, even subjective characteristic of rationality in the first chapter of WJWR (1988):

So rationality itself, whether theoretical or practical, is a concept with a history: indeed, since there are also a diversity of traditions of enquiry, with histories, there are, so it will turn out, rationalities rather than rationality, just as it will also turn out that there are justices rather than justice (WJWR, p. 9).

Rationality is the collection of theories, beliefs, principles, and facts that the human subject uses to judge the world, and a person’s rationality is, to a large extent, the product of that person’s education and moral formation.

To the extent that a person accepts what is handed down from the moral and intellectual traditions of her or his community in learning to judge truth and falsity, good and evil, that person’s rationality is “tradition-constituted.” Tradition-constituted rationality provides the schemata by which we interpret, understand, and judge the world we live in. The apparent reasonableness of mythical explanations, religious doctrines, scientific theories, and the conflicting demands of the world’s moral codes all depend on the tradition-constituted rationalities of those who judge them. For this reason, some of MacIntyre’s critics have argued that tradition-constituted rationality entails an absolute relativism in philosophy.

The apparent problem of relativism in MacIntyre’s theory of rationality is much like the problem of relativism in the philosophy of science. Scientific claims develop within larger theoretical frameworks, so that the apparent truth of a scientific claim depends on one’s judgment of the larger framework. The resolution of the problem of relativism therefore appears to hang on the possibility of judging frameworks or rationalities, or judging between frameworks or rationalities from a position that does not presuppose the truth of the framework or rationality, but no such theoretical standpoint is humanly possible. Nonetheless, MacIntyre finds that the world itself provides the criterion for the testing of rationalities, and he finds that there is no criterion except the world itself that can stand as the measure of the truth of any philosophical theory. So MacIntyre balances the relativity of rationality against the objectivity of the world that we investigate. As Popper and Lakatos found in the philosophy of science, MacIntyre concludes that experience can falsify theory, releasing people from the apparent authority of traditional rationalities.

MacIntyre holds that the rationality of individuals is not only tradition-constituted, it is also tradition constitutive, as individuals make their own contributions to their own rationality, and to the rationalities of their communities. Rationality is not fixed, within either the history of a community or the life of a person. Unexplainable events can occur that reveal shortcomings in a person’s rational resources, like the anomalous data that precipitate scientific revolutions in Thomas Kuhn’s The Structure of Scientific Revolutions or demand changes in research programmes in Imre Lakatos’ The Methodology of Scientific Research Programmes. Problems exposed by anomalous data or by conflicts with other traditions, other communities, or other people may prove rationally insoluble under the constraints that a given tradition places on rationality. Such events, when fully recognized, demand creative solutions, and it may happen that some person or group will discover what appears to be a more adequate response to those problems. To the extent that these new solutions are adopted by others and passed on to subsequent generations (for better or for worse), the rationality of those responsible for the new approach becomes “tradition-constitutive.”

The possibility that experience may falsify theory distinguishes MacIntyre’s theory of tradition-constituted and tradition-constitutive rationality from forms of relativism that make rationality entirely tradition-dependent or entirely subjective. Nonetheless, MacIntyre denies that such falsification is common (WJWR, chs. 18 and 19), and history shows us that individuals, communities, and even whole nations may commit themselves militantly over long periods of their histories to doctrines that their ideological adversaries find irrational. This qualified relativism of appearances has troublesome implications for anyone who believes that philosophical enquiry can easily provide certain knowledge of the world. According to MacIntyre, theories govern the ways that we interpret the world and no theory is ever more than “the best standards so far” (3RV, p. 65). Our theories always remain open to improvement, and when our theories change, the appearances of our world—the apparent truths of claims judged within those theoretical frameworks—change with them.

From the subjective standpoint of the human enquirer, MacIntyre finds that theories, concepts, and facts all have histories, and they are all liable to change—for better or for worse. MacIntyre’s philosophy offers a decisive refutation of modern epistemology, even as it maintains philosophy is a quest for truth. MacIntyre’s philosophy is indebted to the philosophy of science, which recognizes the historicism of scientific enquiry even as it seeks a truthful understanding of the world. MacIntyre’s philosophy does not offer a priori certainty about any theory or principle; it examines the ways in which reflection upon experience supports, challenges, or falsifies theories that have appeared to be the best theories so far to the people who have accepted them so far. MacIntyre’s ideal enquirers remain Hamlets, not Emmas.

i. Whose Justice? Which Rationality?

WJWR presents MacIntyre’s most thorough argument for his theory of rationality. He summarizes the main points of his theory in chapter 1. In chapters 2 through 16, MacIntyre follows the progress of the Western tradition through “three distinct traditions:” from Homer and Aristotle to Thomas Aquinas, from Augustine to Thomas Aquinas and from Augustine through Calvin to Hume (WJWR, p. 326). The inhabitants of these traditions work to deepen, correct, and extend the claims and theories of their predecessors. Chapter 17 examines the modern liberal denial of tradition, and the ironic transformation of liberalism into the fourth tradition to be treated in the book. Chapter 18 reviews MacIntyre’s claims and conclusions concerning the tradition-constituted nature and tradition-constitutive power of human rationality. Chapters 19 and 20 explore the consequences of MacIntyre’s theory for conflicts between traditions.

WJWR fulfills a promise made at the end of AV: “I promised a book in which I should attempt to say both what makes it rational to act in one way rather than another and what makes it rational to advance and defend one conception of practical rationality rather than another. Here it is” (p. 9). To fulfill this promise, MacIntyre opens the book by arguing that “the Enlightenment made us . . . blind to . . . a conception of rational enquiry as embodied in a tradition, a conception according to which the standards of rational justification themselves emerge from and are part of a history.” From the standpoint of human enquiry, no group can arrogate to itself the authority to guide everyone else toward the good. We can only struggle together in our quests for justice and truth and each community consequently frames and revises its own standards of justice and rationality. MacIntyre concludes that neither reason nor justice is universal: “since there are a diversity of traditions of enquiry, with histories, there are, so it will turn out, rationalities rather than rationality, just as it will also turn out that there are justices rather than justice” (p. 9).

The thesis that rationalities and justices arise from the histories and traditions of communities sets MacIntyre squarely at odds with all modern philosophy, and particularly with the unacknowledged imperialism of any form of metaethics that would offer a neutral, third-party forum in which to adjudicate the practical differences between contending moral traditions by the peculiar standards of modern liberal individualism. The same thesis also appears to set MacIntyre at odds with the traditions of Aristotle and Thomas Aquinas—traditions he claims to accept and defend—which make unambiguous claims about the universal nature, true reason, and objective justice. The book therefore has two tasks. On the one hand, the book relates the histories of particular rationalities and justices in a way that undermines the abstract universal notions of reason and justice that provide the foundations for modern moral and political thought. On the other hand, the book provides prima facie evidence

that those who have thought their way through the topics of justice and practical rationality, from the standpoint constructed by and in the direction pointed out first by Aristotle and then by Aquinas, have every reason at least so far to hold that the rationality of their tradition has been confirmed by its encounters with other traditions (p. 403).

In short, the book offers an internal critique of modernity, arguing that it is incoherent by its own standards, and it offers an internal justification of Thomism, holding that Thomism is rationally justified, for Thomists, by Thomist standards. Contrary to initial expectations, MacIntyre’s historicist, particularist critique of modernity is compatible with the historically situated Thomist tradition.

MacIntyre holds that his historicist, particularist critique of modernity is consistent with Thomism because of the way that he understands the acquisition of first principles. In chapter 10 (pp. 164-182), MacIntyre compares Thomas Aquinas’s account of the acquisition of first principles with those of Descartes, Hobbes, Hume, Bentham, and Kant. MacIntyre explains that according to Thomas Aquinas, individuals reach first principles through “a work of dialectical construction” (p. 174). For Thomas Aquinas, by questioning and examining one’s experience, one may eventually arrive at first principles, which one may then apply to the understanding of one’s questions and experience. Descartes and his successors, by contrast, along with certain “notable Thomists of the last hundred years” (p. 175), have proposed that philosophy begins from knowledge of some “set of necessarily true first principles which any truly rational person is able to evaluate as true” (p. 175). Thus for the moderns, philosophy is a technical rather than moral endeavor, while for the Thomist, whether one might recognize first principles or be able to apply them depends in part on one’s moral development (pp. 186-182).

The modern account of first principles justifies an approach to philosophy that rejects tradition. The modern liberal individualist approach is anti-traditional. It denies that our understanding is tradition-constituted and it denies that different cultures may differ in their standards of rationality and justice:

The standpoint of traditions is necessarily at odds with one of the central characteristics of cosmopolitan modernity: the confident belief that all cultural phenomena must be potentially translucent to understanding, that all texts must be capable of being translated into the language which the adherents of modernity speak to one another (p. 327)

Modernity does not see tradition as the key that unlocks moral and political understanding, but as a superfluous accumulation of opinions that tend to prejudice moral and political reasoning.

Although modernity rejects tradition as a method of moral and political enquiry, MacIntyre finds that it nevertheless bears all the characteristics of a moral and political tradition. MacIntyre identifies the peculiar standards of the liberal tradition in the latter part of chapter 17, and summarizes the story of the liberal tradition at the outset of chapter 18:

Liberalism, beginning as a repudiation of tradition in the name of abstract, universal principles of reason, turned itself into a politically embodied power, whose inability to bring its debates on the nature and context of those universal principles to a conclusion has had the unintended effect of transforming liberalism into a tradition (p. 349).

From MacIntyre’s perspective, there is no question of deciding whether or not to work within a tradition; everyone who struggles with practical, moral, and political questions simply does. “There is no standing ground, no place for enquiry . . . apart from that which is provided by some particular tradition or other” (p. 350). MacIntyre calls his position “the rationality of traditions.”

MacIntyre distinguishes two related challenges to his position, the “relativist challenge” and the “perspectivist challenge.” These two challenges both acknowledge that the goals of the Enlightenment cannot be met and that, “the only available standards of rationality are those made available by and within traditions” (p. 252); they conclude that nothing can be known to be true or false. For these post-modern theorists, “if the Enlightenment conceptions of truth and rationality cannot be sustained,” either relativism or perspectivism “is the only possible alternative” (p. 353). MacIntyre rejects both challenges by developing his theory of tradition-constituted and tradition-constitutive rationality on pp. 354-369.

How, then, is one to settle challenges between two traditions? It depends on whether the adherents of either take the challenges of the other tradition seriously. It depends on whether the adherents of either tradition, on seeing a failure in their own tradition are willing to consider an answer offered by their rival (p. 355). There is nothing in MacIntyre’s account of the rationality of traditions that suggest that the superior traditions will vanquish inferior ones, or to provide any analogue to the modern, enlightenment, or Cartesian epistemological first principles that he rejected in his critique of the modern liberal individualist tradition.

MacIntyre emphasizes the role of tradition in the final chapter of the book by asking how a person with no traditional affiliation is to deal with the conflicting claims of rival traditions: “The initial answer is: that will depend upon who you are and how you understand yourself. This is not the kind of answer which we have been educated to expect in philosophy” (p. 393). Such a person might, through some process of reflection on experience and engagement with the claims of one tradition or another, join a tradition whose claims and standards appear compelling, but there is no guarantee of that. MacIntyre’s conclusion is that enquiry is situated within traditions.

WJWR is more than a restatement of the history from AV. AV had argued that an Aristotelian view of moral philosophy as a study of human action could make sense of the failure of modern moral philosophy while modern liberal individualism could not. Aristotelian and Thomist critics complained, however, that MacIntyre’s Aristotelianism, which sought its foundation in teleological activity rather than teleological metaphysics, remained open to the challenge that it was relativistic. WJWR advances the argument of AV in two ways. First, MacIntyre focuses the critique of modernity on the question of rational justification. Modern epistemology stands or falls on the possibility of Cartesian epistemological first principles. MacIntyre’s history exposes that notion of first principle as a fiction, and at the same time demonstrates that rational enquiry advances (or declines) only through tradition. Second, MacIntyre trades the social teleology of AV for a Thomist, metaphysical teleology. MacIntyre justifies this trade in terms acceptable within the Thomist tradition, and acknowledges that those who find Thomism irrational will find little reason to accept it (WJWR P. 403). This general conclusion remained troubling for Aristotelians, and particularly for those Neo-Thomists whose Neo-Scholastic tradition bore debts to the Cartesian tradition.

ii. Three Rival Versions of Moral Enquiry

MacIntyre presented his theory of rationality again in his 1988 Gifford Lectures, published as Three Rival Versions of Moral Enquiry (1990). The central idea of the Gifford Lectures is that philosophers make progress by addressing the shortcomings of traditional narratives about the world, shortcomings that become visible either through the failure of traditional narratives to make sense of experience, or through the introduction of contradictory narratives that prove impossible to dismiss. This vision of progress in philosophy is the same as that of EC, and WJWR, but the presentation is different. In this book, MacIntyre compares three traditions exemplified by three literary works published near the end of Adam Gifford’s life (1820–1887); a bequest of Lord Gifford’s will funds the Gifford Lectures. The Ninth Edition of the Encyclopaedia Britannica (1875–1889) represents the modern tradition of trying to understand the world objectively without the influence of tradition. The Genealogy of Morals (1887), by Friedrich Nietzsche embodies the post-modern tradition of interpreting all traditions as arbitrary impositions of power. The encyclical letter Aeterni Patris (1879) of Pope Leo XIII exemplifies the approach of acknowledging one’s predecessors within one’s own tradition of enquiry and working to advance or improve that tradition in the pursuit of objective truth. Of the three versions of moral enquiry treated in 3RV, only tradition, exemplified in 3RV by the Aristotelian, Thomistic tradition, understands itself as a tradition that looks backward to predecessors in order to understand present questions and move forward. Encyclopaedia, concerns itself only with present facts, and leaves the problems of intellectual history to others. Genealogy defends an historicist interpretation of the past to undermine what it takes to be irrational moral convictions in the present. MacIntyre argues that Encyclopaedists and Genealogists deceive themselves in their rejections of the method of tradition.

Encyclopaedia obscures the role of tradition by presenting the most current conclusions and convictions of a tradition as if they had no history, and as if they represented the final discovery of unalterable truth. In this sense, Encyclopaedia represents the epistemological “Emmas” of MacIntyre’s 1977 essay, EC. Encyclopaedists focus on the present and ignore the past.

Genealogists, on the other hand, focus on the past in order to undermine the claims of the present. The “Nietzschean research program” has three uses for history: (1) to reduce academic history to a projection of the concerns of modern historians, (2) to dissipate the identity of the historian into a collection of inherited cultural influences, and (3) to undermine the notion of “progress towards truth and reason” (3RV, pp. 49-50). In short, Genealogy denies the teleology of human enquiry by denying (1) that historical enquiry has been fruitful, (2) that the enquiring person has a real identity, and (3) that enquiry has a real goal. MacIntyre finds this mode of enquiry incoherent.

To provide an example of the incoherence of the Genealogical mode of enquiry MacIntyre turns to Foucault and begins by describing the “self-endangering paradox” Foucault—or anyone who would maintain and extend the Nietzschean research program—must face: “the insights conferred by this post-Nietzschean understanding of the uses of history are themselves liable to subvert the project of understanding the project” (3RV, p. 50). MacIntyre argues against each of the three Nietzschean uses of history, beginning with the denial of the fruitfulness of the study.

MacIntyre cites Foucault’s 1966 book, Les Mots et les choses (The Order of Things, 1970) as an example of the self-subverting character of Genealogical enquiry. Foucault’s book reduces history to a procession of “incommensurable ordered schemes of classification and representation” none of which has any greater claim to truth than any other, yet this book “is itself organized as a scheme of classification and representation.” In the light of its own account of history, it seems difficult to justify the claims of the book rationally. If historical narratives are only projections of the interests of historians, then it is difficult to see how this historical narrative can claim to be truthful.

Genealogical moral enquiry cannot make sense of its own claims without exempting those claims from its general critique of similar claims. Genealogical moral enquiry must make similar exceptions to its treatments of the unity of the enquiring subject and the teleology of moral enquiry; thus “it seems to be the case that the intelligibility of genealogy requires beliefs and allegiances of a kind precluded by the genealogical stance” (3RV, p. 54-55). Genealogy is self-deceiving insofar as it ignores the traditional and teleological character of its enquiry.

3RV uses Thomism as its example of tradition, but this use should not suggest that MacIntyre identifies “tradition” with Thomism or Thomism-as-a-name-for-the-Western-tradition. As noted above, WJWR distinguished four traditions of enquiry within the Western European world alone (WJWR, p. 349). MacIntyre uses Thomism because it applies the traditional mode of enquiry in a self-conscious manner. Thomistic students learn the work of philosophical enquiry as apprentices in a craft (3RV, p. 61), and maintain the principles of the tradition in their work to extend the understanding of the tradition, even as they remain open to the criticism of those principles.

Tradition differs from both encyclopaedia and genealogy in the way it understands the place of its theories in the history of human enquiry. The adherent of a tradition must understand that “the rationality of a craft is justified by its history so far,” thus it “is inseparable from the tradition through which it was achieved” (3RV, p. 65). To justify the claims of a tradition is to recount how the tradition has developed and understood those claims so far. To master a tradition is also “a matter of knowing how to go further, and especially how to direct others towards going further, using what can be learned from the tradition afforded by the past to move towards the telos of fully perfected work” (3RV, pp. 65-66). Tradition is not merely conservative; it remains open to improvement, and in the 1977 essay EC, it is Hamlet, not Emma, who exemplifies the traditional mode of enquiry.

MacIntyre’s emphasis on the temporality of rationality in traditional enquiry makes tradition incompatible with the epistemological projects of modern philosophy (3RV, pp. 69).

MacIntyre uses Thomas Aquinas to illustrate the revolutionary potential of traditional enquiry. Thomas was educated in Augustinian theology and Aristotelian philosophy, and through this education he began to see not only the contradictions between the two traditions, but also the strengths and weaknesses that each tradition revealed in the other. His education also helped him to discover a host of questions and problems that had to be answered and solved. Many of Thomas Aquinas’ responses to these concerns took the form of disputed questions. “Yet to each question the answer produced by Aquinas as a conclusion is no more than and, given Aquinas’s method, cannot but be no more than, the best answer reached so far. And hence derives the essential incompleteness” (3RV, p. 124). Thomas Aquinas, viewed as practicing the traditional mode of enquiry, is one influential practitioner within a tradition and his writings are contributions to that tradition, rather than collections of unassailable final conclusions. MacIntyre’s Thomistic responses to encyclopedia and genealogy in chapters eight and nine show that MacIntyre does not view the Thomistic tradition in particular, or the traditional mode of enquiry in general, as closed, static, or essentially conservative.

c. Dependent Rational Animals

MacIntyre’s Carus Lectures, Dependent Rational Animals: Why Human Beings Need the Virtues (1999), put MacIntyre’s theory of rationality into practice to examine the conditions of human action and to argue that the virtues are essential to the practice of independent practical reason. The book is relentlessly practical; its arguments appeal only to experience and to purposes, and to the logic of practical reasoning.

DRA does not make metaphysical assertions about the human soul, or human dignity, or human rights, or natural law; it treats the human agent as an animal. “Human identity is primarily . . . bodily and therefore animal identity and it is by reference to that identity that the continuities of our relationships to others are partly defined” (DRA, p. 8). Like other intelligent animals, human beings enter life vulnerable, weak, untrained, and unknowing, and face the likelihood of infirmity in sickness and in old age. Like other social animals, humans flourish in groups. We learn to regulate our passions, and to act effectively alone and in concert with others through an education provided within a community. MacIntyre’s position allows him to look to the animal world to find analogies to the role of social relationships in the moral formation of human beings (DRA, pp. 21-28).

In chapter 8, MacIntyre turns to the moral development of the human agent. The task for the human child is to make “the transition from the infantile exercise of animal intelligence to the exercise of independent practical reasoning” (DRA, p. 87). For a child to make this transition is “to redirect and transform her or his desires, and subsequently to direct them consistently towards the goods of different stages of her or his life” (DRA, p. 87). The development of independent practical reason in the human agent requires the moral virtues in at least three ways.

As in his earlier writings, including his MA thesis, DRA presents moral knowledge as a “knowing how,” rather than as a “knowing that.” Knowledge of moral rules is not sufficient for a moral life; prudence is required to enable the agent to apply the rules well. “Knowing how to act virtuously always involves more than rule-following” (DRA, p. 93). The prudent person can judge what must be done in the absence of a rule and can also judge when general norms cannot be applied to particular cases.

Flourishing as an independent practical reasoner requires the virtues in a second way, simply because sometimes we need our friends to tell us who we really are. Independent practical reasoning also requires self-knowledge, but self-knowledge is impossible without the input of others whose judgment provides a reliable touchstone to test our beliefs about ourselves. Self-knowledge therefore requires the virtues that enable an agent to sustain formative relationships and to accept the criticism of trusted friends (DRA, p. 97).

Human flourishing requires the virtues in a third way, by making it possible to participate in social and political action. They enable us to “protect ourselves and others against neglect, defective sympathies, stupidity, acquisitiveness, and malice” (DRA, p. 98) by enabling us to form and sustain social relationships through which we may care for one another in our infirmities, and pursue common goods with and for the other members of our societies.

The book moves from MacIntyre’s assessment of human needs for the virtues to the political implications of that assessment. Social and political institutions that form and enable independent practical reasoning must “satisfy three conditions.” (1) They must enable their members to participate in shared deliberations about the communities’ actions. (2) They must establish norms of justice “consistent with exercise of” the virtue of justice. (3) They must enable the strong “to stand proxy” as advocates for the needs of the weak and the disabled.

The social and political institutions that MacIntyre recommends cannot be identified with the modern nation state or the modern nuclear family. Modern nation states, which MacIntyre characterizes as “giant utility companies” (DRA, p. 132) are organized to provide services, not to pursue a common good. The nuclear family is too small to allow the self-sufficiency required for the political community that pursues a common good (DRA, p. 133-5). The political structures necessary for human flourishing are essentially local. MacIntyre says, “It is . . . a mistake, the communitarian mistake, to attempt to infuse the politics of the state with the values and modes of participation in local community” (DRA, p. 142). Yet local communities support human flourishing only when they actively support “the virtues of just generosity and shared deliberation” (DRA, p. 142). To find examples of the kinds of local communities that support human flourishing, MacIntyre suggests investigations of “fishing communities in New England . . . Welsh mining communities . . . farming cooperatives in Donegal, Mayan towns in Guatemala and Mexico”( DRA, p. 143).

Coming to the conclusion that moral knowledge and understanding develops within, and is partly constituted by social relationships within particular local communities that require their members to commit themselves to the moral narratives and norms of those communities, MacIntyre finds himself compelled to answer what may be called the question of moral provincialism: If one is to seek the truth about morality and justice, it seems necessary to “find a standpoint that is sufficiently external to the evaluative attitudes and practices that are to be put to the question.” If it is impossible for the agent to take such an external standpoint, if the agent’s commitments preclude radical criticism of the virtues of the community, does that leave the agent “a prisoner of shared prejudices” (DRA, p. 154)?

In the final chapter of DRA, MacIntyre argues that it is impossible to find an external standpoint, because rational enquiry is an essentially social work (DRA, p. 156-7). Because it is social, shared rational enquiry requires moral commitment to, and practice of, the virtues to prevent the more complacent members of communities from closing off critical reflection upon “shared politically effective beliefs and concepts” (DRA, p. 161). “Moral commitment to these virtues and to the common good is not an external constraint upon, but a condition of enquiry and criticism” (DRA, p. 162). MacIntyre contrasts this account of social rational enquiry rooted in moral commitment to the standards of a community against Nietzsche’s notion of independence. In the light of the whole argument of DRA, MacIntyre’s conclusion shows, much more clearly than his remarks at the end of AV, why Nietzsche’s ideal of independence provides a poor model and a misleading guide for human flourishing.

d. The Tasks of Philosophy: Selected Essays, Volume 1

In 2006, MacIntyre published two new collections of selected essays. Both volumes include valuable prefaces discussing the origin, importance, and intentions of each of the essays. The first volume, The Tasks of Philosophy, addresses the goals and methods of philosophical enquiry. It opens with EC, and MacIntyre’s remarks in the preface confirm the essay’s place as the starting point of MacIntyre’s mature work. Five more essays in the first part of the book explore the role of culture in our experience of the world, the problem of relativism, the mistake of ignoring the role of history and personal freedom in the development of individual character, the unity of the human person as an embodied mind, and the failure of modern moral philosophy.

The second part of The Tasks of Philosophy, “The Ends of Philosophical Enquiry” discusses the pursuit of truth. Chapter 7, “The Ends of Life, the Ends of Philosophical Writing,” treats philosophy as a professionalized outgrowth of the natural work of plain persons who struggle with ordinary questions about what it means to live well, or how laws have authority, or whether death has meaning (Tasks, p. 125). The literature of philosophy addresses questions like these, but whether philosophy can be fruitful for its reader depends on whether philosophers also engage those questions, or set the questions aside to focus on the literature of philosophy instead.

MacIntyre credits John Stuart Mill and Thomas Aquinas as “two philosophers of the kind who by their writing send us beyond philosophy into immediate encounter with the ends of life” (Tasks, p. 128). From their example, MacIntyre identifies three characteristics of good philosophical writing.

First, both were engaged by questions about the ends of life as questioning human beings and not just as philosophers. . . . Secondly, both Mill and Aquinas understood their speaking and writing as contributing to an ongoing philosophical conversation. . . . Thirdly, it matters that both the end of the conversation and the good of those who participate in it is truth and that the nature of truth, of good, of rational justification, and of meaning therefore have to be central topics of that conversation (Tasks, pp. 130-1).

Without these three characteristics, philosophy is first reduced to “the exercise of a set of analytic and argumentative skills. . . . Secondly, philosophy may thereby become a diversion from asking questions about the ends of life with any seriousness” (Tasks, p. 131). Third, philosophers’ serious professional enquiries into the writings of other philosophers regarding answers to the questions about the ends of human life may divert their attention completely from those same questions in their own lives.

MacIntyre illustrates this problem by reviewing the responses of Franz Rosenzweig and Georg Lukács to the decline of German NeoKantianism in the early twentieth century. Both Rosenzweig and Lukács abandoned the philosophical orthodoxy into which they had been educated, and in both cases, their abandonment of ideological NeoKantianism marked the beginning of their pursuit of the true ends of philosophy. Rosenzweig’s pursuit of the true ends of philosophy led to “dialogue without theorizing,” while Lukács’s work collapsed into Stalinist “theorizing without dialogue” (Tasks, p. 139). Neither Rosenzweig nor Lukács made philosophical progress because both failed to relate “their questions about the ends of life to the ends of their philosophical writing” (Tasks, p. 139).

To avoid the mistakes of Rosenzweig and Lukács, MacIntyre counsels his readers to remain attached to the questions that philosophy attempts to answer, so that their “beliefs about the ends of life” do not become “detached from the questions to which they are the answer” (Tasks, p. 139). MacIntyre’s recognition of the connection between an author’s pursuit of the ends of life and the same author’s work as a philosophical writer prompts him to finish the essay by demanding three things of philosophical historians and biographers. First, any adequate philosophical history or biography must determine whether the authors studied remain engaged with the questions that philosophy studies, or set the questions aside in favor of the answers. Second, any adequate philosophical history or biography must determine whether the authors studied insulated themselves from contact with conflicting worldviews or remained open to learning from every available philosophical approach. Third, any adequate philosophical history or biography must place the authors studied into a broader context that shows what traditions they come from and “whose projects” they are “carrying forward” (Tasks, p. 142).

Philosophy is not just a study; it is a practice. Excellence in this practice demands that an author bring her or his struggles with the questions of the ends of philosophy into dialogue with historic and contemporary texts and authors in the hope of making progress in answering those questions.

The three essays that complete the volume underscore the challenge MacIntyre gives at the end of “The Ends of Life and the Ends of Philosophical Writing.” These three essays approach the work of philosophy from the perspective of Thomism. Thomism, caricatured in one way by its twentieth-century promoters through deficient textbooks, misguided ideological projects, and abuse in Church politics, and in another by its detractors as an atavistic attachment to an obsolete worldview, has been increasingly marginalized since the 1960s. The three Thomistic essays in this book challenge those caricatures by presenting Thomism in a way that people outside of contemporary Thomistic scholarship may find surprisingly flexible and open; for MacIntyre’s Thomas Aquinas is caught up in the difficulties of the questions of the ends of philosophy no less than MacIntyre and other contemporary philosophers. All three essays return to the notion of enquiry as action. Setting aside the epistemological fictions that modern philosophers, including NeoThomists, had invented in a misguided effort to counter skepticism, MacIntyre defends Thomistic realism as rational enquiry directed to the discovery of truth.

e. Ethics and Politics: Selected Essays, Volume 2

Ethics and Politics (Hereafter E&P) is divided into three parts: “Learning from Aristotle and Aquinas,” “Ethics,” and “The Politics of Ethics.” Essays in the first part compare and contrast Aristotle’s philosophy with some renaissance and modern interpretations of it, examine the political context of Thomas Aquinas’s work on the natural law, and defend Thomas’s natural law theory through a critique of moral epistemology. Essays in the second part investigate the apparent problems of moral dilemmas and the real difficulties of determining whether and when it may be more reasonable to deceive or to lie than to tell the truth. Essays in the third part address the ways that rational enquiry can inform social life.

Two of the essays in the third part of E&P are particularly important to the development of MacIntyre’s thought. “Three Perspectives on Marxism” is the preface to the 1995 edition of M&C. The essay assesses both MI (1953) and M&C (1968), along with the economic and political conditions of 1995, and helps to map the consistency of his positions through nearly forty years of development.

“Social Structures and Their Threats to Moral Agency” expands and develops on the theme of compartmentalization that MacIntyre touched upon in AV (AV, p. 204). The essay examines social structures that encourage compartmentalization of one’s life and thus threaten the human agent’s capacity to recognize, judge, and do what is good and best for her- or himself, as a member of a larger community. MacIntyre considers “the case of J” (J, for jemand, the German word for “someone”), a train controller who learned, as a standard for his social role, to take no interest in what his trains carried, even during war time when they carried “munitions and . . . Jews on their way to extermination camps” (E&P, p. 187). J had learned to do his work for the railroad according to one set of standards and to live other parts of his life according to other standards, so that this compliant participant in “the final solution” could contend, “You cannot charge me with moral failure” (E&P, p. 187).

MacIntyre does not accept J’s relativist defense. J’s moral failure has nothing to do with his conscientious obedience to cultural standards; it stems from his failure to stand up as a moral agent. MacIntyre lists three characteristics of the self understanding of a moral agent. To be a moral agent, (1) one must understand one’s individual identity as transcending all the roles that one fills; (2) one must see oneself as a practically rational individual who can judge and reject unjust social standards; and (3) one must understand oneself as “as accountable to others in respect of the human virtues and not just in respect of [one’s] role-performances” (E&P, p. 196). J is guilty, not because he knowingly participated in the final solution; MacIntyre allows that J knew nothing about it and that his claim of innocence was sincere. J is guilty because he complacently accepted social structures that he should have questioned, structures that undermined his moral agency. This essay shows that MacIntyre’s ethics of human agency is not just a descriptive narrative about the manner of moral education; it is a standard laden account of the demands of moral agency.

f. God, Philosophy, Universities

God, Philosophy, Universities looks at the history of the Catholic philosophical tradition through its sources, its initial development through Thomas Aquinas, its decline into a silence that lasted from 1700 to 1850, its renewal in response to Pope Leo XIII’s encyclical letter Aeterni Patris (1879) and its redevelopment in the twentieth century. This history returns to AV’s account of the relationships between practices and institutions, for the different parts of this history are marked by varying relationships between the practice of philosophy within the Catholic Church and the political, ecclesial, and academic institutions that have supported it. The Catholic practice of philosophy was left moribund when its practitioners bowed to institutional pressures in the transition from late medieval to early modern philosophy (God, Philosophy, Universities, p. 106). But this practice was resuscitated by the authority of the Church in 1879 when Leo XIII promulgated the encyclical Aeterni Patris. MacIntyre credits Pope John Paul II for redefining the Catholic intellectual tradition and its relationship to the teaching authority of the Catholic Church in the 1998 encyclical letter Fides et Ratio, and he recommends new research programs to help the Catholic intellectual tradition to make progress in the future.

5. The Main Themes of MacIntyre’s Philosophy

a. The Ethics and Politics of Human Agency

What emerges from MacIntyre’s work is an ethics of human agency, in contrast to modern moral normative ethics and metaethics. The best summary of MacIntyre’s ethics of human agency is found in Kelvin Knight’s Aristotelian Philosophy: Ethics and Politics from Aristotle to MacIntyre (Polity Press, 2007).

The epistemological theories of Modern moral philosophy were supposed to provide rational justification for rules, policies, and practical determinations according to abstract universal standards, but MacIntyre has dismissed those theories, not only in AV, but in every major publication of his career. Modern metaethics is supposed to enable its practitioners to step away from the conflicting demands of contending moral traditions and to judge those conflicts from a neutral position, but MacIntyre has rejected this project as well. In his ethical writings, MacIntyre seeks only to understand how to liberate the human agent from blindness and stupidity, to prepare the human agent to recognize what is good and best to do in the concrete circumstances of that agent’s own life, and to strengthen the agent to follow through on that judgment. In his political writings, MacIntyre investigates the role of communities in the formation of effective rational agents, and the impact of political institutions on the lives of communities. This kind of ethics and politics is appropriately named the ethics of human agency.

MacIntyre is sometimes categorized as a “virtue ethicist,” and AV is counted among the principle texts in virtue ethics, but this label may be misleading for MacIntyre. Virtue ethics developed as an alternative to modern moral theories. The purpose of the modern moral philosophy of authors like Kant and Mill was to determine, rationally and universally, what kinds of behavior ought to be performed—not in terms of the agent’s desires or goals, but in terms of universal, rational duties. Those theories purported to let agents know what they ought to do by providing knowledge of duties and obligations, thus they could be described as theories of moral epistemology.

Contemporary virtue ethics proposes an alternative to modern moral theory, but takes for granted that the purpose of ethics is to provide a moral epistemology. Contemporary virtue ethics purports to let agents know what qualities human beings ought to have, and the reasons that we ought to have them, not in terms of our fitness for human agency, but in the same universal, disinterested, non-teleological terms that it inherits from Kant and Mill. MacIntyre’s ethical project examines the virtues, but it is not a branch of moral epistemology.

For MacIntyre, moral knowledge remains a “knowing how” rather than a “knowing that;” MacIntyre seeks to identify those moral and intellectual excellences that make human beings more effective in our pursuit of the human good. MacIntyre’s purpose in his ethics of human agency is to consider what it means to seek one’s good, what it takes to pursue one’s good, and what kind of a person one must become if one wants to pursue that good effectively as a human agent. As a philosophy of human agency, MacIntyre’s work belongs to the traditions of Aristotle and Thomas Aquinas.

Teleology and Metaphysics: From the beginning of his career, MacIntyre has pursued teleological practical reasoning, rather than utilitarian or deontological moral reasoning. The Project proposed in “Notes from the Moral Wilderness” is a teleological project. “Freedom and Revolution” and “Can Medicine Dispense with a Theological Perspective on Human Nature?” are likewise teleological. AV criticized Christian voluntarism and divine command theory because it rejected teleological practical reasoning and adopted an arbitrary, legal model of moral reasoning. AV criticized modernity for secularizing the arbitrary, legalistic moral reasoning of Christian voluntarism.

The purpose of the constructive argument of the second half of AV is to renew teleological practical reasoning, but MacIntyre attempted to renew Aristotelian teleology while rejecting Aristotelian metaphysics. The teleology of AV, like the teleology of MacIntyre’s broader project since “Notes from the Moral Wilderness,” was to be a social teleology, discovered through reflection on experience. The social teleology appeared to have two advantages. First, it forestalled a host of objections that MacIntyre was involved in an arbitrary, atavistic project to return, whole cloth, to the world view of Aristotle including his views on the subjugation of women and “natural slaves.” Second, in keeping with the insight of Marx’s third thesis on Feuerbach, it maintained the common condition of theorists and people as peers in the pursuit of the good life.

MacIntyre grew to reconsider the adequacy of social teleology in the years following AV. In the Prologue to the 3^rd edition (2007), MacIntyre reported that he had accepted from Thomas Aquinas that it was necessary to provide a metaphysical grounding for the social teleology:

It is only because human beings have an end toward which they are directed by reason of their specific nature, that practices, traditions, and the like are able to function as they do. So I discovered that I had, without realizing it, presupposed the truth of something very close to the account of the concept of good that Aquinas gives in question 5 of the first part of the Summa Theologiae (p. xi).

In MacIntyre’s subsequent Thomist works, principally WJWR (chapters 10 & 11), 3RV (chapters 5 & 6), his Aquinas Lecture, First Principles, Final Ends, and Contemporary Philosophical Issues, and “On Being a Theistic Philosopher in a Secularized Culture,” MacIntyre explicitly defends a metaphysical foundation for teleology.

In his ethical work, MacIntyre’s nonetheless continues to approach teleology primarily by examining the phenomena by which metaphysical nature manifests itself. DRA is a thoroughly Thomistic work, yet it is relentlessly practical in its argumentation. The book invites its readers to join that work of dialectical construction that might lead them to first principles. DRA does not assert the demands of substantive metaphysics; it invites its readers to discover them, whether they recognize them as such or not.

MacIntyre illustrates the need for a phenomenological approach to teleology in his two lectures on “Rival Aristotles” (in E&P, chapters 1 & 2). In these two lectures, MacIntyre examines two kinds of errors that Aristotle’s interpreters have made regarding knowledge of the human telos, and the role of that knowledge in practical reasoning. Certain renaissance Aristotelians, including Francesco Piccolomini, overstated the role of theoretical knowledge of the human good in practical reasoning (E&P, p. 14), and understated the place of character in Aristotle’s ethics. Certain contemporary Aristotelians, including Sarah Brodie, go to the opposite extreme, denying the need for knowledge of the good. MacIntyre avoids both misinterpretations. He holds that the human good plays a role in our practical reasoning whether we recognize it or not, so that some people may do well without understanding why (E&P, p. 25). He also reads Aristotle as teaching that knowledge of the good can make us better agents (E&P, p. 26).

b. Ethics and Politics

In the closely connected studies of ethics and politics, MacIntyre’s work is Aristotelian in the sense that it is a study of human action, the goals of human action, and the moral conditions that enable or hinder an agent’s recognition and pursuit of what is good and best. In keeping with his general approach to philosophy, however, MacIntyre’s Aristotelianism is phenomenological and historicist. AV does not define virtue in metaphysical terms as the perfection of nature (AV, pp. 148, 196). AV defines virtue in terms of the practical requirements for excellence in human agency, in an agent’s participation in practices (AV, ch. 14), in an agent’s whole life, and in an agent’s involvement in the life of her or his community (AV, chapter 15). This peculiar form of Aristotelianism, which MacIntyre described in the “Postscript to the 2^nd ed.” of AV as “an historicist defense of Aristotle” (AV, p. 277), remains controversial among Aristotelian and Thomistic metaphysicians.

MacIntyre’s Aristotelian concept of “human action” opposes the notion of “human behavior” that prevailed among mid-twentieth-century determinist social scientists. Human actions, as MacIntyre understands them, are acts freely chosen by human agents in order to accomplish goals that those agents pursue. Human behavior, according to mid-twentieth-century determinist social scientists, is the outward activity of a subject, which is said to be caused entirely by environmental influences beyond the control of the subject. Rejecting crude determinism in social science, and approaches to government and public policy rooted in determinism, MacIntyre sees the renewal of human agency and the liberation of the human agent as central goals for ethics and politics.

As an account of human action, MacIntyre’s projects in ethics and politics continue to pursue the goals of early Marxists, who had sought to reverse the processes of individualization and proletarianization that had undermined the solidarity and self-determination of workers during the industrial revolution. William Cobbett emerges as a Quixotic hero in AV because of his opposition to the dividing and conquering influences of individualism and industrialization.

MacIntyre’s Aristotelian account of “human action” examines the habits that an agent must develop in order to judge and act most effectively in the pursuit of truly choice-worthy ends. This examination demands a rich account of deliberate human activity encompassing moral formation and community life. Where modern moral philosophy seeks rational moral criteria to judge individual human acts without considering the subjective ends of the agent, MacIntyre seeks to understand what it takes for the human person to become the kind of agent who has the practical wisdom to recognize what is good and best to do and the moral freedom to act on her or his best judgment. In this way, MacIntyre’s Aristotelian account of human action opposes the late medieval and modern reduction of ethics to the moral assessment of behavior.

MacIntyre rejected the determinism of modern social science early in his career (“Determinism,” 1957), yet he recognizes that the ability to judge well and act freely is not simply given; excellence in judgment and action must be developed, and it is the task of moral philosophy to discover how these excellences or virtues of the human agent are established, maintained, and strengthened. In this sense, MacIntyre’s ethics and politics continues the project of Aristotle, who wrote, “Neither by nature nor contrary to nature do the virtues arise in us; rather we are adapted by nature to receive them, and are made perfect by habit” (Nicomachean Ethics, 2.1 [1103a 23–25], trans. Ross).

MacIntyre’s Aristotelian philosophy investigates the conditions that support free and deliberate human action in order to propose a path to the liberation of the human agent through participation in the life of a political community that seeks its common goods through the shared deliberation and action of its members (DRA, ch. 8).

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Works

MacIntyre, Alasdair. Marxism: An Interpretation. London: SCM Press, 1953.
- Alasdair MacIntyre’s first published work argues for Marxist ethics and politics, criticizes Marxist social science, and defends Christian moral teaching that criticizes unjust social structures and encourages human agency.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Visions.” In New Essays in Philosophical Theology. Ed. Antony Flew and Alasdair MacIntyre. New York: Macmillan, 1955.
- This is an example of MacIntyre’s Barthian-Wittgenstinian fideist philosophy of religion.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Manchester: The Modern Universities and the English Tradition,” Twentieth Century, 159 (Feb. 1956): 123-9.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “The Logical Status of Religious Belief.” In Metaphysical Beliefs: Three Essays, by Stephen Toulman, Ronald W. Hepburn, and Alasdair C. MacIntyre. London: SCM Press, 1957. Reprinted with new preface, 1970. pp. 159–201.
- This essay argues from the perspective of MacIntyre’s Barthian-Wittgenstinian fideist philosophy of religion that it is impossible to justify religious belief rationally. MacIntyre’s preface to the 1970 edition of the book condemns the essay’s “irrationalism as both false and dangerous.”
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Determinism” Mind, 66 (1957): 28-41.
- This article criticizes determinism in the social sciences.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Notes from the Moral Wilderness” I and II, New Reasoner 7 (Winter 1958–1959): 90–100; and New Reasoner 8 (Spring 1959): 89–98. Reprinted in The MacIntyre Reader, pp. 31-49 and in Alasdair MacIntyre’s Engagement with Marxism, pp. 45-68.
- These essays are nearly indispensable summaries of the difficulties and goals of the Marxist ethical project that would lead to AV. MacIntyre asks, what rational justification can one give for the moral critique of Stalinism. He asks how we may develop an ethics that treats moral action and moral reasoning as human action and practical reasoning.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. Difficulties in Christian Belief. London: SCM Press, 1959.
- This small book discusses the problem of evil and other difficulties in Christian belief from the perspective of MacIntyre’s Barthian-Wittgenstinian fideist philosophy of religion.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. A Short History of Ethics: A History of Moral Philosophy from the Homeric Age to Twentieth Century. New York: Macmillan, 1966. Repr. New York: Touchstone, 1996.
- This historicist account of morality and human agency through the history of the Western tradition lays out some of the elements of the histories that would follow in AV and WJWR but it lacks the Aristotelian teleology and virtue that define MacIntyre’s mature work.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “The Debate about God: Victorian Relevance and Contemporary Irrelevance.” In Alasdair MacIntyre and Paul Ricoeur, The Religious Significance of Atheism (Bampton Lectures in America delivered at Columbia University, 1966). New York: Columbia University Press, 1969. pp. 1–55.
- In two lectures, MacIntyre describes Theism from the perspective of atheism. The first lecture discusses the struggle between Theism and the secular intellectual culture and the choices Theists made between a self-conscious cultural atavism that is irrelevant to secular culture and deistic forms of theism that become palatable to secular culture at the price of becoming empty. The second lecture discusses factors that have undermined the relationship between social life and morality in contemporary theistic morality.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. Marxism and Christianity. New York: Schocken Books, 1968. Republished, University of Notre Dame Press, 1984. Revised edition with new Introduction, London: Duckworth, 1995.
- In 1968, MacIntyre significantly revised Marxism: An Interpretation to reflect developments in his understanding of Marxism and of the role of Friedrich Engels in Marx’s move toward predictive social science. The Introduction to the 1995 edition, which is reprinted in Ethics and Politics, helps to explain the purpose of the book and its relationship to his mature work.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. Against the Self-Images of the Age: Essays on Ideology and Philosophy. London: Duckworth; New York: Schocken Books, 1971. Republished, Uniersity of Notre Dame Press, 1978.
- This collection of essays, including journal articles published as early as 1957, is divided into two parts. The first part criticizes Marxist literature and political practice. The second part criticizes modern liberal individualist ethics and politics. This book contains many of the components of AV, but lacks the Aristotelian theory that unifies AV.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Can Medicine Dispense with a Theological Perspective on Human Nature?” In Knowledge, Value, and Belief. The Foundations of Ethics and Its Relationship to Science, Volume II. Hastings-on-Hudson, N.Y.: The Hastings Center, 1977. pp. 25–43.
- Arguing as an atheist, MacIntyre claims that absolute precepts of ethics do not require the existence of God, but do require teleology. The teleology that can justify absolute moral precepts must be social rather than individual, thus it is necessary to reject individualism and individualistic institutions. MacIntyre speaks of various kinds of histories presenting “human life as enacted narrative.” The essay is followed by “A Rejoinder” from Paul Ramsey and “A Rejoinder to a Rejoinder” from MacIntyre.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Epistemological Crises, Dramatic Narrative, and the Philosophy of Science.” The Monist 60, no. 4 (October 1977): 453–472; reprinted in Alasdair MacIntyre, The Tasks of Philosophy. Cambridge University Press, 2006. pp. 3-23.
- As noted in the article above, this essay is MacIntyre’s discourse on method. It is reprinted in The Tasks of Philosophy. The preface to The Tasks of Philosophy explains the importance of this essay.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Utilitarianism and Cost-Benefit Analysis: An Essay on the Relevance of Moral Philosophy to Bureaucratic Theory,” in Values in the Electric Power Industry, Kenneth Sayre, ed. Notre Dame and London: University of Notre Dame Press, 1977. pp. 217-37. Reprinted as “Utilitarianism and the Presuppositions of Cost-Benefit Analysis,” in The Moral Dimensions of Public Policy Choice: Beyond the Market Paradigm, John Martin Gilroy and Maurice Wade, eds. Pittsburgh and London: University of Pittsburgh Press, 1992. pp. 179-94.
- MacIntyre discusses the unacknowledged and uncriticized role of utilitarianism in modern bureaucratic organizations, particularly in the reasoning of the “bureaucratic manager,” who appears in AV as one of the characters of the culture of emotivism. This essay presents some of MacIntyre’s earliest comments on “compartmentalization.”
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Social Science Methodology as the Ideology of Bureaucratic Authority,” in Through the Looking Glass: Epistemology and the Conduct of Inquiry, Maria J. Falco, ed. (Washington: University Press of America, 1979) pp. 42-58. Reprinted in Kelvin Knight, ed. The MacIntyre Reader. pp. 53-68.
- This essay is an illuminating precursor to the discussion of the social sciences in chapter eight of AV.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Corporate Modernity and Moral Judgment: Are They Mutually Exclusive,” in Ethics and Problems of the 21st Century, Kenneth M. Sayre and Kenneth E. Goodpaster, eds. Notre Dame and London: University of Notre Dame Press, 1979. pp. 122-35.
- This essay works out in greater detail MacIntyre’s treatment of the replacement of unified personal identity with role-playing and his interpretation of Erving Goffman, which play important roles in MacIntyre’s critique of bureaucratic individualism in AV.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. After Virtue: A Study in Moral Theory. 2d ed. Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press, 1984. 3^rd edition with new prologue, 2007.
- This book makes two arguments. The critical argument in the first nine chapters of the book shows how the moral and political language of modern liberal individualist “culture of emotivism” has been transformed into a manipulative tool for social control. The constructive argument that makes up the rest of the book proposes the Aristotelian practical philosophy of learning to recognize and pursue what is good as an alternative to modern moral philosophy, proposes virtue, defined as excellence in human agency, as the moral goal for the renewal of culture, and argues that this culture of the virtues cannot be imposed through modern political means.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. Whose Justice? Which Rationality? Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press, 1988.
- As noted above, this book provides MacIntyre’s most extensive argument for his theory of rationality. He argues that there are justices rather than justice, and rationalities rather than rationality, but this cultural relativity in the conditions of human enquiry need not lead us to cultural relativism.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Relativism, Power, and Philosophy.” In Relativism: Interpretation and Confrontation. Edited with introduction by Michael Krausz. Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press, 1989, 182–204.
- This is a succinct statement of the problem of relativism.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. Three Rival Versions of Moral Enquiry: Encyclopaedia, Genealogy, and Tradition (Gifford Lectures). Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press, 1990.
- MacIntyre’s Gifford Lectures digest the main points of WJWR in a shorter form using examples that make MacIntyre’s theory more accessible to general readers.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. First Principles, Final Ends, and Contemporary Philosophical Issues. The Aquinas Lecture, 1990. Milwaukee: Marquette University Press, 1990.
- This lecture, reprinted in The Tasks of Philosophy, is MacIntyre’s most explicit defense of his approach to Thomistic metaphysics.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Plain Persons and Moral Philosophy: Rules, Virtues, and Goods.” 1991 Aquinas Lecture at the University of Dallas. American Catholic Philosophical Quarterly 66, no. 1 (Winter 1992): 3–19.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “My Station and Its Virtues.” In Symposium in Memory of Edmund L. Pincoffs. Journal of Philosophical Research 19 (1994): 1–8.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Moral Relativism, Truth and Justification.” In Moral Truth and Moral Tradition: Essays in Honor of Peter Geach and Elizabeth Anscombe. Ed. Luke Gormally. Dublin: Four Courts Press, 1994, 6–24.
- This essay is an important, succinct statement of MacIntyre’s approach to relativism.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “The Theses on Feuerbach: A Road Not Taken,” in Carol C. Gould and Robert S. Cohen, eds, Artifacts, Representations, and Social Practice: Essays for Marx Wartofsky (Kluwer Academic Publishing, 1994), reprinted in Kelvin Knight, ed., The MacIntyre Reader. pp. 223–234.
- As noted in the article, MacIntyre explains in this essay the importance of The Theses on Feuerbach for his own career as a philosopher. Written later in MacIntyre’s career, and delivered at a gathering of “Marxists, ex-Marxists, and post-Marxists of various kinds,” this essay gives a valuable perspective on MacIntyre’s relationship with Marxist political thought.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “Kinesis Interview with Professor Alasdair MacIntyre.” Interview by Thomas D. Pearson. Kinesis 20, no. 2 (Spring 1994): 34–47.
- MacIntyre discusses his debts to Marxism, explains why financial management is not a practice, and answers some questions about his adherence to Catholic Christian teaching.
MacIntyre, Alasdair C., and Kelvin Knight. The MacIntyre Reader. Notre Dame, Ind: University of Notre Dame Press, 1998.
- Kelvin Knight’s “Introduction” places the 13 selections and 2 interviews into a helpful narrative. This book gathers some of the most essential texts for a through study of MacIntyre’s work, including “Notes from the Moral Wilderness,” “Moral Relativism, Truth, and Justification,” “The Theses on Feuerbach: A Road Not Taken,” the interview with Giovanna Borradori, and the interview for Cogito.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. Dependent Rational Animals: Why Human Beings Need the Virtues. Chicago: Open Court, 1999.
- Where moral philosophy textbooks typically begin with the decisions of the healthy autonomous adult as the subject matter for ethics, MacIntyre begins with vulnerability and dependence. We are vulnerable and dependent in childhood and in old age. Children must train and discipline their desires with the help of their communities if they are to achieve the relative autonomy of independent practical reasoners as adults. Adults must care for the young and old if they are to live out their lives in communities that take care of their old and young. This book is MacIntyre’s most complete statement of his moral philosophy.
MacIntyre, Alasdair C. Edith Stein: A Philosophical Prologue, 1913 – 1922. Lanham: Rowman & Littlefield, 2006.
- MacIntyre explores the practice of philosophy through a study of Edith Stein and of the people and problems that formed her philosophical context in the years leading to her baptism in 1922.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. The Tasks of Philosophy. Selected Essays, Volume 1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006.
- This collection includes EC, “Moral Philosophy and Contemporary Social Practice: What Holds Them Apart?” “The Ends of Life and the Ends of Philosophical Writing,” and seven other essays on the practice of philosophy. Three essays discuss Thomistic metaphysical realism.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. Ethics and Politics. Selected Essays, Volume 2. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006.
- A collection of some of MacIntyre’s best short works on ethics and politics. The book includes two essays on Thomistic natural law, “Moral Dilemmas,” “Three Perspectives on Marxism,” and “Social Structures and their Threats to Moral Agency.”
MacIntyre, Alasdair C., Paul Blackledge, and Neil Davidson. Alasdair MacIntyre’s Engagement with Marxism: Selected Writings 1953-1974. Leiden: Brill, 2008. Published in Paperback, Chicago: Haymarket Books, 2009.
- Paul Blackledge and Neil Davidson’s Introduction differentiates some of the strains in Marxist thought and practice in the 1950s and 1960s and connects MacIntyre to the Campaign for Nuclear Disarmament and the New Left. The 46 Marxist essays in the book reveal consistencies between MacIntyre’s earlier classical Marxism and his later Thomism. The collection includes “Communism and British Intellectuals,” “Freedom and Revolution,” and “Breaking the Chains of Reason.”
MacIntyre, Alasdair. “On Being a Theistic Philosopher in a Secularized Culture.” Proceedings of the American Catholic Philosophical Association 84 (2010): 23–32.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. Chapter 5, “Alasdair MacIntyre: The Illusion of Self-sufficiency’ in Conversations on Ethics by Alex Voorheve, Oxford University Press, 2009.
- Each chapter in this book is an interview with a contemporary moral philosopher. Alasdair Macintyre calls Chapter 5 “the best short statement of my views in print.”
MacIntyre, Alasdair. God, Philosophy, Universities: A Selective History of the Catholic Philosophical Tradition. Lanham. MD: Rowman & Littlefield, 2011.
- This book surveys the history of Catholic philosophical tradition, as a relationship between a practice and the institution that supports it.
MacIntyre, Alasdair C., and Fran O’Rourke. What happened in and to moral philosophy in the twentieth century?: philosophical essays in honor of Alasdair Macintyre. University of Notre Dame Press, 2013.
- This festschrift from the 2009 Conference hosted by Fran O’Rourke at University College Dublin in honor of MacIntyre’s eightieth birthday contains MacIntyre’s autobiographical lecture, “On Having Survived The Academic Moral Philosophy of the Twentieth Century,” MacIntyre’s response to the essays in the book, and some comments on moving forward in philosophy.

b. Secondary Works

Ballard, Bruce W. Understanding MacIntyre. Lanham, Md.: University Press of America, 2000.
- This is a brief, basic introduction to MacIntyre’s philosophy from a professor who understands it.
Beadle, Ron and Geoff Moore. “MacIntyre on Virtue and Organization.” Organization Studies 27, no. 3 (2006): 323–340.
- Ron Beadle and Geoff Moore’s groundbreaking essay on MacIntyre’s contribution to organizational theory has been cited widely In the Business Ethics literature and included in Sage’s four volume collection of the best papers in business ethics.
Beadle, Ron and Geoff Moore, eds. MacIntyre, Empirics, and Organization, special edition, Philosophy of Management 7 no.1 (2008).
- The nine articles in this special MacIntyre issue of Philosophy of Management were selected “to illustrate both the range of empirical endeavors that might be animated by MacIntyre’s ideas and the variety of responses his work has provoked among social scientists.”
Bielskis, Andrius and Kelvin Knight, eds. Virtue and Economy: Essays on Morality and Markets. London: Ashgate, 2014.
- This volume includes papers from the 2010 meeting of the International Society for MacIntyrean Enquiry hosted by Andrius Bielskis in Vilnius, Lithuania. Also includes MacIntyre’s essay “The Irrelevance of Ethics,” in which MacIntyre argues that courses in business ethics cannot solve social moral problems; those solutions demand moral formation in habits of justice, and no technical knowledge of moral arguments can make up for the lack of this moral formation.
Blackledge, Paul. “Morality and Revolution: Ethical Debates in the British New Left,” Critique 35, no. 2 (August 2007): 211–228.
Cunningham, Lawrence S. Intractable Disputes About the Natural Law Alasdair MacIntyre and Critics. Notre Dame, Ind: University of Notre Dame Press, 2009.
- MacIntyre presents the problem of intractable moral disagreement as it has emerged in his writings since the late 1970s; eight scholars respond and MacIntyre replies.
Davenport, John J., Anthony Rudd, Alasdair C. MacIntyre, and Philip L. Quinn. Kierkegaard After MacIntyre: Essays on Freedom, Narrative, and Virtue. Chicago: Open Court, 2001.
- Twelve essay by respected Kierkegaard specialists take issue MacIntyre’s interpretation of Kierkegaard, published in The Encyclopedia of Philosophy (1968) and in AV (1981). MacIntyre responds.
Franks, Joan M., O.P. “Aristotle or Nietzsche.” Listening 26, no. 2 (1991): 156–163.
Flew, Antony. “Psycho-Analytic Explanation.” Analysis 10, no. 1 (October 1949).
Flew, Antony. Review of Metaphysical Beliefs. The Philosophical Quarterly 8, no. 33 (Oct., 1958): 383-384.
George, Robert P. “Moral Particularism, Thomism, and Traditions.” Review of Metaphysics 42 (March 1989): 593–605.
Hauerwas, Stanley, and Paul Wadell. Review of After Virtue, by Alasdair MacIntyre. The Thomist 46, no. 2 (April 1982): 313–323.
Hibbs, Thomas S. “MacIntyre’s Postmodern Thomism: Reflections on Three Rival Versions of Moral Enquiry.” The Thomist 57 (1993): 277–297.
Hittinger, Russell. Review of After Virtue by Alasdair MacIntyre, The New Scholasticism 56, no. 3 (1982): 385–90.
- Russell Hittinger wrote a peculiarly insightful book review that connects the achievement of AV to the frustrations of ASIA.
Horton, John, and Susan Mendus, eds. After MacIntyre: Critical Perspectives on the Work of Alasdair MacIntyre. Notre Dame, Ind.: University of Notre Dame Press, 1994.
- This is a collection of essays critical of MacIntyre’s work. It is of mixed quality. MacIntyre responds.
Knight, Kelvin. Aristotelian Philosophy: Ethics and Politics from Aristotle to MacIntyre. Cambridge, UK: Polity, 2007.
- Kelvin Knight interprets Aristotle’s Nicomachean Ethics in terms of action and agency, and shows how MacIntyre’s ethics and politics develop these themes. Kelvin Knight is respected internationally as a leading MacIntyre scholar.
Kelvin Knight and Paul Blackledge, eds. Revolutionary Aristotelianism (Stuttgart: Lucius & Lucius, 2008), special edition of Analyse & Kritik 30, no. 1 (June 2008).
Lutz, Christopher Stephen. Tradition in the Ethics of Alasdair MacIntyre: Relativism, Thomism, and Philosophy. Lanham, Md.: Lexington books, 2004.
- This general introduction to MacIntyre’s theory of rationality provides a brief intellectual biography and examines the claims of MacIntyre’s critics.
Lutz, Christopher Stephen. “Alasdair MacIntyre’s Tradition Constituted Rationality: An Alternative to Relativism and Fideism.” American Catholic Philosophical Quarterly 85:3 (Summer 2011).
Lutz, Christopher Stephen. Reading Alasdair MacIntyre’s AV. New York: Continuum, 2012.
- This book situates AV in the larger context of MacIntyre’s career, summarizes and comments on the critical and constructive arguments of the book, and discusses the subsequent development of MacIntyre’s work.
Maletta, Sante. Biografia della ragione: Saggio sulla filosofia politica di MacIntyre. Rome: Rubbettino, 2007.
McMylor, Peter. Alasdair MacIntyre: Critic of Modernity. London: Routledge, 1994.
- Peter McMylor traces MacIntyre’s development and explains his central theories from a perspective informed by sociology. This book is a valuable complement to philosophically centered readings of MacIntyre’s work.
Mitchell, Basil. “The Justification of Religious Belief.” The Philosophical Quarterly 11, No. 44 (Jul., 1961): 213–226.
Murphy, Mark C. ed. Alasdair MacIntyre. Contemporary Philosophy in Focus. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
- Seven excellent essays from respected authors combine to draw a very good picture of the whole project. This is a valuable reference.
Nicholas, Jeffery L. Reason, Tradition, and the Good: MacIntyre’s Tradition-Constituted Reason and Frankfurt School Critical Theory. Notre Dame, Ind: University of Notre Dame Press, 2012.
- Nicholas parallels the concerns of critical theory and those of contemporary Aristotelians and Thomists; in so doing, he offers an opportunity to Aristotelians and critical theorists to engage one another.
Nussbaum, Martha Craven. “Recoiling from Reason.” Review of WJWR by Alasdair MacIntyre. New York Review of Books 36, no. 19 (December 7, 1989): 36–41.
- Nussbaum’s review is a notable example of the nostalgia complaint against MacIntyre’s work on tradition. Her interpretation of MacIntyre is contrary to MacIntyre’s writings on at least two points. First, it disregards his continued rejection of fideism. Second, it treats tradition after the fashion of Burke, Polanyi, or Kuhn, as essentially conservative and essentially unitary. Compare to “Epistemological Crises” in Tasks, p. 16.
Perreau-Saussine, Emile. Alasdair MacIntyre: Une Biographie Intellectuelle. Presses Universitaires France, 2005.
Perreau-Saussine, Emile. “The Moral Critique of Stalinism,” in Paul Blackledge and Kelvin Knight, eds. Virtue and Politics. pp. 134–151.
Perreau-Saussine examines the problem and implications of MacIntyre’s struggle with the moral critique of Stalinism with illuminating insight.
Peters, Richard. “Cause, Cure, and Motive.” Analysis 10, no. 5 (April 1950).
Reames, Kent. “Metaphysics, History, and Moral Philosophy: The Centrality of the 1990 Aquinas Lecture to MacIntyre’s Argument for Thomism.” The Thomist 62 (1998): 419–443.
Ryle, Gilbert. “Knowing How and Knowing That: The Presidential Address. ” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society. New Series, Vol. 46, (1945 – 1946): 1-16.
Scheffler, Samuel. Review of AV: A Study in Moral Theory [1st ed.] in The Philosophical Review 92, No. 3 (July 1983): 443–447.
Toulmin, Steven. “The Logical Status of Psycho-Analysis.” Analysis 9, no. 2 (December 1948).
Wachbroit, Robert. “A Genealogy of Virtues.” Review of AV [1st ed.]. The Yale Law Journal 92 (1983): 564–576.
Wachbroit, Robert. “Relativism and Virtue.” The Yale Law Journal 94 (1985): 1559–1565.
Wartofsky, Marx. “Virtue Lost or Understanding MacIntyre.” Inquiry 27 (1984): 235–50.
Zoll, Patrick. Ethik ohne Letztbegründung?: Zu den nicht-fundamentalistischen Ansätzen von Alasdair MacIntyre und Jeffrey Stout. Würzburg, Deutschland: Verlag Königshausen & Neumann GmbH, 2012.
The photograph of MacIntyre appears by permission of the London Metropolitan University.

Author Information

Christopher Stephen Lutz
Email: clutz@saintmeinrad.edu
Saint Meinrad Seminary and School of Theology
U. S. A.

Blaise Pascal (1623–1662)

Blaise Pascal was a French philosopher, mathematician, scientist, inventor, and theologian. In mathematics, he was an early pioneer in the fields of game theory and probability theory. In philosophy he was an early pioneer in existentialism. As a writer on theology and religion he was a defender of Christianity.

Despite chronic ill health, Pascal made historic contributions to mathematics and to physical science, including both experimental and theoretical work on hydraulics, atmospheric pressure, and the existence and nature of the vacuum. As a scientist and philosopher of science, Pascal championed strict empirical observation and the use of controlled experiments; he opposed the rationalism and logico-deductive method of the Cartesians; and he opposed the metaphysical speculations and reverence for authority of the theologians of the Middle Ages.

Although he never fully abandoned his scientific and mathematical interests, after his uncanny “Night of Fire” (the intense mystical illumination and midnight conversion that he experienced on the evening of November 23, 1654), Pascal turned his talents almost exclusively to religious writing. It was during the period from 1656 until his death in 1662 that he wrote the Lettres Provinciales and the Pensées. The Lettres Provinciales is a satirical attack on Jesuit casuistry and a polemical defense of Jansenism. The Pensées is a posthumously published collection of unfinished notes for what was intended to be a systematic apologia for the Christian religion. Along with his scientific writings, these two great literary works have attracted the admiration and critical interest of philosophers and serious readers of every generation.

Biography
Literary and Religious Works
Mathematical and Scientific Works
Philosophy of Science and Theory of Knowledge
1. Philosophy of Science
2. Theory of Knowledge
  1. Reason and Sense
  2. The Heart
Fideism
Existentialism
Conclusion: Pascal’s Reputation and Cultural Legacy
References and Further Reading
1. Texts and translations of works by Pascal
2. Biographical and critical studies

1. Biography

“Pascal’s life is inseparable from his work.”—A. J. Krailsheimer

Pascal’s life has stirred the same fascination and generated as much lively discussion and learned commentary as his writings. This is largely attributable to his intriguing, enigmatic personality. To read him is to come into direct contact with both his strangeness and his charm. It is also to encounter a tangle of incongruities and seeming contradictions. For Pascal himself – humble yet forceful; fanatical as well as skeptical; mild and empathetic, yet also capable of withering scorn – personified the very “chimera” he famously declared man to be (Pensées, 131/164). [Note: Throughout this article, fragments of the Pensées are identified first (that is, before the slash) by the numeration system of Lafuma and second (after the slash) by that of Sellier – L/S.]

Interest in his life is also due to our natural desire to learn more about this “scary genius” , or effrayant génie – Chateaubriand’s memorable phrase, whose unique combination of talents enabled him to make revolutionary contributions not only to mathematics and physical science but also to the theology and literature of his age. Merely to list his achievements is once again to encounter Pascal the “chimera,”— the human riddle who was both an avant-garde crusader for empirical science as well as an avid supporter of ancient prophecy, mysticism, miracles, and Biblical hermeneutics. Modern readers are usually shocked to discover that the father of gambling odds and the mechanical computer wore a spiked girdle to chastise himself and further mortify a body already tormented by recurrent illness and chronic pain.

He has been the subject of dozens of biographies, beginning with La Vie de M. Pascal, the brief hagiographic sketch composed by his sister Gilberte Périer shortly after his death in 1662 and first published in 1684. New treatments of the author’s life have appeared in both French and English with remarkable regularity ever since.

Périer’s memoir established a precedent by applying an underlying pattern and symmetry to her brother’s life. The implied form is that of a well-made play with classic five-act structure. In Périer’s treatment this life-drama is a divine comedy showing the spiritual rise and eventual salvation of a distressed soul who, after a series of trials and setbacks, reunites with God. Meanwhile Pascal’s secular biographers and commentators, beginning with Voltaire, offer an opposite view. They portray Pascal’s career as essentially a tragedy, a descending arc tracing the decline into timidity and superstition of a once bold and independent thinker. Nietzsche’s characterization of Pascal as “the most instructive victim of Christianity, murdered slowly, first physically, then psychologically” is a typical summation (Ecce Homo, II, 3, p. 243).

Both views are oversimplified. First of all, at no point during his lifetime was Pascal ever a libertine or libre-penseur. So portraying his life as though it consisted of two sudden and powerful “conversions,” with an intervening slide into worldliness and sins of the flesh, seems a bit too pat and melodramatic. Similarly, since Pascal was a lifelong supporter of the Catholic faith, and since he also maintained an interest in scientific and mathematical problems well after his commitment to Jansenism and Port-Royal, it seems unfair to portray his final years as a betrayal of his scientific principles rather than as an intensification or culmination of his religious views. Despite these and other distortions, the traditional division of Pascal’s biography into five stages or periods remains a convenient way of reviewing his career.

a. Early Years

Blaise Pascal was born on June 19, 1623, in Clermont (now Clermont-Ferrand) in the Auvergne region of central France. His parents were Étienne Pascal (1588 – 1651), a magistrate, civil servant, and member of the aristocratic and professional class known as the noblesse de robe, and Antoinette Bégon Pascal (1596-1626), the daughter of a Clermont merchant. Pascal was named for his paternal uncle as well as for St. Blaise, the 3rd-century Armenian saint martyred by having his flesh flayed by iron carding combs as his namesake would later punish his own flesh by wearing a belt studded with sharp nails.

The Pascal family, including Pascal’s older sister Gilberte (b. 1620) and younger sister Jacqueline (b. 1625), enjoyed a comfortable, upper-bourgeois lifestyle. Étienne, in addition to being a lawyer, public official, and tax administrator, was proficient in Latin and Greek, a dabbler in natural philosophy, and an expert mathematician. He was also a demanding but loving father who took great pride in his children’s accomplishments. Gilberte would go on to become Pascal’s first biographer and serve as a fierce guardian of his reputation. Jacqueline displayed an early literary genius and earned acclaim as a poet and dramatist before becoming a nun at Port-Royal. Pascal’s mother, who was known for her piety and charitable work, died when Pascal was only three years old and Jacqueline was but an infant.

Pascal was a sickly child who suffered various pains and diseases throughout his life. According to a family anecdote related by his niece, at age one he supposedly fell victim to a strange illness. His abdomen became distended and swollen, and the slightest annoyance triggered fits of crying and screaming. This affliction supposedly continued for more than a year, and the child often seemed on the verge of death.

Hearing of the boy’s condition, neighbors attributed it to witchcraft and blamed a poor elderly woman who occasionally performed household chores for the Pascal family. Étienne, as an educated gentleman, at first scoffed at the accusation, but when his patience eventually wore thin he confronted the woman and threatened her with hanging if she didn’t come forward with the truth. The woman reportedly fell to the floor and promised to divulge everything if her life would be spared. She confessed that in a moment of anger and resentment she had cast a spell on the child – a fatal spell that could be undone only by having it transferred to some other living creature. Supposedly the family cat was given to her and made a scapegoat for the otherwise doomed child. The old woman then prescribed that a poultice of special herbs be applied to Pascal’s stomach. After an intense crisis, during which he appeared to be comatose and close to death, Pascal awoke from his “spell” and eventually recovered his health.

This strange and improbable “witch” tale is scarcely credible today. But that Pascal endured a serious and potentially fatal childhood illness during which his parents desperately tried all kinds of fanciful cures and treatments seems very likely. In fact, the anecdote is perfectly consistent with the wild and paradoxical world of 17^th_ century culture and especially the medical practice of the time – a time when empirical science and natural magic, enlightened new techniques and antique superstitions, were routinely intermingled and practiced side by side.

The exact cause and basis of Pascal’s lifelong health problems have never been fully settled or accounted for. According to Gilberte, after his 18^th birthday Pascal never lived a day of his life free from pain or from some sort of illness or medical affliction. The most common medical opinion is that he contracted gastrointestinal tuberculosis in early childhood and that manifestations of the disease, along with signs of possible concurrent nephritis or rheumatoid arthritis, recurred periodically throughout his lifetime. The accounts of his pathology are also consistent with migraine, irritable bowel syndrome, and fibromyalgia – a complex of illnesses often found together and which also frequently occur in combination with symptoms of anxiety, depression, and emotional distress.

Scholarly interest in this matter involves more than just idle curiosity and medical detective-work. The question of Pascal’s physical and mental health goes to the heart of desires to learn more about the conditions and circumstances that produce extraordinary genius. Affliction and disease, physical or emotional trauma, a natural disadvantage or disability have often served as an added motive or accelerator for high-level creative achievement. Examples abound – from the ancient legend of the blind and vagabond Homer to the documented histories of modern creative figures like Isaac Newton, Van Gogh, Stephen Hawking, and Christy Brown. We can only speculate whether and to what extent Pascal’s physical ailments and disabilities, instead of retarding his career, may have actually spurred and given rise to his intellectual triumphs.

In 1631, a few years after the death of his wife, Étienne sold his government post (a common practice of the day) along with most of his property and moved with his children to Paris. Over the next nine years he devoted himself to his amateur scientific and mathematical pursuits and took personal charge of his children’s education. Recognizing early on his son’s exceptional intellectual gifts, Étienne designed and supervised a special program and curriculum for the boy based on his own anti-scholastic and progressive educational principles.

Young Pascal was taught Latin and Greek as well as history, geography, and philosophy – all on an impromptu schedule, including during meals and at various hours throughout the day. Science, or natural philosophy as the discipline was then known, ignited Pascal’s imagination, and he demonstrated an early inquisitiveness about natural phenomena and a fondness for devising experiments. Civil and canon law were also part of a varied curriculum that included study of the Bible and the Church Fathers. The latter studies were in accordance with Étienne’s personal religious views, which were plain and respectful and as progressive as his views on education. He taught his son his own cardinal principle that whatever is a matter of faith should not also be treated as a matter of reason; and vice-versa. It is a tenet that Pascal took to heart and followed throughout his career.

In the belief that, once exposed to mathematics, his son would be so captivated by it that he would forsake or ignore his other studies, Étienne determined to withhold instruction in math and geometry until Pascal had completed the rest of his training. However, upon discovering that the boy had already achieved an intuitive understanding of the discipline including his own independently worked out demonstration of a proof in Euclid, Étienne acquiesced. The pages of Euclid were finally opened to the youth, and thus began Pascal’s belated introduction to mathematics – the subject with which he would conduct, at times guiltily, a lifelong love affair.

Pascal’s education was unique for his own time and would be unusual in any era. A passionate student who delved earnestly into each new subject, he absorbed new material, including, at a later period, the most arcane and technical components of theology quickly and effortlessly. However, his learning, while deep in a few areas, was never broad and was in some ways less remarkable for what it included than for what it left out.

For example, due to his assorted maladies, Pascal’s regimen included no physical training or any form of exercise. In addition, because of the sequestered, hermetic, entirely private form of his schooling, he never experienced any of the personal contacts or opportunities for social development that most young people, including even novice monks in monastic schools, commonly do. To what extent this may have deformed or limited his social and interpersonal skills it is hard to say. He was known to be temperamentally impatient with and demanding of others while sometimes seeming arrogant and self-absorbed. At a later point in his career, he fully acknowledged his deficiencies and indeed chastised himself for his social ambition and intellectual vanity.

Pascal was not widely read in the classics or in contemporary literature. Though he was well acquainted with Aristotelian and Scholastic thought, philosophy for him consisted mainly of Epictetus, Montaigne, and the traditional debate between Stoicism and Epicureanism. Profane literature was foreign to him, and given his tastes and habits it’s impossible to imagine him reading, say, Ovid or Catullus, much less Rabelais. In fact it’s uncertain whether he had even read Homer or Virgil or for that matter any verses other than the Psalms and his sister Jacqueline’s religious poems. As for drama, Corneille was a family friend who at one time personally championed Jacqueline’s poetry and dramaturgy, and the young Racine studied classical literature and rhetoric at the school at Port-Royal while Jacqueline and Pascal were also there. Yet Pascal never mentions the work of either great writer and indeed – other than to refer to the stage as a “dangerous diversion” (Pensées, 764/630) – seems to have taken little interest at all in contemporary French theatre, which was then at its artistic zenith.

But whatever he may have lacked in physical education, humanistic studies, and art appreciation, Pascal more than made up for in his favored pursuits. In fact, so rapidly did he advance in physics and mathematics that Étienne boldly introduced the boy at the age of only thirteen into his small Parisian academic circle known as the Académie libre. The central figure of this group was the polymathic philosopher, mathematician, theologian, and music theorist Père Marin Mersenne, one of the leading intellectuals of the age. Mersenne corresponded with Descartes, Huygens, Hobbes, and other luminaries of the period and actively promoted the work of controversial thinkers like Galileo and Gassendi. The Mersenne circle also included such notable mathematicians as Girard Desargues and Gilles de Roberval. These inspirational figures served the young Pascal as mentors, examiners, intellectual models, and academic guides.

It was during his involvement with the Mersenne circle that Pascal published, at age sixteen, his Essai pour les Coniques, an important contribution to the relatively new field of projective geometry. The essay includes an original proof concerning the special properties of hexagons inscribed within conic sections that is still known today as Pascal’s Theorem.

Around the same time that Pascal was working on his Theorem, Étienne, who had at one time served as an adviser to Cardinal Richelieu, incurred the wrath of the First Minister by leading a protest over a government bond default. Threatened with prison, he sought refuge in Auvergne. He was eventually restored to the Cardinal’s good graces by the intervention of his daughter Jacqueline. (The Cardinal, a patron of the theatre, was charmed not only by Jacqueline’s poetic and dramatic skills but also by her beauty and courtly manners.) It’s also likely that Richelieu had an additional motive for welcoming Étienne back. For no sooner was Étienne returned to royal favor than Richelieu appointed him the chief tax administrator for Rouen. At the Cardinal’s behest, the Pascal family moved from Paris to Rouen in early January of 1640.

Rouen was a city in crisis, beset by street violence, crop failures, a tax revolt, and an outbreak of plague. It was Étienne’s job to handle the taxpayer revolt, which he eventually managed to do by working with the local citizens and earning their confidence and respect. Pascal meanwhile seems to have been little affected by the change of scene and continued with his mathematical studies. He also undertook a new project. Impressed by the massive number of calculations required in his father’s work of accounting and tax assessment, he wondered if the drudgery of such labor might not be relieved by some type of mechanical device. Setting to work on the idea in 1642, he eventually conceived, designed, and oversaw the construction of what was presented to the public in 1645 as la machine arithmétique, later known as the Pascaline. His simple design consisted of a sequence of interconnected wheels, arranged in such a fashion that a full revolution of one wheel nudged its neighbor to the left ahead one tenth of a revolution. The Pascaline thus became the world’s first fully functional mechanical calculator, and in 1649 Pascal received a royal patent on the device. Over the next five years he continued tinkering with his design, experimenting with various materials and trying out different linkage arrangements and gear mechanisms. Nine working models survive today and serve as a reminder that Pascal was not just a mathematical Platonist absorbed in a higher world of pure number but also a practical minded, down-to-earth engineering type interested in applying the insights of science and mathematics to the solution of real-world problems.

b. First Conversion

On an icy day in January of 1646, Étienne Pascal, in his capacity as a public official, was summoned to prevent a duel that was to take place in a field outside Rouen. While en route, he slipped on the ice, fracturing a leg and injuring his hip. The family called in two local bonesetters, the brothers Deschamps, who moved into the Pascal household for a period of three months to care for Étienne and oversee his recovery. The brothers turned out to be members of the small, saintly community of Augustinian worshippers established at Port-Royal by the Jansenist priest Jean du Vergier de Hauranne, more simply known as the abbé Saint-Cyran.

The Jansenists (named for the Dutch theologian Cornelius Jansen) accepted the strict Augustinian creed that salvation is achieved not by human virtue or merit but solely by the grace of God. At Port-Royal they practiced an ascetic lifestyle emphasizing penance, austerity, devotional exercises, and good works. While treating Étienne, the Deschamps brothers shared their stringent, exacting, and somewhat cheerless religious views with the Pascal family. Pascal himself, along with his father and sisters, had never displayed much in the way of genuine religious fervor. They were good upper-middle-class Catholics, mild and respectful in their beliefs rather than zealous, neither God-fearing nor, to any extraordinary degree, God-seeking. Yet the ardor of the Deschamps brothers proved contagious. Pascal caught the fire and read with avidity the Jansenist texts that were given to him – sermons by Saint-Cyran along with doctrinal works by Augustine, Antoine Arnauld (Saint-Cyran’s successor), and Jansen himself. Gradually, with growing assurance, and eventually with complete sincerity and conviction, Pascal embraced the Jansenist creed. According to Gilberte’s account, he was the first in the family to convert to the new faith, and no sooner had he done so than he set about to convert the rest of family, first Jacqueline, then Étienne, and finally Gilberte and her husband Florin Périer. It should be added, however, that from Pascal’s own point of view he wasn’t so much “converting” to Jansenism, or any particular group or sect, as he was declaring or reaffirming his commitment to the true faith.

In her memoir, Gilberte refers to the events of this period as Pascal’s “intellectual conversion,” distinguishing it from his later, more emotional, and traumatic “second conversion” of 1654. She also asserts that at this time Pascal formally renounced all his scientific and mathematical researches and ever afterward devoted himself entirely and exclusively to the love and service of God. This claim is inaccurate and indeed hard to fathom given that only a year later Florin Périer, Gilberte’s own husband, assisted in what is probably Pascal’s most famous scientific investigation, the celebrated Puy-de-Dôme experiment measuring air pressure and proving the existence of the vacuum. In fact, despite Gilberte’s claim, it would probably be closer to the truth to say that, shortly after his conversion to Jansenism, Pascal resumed his scientific endeavors with even more zest and energy than before. In the spring of 1647, partly on the advice of his physicians, he returned to Paris where he linked up once again with former colleagues and began organizing several new essays and treatises for publication. His supposed renunciation of natural philosophy and the bright world of Parisian intellectual life had lasted all of six months.

c. Worldly Reversion

Contrary to Gilberte’s account, most biographers have accepted the years 1649 -1654 as a periode mondaine in Pascal’s career – that is, as a time when he retreated from his pledge to serve only God and resumed to a significant degree the life of a gentleman-scientist.

It was not a period of debauchery and libertinism or anything of the kind. Although he showed an occasional weakness for silk and brocade and enjoyed the amenities of both a valet and a coach-and-six, Pascal did not become a salon habitué or even much of a bon vivant. He was simply a young man who sought the company of fellow experts, savored the spotlight of recognition for personal achievement, and delighted in the social world of learned conversation and sparkling intellectual debate. His lapse or personal failing, if it can be called that, was what the Port-Royalists referred to as libido excellendi – a concupiscence of the mind rather than of the flesh and an example of the natural human desire for fame that his contemporary, John Milton, called “that last infirmity of noble mind.”

Pascal’s companions during this period included such stars of the Paris social scene as Artus Gouffier, the Duc de Roannez, a former military officer, noted courtier, and amateur dabbler in science and mathematics; Antoine Gombaud, the Chevalier de Méré, a soldier, gambler, author, and paragon of honnêteté (more than mere “honesty,” this term connotes an entire code of conduct and the gallant, cheerful lifestyle of an independent-minded man of the world); and Damien Mitton, another champion of honnêteté whose name became a byword for debonair charm and colorful raconteurship. Several commentators on the Pensées argue that the work is directly aimed at the culture of honnêteté and that it specifically targets figures like Méré and Mitton, that is, persons who seek a life of virtue and happiness apart from God.

Shortly after his return to Paris in 1647 and during a turn for the worse in his health, Pascal reunited with his old circle of friends and fellow intellectuals and was also introduced into polite society. Descartes himself paid a visit (and according to reports wisely suggested that Pascal follow a regimen of bed-rest and bouillon rather than the steady diet of enemas, purgings, and blood-lettings favored by his doctors). The historic meeting between the two scientific and philosophical rivals reportedly did not go well.

Pascal’s new life in Paris was interrupted in 1648 by the outbreak of the Fronde, the violent civil clash that began as a power struggle between Chief Minister Mazurin and leaders of Parliament and which continued as a conflict between the crown and various aristocratic factions over the next five years. To escape the mob havoc and pervasive military presence in Paris, Pascal returned to Clermont along with his sisters, brother-in-law, and father. There he effectively inserted himself into the Auvergne equivalent of Parisian high society and resumed his temporary infatuation with la vie honnêteté. He returned to Paris in 1650, reconnected with his old friends, and began revising and polishing several scientific papers, including portions of a never completed or partially lost version of his Treatise on the Vacuum.

On September 24, 1651, Étienne died; he was 63. Pascal and Jacqueline were at his bedside. Gilberte was in Clermont awaiting the birth of a child who would be named Étienne Périer in honor of his grandfather. Pascal’s letter of consolation to Gilberte, preserved among his complete works, has disappointed some of his admirers due to its austere tone and cold Jansenist view of death (we should not grieve but rejoice at God’s will; the deceased is now in a better world; and so forth.). However, the letter includes a note of affection for the man who had taken personal charge of his education and who was the first to introduce him to the world of science and mathematics. Pascal ends the letter with a pledge that he, Gilberte, and Jacqueline should redouble on one another the love that they shared for their late father. A few months later, Jacqueline finally made good on her determination (long postponed in obedience to her father’s and brother’s wishes) to dedicate her life to holy service and enter Port-Royal as a nun.

In the summer of 1654 Pascal exchanged a series of letters with Fermat on the problem of calculating gambling odds and probabilities. It was also at this time (although many have doubted his authorship) that he completed his Discourse on Love. And according to at least two of his biographers (Faugère and Bishop) it was during this same period (1653-54) that Pascal himself fell victim to amorous passion and even contemplated marriage (supposedly to the comely Charlotte de Rouannez, his frequent correspondent and the sister of his good friend the Duke). On the other hand, Gilberte in her account of her brother’s life makes no mention whatsoever of a love affair, and the evidence that Pascal ever succumbed to romance or became a suitor remains sketchy at best.

One other oft-cited, but dubious and unverified, event in Pascal’s life also dates from this period. According to various sources, none wholly reliable, in October of 1654, Pascal was supposedly involved in a nearly fatal accident while crossing the Pont de Neuilly in his coach. His affrighted horses reportedly reared, bolted, and plunged over the side of the bridge into the Seine, nearly dragging the coach and Pascal after them. Fortunately, the main coupling broke and the coach, with Pascal inside, miraculously hung on to the edge and stabilized.

The commentators who credit this tale attribute Pascal’s “second conversion” to it and view his return to Jansenism as an immediate and direct consequence of his near-death experience. Sigmund Freud accepted the story and even used it as an example of how severe trauma can trigger an obsessive or phobic reaction. However, there is no conclusive evidence that the event ever happened.

d. Second Conversion

The crucial event of Pascal’s life and career occurred on November 23, 1654, between the hours of 10:30 pm and 12:30 am. Pascal lay in bed at his home in the Marais district in Paris when he experienced the religious ecstasy or revelation that his biographers refer to as his “second conversion” or “night of fire.” He produced a written record of this momentous experience on a sheet of paper, which he then inserted into a piece of folded parchment inscribed with a duplicate account of the same vision. This dual record, known as the Memorial, he kept sewed into the lining of his jacket as a kind of secret token or private testament of his new life and total commitment to Jesus Christ. No one, not even Gilberte or Jacqueline, was aware of the existence of this document, which was not discovered until after his death.

The text of the Memorial is cryptic, ejaculatory, portentous. At the top of the sheet stands a cross followed by a few lines establishing the time and date, then the word FEU (fire) in all upper case and centered near the top of the page. Then:

Dieu d’Abraham, Dieu d’Isaac, Dieu de Jacob, non des philosophes et des savants.

Certitude. Certitude. Sentiment. Joie. Paix.

Dieu de Jésus-Christ.

Deum meum et Deum vestrum.

Ton Dieu sera mon Dieu.

(God of Abraham, God of Isaac, God of Jacob, not of the philosophers and scholars. Certitude, certitude, feeling, joy, peace. God of Jesus Christ. My God and your God. Thy God will be my God.)

And so on, in a similarly ecstatic vein for about eighteen more lines. The parchment copy ends with the solemn pledge: “Total submission to Jesus Christ and to my director. Eternally in joy for a day’s trial on earth. I shall not forget thy word.”

As the name Memorial implies, Pascal’s words were written down to preserve them indelibly in his memory and to bear tangible witness to what was for him a soul-piercing and truly life-altering event. His account, despite its brevity and gnomic style, accords closely with the reports of conversion and mysticism classically described and analyzed by William James.

In the weeks leading up to November 23, 1654, Pascal had on several occasions visited Jacqueline at Port-Royal and had complained, despite his active social life and ongoing scientific work, of feelings of dissatisfaction, guilt, lack of purpose, and ennui. As in the story of his carriage accident by the Seine, he seemed to be a man teetering on the edge – in this case between anxiety and hope. His “Night of Fire” dramatically changed his outlook and brought him back from the brink of despair.

e. Final Years

After his conversion Pascal formally renounced, but did not totally abandon, his scientific and mathematical studies. He instead vowed to dedicate his time and talents to the glorification of God, the edification of his fellow believers, and the salvation of the larger human community. It wasn’t long before he got an early test of his new resolve.

In fact, hardly had Pascal committed himself to Port-Royal than the Jansenist enclave, never secure and always under the watchful suspicion of the greater Catholic community, found itself under theological siege. Antoine Arnauld, the spiritual leader of Port-Royal and the uncompromising voice and authority for its strict Augustinian beliefs and values, was embroiled in a bitter controversy pitting Jansenism against the Pope, the Jesuit order, and a majority of the bishops of France. In effect, opponents charged that the entire Jansenist system was based on a foundation of error. At issue were matters of Catholic doctrine involving grace, election, human righteousness, divine power, and free will. Arnauld denied the charges and published a series of vehement counter-attacks. Unfortunately, these only served to make the hostility towards himself and the Port-Royal community more intense. He ended up being censored by the Faculty of Theology at the Sorbonne and stood threatened with official accusations of heresy. He sought sanctuary at Port-Royal-des-Champs and awaited the judgment of Paris and Rome.

With the official voice of Port-Royal effectively muted, the cause of Jansenism needed a new champion. Pascal stood ready to fill the role. During the period 1656-57, under the pseudonym Louis de Montalte,

he produced a series of 18 public letters attacking the Jesuits and defending Arnauld and Jansenist doctrine. The Lettres provinciales, as they became known, introduced an entirely new tone and style into contemporary theological debate. From time to time, the genre had served as a forum for obfuscation, vituperation, abstruse technical language, and stodgy academic prose. Pascal’s Lettres injected a new note of wit and humor and ran the gamut from light irony and sarcasm to outright mockery and scorn. They also featured a popular idiom and conversational tone and made use of literary devices such as characterization, dialog, dramatization, and narrative voice. They became a sensation and attracted the amused attention of readers throughout France. Who, people wondered, is this clever fellow Montalte? The Jesuits, stunned and slow to respond, seemed to have met their intellectual match.

f. Miracle of the Holy Thorn

During the same week that Pascal’s fifth provinciale (a polemic against Jesuit casuistry) was published, and just when rumors of new antagonism and royal disfavor with Jansenism began to circulate, an extraordinary event occurred at Port-Royal. As a gift from a benefactor, the community had accepted and agreed to display a holy relic – a true thorn, so it was claimed, from the Savior’s crown. Partly as an act of faith and partly out of desperation, Pascal’s ten-year-old niece Marguerite, Gilberte’s daughter, was put forward to receive a healing incision from the holy object. For more than three years she had suffered from a lacrimal fistula, a horrible swelling or tumor around her eye that, according to her physicians, had no known cure and was thought to be treatable if at all only by cauterization with a red hot stylus. Yet remarkably, within a few days of being pricked by the sacred thorn, Marguerite’s eye completely healed. The seeming miracle excited the Pascal family and the entire Port-Royal community; news of the event soon spread outside the walls of Port-Royal and around the nation. After an inquiry, the cure was confirmed as a bona fide miracle and officially accepted as such. Port-Royal rejoiced, and for a while the antagonism against it from the larger Catholic community abated. Pascal regarded the miracle as a sign of divine favor for his Lettres project and for the cause of Jansenism in general. It also confirmed his belief in miracles, a belief that would form part of the foundation for his view of religious faith as set forth in the Pensées.

Despite the auspicious sign of heavenly favor, and even though the Lettres were brilliantly successful in the short term, they failed in their ultimate goal of vindicating Arnauld and Port-Royal. A papal “bull” condemning Jansenism was issued by Alexander VII in October of 1656 and approved in France in December of 1657. An official oath decreeing that Jansenist doctrine was contaminated by heresy was circulated and all French priests, monks, and nuns, including the Port-Royalists and Pascal’s sister Jacqueline, were compelled to sign. In 1660 the “little schools” of Port Royal, renowned for excellence and models of progressive education, were closed. In 1661 the monastery was no longer allowed to accept novices. Early in the next century the abbey would be abolished, the community of worshippers disbanded, and the buildings razed. Overwhelmed by a combined force of royal politics and papal power, Port-Royal would lie in ruins and Jansenism, though it would inspire a few random offshoots and latter-day imitations, would find itself largely reduced to an interesting but brief chapter in the history of French Catholicism.

Meanwhile, in the spring of 1658, as he was studying the Bible and doing preparatory work for what was to be his magnum opus – the great Apology for Christianity that would become the Pensées – Pascal turned his attention once again to mathematics and to the problem of the roulette or cycloid. Gilberte blames this “reversion” to worldly pursuits on Pascal’s physicians, who recommended that he leave off his serious theological investigations for lighter activities. She also claims that the solution to the problem, which had challenged the likes of Galileo, Torricelli, and Descartes, came to him almost despite himself and during a bout of sleeplessness caused by a toothache. She finally alleges that Pascal decided to make his discovery public only when he was at length persuaded by others that it was God’s will. Gilberte’s claims are questionable. What is known is that when Pascal, under the pseudonym Amos Dettonville, actually did publish his solution, which was done within the context of a contest or challenge that he had thrown out to some of the best mathematical minds of Europe, the result was a controversy that occupied his time and energy for several months and which distracted him from working on his new project.

The Pensées occupied Pascal’s final years and were undertaken at a time when his health, which was never robust, deteriorated and grew progressively worse. Originally conceived as a comprehensive defense of the Christian faith against non-believers, the work in its existing form is a rich assortment of notes, fragments, aphorisms, homilies, short essays, sermonettes, and aperçus that even in their disorganized and unfinished state constitute a powerful and fascinating contribution to philosophy, theology, and literary art.

Pascal worked determinedly on the Pensées to the extent that his health permitted him, which was unfortunately not very often or for very long. By early 1659 he was already seriously ill and could work for only short spurts before succumbing to mental and physical exhaustion. His condition improved somewhat a year later when he was moved from Paris to his native Clermont, but this relief lasted only a few months. When he returned to Paris he mustered enough energy to work out his plan for a public shuttle system of omnibuses for the city. When this novel idea was realized and put into actual operation in 1662, Paris had the first such transit system in the world.

The last two years of Pascal’s life were spent in Paris under the care and supervision of Gilberte and Florin, who had taken a home nearby. It was a grim period for all the Pascals; Jacqueline died in 1661, only a few months after being forced to subscribe to the formulary condemning Jansen’s Augustinus as heretical. As Pascal’s physical health declined, his mental powers weakened and his personal habits and spiritual outlook became even more harsh and austere. According to Gilberte, he regarded any sort of dining pleasure or gastronomic delight as a hateful form of sensuality and adopted the (very un-Gallic) view that one should eat strictly for nourishment and not for enjoyment. He championed the ideal of poverty and claimed that one should prefer and use goods crafted by the poorest and most honest artisans, not those manufactured by the best and most accomplished. He purged his home of luxuries and pretty furnishings and took in a homeless family. He even cautioned Gilberte not to be publicly affectionate with her children – on grounds that caresses can be a form of sensuality, dependency, and self-indulgence. In his opinion, a life devoted to God did not allow for close personal attachments – not even to family.

During his last days he burned with fever and colic. His doctors assaulted him with their customary cures. He wavered in and out of consciousness and suffered a series of recurrent violent convulsions. However, Gilberte attests that he recovered his clarity of mind in time to make a final confession, take the Blessed Sacrament, and receive extreme unction. His last coherent words were reportedly “May God never abandon me.” He died at 1:00 AM August 19, 1662, at the age of 39.

Even post-mortem Pascal was unable to escape the curiosity and intrusiveness of his physicians. Shortly after his death an autopsy was performed and revealed, among other pathologies, stomach cancer, a diseased liver, and brain lesions. Nor after death, was he granted peace from the still ongoing crossfire between Jesuits and Port-Royal. Was Pascal, it was asked, truly orthodox and a good Catholic? A sincere believer and supporter of the powers of the Pope and the priesthood and the efficacious intervention of the Saints? Did he reject the Jansenist heresy on his deathbed and accept a more moderate and forgiving theology? Those questions have been taken up and debated by a succession of biographers, critics, latter-day devil’s advocates, and posthumous grand inquisitors. His works have fared better, having received, during the three and a half centuries since his death, first-rate editorial attention, a number of superb translations, and an abundance of expert scholarly commentary. The Pensées and the Provincial Letters have earned him a place in the pantheon of French philosophical non-fiction alongside names like Montaigne, Descartes, Voltaire, Rousseau, and Sartre.

2. Literary and Religious Works

a. Provincial Letters

Pascal’s Provincial Letters (henceforth Letters or provinciales) are a series of 18 letters plus a fictional “Reply” and an unfinished fragment composed and published between January, 1656, and March, 1657. Their aim was to defend the Jansenist community of Port-Royal and its principal spokesman and spiritual leader Antoine Arnauld from defamation and accusations of heresy while at the same time leading a counter-offensive against the accusers (mainly the Jesuits). Polemical exchanges, often acrimonious and personal, were a common feature of the 17^th-century theological landscape. Pascal ventured into this particular fray with a unique set of weapons – a mind honed by mathematical exercise and scientific debate, a pointed wit, and sharp-edged literary and dramatic skills.

In the background of the letters stand two notable events: (1) In May of 1653, Pope Innocent X in a bull entitled Cum Occasione declared five propositions supposedly contained in Cornelius Jansen’s Augustinus to be heretical. (2) In January of 1656, after a long and heated trial, Arnauld, who had repeatedly denied that the five propositions were in Jansen’s text, was officially censured and expelled from the Sorbonne.

The five propositions can be stated as follows:

1. Even the just, no matter how hard they may strive, lack the power and grace to keep all the commandments.

2. In our fallen condition it is impossible for us to resist interior grace.

3. In order to deserve merit or condemnation we must be free from external compulsion though not from internal necessity.

4. It is heresy to say that we can either accept grace or resist it.

5. Christ did not die for everyone, but only for the elect.

Two separate questions were at stake: (1) Are the propositions actually in Jansen, if not explicitly and verbatim, then implicitly in meaning or intention? This was the so-called question of fact (de fait). (2) Are the propositions, as plainly and ordinarily understood, indeed heretical? This was the question of right or law (de droit). The Port-Royal position was yes in the case of the second question, no in the case of the first. Arnauld claimed that the propositions do not occur, verbatim or otherwise, anywhere in Jansen’s text, but he acknowledged that if they did occur there (or for that matter anywhere), they were indeed heretical. Despite the fact that he disavowed any support for the five propositions, he and the Port-Royal community as a whole stood under suspicion of secretly approving, if not openly embracing them.

Such was the situation that Pascal found himself in when he sat down to compose the first provinciale. What he produced was something utterly new in the annals of religious controversy. In place of the usual fury and technical quibbling, he adopts a tone of easy-going candor and colloquial simplicity. He presents himself as a modest, ordinary, private citizen (originally anonymous, but later identified in the collected letters by the pseudonym Louis de Montalte) who is writing from Paris to a “provincial friend.” “Montalte’s” purpose is to pass along his personal observations, insights, and commentary on the learned and mighty disputes that recently took place at the Sorbonne. In essence, via his fictional persona, Pascal provides an account of l’affaire Arnauld and the case against Jansenism as viewed by a coolly observant, playful outsider.

In the course of the letter, Pascal/Montalte introduces a series of fictional interlocutors who explain or advocate for the Jansenist, Jesuit, and Thomistic views on a range of theological issues, most notably the doctrines of sufficient grace vis-à-vis efficacious grace and the notion of proximate power. These happen to be exactly the sort of deeply esoteric, highly technical, theological matters that “Montalte” and his “provincial friend” (and thus, by extension and more importantly, his target audience of plain-spoken, commonsense, fellow citizens) were likely to find strained, incomprehensible, and somewhat silly. Through devices of interview and dialogue Montalte manages to present these issues in relatively clear, understandable terms and persuade the reader that the Jansenist and Thomist views on each are virtually identical and perfectly orthodox. He goes on to show that any apparent discrepancy between the two positions – and in fact the whole attack on Jansenism and Arnauld – is based not on doctrine, but is entirely political and personal, a product of Jesuit calumny and conspiracy. In effect, a complicated theological conflict is presented in the form of a simple human drama. Irony and stinging satire are delivered with the suave aplomb of a Horatian epistle.

Not all of the provinciales deal with the same issues and concerns as the first. Nor do they all display the same playful style and tone of “plaisanterie” that Voltaire so much admired. In fact some of the later letters, far from being breezy and affable, are passionate and achieve sublime eloquence; others are downright vicious and blistering in their attack. Letters 1-3 offer a defense of Arnauld, challenging his trial and censure. Letter 4, pitting a Jesuit against a Jansenist, serves as a bridge between provinciales 1-3 and 5-10. Letters 5-10 attack Jesuit casuistry and doctrine; in them Montalte accuses the Society of hypocrisy and moral laxity and of placing ease of conscience and the glory of the Order above true Christian duty and love of God. Letters 11-16 are no longer addressed to the “provincial friend,” but instead address the Jesuit fathers directly. Letter 14 includes an extended discussion of both natural and divine law and makes an important ethical distinction between homicide, capital punishment, and suicide. Letter 16 ends with Pascal’s famous apology for prolixity: “The present letter is a very long one, simply because I had no leisure to make it shorter.”) Letters 17 and 18 are addressed to Father Annat, SJ, confessor to the King, and are direct and personal. Here Pascal virtually abandons the artifice of “Montalte” and seems almost to come forward in his own person. In Letter 17, a virtual reprise and summation of the case of the five propositions, he repeats once again that he writes purely as a private citizen and denies that he is a member of Port Royal. Since Pascal was neither a monk nor a solitaire within the community, the claim is technically accurate, though it arguably leaves him open to the same charges of truth-bending and casuistry that he levels against the Jesuits.

Although the Letters gained a wide readership and enjoyed a period of popular success, they failed to achieve their strategic goal of preserving Port-Royal and Jansenist doctrine from external attack. They also had a few unfortunate, unintended consequences. They were blamed, for instance, for stirring up cynicism, disrespect, and even contempt for the clergy in the minds of ordinary citizens. Quickly translated into English and Latin, they also became popular with Protestant readers happy to extend Pascal’s wounding attack on Jesuit morality into a satirical broadside against Catholicism as a whole. After the publication of the provinciales, the term Jesuitical would become synonymous with crafty and subtle and the words casuistry and casuistical would never again be entirely free from a connotation of sophistry and excuse-making. Banned by order of Louis XIV in 1660 and placed on the Index and burned by the Inquisition, the provinciales nevertheless lived on underground and abroad with their popularity undimmed.

Today, the provinciales retain documentary value both as relics of Jansenism and as surviving specimens of 17^th-century religious polemic, but modern readers prize them mainly for their literary excellence. They represent the original model not only for the genre of satirical non-fiction, but for classic French prose style in all other genres as well. Rabelais and Montaigne were basically inimitable and far too quirky and idiosyncratic to serve as a style model for later writers. Pascal’s combination of brisk clarity and concise elegance set a pattern for French authors from La Rochefoucauld, Voltaire, and Diderot to Anatole France. Even Paul Valéry, arguably Pascal’s most severe critic, excoriated his predecessor in a prose style heavily indebted to him. Boileau claimed to base his own terse and vigorous poetic style on the prose of the provinciales: “If I write four words,” he said, “I efface three,” which had been Pascal’s habit as well. Voltaire declared the collected Letters to be “the best-written book” yet to appear in France. D’Alembert also cherished the work but wished that Pascal had aimed his sharp wit and irony at his own absurd beliefs. He argued that Jansenism is every bit as “shocking,” and as deserving of scorn and ridicule, as the doctrines of Molina and the Jesuits. Of Pascal’s modern readers only the arch conservative Joseph de Maistre, spearhead of the counter-Enlightenment, utterly scorned the work, calling Jansenism a “vile” and “unblushing” heresy and finding the style of the Letters rancorous and bitter.

In the end, it’s unfortunate that the principal debate in the provinciales was theological rather than philosophical, for it would have been useful and interesting to have Pascal’s candid discussion of free will vs. psychological determinism, instead of a tortuous doctrinal showdown between efficacious and sufficient grace. Jansen’s own formula – that “man irresistibly, although voluntarily, does either good or evil, according as he is dominated by grace or by concupiscence” – is paradoxical and tries to have it both ways. (Can an act be both voluntary and irresistible?) Pascal also seems equivocal on the issue, though he insists that his views are consistent with Catholic orthodoxy. He wrestled with the problem of grace and free will not only in the Letters, but also in portions of the Pensées and especially in his Écrits sur la grâce (1657-58), where he offers an extensive commentary on Augustine and compares the Calvinist, Jansenist, and Jesuit views. However, even there his account is abstruse and theological rather than blunt and philosophical and is thus of interest mainly to specialists rather than general readers.

b. Pensées

i. Plan and Purpose of the Work and its Textual History

The Pensées are a rarity among literary and philosophical works – a magnum opus by a major author that has achieved classic status despite being unfinished, fragmentary, and almost scrapbook-like in form. The Aeneid, The Canterbury Tales, De Rerum Natura, Kafka’s manuscripts all had work remaining or were incomplete when their authors died, but they seem like final drafts compared to the Pensées. Sainte-Beuve compared the work to a tower in which the stones have been piled up but not cemented. The text, as we have it today, represents the assembled notes, fragments, miscellaneous aphorisms, and short essays-in-progress of what was to be a detailed and comprehensive Apology for Christianity – a defense of the faith against atheism, deism, libertinism, pagan philosophy, and the cult of honnêteté.

Inspired by the force and certainty of his own conversion and by the late excitement of the Holy Thorn, Pascal was further encouraged by the recent success of the provinciales. Confident in his powers of argument and persuasion, both logical and literary, he felt called upon to undertake a bold new project. The new work was to be nothing less than a definitive affirmation and justification of Christianity against its detractors and critics. It would also be an exercise in spiritual outreach and proselytization – an earnest appeal, addressed to both the reason and the heart, inviting scoffers, doubters, the undecided, and the lost to join the Catholic communion. In the Pensées, Pascal would assume the role of both Apologist and Apostle.

In the spring of 1658, he presented a detailed outline of his project, explaining its scope and goals, to an audience of friends and members of Port-Royal. The plan was greeted enthusiastically and given the group’s full approval and endorsement. The work would be unified, but layered and textured, with multiple sections and two main parts:

First part: Misery of man without God.

Second part: Happiness of man with God.

First part: That nature is corrupt. Proved by nature itself.

Second part: That there is a Redeemer. Proved by Scripture. (6/40).

The project was designed as an example of what is today termed immanent apologetics. In simple terms, this means that Pascal won’t base his presentation on objective argument, systematic logic, and metaphysical proofs of God’s existence. Indeed, except for a few instances, such as 135/167, where he finds evidence in nature for a Being who is “necessary, infinite, and eternal,” Pascal eschews most of the traditional proofs of God, even Augustine’s. He will instead appeal to the unfolding history of the Christian faith from its roots in Old Testament prophecy through its early development to the modern Church. Further, he will appeal directly to the subjective human spirit and to each reader’s personal experience, emphasizing our existential human need for God and our feelings of incompleteness and wretchedness apart from Him.

In essence, Pascal will leave it to readers to decide whether his account of the human condition and his descriptions of their social and physical worlds (not as they might wish them to be, but as they actually experience them in our daily lives) are credible and persuasive. If the reader accepts his accounts, Pascal will be halfway to his goal. It will remain for him to further convince readers that the solution to our wretchedness, to the disorder and unfairness of life, is acceptance of Jesus Christ. He will argue that not only is belief in Christianity not contrary to reason, but that it’s the only religion that is fully compatible with it. To support this claim, he will offer historical evidence in its favor from the authority of Scripture and ancient witnesses, and also in the form of miracles, prophecies, and figural (typological) hermeneutics. However, he admits that this evidence will not be conclusive – for Christianity can never be proved by reason or authority alone. It must be accepted in the heart (coeur – a special term in Pascal’s vocabulary that includes connotations of “spirit,” “soul,” “natural human instinct,” and even “love,”): “It is the heart which experiences God, and not the reason. This, then, is faith: God felt by the heart, not by the reason” (424/680).

Such in essence was the plan. Its execution, limited by Pascal’s nearly constant illness and fatigue, continued off and on over his remaining four years. Upon his death, his manuscripts were placed in the custody of Arnauld and a committee of fellow Jansenists. While transcribing the manuscripts, the committee produced two variant copies. The original Port Royal edition of Pascal’s works came out in 1670, incomplete and carefully screened to avoid offending the government. Prosper Faugère brought out a revised and authoritative edition of the work in 1844. Several new editions, with different arrangements of the material, appeared over the next century. The numerical ordering used in Léon Brunschvicg’s 1897 edition became standard, but was superseded first by the 1951 edition of Louis Lafuma (which was based on the First Copy) and then again by the 1976 edition of Phillipe Sellier (which was based on the Second Copy). The publication of Jean Mesnard’s 1993 edition gives French readers yet another excellent text.

ii. Philosophical Themes

Death, God, infinity, the nature of the universe, the limits of reason, the meaning of life – these are just a few of the big ideas and philosophical topics that Pascal reflects on in the short space of the Pensées. Indeed, other than the gnomic fragments of Heraclitus or the terse aphoristic texts of Wittgenstein, it’s hard to think of a work that packs as many provocative philosophical musings into so few pages.

Yet even with its multiple subject headings and wide range of topics, the work can still be read as the deep exploration of a single great theme: the Human Condition, viewed under its two opposing yet interrelated aspects – our wretchedness without God, and our greatness with Him. Pascal argues that without God our spiritual condition is essentially a state of misery characterized by anxiety, alienation, loneliness, and ennui. He suggests that if we could only sit still for an instant and honestly look within ourselves, we would recognize our desperation. However, we spend most of our time blocking out or concealing our true condition from ourselves via forms of self-deception and amour-propre. (Like Augustine before him, Pascal accurately describes mechanisms of denial and ego-defense long before they were clinically and technically defined by Sigmund Freud).

Chief among these ego-protective devices is divertissement (distraction or diversion), Pascal’s term for our continual need and almost addictive tendency to seek out mindless or soul-numbing forms of entertainment and amusement. Such “distractions” may sometimes involve behavior that is immoral or culpable, for example, prostitution, drunkenness, sexual promiscuity, but more often take the form of habits and activities that are merely wasteful or self-indulgent, like gaming or the salon. They may even consist of pastimes that are basically innocent, but which are nevertheless vain, trivial, or unedifying, for example, sports like tennis and fencing. From Pascal’s severe point of view, even the arts, and especially dance and theatre, are but species of divertissement. So are all the luxuries, consumer goods, and worldly delights with which we proudly surround ourselves. According to Pascal, we use these goods and activities not, as we self-flatteringly suppose, to certify our achievements or add a touch of bonheur to our inner life. On the contrary, we use them mainly as a way of concealing our bleak inner reality from ourselves and from one another. They are a means of denying our own mortality and hollowness. (136/168; 139/171.)

iii. Between Misery and Grandeur

In effect diversions prevent us from acknowledging our essential misery. They create a false sense of security that hides the abyss or vacuum within. On the other hand, wretchedness and insecurity are only part of our nature. Our condition, as Pascal points out repeatedly in the Pensées and also in his “conversation” with Sacy, is dual. We are one part misery and one part grandeur; and alongside our feelings of isolation and destitution we also have a profound sense of our intrinsic dignity and worth. Pascal calls us “thinking reeds,” though his stress is on thinking. For thought, he argues, is the whole basis of our dignity, the attribute of our nature that elevates and separates us from the rest of the material universe. It’s an accident of history that Pascal’s collection of notes came to be called Pensées. But the title is appropriate, since the work as a whole could well be described as an extended meditation on human consciousness, on what it means to think.

iv. Critical Approaches and Interpretation

Criticism and interpretation of the Pensées have followed two main approaches. The first, which could be called the conventional or historical approach, is the one favored by most literary scholars and historians of religion, including most notably Philippe Sellier, David Wetsel, and Jean Mesnard. According to this view the Pensées are to be understood within the context and framework of traditional Christian apologetics. Moreover, the author’s original design and purpose (so far as modern scholarship can determine them) are to be carefully reconstructed and fully respected. Most of the biographers and critics who follow this approach agree that Pascal’s primary purpose was to articulate and defend Christianity – and especially the Augustinian-Jansenist form of Christianity practiced at Port-Royal – against its skeptical, atheistic, and deistic opponents. In particular, they argued, Pascal aims to convert the contemporary free-thinker and honnête homme – that is to say, a figure much like his friends Mitton and Méré and indeed not unlike a secular, rationalistic, and worldly version of himself. The work is thus understood to be not an inner drama enacting Pascal’s own personal struggles with religious belief but rather an artfully contrived dialog with and rhetorical proselytization of an imagined adversary. The “I” of the work, in this view, is not Pascal himself in propria persona but a polyphonic fiction – a range of literary voices and masks adopted by Pascal strictly as a rhetorical device and as a means of persuasion. Thus, any time we seem to hear the narrative voice of the Pensées expressing fear, doubt, conflict, or existential agony we are to understand that voice not as Pascal’s own, but as that of a literary creation or persona whose utterances are to be interpreted ironically or as presented for dramatic or rhetorical effect.

Although he was neither a literary scholar nor a historian of religion (but more like a cantankerous version of each), Voltaire seems to have read and understood the Pensées in this traditional way. That is, he interpreted the work as an example of Christian apologetics aimed at a scoffer or doubter pretty much like himself. Needless to say, he was not swayed by Pascal’s arguments. To the claim that the human condition is one of anxiety and wretchedness, he responds that we are neither as wicked nor as miserable as Pascal says. As for Pascal’s extensive discussion of miracles, prophecy, the figurative interpretation of Scripture, and the like, Voltaire regards the effort as so much wasted breath. He even suggests that Christianity would be better off without such strained and overwrought apologetics, which he compared to trying to prop up an oak tree by surrounding it with reeds.

The poet and critic T. S. Eliot, in his 1933 introductory essay to the Pensées, also interprets the work in this traditional way. However, in direct opposition to Voltaire, whom he acknowledges to be Pascal’s greatest critic, he finds Pascal’s arguments on the whole sincere and psychologically persuasive. He departs from the traditional reading only to the extent that he considers the Pensées not only as a work of Christian apologetics but also as an example of spiritual biography, an expression of Pascal’s forceful and idiosyncratic personality and unique combination of passion and intellect (360).

In opposition to this essentially historical and scholarly way of reading the Pensées, several critics and commentators, from Chateaubriand and Walter Pater to Paul Valéry, AJ Krailsheimer, and Lucien Goldmann, have offered versions of what might be called a “romantic,” “confessional,” or “phenomenological” approach. According to this line of interpretation, Pascal’s fragmentary narrative represents either a fictional portrait of a soul in crisis or a true personal confession in the manner of Augustine (and later Rousseau). That is, it presents a cri de coeur or cri de triomphe that provides a direct look into the heart and soul of a penitent former sinner who, after a long and agonizing struggle, finds Christ and renounces the world. Romantic readers themselves disagree on the extent to which this exercise in self-revelation is a conscious product – that is, a carefully arranged and skillfully made artifact – or, in a more psychoanalytic vein, the expression of the author’s actual inner conflicts and unconscious motives and intentions. They also offer different interpretations of the audience or addressee of the work. Are the Pensées a dramatic monologue? A private confession addressed to God? A dialog between Pascal and the reader? Between Pascal and himself? Are they truly intended to convert a Méré or a Mitton, and are they addressed only to skeptics and those lacking faith? Or are they meant also as a meditative exercise and inspiration for active Christians, a spiritual tool to help guide believers and strengthen their faith? Or perhaps Pascal, in the manner of St. Paul, is trying to be all things to all people and thus to a certain extent trying to do some or all of the above at the same time?

The great Victorian critic Walter Pater compares the Pensées to Shakespearian tragedy and notes that Pascal is not a converted skeptic or former infidel who has seen the light. Instead, he seems caught “at the very centre of a perpetually maintained tragic crisis holding the faith steadfastly, but amid the well-poised points of essential doubt all around him.” The Pensées, Pater goes on to claim, dramatize an intense inner dialectic: “no mere calm supersession of a state of doubt by a state of faith; the doubts never die, they are only just kept down in a perpetual agonia.”

This view of the Pensées as an interior dialogue or psychomachia dramatizing Pascal’s own personal struggle between faith and doubt is thoroughly rejected by Jean Mesnard and other scholars who insist that any hint of such a struggle is merely a rhetorical pose on Pascal’s part and employed for dramatic effect.

Pascal was proclaimed a heretic and a Calvinist during his lifetime and has been called everything from a skeptic to a nihilist by modern readers. So to a certain extent Paul Valéry in his controversial essay “Variations on a Pensée” was for the most part only repeating criticisms of the author that earlier critics, many of them Catholic clergymen, had made before (for example, that he was a poor theologian, that he was insensitive to natural beauty and to art, and so forth). Valéry seems to recognize a distinction between Pascal the author and the “I” of the Pensées, but he finds the “I” of the work so artificial and overwrought that he accuses the author of being hypocritical and insincere. Thinking of the passage in the Pensées about the terror induced by “the eternal silence” of infinite space (201/233), he says, here is a “strange Christian,” who gazes upon the starry heavens yet fails to discover his Heavenly Father. Echoing a criticism formerly made by Voltaire, Valéry likens Pascal to a tragic poet who portrays the human condition as much bleaker and harsher than it actually is; who describes the fears and torments of life vividly, but who depicts its delights and joys, its moments of excitement and intensity, hardly at all.

Lucien Goldmann has argued that the fragmentary form of the Pensées may be an accident due to Pascal’s death, but it also qualifies as a brilliantly achieved creative product, an aesthetically and psychologically appropriate form that not only reflects the true style and state of mind of Pascal himself and of his narrative persona but also captures the mood and temper of his time. Writing from a Lukácsian-Marxist and evolutionary perspective that he calls “genetic structuralism,” Goldmann views Pascal as both a cutting-edge, creative force and at the same time a product of his personal circumstances and historical era. In this interpretation, Pascal sets up dialectical polarities in the Pensées –man’s wretchedness vs. his greatness; concupiscence vs. godliness and sacrifice; Old Testament type vs. New Testament antitype; reason vs. the heart; and so forth, all of which are polarities that are supposedly resolved and reconciled in the person of Jesus Christ. Those polarities are homologous with and paralleled by the larger historical oppositions of the period: the new science vs. ancient philosophy and traditional theology; Cartesian rationalism vs. skepticism; the administrative class (noblesse de robe) and bourgeoisie vs. the nobility; Protestantism and Jansenism vs. Catholicism; and so forth. Viewed in this way, the Pensées can be seen to encapsulate and effectively dramatize the main intellectual and social dynamics of an entire era.

v. The Wager

One of the more remarkable developments in Western philosophy is the fact that one sliver of the Pensées , a single fragment of a fragmentary text and but a small portion of the untidy, multi-part, unfinished work that contains it, has achieved a full literary life of its own, with its own lively history of commentary and criticism. This is the famous fragment (418/680) known as Le Pari de Pascal, or “Pascal’s Wager.” Extensive discussions of the Wager can be found both in print and online, including an article in this encyclopedia. These discussions address a range of issues relating to the Wager, such as its status in the development of decision theory and probability theory, the various objections that have been made against it, and the numerous revised or alternate versions and applications that have been derived from it. This section will take up only two matters related to the topic: (1) the question of whether or not Pascal himself sincerely approved the Wager and believed that it presents a legitimate and persuasive argument for faith in God; (2) the response to the Wager on the part of a few selected philosophers and critics along with a glance at some of its precedents in literary history.

Simply characterized, the Wager is a second-person dialog in which Pascal imagines an individual forced to choose between belief in God and disbelief in Him. He analyzes the situation as if the reader-protagonist (the “you” of the imaginary dialog) were involved in a great existential coin-toss game. The conditions and possible outcomes of the Wager are presented in the following table:

	You bet that He exists	You bet that He does not exist
God exists	+ ∞ (infinite gain)	– ∞ (infinite loss)
God does not exist	– x (finite loss)	+ x (finite gain)

Pascal argues that given the terms of the Wager it is not simply prudent, it is practically obligatory to bet on God’s existence and illogical and utterly foolish to bet against Him. For consider: if you bet on His existence, you stand to win an infinite reward (an eternity in paradise) at the risk of only a small loss (whatever earthly pleasures you would be required to forego during your mortal life). On the other hand, if you bet against His existence, you risk the possibility of an infinite loss (loss of paradise – along with the possibility of an eternity in Hell) for only a limited gain (the opportunity to enjoy a few years’ worth of worldly delights).

Pascal was a lifelong Catholic whose personal conversion from lukewarm to whole-hearted faith was accomplished not by rational argument but by a life-changing mystical experience. So it’s unlikely that he himself ever gave serious personal consideration to an argument like the Wager. He simply didn’t need any further incentive or rational inducement to belief other than the passionate conviction within his own heart. On the other hand, it’s not unlikely that he thought the Wager might appeal to and perhaps even sway a libertine, a skeptic, or a Deist who might be teetering on the brink of belief. And that goes even more for a figure like a Méré or Mitton or any of the other young gallants and connoisseurs of honnêteté whom Pascal came to know in the salons and gaming rooms of Paris. After all, what better than a wager to entice a gambler? “Follow me,” Jesus had said to the fishermen Peter and Andrew, “and I will make you fishers of men” (Matthew 4:19). Similarly, Pascal, in the role a latter-day apostle, uses a game of chance as a net to bring sinners to salvation.

The concept of the Wager was by no means original with Pascal. Versions of it can be found as far back as Euripides’ The Bacchae. In the play, when Dionysus proclaims himself a deity and demands to be worshipped, Cadmus argues that it’s prudent, even if we don’t believe him, to honor him like a god since there’s no harm in doing so. (On the other hand, we risk a great deal of personal hardship by failing to show him proper reverence if he truly is a god.)

Sir Thomas More’s anecdote of the Gallant and the Friar presents in an inverted form a similar conflict and moral: When a gallant sees a friar walking barefoot in the snow, he asks him why he endures such pain. The friar responds that the pain is trivial, if we remember Hell. “But what if there is no hell?” inquires the amused gallant, adding “then art thou a great fool.” “Yes, master,” the friar replies, “but what if there is a hell? Then art thou a greater fool.”

A comical modern parody of the Wager occurs in the 1951 Broadway musical Guys and Dolls. Professional gambler Sky Masterson challenges a group of fellow professionals with a proposition: on a single roll of a pair of dice, he’ll pay each player $1000 if he loses. But if he wins, the gamblers will have to attend a midnight revival meeting at the Save-a-Soul mission. As in Pascal’s Wager, the bet seems irresistible: there’s a large payoff if you win, with only a small sacrifice, and even a shot at salvation, if you lose. Sky wins his wager. The gamblers are “saved.”

Voltaire called the Wager “indecent and childish” and thought it strange that Pascal reduced questions of the highest gravity to the mathematics of games of chance. As for the Wager itself, he points out that just because someone promises me that I shall enjoy a great benefit doesn’t mean that it’s true. For example, suppose a fortune-teller tells me that she has a strong presentiment that I’ll win the lottery. Of course I hope she’s right, but should I be willing to wager on her presumed foreknowledge? If so, how much? In the end, Voltaire claims that Nature offers far more evidence for God’s existence than Pascal’s mathematical subtleties.

Following up on Voltaire’s objections, Diderot pointed out that Pascal’s same basic argument (better to believe than not to believe) would apply equally well to any other religion: “An imam could argue just as well this way.” Indeed, by this logic, it could be argued that the more fanatical the religion, and the more extreme its promised rewards for belief and punishments for non-belief, the more powerful the argument in its favor.

Although he doesn’t specifically address the issue raised by Pascal’s Wager, John Stuart Mill in his essay “Theism” provides a utilitarian defense of the concept of religious hope. In effect, he argues that in a case where the truth is uncertain and the alternatives, immortality of the soul vs. extinction; existence of God vs. His non-existence, appear equally probable, it is legitimate to prefer the more hopeful option as being the choice more likely conducive to overall happiness.

In his essay “The Will to Believe” William James offers a sharp critical assessment of the Wager and finds Pascal’s basic argument to be weak, sophistic, and insincere:

. . . When religious faith expresses itself thus, in the language of the gaming-table, it is put to its last trumps. Surely Pascal’s own personal belief in masses and holy water had far other springs; and this celebrated page of his is but an argument for others, a last desperate snatch at a weapon against the hardness of the unbelieving heart. We feel that a faith in masses and holy water adopted willfully after such a mechanical calculation would lack the inner soul of faith’s reality; and if we were ourselves in the place of the Deity, we should probably take particular pleasure in cutting off believers of this pattern from their infinite reward (224).

However, having said this, James goes on to makes a pragmatic case for voluntary belief similar to Mill’s utilitarian defense of “hope” and to some extent comparable to Kierkegaard’s “leap of faith”. He argues that there are matters where the truth is in doubt and science is incapable of passing judgment as in the question of whether God exists. Where that choice is, in his terms, live (meaning that it seems of vital interest and value to us and engages us emotionally), momentous (meaning that it is non-trivial and has serious consequences), and forced (meaning that we must choose one way or the other and cannot simply sit the fence or stand aside), then it is lawful, indeed even necessary for us to weigh the risks and evidence and choose. In the end, James basically recasts Pascal’s Wager in a new form, re-focusing on its existential and psychological dimensions and dispensing with what he regards as its stagy and cheapening gambling metaphors.

c. Minor Works (Opuscules)

Besides his two major works (the Pensées and the Provinciales), Pascal also wrote several shorter works touching on a wide range of topics – from political legitimacy and social order to Stoicism and romantic love. A brief overview and précis of some of the better known and more important of these minor works follows.

i. Writings on Grace

Essentially an extensive commentary on human nature and the doctrine of divine grace, the Écrits represent Pascal’s most ambitious venture into the arena of Catholic theological debate. First published in 1779, the work was written at the same time as the provinciales and covers much of the same ground (proximate power, concupiscence, free will, and so forth), though in a more serious and less cavalier manner and in a more direct and methodical form. Along with other deep matters, Pascal here explicates Augustine’s distinction between human nature in its unfallen state as pure, innocent, and naturally just, though capable of choice and error, and our postlapsarian condition, which is in thrall to concupiscence and naturally prone, indeed practically bound to do evil if it were not for God’s prevenient grace. Adam was upright but free to fall; we children of Adam are weighed down by sin, and incapable of rising by our own effort. But, we are free to accept grace and can therefore be lifted up.

Pascal dissects the problem of free will in a similarly Augustinian fashion. Adam had free will in the sense that he could freely choose either good or evil, though he naturally inclined to the former. We, in our concupiscent state, are also free to choose. However, we are naturally inclined to prefer evil, which in our ignorant, fallen condition we commonly mistake for good. Pascal also points out that through the grace of Jesus Christ, a grace instilled by the Holy Spirit, we can achieve a redeemed will – a will sufficient to overcome concupiscence and capable of recognizing and choosing good.

Commentators on the Écrits have questioned whether its depiction of grace (which is presented as something largely mysterious yet vital for salvation) is consistent with the rational apologetic approach and systematic style of argument that Pascal sought to use in the Pensées.

ii. On the Geometric Spirit

Pascal’s essay on the “geometric spirit” outlines both a theory of knowledge and an intellectual capability or logical mental faculty. He asserts that geometry and mathematics are the only areas of human inquiry that provide knowledge that is both certain and infallible. He then supports this claim with arguments and demonstrations. He goes on to describe a certain quality or faculty of mind that he calls l’esprit géométrique, which he defines as the ability to take known or perceived truths and to present them in such a way – with such precise steps, perfect elegance, and logical rigor – that their truth cannot help but be recognized and approved by others. Such an irrefutable and triumphant persuasiveness – the ability to vanquish all doubt and counter-argument – seems to have been Pascal’s goal in all his writings, whether on scientific subjects or in matters of theological dispute. In any case, the “geometric spirit” is both a prominent characteristic of Pascal’s own genius as well as an important epistemological idea (illustrating both the powers and limitations of the human mind) that he returns to repeatedly throughout his writings.

iii. Discourse on the Passions of Love

Pascal’s authorship of the “Discourse on the Passions of Love” has been disputed for the obvious reason that its subject (romantic love) and sentiments (that love exalts the soul, that those with the greatest souls make the truest lovers, that secret or undeclared love entails both exquisite joy and agonizing pain, and so forth) are highly uncharacteristic of the writer and would seem to be far outside his range of interest and expertise. Yet the style of the Discourse is distinctively Pascalian and some of the ideas contained in it (such as the distinction between the “geometric” mind and the spirit of “finesse”) are certifiably his own. Thus his authorship, while dubious, is at least possible, and so the question for his critics and biographers becomes: how to account for a work that seems so utterly contrary to Pascal’s own modest habits and reputation, so much more in the spirit of the salons of Paris rather than the cells of Port-Royal?

The most popular way of dealing with the Discourse has been simply to dismiss it as uncanonical and regard it as, at bottom, some kind of anonymously composed pastiche that incorporates bits and echoes of Pascal along with selections from other sources. Alternatively, it could be argued that the Discourse is written in the style and spirit of the Paris salons because Pascal himself intentionally wrote it in that vein, possibly as a kind of literary exercise or demonstration on his part for the amusement of his friends Méré and Mitton and their circle. (One can indeed easily imagine the pair challenging their shy friend to attempt such an exercise and then delighting in his successful performance.) So even though the Discourse may indeed be Pascal’s, its content and sentiments are for the most part artificial and insincere, many of the expressed opinions being mere restatements or variations of age-old commonplaces and platitudes about romantic love taken either from the précieuse poetry of his own era or from earlier literature. (See, for example, the medieval Rules of Courtly Love of Andreas Capellanus, a compendium of witty, lofty, acerbic, or tongue-in-cheek observations about love very similar to Pascal’s.)

iv. Discourses on the Condition of the Great

Despite its minor status, the “Discourses on the Great” is nevertheless of interest since it is the only work of Pascal’s that attempts to formulate something like a social or political philosophy. The work (which is addressed to a young man of high degree) begins with a parable about a castaway on an island whom the inhabitants (owing to his close physical resemblance) mistake for their long-lost king. Such, Pascal argues, is the condition of those born to nobility or wealth within society: it is only by coincidence or lucky accident and by the power of custom and convention, not by nature, that they have their status. From this it follows that persons of rank are obligated to conduct themselves with due humility and must never allow themselves to treat those on society’s lower rungs with insolence or disrespect. Pascal concludes the Discourses by reminding his young learner of his true condition and enjoins him to rule and lead with beneficence.

Simply stated, the political philosophy expressed in the Discourses is noblesse oblige. Pascal acknowledges that the origins of human inequality are of two kinds, natural and institutional. The former arise from relative abilities or deficiencies of mind or body. For instance, A has better eyesight than B; X is taller and stronger than Y).Institutional inequalities, unless they are sanctioned by divine law, are entirely conventional and sometimes even arbitrary and can be rescinded or overturned. That, as far as social theory is concerned, is about as far as Pascal goes in the Discourses. Since his primary purpose is to offer moral instruction to a young nobleman, he doesn’t address topics like property, the social contract, divine right theory, which was a view recently and avidly affirmed by Louis XIV, or the ethics of revolt. From scattered comments in the Pensées, we know that he was politically conservative and despised violence. Apparently his experience during the Fronde led him to believe that even oppressive order is better than anarchy and that there is no worse social evil than civil war (see Pensées 94/128, 81/116, 85/119).

v. Prayer on the Proper Use of Sickness

Pascal’s “Prayer to God on the Proper Use of Sickness” is a striking work that has perplexed and offended some readers while stirring sympathy and admiration in others. Readers of the first sort, knowing of Pascal’s persistent illnesses and chronic pain, are disturbed to find him here not only begging forgiveness for the few pleasures he enjoyed during his brief intervals of health, but even thanking God for his lifetime of afflictions and earnestly beseeching Him for more of the same. These readers view the “Prayer” as an expression of almost pathological morbidity and the testament of a fanatic. Interpreted in this way, Pascal’s portrayal of the pleasures of life as cruel and deadly and of disease and affliction as salutary and healing seem not so much holy paradoxes as evidence of the extent to which the gloom of Jansenism had darkened his entire outlook.

This reading is defective in at least two ways. First, it ignores the fact that the paradoxes invoked in the “Prayer”—life is death; death is life; health is illness, illness is health; pain is pleasure, pleasure is pain; and so forth — are Christian commonplaces and that the rhetorical use of such figures had long been a standard feature of Christian discourse. (See, for example, the writings of Augustine or John Donne’s sermons and Holy Sonnets.) Second, any accusation of exaggerated melodrama or overstatement in the “Prayer” also overlooks the degree to which serious illness and devastating rates of mortality – plagues, deaths, executions, amputations – were an everyday part of life in Europe during the 17th century. Viewed in this context, the “Prayer” may still strike modern readers as unnaturally bleak, but it expresses sentiments and feelings that many of Pascal’s contemporaries would have been familiar with and shared.

The “Prayer” can be more accurately characterized as a simple statement of faith and humility and a plea for patience and courage. It expresses the blend of neo-stoicism and contemptus mundi that was common in prayers and sermons of the day. Christian stoicism had been recently introduced into French literature via the writings of Guillaume du Vair, and Pascal had likely read Epictetus’s Enchiridion in du Vair’s translation. Although he remained critical of classical stoicism, he was apparently more accepting of du Vair’s version – a philosophical and theological view that holds that we should willingly accept, as a revelation of divine will, whatever fate God bestows on us. Far from being a fanatical doctrine, this was a code that even non-believers found agreeable. Indeed most of us find it admirable when individuals who are sorely afflicted with a disease or who have suffered the loss of an organ or limb accept their condition with fortitude and equanimity.

vi. Pascal’s Conversation with M. de Saci on Epictetus and Montaigne

The minor work Entretien avec M.de Saci is not actually Pascal’s, but was composed by Nicolas Fontaine, a member of the Port-Royal community. It is the record of a conversation that took place between Pascal and his spiritual director Lemaistre de Sacy shortly after Pascal took up residence at Port-Royal in 1654. The work wasn’t published until 1736, but it’s an important document nevertheless since it represents the fullest discussion that we have of Pascal’s views on Western philosophy. The portrait of Pascal that emerges from the Conversation is well drawn and seems authentic, and the words and style are recognizably his own. Many of the ideas presented in the work can be found scattered throughout the Pensées, where they are expressed in nearly similar language and where once again Epictetus and Montaigne stand as mighty opposites: the former championing but over-estimating the greatness and nobility of humankind, the latter recognizing but exaggerating our folly and ignorance.

Pascal praises Epictetus as a brilliant philosopher whose knowledge of our essential moral duties and especially of our need for patience, courage, faith, and humility is unsurpassed. Unfortunately, the philosopher’s “diabolic pride” leads him astray. For example, Epictetus wrongly supposes that human reason is a perfectly reliable guide to truth. He also errs in holding that the mind and the senses are sufficient for perceiving and understanding the true nature and overall justice of the cosmos.

Of Montaigne, Pascal remarks that although he was a professed Catholic he nevertheless chose to forego Christian doctrine as a source of moral law and turned instead to his, admittedly fallible, personal judgment and natural instinct as ethical guides. Pascal then goes on to criticize Montaigne for his utter and thoroughgoing Pyrrhonism symbolized by the device of a scales that Montaigne had emblazoned on the ceiling of his study with his famous motto Que sais-je?(What do I know?) inscribed beneath. Pascal argues that, in contrast to Epictetus, Montaigne’s error consists not in glorifying or over-estimating human reason and knowledge but rather in denying them any credit or status whatsoever. Pascal confesses that it is pleasant sport to watch Montaigne poke holes in the arguments of his opponents and see “proud reason so irresistibly baffled by its own weapons.” Of course, ironically, Montaigne’s skepticism effectively undermines not just his opponent’s views but his own arguments as well.

Near the end of the conversation, Pascal launches into an oratorical peroration describing how the errors, imperfections, and opposing polarities represented by the two philosophers are ultimately mediated and reconciled in the person of Jesus Christ. @

It is therefore from this imperfect enlightenment that it happens that the one [that is, Epictetus] knowing the duties of man and being ignorant of his impotence, is lost in presumption, and that the other [that is, Montaigne], knowing the impotence and being ignorant of the duty, falls into laxity; whence it seems that since the one leads to truth, the other to error, there would be formed from their alliance a perfect system of morals. But instead of this peace, nothing but war and a general ruin would result from their union; for the one establishing certainty, the other doubt, the one the greatness of man, the other his weakness, they would destroy the truths as well as the falsehoods of each other. So that they cannot subsist alone because of their defects, nor unite because of their opposition, and thus they break and destroy each other to give place to the truth of the Gospel. This it is that harmonizes the contrarieties by a wholly divine act, and uniting all that is true and expelling all that is false, thus makes of them a truly celestial wisdom in which those opposites accord that were incompatible in human doctrines. . . . Such is the marvelous and novel union which God alone could teach, and which He alone could make, and which is only a type and an effect of the ineffable union of two natures in the single person of a Man-God.

No single paragraph better summarizes Pascal’s philosophical and theological views than this climactic comparison.

3. Mathematical and Scientific Works

a. Conic Sections

Pascal made his first important mathematical discovery and published his first article, the Essay on Conics (1640), at the age of sixteen. Barely an essay at all, the work is a one-page document consisting of three diagrams, three definitions, and two lemmas. Although it had little immediate impact beyond a small circle of mathematicians, it was nevertheless a breakthrough contribution to the emerging new field of projective geometry. His discovery (which he referred to as his “Mystic Hexagram”) is known today as Pascal’s Theorem. It states that if six points are situated on a conic section (an ellipse, parabola, or hyperbola), and if these points are then joined by line segments to form a hexagon, then if the sides of this hexagon are projected beyond the section, the pairs of opposite sides will meet in three points all of which lie on a straight line.

Figure 1: Pascal’s “Mystic Hexagram.” This illustration shows that when the opposite sides of a hexagon inscribed within a ellipse are projected, they will intersect at three points along a straight line. (In this case all the points lie entirely outside the ellipse.)

After his death, Pascal’s unpublished mathematical papers (including what seems to have been a full treatise on conics) were collected by his nephew Étienne Périer. Eventually these manuscripts were turned over to the great German philosopher and mathematician Gottfried Leibniz for his evaluation and use. Leibniz left behind an extensive set of notes on the collection and registered his admiration for Pascal’s genius. Unfortunately Pascal’s original papers have all been lost.

b. Experiments on the Vacuum

In 1644 the Italian physicist Evangelista Torricelli, testing a hypothesis suggested by Galileo, took a glass tube closed at one end and filled it with mercury. He then inverted the tube, open end down, into a bowl also containing mercury and watched as the mercury in the tube dropped slightly leaving a vacant space at the top. Contrary to the prevailing scientific view upheld by Aristotelians and Cartesians alike according to which a vacuum in nature is a physical impossibility, Torricelli surmised that the space at the top of the tube was indeed a vacuum and that it was created by the pressure of the external air, which exactly balanced the pressure exerted by the column of mercury inside the tube.

Pascal learned of the experiment from his former mentor Père Mersenne. Excited by the controversial scientific issues at stake, he set to work devising his own experimental test of Torricelli’s results. Just obtaining the required apparatus posed a huge challenge. Scientists of the era typically had to design, specify, oversee the production of, test, and of course pay for their own equipment. Pascal did all that and then went to work conducting his own experiments and demonstrations. Confident of his results, he went on tour to demonstrate his hypothesis, which he was able to do using tubes of different length and diameter and a variety of liquids. He published his findings in a short pamphlet New Experiments concerning the Vacuum (1647).

The decisive experiment, proving that the level of mercury in the tube was due to external air pressure, was conducted at the Puy-de-Dôme, the mountainous lava dome near Pascal’s native Clermont. Pascal designed and organized the experiment, but because of his health issues it was actually conducted by his brother-in-law Florin Périer along with a team of observers, clerics, and local officials. Using two identical tubes, the team measured the levels of mercury at a base point in the town. Then, with a portion of the party staying behind to monitor the mercury level in one tube, which remained at the home base, Florin and the rest of the party ascended the mountain with the other tube and measured the mercury level at various elevations. It was found that the level of mercury in the mobile (or test) tube varied inversely with the altitude. Meanwhile, the mercury level in the stationary (or control) tube never varied. Repeated experiments produced the same conclusive results: the level of mercury was due to air pressure, which also has the ability to create a vacuum.

Pascal published a record of the experiment in a short document entitled “The Account of the Great Experiment of the Equilibrium of Fluids.” to which he appended a closing note that deserves quotation since it marks a historic turning point in the advance of modern science vis-à-vis ancient authority. On the basis of his experiments, he asserts “that nature has no repugnance for the vacuum” and “makes no effort to avoid it”:

. . . all the effects that have been attributed to her horror have their origin in the weight and pressure of the air, that it is their sole and true cause. . . . It is not on this occasion only that, when the weakness of men has been unable to find the true causes, their subtlety has substituted imaginary causes to which they have given specious names filling the ears and not the mind. Thus it is said that the sympathy and antipathy of natural bodies are efficient causes, responsible for many effects, as if inanimate bodies were capable of sympathy and antipathy; it is the same with antiperistasis and with many other chimerical causes, which but give a vain solace to man’s hunger to know hidden truths, and which, far from revealing them, serve only to cover up the ignorance of such inventors and to feed that of their followers.

One other document relating to the vacuum that dates from this period (October 29, 1647) and which bears special mention is Pascal’s reply to (the felicitously if improbably named) Père Noël. A Jesuit priest who embraced the widely accepted doctrine (approved by both Aristotelian and Cartesian physicists) that nature is a material plenum and will not permit a vacuum, Noël had written a letter to Pascal defending the horror vacui viewpoint and arguing that the empty space that Pascal claims to have observed at the top of the tubes in his experiments was not empty space at all but a space necessarily filled with “rarified air” or some other subtle form of substance. Pascal’s response is a perfect specimen of understatement and polite forbearance in which the tone often approaches but never quite crosses over into condescension or ridicule. The provinciales are usually cited as the original instance of classic French prose style, but the letter to Noël and indeed a number of Pascal’s scientific papers – all notable for their force, clarity, concision, and elegance as well as for their utter absence of bombast, fustian, and needless adornment – could also lay claim to setting the model. An early paragraph in Pascal’s letter succinctly defines his criteria and standards of truth in matters of scientific investigation; two later paragraphs illustrate his tactful but forceful way of dealing with the kind of learned ignorance that Sir Francis Bacon had referred to as “vain imaginations” and the “idols of the theatre”:

The rule [of scientific method] is never to make a decisive judgment, affirming or denying a proposition, unless what one affirms or denies satisfies one of the two following conditions: either that of itself it appear so clearly and distinctly to sense or to reason, according as it is subject to one or the other, that the mind cannot doubt its certainty, and this is what we call a principle or axiom, as, for example, if equals are added to equals, the results are equal; or that it be deduced as an infallible and necessary consequence from such principles or axioms . . . . Everything satisfying one of these conditions is certain and true, and everything satisfying neither is considered doubtful and uncertain. We pass decisive judgment on things of the first kind and leave the rest undecided, calling them, according to their deserts, now a vision, now a caprice, occasionally a fancy, sometimes an idea, and at the most a happy thought; and since it is rash to affirm them, we incline rather to the negative, ready however to return to the affirmative if a convincing demonstration brings their truth to light….

For all things of this kind [that is, hypothetical entities] whose existence is not manifest to sense are as hard to believe as they are easy to invent. Many persons, even among the most learned men of the day, have opposed me with this same substance [that is, rarified air or some comparable ethereal matter] before you (but simply as an idea and not as a certain truth), and that is why I mentioned it among my propositions. Others, to fill empty space with some kind of matter, have imagined one with which they have filled the entire universe, because imagination has this peculiarity that it produces the greatest things with as little time and trouble as little things; some have considered this matter as of the same substance as the sky and the elements, and others of a different substance, as their fancy dictated, for they disposed of it as of their own work.

But if we ask of them, as of you, that you show us this matter, they answer that it cannot be seen; if we ask that it make a sound, they say it cannot be heard, and so with all the remaining senses; and they think they have done much when they have convicted others of powerlessness to show that it does not exist by depriving themselves of all power to show that it does.

Pascal later composed, but never published, two detailed monographs that were discovered among his manuscripts after his death: a Treatise on the Equilibrium of Liquids and a Treatise on the Weight of the Mass of Air. These two treatises represent seminal contributions to the sciences of hydraulics and hydrostatics and include the discovery that if no other forces are acting on a fluid, the pressure will be the same throughout the fluid and the same in all directions – an observation that is known today as Pascal’s Principle. It is in recognition of his important work in the study of fluid mechanics that a standard unit of pressure is today known as the pascal (Pa), defined as a force equal to 1 Newton per square meter.

c. Pascal’s Triangle and Probability Theory

In 1654, Pascal responded to a series of problems posed by his friend Antoine Gombaud, the self-styled Chevalier de Méré, an amateur mathematician and noted gambler. Suppose, Pascal was asked, that you are given 24 rolls of a pair of dice. What is the probability of your throwing double sixes at least one time? Méré also asked a related question known as the “problem of the points” (also known as the problem of the division of the stakes). This problem asks, if a wager game is terminated before it has been completed, how should the contestants divide the stakes? For example, suppose that A and B are playing a winner-take-all game in which a point is scored on every try and the winner is the first player to reach ten points. How should the stakes be divided if the game is terminated after A has 7 points and B has 5?

Pascal developed solutions to these and other problems relating to the calculation of gambling odds and in an exchange of letters shared his insights with the great Toulouse mathematician Pierre de Fermat. Together the two correspondents effectively founded the modern theory of probability.

Part of the foundation for the modern theory is provided in Pascal’s “Treatise on the Arithmetical Triangle,” which he composed in 1653. (He sent a copy of this document to Fermat during their correspondence, but it was never published until after his death.) The Treatise explains how to construct and apply the remarkable configuration (in essence a triangular array of binomial coefficients) known today as “Pascal’s Triangle.” The array had been generated and used previously by Chinese, Indian, Persian, and European mathematicians, and Pascal never claimed to have discovered or originated it. He was simply interested in demonstrating its fascinating properties and powers.

Figure 2. Pascal’s Triangle.

Pascal calls the square containing each number in the array a cell. The numeral 1’s at the top of his triangle head perpendicular rows; those on the left side of the triangle head parallel rows. He calls the third (diagonal) side of the triangle the base. Cells along any diagonal row are called cells of the same base. The first diagonal row (consisting of the number 1) is row 0. The second diagonal row (1, 1) is row 1; and so on. The number value of each cell is equal to the sum of its immediately preceding perpendicular and parallel cells. For example, 120 in the base diagonal (item 4 in row 7) = 36 + 84.

Furthermore, the number value of each cell is also equal to the sum of all the cells of the preceding row (from the first cell to the cell immediately above the target cell). For example, 126 (the number value of cell 6 in row 5) = 1 + 4 + 10 + 20 + 35 + 56 (the sum of cells 1-6 of row 4).

Pascal explains in detail how the Triangle can be used to calculate combinations (that is to compute C in cases where _nC_r₌ n things taken r at a time). As Pascal demonstrates, to find the answer we would move perpendicularly down to the nth row and then move diagonally r cells. For example, for ₅C_4,we would go perpendicularly down to row 5 and then move diagonally 4 cells and find that the number of combinations is 5. Similarly, if we calculate for ₆C₃,we would move down 6 rows and then diagonally 3 cells and find that the answer is 20. And so on. In another section of the Treatise, Pascal explains how to use the Triangle to solve the Problem of Points.

Solutions to Méré’s problems:

1. Probability of at least one double-six in 24 rolls of two dice: 1 – (35/36)²⁴= 0.4914.

2. Problem of points: A needs 3 more points, B needs 5 more points. (Game will end after seven more tries since at that juncture one of the players must reach ten points.) Count 3 + 5 rows on the Triangle; then sum the first 5 items. That sum divided by the sum of all items in the row is A’s portion of the stakes. Then sum the remaining 3 items in the row and divide that total by the sum of all the items in the row. That will be B’s portion.

From the Triangle:

(1+7+21+35+35) ÷ (1+7+21+35+35+21+7+1) = 99/128 = A’s portion.

(1+7+21) ÷ (1+7+21+35+35+21+7+1) = 29/128 = B’s portion.

Expressed as a percentage, A receives 77.34375 percent of the stake; B receives 22.65625 percent of the stake.

d. Infinity

The idea of mathematical infinity – of a number that can be vaguely conceived but whose properties and nature can never be fully understood – has strong affinities with Pascal’s idea of God and also relates to his Wager and to his personal anxiety as he contemplates the “eternal silence of these infinite spaces” (201/233).

Imagine Pascal’s Triangle. Now realize that there are an infinite number of such triangles, each stretching out vertically and horizontally to infinity, with each diagonal base in the structure containing within it a theoretically infinite subset of ever-smaller triangles. Such is the paradoxical notion of infinity, a concept that astounded and haunted Pascal, and which has teased, baffled, and intrigued a long list of theorists and commentators from Nicholas of Cusa and Giordano Bruno to Bertrand Russell and David Foster Wallace. Although the idea of infinity can fill the imagination with dread, it can also, as Pascal points out at the conclusion of his treatise Of the Geometrical Spirit, provide us with a true understanding of nature and of our place in it:

But those who clearly perceive these truths will be able to admire the grandeur and power of nature in this double infinity that surrounds us on all sides, and to learn by this marvelous consideration to know themselves, in regarding themselves thus placed between an infinitude and a negation of extension, between an infinitude and a negation of number, between an infinitude and a negation of movement, between an infinitude and a negation of time. From which we may learn to estimate ourselves at our true value, and to form reflections which will be worth more than all the rest of geometry itself.

e. Solving the Cycloid

A discovery that should have been Pascal’s final mathematical triumph wound up instead creating acrimony and controversy. In the spring of 1658, supposedly as a diversion while contending with a toothache, he took up the problem of the roulette or cycloid, a problem that had puzzled some of Europe’s best mathematicians, including Galileo and Descartes, for nearly a century.

Figure 3: Cycloid

Imagine a point P on the circumference of a revolving circle. A cycloid is the curve described by P as it rolls along a straight line. The challenge is to discover and prove the area of this curve geometrically. Pascal worked out his own solution and then, as was common practice at the time, issued a public challenge to fellow mathematicians. Under the name Amos Dettonville, an anagram of the pseudonym Louis de Montalte, which he had used to write the provinciales (an anagram of the motto Talentum Deo Soli – “My talent for God alone”—according to Morris Bishop), Pascal drew up a list of six problems relating to the cycloid and offered a prize of 600 livres to the first person to solve them (Bishop 222). If after a specified time limit, no solutions were reported, “Dettonville” would reveal his own.

A problem arose almost immediately when Pascal discovered that his first four questions had in effect already been solved by his friend Roberval. The contest was therefore reduced to the final two questions, a change that, unfortunately, was not made clear to all the contestants. In addition, some contestants protested that the time limit was unreasonably short. Christian Huygens and Christopher Wren published solutions, but did not compete for the prize. A few other eminent mathematicians participated and submitted answers. However, Pascal, finding none of the submissions fully satisfactory, eventually revealed his own solutions and declared himself the winner. Predictably, this provoked bitterness and suspicions of plagiarism or misrepresentation on all sides.

Though the controversy left a blemish on Pascal’s reputation, his work on the cycloid has been admired by later mathematicians for its ingenuity and elegance, and he is credited, alongside his great contemporaries Galileo, Torricelli, Descartes, Mersenne, Roberval, Fermat, Wren, and Huygens, as having helped to solve the curve once known for its power to attract and captivate all who studied it as the “Helen of geometers.” In 1672, after having obtained and reviewed copies of Pascal’s papers on conics and the cycloid, Leibniz attested to their brilliance and concluded that were it not for an “evil fate” (by which phrase it’s unclear whether he meant their author’s short lifespan or his absorption in Jansenist theology) Pascal would have almost certainly gone on to make further and deeper mathematical discoveries.

Summarizing Pascal’s scientific and mathematical achievements, it can be said that in an age of amateurism, when everyone from priests and attorneys to soldiers and salonnières dabbled in “natural philosophy,” he was a marvel who often found himself in a position analogous to that later experienced by Newton and Leibniz: that is, he had to communicate dramatically new, highly complex and abstract concepts to readers who lacked his extraordinary mathematical imagination and facility. Having made his discoveries more or less instinctively, using his own private mathematical inventions and methods, he then found he had to “translate” his ideas into the conventionally accepted language and procedures of his peers and fellow numerophiles. Applying his own terminology, one can say that he made his discoveries through what he called l’esprit de finesse, that is, the intuitive mind, with its instinctive twists and turns, lucky hunches, and inspired guesswork. He found, however, that in order to communicate his findings to others he had to turn to what he styled l’esprit géométrique that is, the geometric mind, which he defined as the skill or capacity for “demonstrating truths already found, and of elucidating them in such a manner that the proof of them shall be irresistible”. Excellence in science and mathematics, he argued, requires both capabilities. It was Pascal’s good fortune to possess both l’esprit de finesse and l’esprit géométrique in rare and powerful abundance.

4. Philosophy of Science and Theory of Knowledge

a. Philosophy of Science

Of the many great natural philosophers of the 17^th century – a group that includes both theoreticians and experimentalists and such illustrious names as Galileo, Descartes, Bacon, Boyle, Huygens, and Gassendi – Pascal arguably was the one who came closest to articulating a coherent, comprehensive, durable philosophy of science consistent with and comparable to the standard view that prevails today, except that he came up short. As Desmond M. Clarke has argued, Pascal was torn between his love of geometric proof and pure logical demonstration on the one hand and his skeptical, pragmatic instincts in favor of down-to-earth experimentalism and empiricism on the other. As a result he seemed trapped in a kind of philosophical limbo. (See “Pascal’s Philosophy of Science,” in Hammond, 118.) Similarly, although he seemed to recognize that our knowledge of the natural world is only probable and can never be certain, a part of him nevertheless remained enthralled by the “will-o-the-wisp” or “Holy Grail” of absolute certainty.

In most other respects, Pascal’s outlook is ahead of its time and admirable in its self-restraint and in its awareness of its own limitations. Unlike Bacon, he makes room for hypothesis and even imaginative insight and conjecture (l’esprit de finesse) and also allows a deductive component a la Descartes (l’esprit géométrique). He acknowledges that all hypotheses must be tested and confirmed by rigorous experiments, and even if he didn’t actually carry out his experiments exactly as described, he nevertheless accepts the necessity of such testing. Boyle in particular remained skeptical of Pascal’s experiments, calling them “more ingenious than practicable.” He especially marveled at the availability of 40-ft. Torricelli tubes and of brass fittings engineered to nearly microscopic precision. Attempting to reproduce one of Pascal’s hydrostatic tests involving a fly in a chamber of water, Boyle attests that “upon tryal with a strong flie” the creature “presently drowned” (243.)

Pascal fully understood that once a hypothesis is tested and confirmed, the problem of determining the true cause of the phenomenon still remains and becomes itself a matter for further conjecture. For example, take his prediction, experimentally confirmed, that the level of mercury in a Torricelli tube will decline as altitude increases. Pascal claimed that this phenomenon was due to the weight of air, though he knew that other factors might also explain the same effect. Indeed, for all he knew, an invisible emanation from the god Mercury may have influenced his results. (Ironically, the famous Puy-de-Dôme experiment had been performed near an ancient temple to that deity). As Pascal observed to Father Noël, fanciful explanations for phenomena are as easy to imagine as they are impossible to disprove.

In his correspondence with Noël, Pascal at one point suggests that it is fatal for one’s hypothesis if an experimental test fails to confirm a predicted outcome. However, as he himself and his fellow experimentalists certainly knew, there can be nearly as many reasons why an expected result does not occur, such as defective apparatus, lack of proper controls, measurement errors, extraordinary test circumstances, etc, as there are explanations for a result that occurs as expected. Apparently in his haste to champion the new science of experimentalism against its critics, both Cartesian and Scholastic, Pascal wanted to at least be able to say that if experiments cannot conclusively prove a given hypothesis, then they may at least be able to disprove it. If this was his intention, he was anticipating by nearly three centuries Karl Popper’s theory of empirical falsification and opposed to (and seemingly fearful at the prospect of) any view similar to WVO Quine’s theory of confirmation holism, according to which all scientific claims are at best only probable and there is no such thing as a decisive experiment.

b. Theory of Knowledge

Que-sais-je? (“What do I know?”) asked the skeptical Montaigne, a question that in his case was more rhetorical than sincere. Que puis-je savoir? (“What can I know?”) was Pascal’s more earnest if also slightly skeptical variation. Anticipating Kant, he wondered with what limitations and with what level of assurance we can confidently say we know what we believe we know.

Pascal has been plausibly labeled an empiricist, a foundationalist, even a positivist and a skeptic. The confusion is understandable and is due largely to the fact that his epistemological views are complex and seem in certain respects equivocal or inconsistent. For example, he accepts the rule of authority in some areas of knowledge, such as ancient history, while opposing and even forbidding it in others, especially physical science. He also recognizes three different types or sources of knowledge related to his so-called “three orders”: body/sense; mind/reason; heart/will or instinct, each with its own domain or area of applicability, level of certainty, and tests of confirmation and reliability.

i. Reason and Sense

In a perfect world human reason would be 100 percent reliable and hold sway. Presumably, Adam, prior to the Fall, had such a pristine and certain view of things, such that there was a perfect congruency or correspondence between his inner perceptions and the outer world. Pascal believes that the axioms and first principles of math, geometry, and logic constitute knowledge of this kind. They are perceived directly by reason and (along with any consequences that we can directly deduce from them) represent the only knowledge that we can know infallibly and with certainty. It is with respect to such axioms and principles alone that Pascal accepts Descartes’ criteria of clearness and distinctness as reliable evidence of truth. Everything else is subject to error and doubt.

A critic of Cartesian rationalism and the deductive method, which he referred to as “useless and uncertain” – 887/445, Pascal was for the most part an empiricist and experimentalist who held that our knowledge of the natural world is acquired through the senses and must be tested and empirically verified by experiment. Reason also has a role in this process. It guides our observations and assists us in the forming of hypotheses and predictions. It is reason that also judges and approves (or disapproves) the final results, though it does so on the basis of empirical evidence, not deductive logic or some preconceived system.

In the Preface to his Treatise on the Vacuum, Pascal declares that reason and sense alone must rule and authority has no place in the establishment of scientific truth. Authority is to be respected, he says, in history, jurisprudence, languages, and above all in matters of theology, where the authority of Scripture and the Fathers is omnipotent. But, he argues that in the case of physical science reverence for the ancients can actually cloud the truth and impede the advancement of knowledge, especially when such reverence is, blind, misplaced, or overly devout. He concludes the Preface with a witty reversal of roles in the heated, ongoing debate between “ancients and moderns”:

Those whom we call ancient were really new in all things, and properly constituted the infancy of mankind; and as we have joined to their knowledge the experience of the centuries which have followed them, it is in ourselves that we should find this antiquity that we revere in others.

ii. The Heart

If there is an element of mystery in Pascal’s theory of knowledge, it is in the source of knowledge and inner being that he terms le Coeur. In scattered places throughout the Pensées he makes reference to a logique du coeur or an ordre du coeur. But what exactly he means by such phrases he never clearly explains. The term coeur appears most famously in fragment 423/680:

The heart has its reasons, which reason does not know. We feel it in a thousand things. I say that the heart naturally loves the Universal Being, and also itself naturally, according as it gives itself to them; and it hardens itself against one or the other at its will. You have rejected the one, and kept the other. Is it by reason that you love yourself?

“The heart has its reasons, which reason doesn’t know.” Not only has Pascal’s famous aphorism become an oft-quoted cliché, it has also managed to enter and even permeate popular culture in the form of song lyrics, as the title of a love memoir, and as a message of endearment or benediction on bumper stickers and greeting cards. Even people who have never read a page of the Pensées are familiar with the quote, and while it seems safe to say that Pascal had no such sentimental meaning in mind, amour, in its various senses from romantic love and self-love to charity and maternal instinct, seems an inescapable association when we hear the phrase “reasons of the heart.” In fact, the Catholic scholar Romano Guardini has plausibly offered “love” and “charity” as appropriate translations or synonyms for coeur (133).

It has also been suggested that by “heart” Pascal means something transcending reason and prior to it (Peters 168-171; Kearns 101-02), almost as if it were some kind of Kantian intuition, or as if it were a form of natural or divinely endowed intelligence on the very cutting edge of perception; some instinctive faculty that, without contradicting reason, can either surpass it or supplement it. (110/142). Such a faculty, if it is indeed instinctive, would presumably be inborn and thus either a part of our basic nature and something that all humans share or a special gift or grace bestowed by God to the elect. And if it is intuitive, then it possibly bears some relation to what Pascal elsewhere terms l’esprit de finesse, the subtle or intuitive component of intellect that somehow “sees” or penetrates directly into truths that l’esprit géométrique, the logical or sequential intelligence, can arrive at only via incremental, deductive steps. Heart-knowledge would then be like some faint glimmer or trace of the instantaneous, clairvoyant understanding that the unfallen Adam was believed to enjoy in Paradise. In any case, the notion of a raison du Coeur remains a critical crux in Pascal studies and posed a mystery and challenge to his readers.

5. Fideism

Fideism can be defined as the view that religious truth is ascertainable by faith alone and that faith is separate from, superior to, and generally antagonistic towards reason. Whenever the term shows up in a religious or philosophical discussion, it is typically in conjunction with a list that includes names like Tertullian, Luther, Montaigne, Kierkegaard, Wittgenstein, and William James. Pascal’s name is often inserted into this group.

Based on the foregoing definition of fideism, Pascal does not fit into such a list, though the tendency to include him is understandable. Perhaps the most compelling evidence in favor of labeling him a fideist is the striking fact of his midnight conversion and “Night of Fire,” the powerful, visionary experience, clearly more mystical than rational, on the basis of which he wound up explicitly rejecting “the god of the philosophers.” However, just because the medium or process through which a belief is achieved may not be rational, doesn’t mean that the belief itself is unreasonable. For Pascal, that belief was his acceptance of Jesus Christ as his Lord and Savior. Kekule discovered the shape and structure of the benzene molecule in a dream. Though his means of discovery was non-rational, what he discovered was quite reasonable and proved true.

Another reason why Pascal’s religious views are sometimes confused with fideism is his notion of an infinite and hidden God, who is essentially beyond our comprehension and understanding and whose existence and nature transcends the limited perspectives of reason and sense perception. However, once again, just because God surpasses or eludes empirical sense and reason doesn’t mean that He is contrary to or incompatible with them. “Faith,” Pascal writes, “indeed tells what the senses do not tell, but not the contrary of what they see. It is above them, and not contrary to them” (185/265). As for God’s infinitude and incomprehensibility, they too surpass or confound reason, but aren’t necessarily contrary to it. The notion of mathematical infinity baffles us in the same way. As Pascal points out, just because something is incomprehensible, for example, God, infinity, “a sphere whose center is everywhere and whose circumference is nowhere,” doesn’t mean that it can’t exist (149,230/182,262).

Some critics have even used the Wager itself (418/680) as a basis for linking Pascal to fideism since that fragment sets forth and vividly illustrates the view that God’s existence is uncertain and can’t be proved. Of particular significance in this respect is the paragraph in which Pascal, in an observation that seems to echo Tertullian almost as much as St. Paul, candidly acknowledges the “foolishness” of the Christian creed:

Who then will blame Christians for not being able to give reasons for their beliefs, since they profess belief in a religion which they cannot explain? They declare, when they expound it to the world, that it is foolishness, stultitiam; and then you complain because they do not prove it! If they proved it, they would not keep their word; it is through their lack of proofs that they show they are not lacking in sense.

But, again, not being able to prove or give a convincing explanation for a belief is not quite the same thing as saying that the belief is incompatible with or contrary to reason. Conspiracy theories are typically lamely supported and impossible to prove, but they are seldom implausible or illogical. Moreover, it is not just a fideistic claim, but a perfectly orthodox Catholic view (and indeed a widely observable fact) that reason has limits; that it is indeed, as Pascal claims, unreasonable to trust reason too much. “Reason’s last step is the recognition that there are an infinite number of things which are beyond it.” (188/220.)

Pascal eschewed metaphysical proofs of God’s existence not on fideistic grounds because he thought that, as rational constructions, they were contrary to faith, but because he felt they were emotionally sterile and too abstruse and technical to persuade a non-believer:

The metaphysical proofs for the existence of God are so remote from human reasoning and so involved that they make little impact, and, even if they did help some people, it would only be for the moment during which they watched the demonstration, because an hour later they would be afraid they had made a mistake. (190/222)

And this is why I shall not undertake here to prove by reasons from nature either the existence of God, or the Trinity or the immortality of the soul, or anything of that kind: not just because I should not feel competent to find in nature arguments which would convince hardened atheists, but also because such knowledge, without Christ, is useless and sterile. Even if someone were convinced that the proportions between numbers are immaterial, eternal truths, depending on a first truth in which they subsist, called God, I should not consider that he made much progress towards his salvation. The Christian’s God does not consist merely of a God who is the author of mathematical truths and the order of the elements. That is the portion of the heathen and Epicureans. (449/690)

In the end, the strongest reason for denying Pascal a place within fideism is that he believed that even the most “irrational” proofs of Christianity – the prophesies, miracles, typological confirmations, and so forth – were not only not contrary to reason but were in fact perfectly compatible with it. (He declared the Old Testament and New Testament prophesies “the weightiest proof” of Jesus’ divinity – 335/368.) That Christianity is reasonable though not provable by reason effectively summarizes one of the central arguments of the entire Pensées.

6. Existentialism

Pascal is frequently included in the ranks of “existentialist” philosophers, alongside names like Augustine, Kierkegaard, Nietzsche, Heidegger, and Sartre.

Again it can be asked (as it was in the case of his alleged affiliation with fideism) whether he belongs in such a list . Once again, the strict, technical response would seem to be that he isn’t an existentialist–although in this case the label is arguably more appropriate and may even be justified.

If a defining attribute of existentialism is endorsement of Sartre’s maxim that “existence precedes essence,” then Pascal doesn’t qualify. For in his view human beings enter the world with a largely defined and determined nature and a destiny that is partly charted, partly free. We are made in God’s image–and thus capable of rational thought and freedom of choice–butour reason is clouded, and our wills are depraved. We are broken creatures and would be hopelessly lost if it were not for divine grace. If such a view of the human condition is incompatible with existentialism, then Pascal is no existentialist.

On the other hand, if Augustine and Kierkegaard (or for that matter any Christian thinker) can be considered existentialists in some broad sense, then it is hard to see why Pascal might not also qualify. Like Augustine and Kierkegaard, he emphasizes the priority of the individual and the deeply personal character of our choice to believe. Like them, he values and personally exemplifies an extreme inwardness, indeed at times displays an almost fanatical absorption in his mental and spiritual life. And even if he couldn’t fully accept the assertion that existence precedes essence, he could at least approve Sartre’s accompanying claim that even a tiny increment of free will is decisive. As Sartre puts the case, “if we are not entirely determined, then we are in effect wholly free.” Pascal would agree, though he would attribute this freedom to divine grace rather than accepting it as a mere donnée or product of happenstance.

The Confessions, with its focus on the self and personal identity, and especially on the self as a cumulative record, inscribed in memory, of our life-altering decisions and events, is conceivably the first existentialist text. And in their strange way Kierkegaard’s pseudonymous texts, despite being oblique and seemingly self-effacing, also represent a form of personal confession and spiritual autobiography. The Pensées stands as an intermediate text in this series, an experiment in autobiographical apologetics linking the direct, confessional style of Augustine with the multiple personae, lyrical vignettes, and pensive fragments typical of Kierkegaard.

That human life without God is wretched and that the human condition is marked by restlessness, ennui, and anxiety is an observation common to all three writers. Another common feature of their work is the recurrent image of a vast gulf or abyss. Augustine compares the human soul to a deep abyss and likens it to the Nothingness preceding the Creation (Genesis 1:2). Without the light of God, he suggests, we are but a dark emptiness. Kierkegaard argues that human freedom necessarily entails a constant sense of anxiety, and his image of our condition is that of a person standing on the edge of a dark precipice. Pascal’s dread of the silence of infinite space (201/233) and similar images in the Pensées of void and darkness echo these sentiments. And in the background of this imagery also stands the legend of his personal idée fixe – that is, his feeling that he was constantly shadowed by a personal abyss. (This legend relates to the aforementioned story of his accident on the Pont de Neuilly when his coach supposedly almost plunged into the Seine – an unconfirmed but oft-retold event that has been perpetuated and basically permanently enshrined in Baudelaire’s poem “Le Gouffre” and in Freud’s writings on obsession.)

In the Confessions Augustine describes the long ordeal that eventually leads to his conversion. But his narrative doesn’t end at that point. Instead, he must begin a new spiritual test and journey – that of actually living a Christian life. Similarly, Kierkegaard never wrote of being a Christian, but always of becoming one. He regarded an authentic Christian life as a constant trial and task. Like Augustine, Pascal places even harsher spiritual demands on himself after his conversion. And like Kierkegaard, he believes that true Christianity is an ever-striving imitatio Christi, a continual remaking of oneself in the image and spirit of Jesus.

With these resemblances in mind, it’s hardly a stretch to say that entire portions of the Pensées, translated into Latin or Danish, could easily pass for an excerpt from Augustine or from Kierkegaard’s Training in Christianity or another of the author’s “edifying” texts. Similarly, if we place Pascal in a sequence of “Christian existentialist” writers, a line that arguably proceeds from Augustine to Kierkegaard and then on to, say, Unamuno and Berdyaev, we find the same emphasis on personal experience and individual freedom and responsibility; the same rhetorical skill and verbal flourishes; the same flair for metaphor and self-dramatization. In short, if we accept existentialism as not so much a system or body of doctrine, but as more of a perspective or attitude towards life – an exacting and indeed tragic sense of life (depicted graphically and with Dostoyevsky-like force in fragment 434/686) – then Pascal can be considered an existentialist philosopher.

7. Conclusion: Pascal’s Reputation and Cultural Legacy

“Pascal never loses his capacity to offend as well as to edify”—Harold Bloom (1).

“How few,” wrote Walter Pater in what was to be his last work, a sparkling critical essay on Pascal, “how select, are the literary figures who have earned the honor of receiving regular ongoing criticism, both appreciative and deprecatory, from their successors.” Pascal has earned that honor and is of that rare and select company, having acquired during the nearly four centuries since his birth a long line of admirers and detractors, including many of the leading names in world literature. Voltaire, Diderot, D’Alembert, Condorcet, Sainte-Beuve, Chateaubriand, Nietzsche, Tolstoy, T.S. Eliot, Borges, Bertrand Russell, Paul Valéry, Harold Bloom – the list of important writers and thinkers who have studied Pascal and gone on to voice their appreciation or discontent could be extended literally for pages.

In his introductory essay to the Pensées published in 1933, Eliot referred to Pascal as “one of those writers who will be and who must be studied afresh by men in every generation. It is not he who changes, but we who change. It is not our knowledge of him that increases, but our world that alters and our attitudes towards it.” (355)

For some reason Eliot assumed that our knowledge of Pascal was basically complete eighty years ago and that modern scholarship would do little to alter or augment our understanding of his life and work. On this point he was quite mistaken. In fact, on the contrary, owing to the biographical and textual labors of scholars like Lafuma, Sellier, and Mesnard, students of Pascal today have a much fuller understanding of the author’s personal life, family, medical history, intellectual and religious development, and social milieu, as well as a far better sense of the likely order, design, and method of the Pensées, than any previous generation of readers.

Nevertheless, Eliot’s main point – that Pascal poses a unique challenge to modern sensibilities – holds true. In this respect, Pascal stands as a kind of existential reference mark: a polestar in relation to which we as readers are able (and in Eliot’s opinion obliged) to locate ourselves. He remains a fixed point against which we are challenged to measure the sincerity and durability of our own values and beliefs.

Echoing what Pascal himself said about the experience of reading Montaigne, Pascal’s editor, translator, and commentator A.J. Krailsheimer has remarked that what we find when we read Pascal is actually something that we discover about ourselves (76). In effect, what both Krailsheimer and Eliot are suggesting is that ultimately there is not one Pascal, but many – possibly as many as there are readers of his texts. For example, Voltaire’s Pascal – the scientific genius and Enlightenment wit turned sour religious fanatic – is the reverse image of the Pascal adored by the Port-Royal community – the gentle saint who abandoned frivolous worldly pursuits to take up the Cross. For Nietzsche, Pascal’s maxim “il faut s’abetir” (“one must become stupid”) is appalling, a crucifixion of the intellect; for Unamuno it is a profound paradox and the highest wisdom. Valéry’s Pascal is a sententious and badgering preacher, oblivious to the beauty of nature; the Pascal of Sainte-Beuve is an “athlete, martyr, and hero of the invisible moral world.” What Gilberte Perier refers to as her brother’s “second conversion,” Bertrand Russell regards as an act of “philosophical suicide.” And so on. In short, Pascal’s writings, and especially the Pensées, have served less as a window into the author’s soul than as a kind of mirror or prism reflecting the different outlooks and opinions of his readers.

Of course any proper summation of Pascal’s cultural legacy must include his contributions to probability theory and game theory and his invention of the mechanical computer (in honor of which the Swiss computer scientist Niklaus Wirth aptly named his new programming language Pascal). And, one must include all the other eponymous scientific, mathematical, and theological concepts (Pascal’s Theorem, Pascal’s Principle, Pascal’s Triangle, Pascal’s Wager, and so forth) that bear his name. In addition, every modern system of intra-urban or inter-urban shuttle transportation also owes a debt to the philosopher, who first conceived such a system and oversaw its original implementation in the city of Paris.

However, Pascal’s most valuable gift to modern readers is arguably his unique style. His combination of wit, irony, and aphorism, his ease and clarity, his air of someone skilled both in urbane conversation and erudite technical debate was to a large extent already present and on dazzling display in Montaigne. The same features reappear in the writings of Voltaire and the philosophes. And today, thanks largely to Pascal, these attributes have become a part of French literary tradition. However, what sets Pascal’s style apart, especially in the Pensées, is that supplemental to his characteristic élan and luster he adds a tone of existential angst: a visionary quality, together with an element of strangeness that is utterly foreign to the works of Montaigne and Voltaire but which appears powerfully in writers like Dante, Kafka, and Borges. Pascal’s imagination, like theirs, seems haunted by the notion of infinity and by images of mystery and turmoil; by circles, mazes, precipices, and abysses:

“At the far end of an infinite distance a coin is being spun . . .” 418/680.

“Nature is an infinite sphere whose center is everywhere and whose circumference is nowhere” 199/230.

Relatively few writers, and certainly few philosophers, have his uncanny quality, using that term in Freud’s sense as the ability to make familiar ideas seem strange and strange ideas seem familiar. Pater rightly called him the intellectual equivalent of lightning.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Texts and translations of works by Pascal

Faugère, Prosper, ed. The Miscellaneous Writings of Pascal (consisting of Letters, Essays, Conversations, and Miscellaneous Thoughts). George Pearce, tr. London: Longman, Brown, Green, and Longmans, 1849.
Mesnard, Jean, ed. Œuvres complètes de Pascal. 4 vols. (to date). Paris: Desclée de Brouwer, 1964-1992.
Pascal, Blaise, Gilberte Pascal Périer, and Louis Lafuma (ed). Oeuvres Complètes. Paris: Seuill, 1980.
Pascal, Blaise. Thoughts, Letters, and Opuscules. O. W. Wright, tr. New York: Hurd and Houghton, 1869.
Pascal, Blaise. Provincial Letters, Pensées, Scientific Treatises. Chicago: Encyclopedia Britannica, 1952.
Pascal, Blaise. Pensées. Roger Ariew, trans. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Co., 2004.
Pascal, Blaise. Pensées. AJ Krailsheimer, trans. New York: Penguin Books, 1995.
Pascal, Blaise. Pensées and Other Writings. Honor Levi, trans. Anthony Levi, ed. New York: Oxford University Press, 1995.
Pascal, Blaise. Provincial Letters, translated by Hilaire Belloc, Catholic Truth Society, 1921.
Pascal, Blaise. Édition de Pascal, Provinciales, Pensées et opuscules divers. Phillipe Sellier and G. Ferryrolles, eds. Paris: La Pochothèque, 2004.
Pascal, Jacqueline, Gilberte Pascal Périer, and Marguerite Périer. Lettres, opuscules et mémoires de madame Perier et de Jacqueline, soeurs de Pascal, et de Marguerite Perier, sa nièce: Publiés sur les manuscrits originaux par M. P. Faugère. Armand Prosper Faugère, ed. Paris: Auguste Vaton, 1845. (Elibron Classics replica edition, 2001.)

b. Biographical and critical studies

Bishop, Morris. Pascal: The Life of Genius. New York: Reynel & Hitchcock, 1936.
Bloom, Harold, ed. Blaise Pascal: Modern Critical Views. New York: Chelsea House, 1989.
Borges, Jorge Luis. “Pascal’s Sphere.” In Selected Non-Fictions. New York: Penguin Books, 1999.
Boyle, Robert. Hydrostatical Paradoxes: Made Out by New Experiments. Oxford: William Hall, 1666.
Cobb, William Frederick. “Pascal.” In James Hastings and John A. Selbie, eds. The Encyclopedia of Religion and Ethics, Part 18. Reprint. Whitefish, MT: Kessinger Publishing, 2003. 645-657.
Cousin, Victor. Études sur Pascal. 5^th edition. Paris, Didier, 1857. Digitized by Google Books.
Davidson, Hugh M. Blaise Pascal. Boston: Twayne, 1983.
Edward, AWF. Pascal’s Arithmetical Triangle: The Story of a Mathematical Idea. Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press, 2002.
Eliot, T.S. “The Pensées of Pascal.” Selected Essays. New York: Harcourt, Brace, and World, 1964; 355-368.
Faugere, Prosper. Génie et Écrits de Pascal. Paris, 1847. Digitized by Google Books.
Goldmann, Lucien. The Hidden God: A Study of Tragic Vision in the Pensées of Pascal and the Tragedies of Racine. Tr. Philip Thody. Brill, 1964.
Guardini, Romano. Pascal for Our Time. New York: Herder and Herder, 1966.
Hammond, Nicholas, ed. The Cambridge Companion to Pascal. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
James, William. “The Will to Believe.” In Religion from Tolstoy to Camus. Walter Kaufmann, ed. New Brunswick, NJ: Transaction Publishers, 2002. 221-238.
Jones, Matthew. The Good Life in the Scientific Revolution: Descartes, Pascal, Leibniz and the Cultivation of Virtue. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2006.
Kearns, Edward John. Ideas in Seventeenth-Century France. Manchester, UK: Manchester University Press, 1979.
Krailsheimer, A.J. Pascal. New York: Hill and Wang, 1980.
Melzer, Sara E. Discourse of the Fall: A Study of Pascal’s Pensées. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1986.
Mesnard, Jean. Pascal. Claude and Marcia Abraham, tr. Tuscaloosa, AL: University of Alabama Press, 1969.
Mesnard, Jean. Pascal: His Life and Works. London: Harvill Press, 1952.
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Author Information

David Simpson
Email: dsimpson@depaul.edu
Depaul University
U. S. A.

Friedrich Nietzsche: Philosophy of History

Nietzsche was well-steeped in his contemporary methods and debates in the philosophy of history, which carried over into his philosophy in essential ways. Once a prodigy in classical philology, Nietzsche’s philosophy is everywhere concerned with traditions, historical shifts in custom and meaning, and, to adapt his key expression, “how things become what they are”. Beyond these, Nietzsche was closely concerned with the manner these traditions are recorded, emphasized or covered over, as accords the subjective dynamic of those who would claim to know and re-present the past. His earliest philosophical books are marked by an attempt to incorporate Schopenhauer’s notion of timeless ideas into Jakob Burckhardt’s language of historiographical typology. His middle and mature works offer important critiques of both sides of the 19th Century ‘history wars’. Against the Hegelians, Nietzsche rejects efforts to systemize history within rational frameworks as well as teleological schemes generally. Against the ‘Berlin School’ of scientific historiography, he rejects the possibility of subject-free objectivity, realist description, and deductive explanations as to why things happened as they did. In his later thinking, Nietzsche devises his own genealogical mode of writing about the past in response to evolutionary accounts of the development of morals.

This article will trace the context and evolution of Nietzsche’s philosophy of history throughout his career. Attention will be paid, too, to its reception by thinkers in the twentieth and twenty-first centuries.

Schulpforta
Bonn and Leipzig
Basel
Physiognomy and Teleology
Réealism and Genealogy
Reception
References and Further Reading
1. References
2. Further Reading

1. Schulpforta

Nietzsche enrolled at Schulpforta in 1858 at the age of fourteen. The four hundred year-old school was long the standard of humane education in Germany. During Nietzsche’s time there, the character of the school mirrored that of its most venerable literary scholar and historian Friedrich August Koberstein. Embracing those same two disciplines himself, Nietzsche’s first extensive historiographical project covered the saga of the fourth century Ostrogoth King Ermanarich (KGW I/2, 274-284). Even then Nietzsche tried his hand at various historiographic expressions. In 1861, he wrote a symphonic poem entitled Serbia (BAW 2, 32-37). The following year, he presented to his friends Wilhelm Pinder and Gustav Krug three additional “Hungarian Sketches” in imitation of Liszt, whose daughter Cosima was to become Cosima van Bulow and then Cosima Wagner. In the fall of that year, Nietzsche outlined the composition of a dramatic production entitled ‘Ermanarich’ (BAW 2, 144-54), and as late as the summer of 1865, he was considering the performance of an Ermanarich, Oper in drei Akten (BAW 3, 123-4).

Nietzsche’s problem, foremost, is one of conflicting historical sources. Ermanarich, king of Oium in the early 300’s, had been confused over time with various old tribal kings of gothic Germany, like Hermenrich and Emelrich, and the old Danish tribal leader Jarmarich of whom Saxo Grammaticus spoke (BAW 2, 306). His name is Eormenric in the English epic Beowulf and Jörmunrekkr in old Norse songs. His story had been manipulated most egregiously by the chroniclers of the Anglo-Saxons who sought to associate the notoriously cruel and rapacious traits of Attila the Hun with all of their Eastern foes. Whoever Ermanarich actually was, and whatever the factual details of his life and death were, is likely unrecoverable given the discontinuity of the extant historical evidence. But Nietzsche did not rest at the level of philological skepticism. In this, as in his earliest published articles on Theognis and Diogenes Laertius, he constructed a speculative character portrait intended to fill in the missing pieces of the historical story. Such a two-phase meta-historical standpoint—a skeptical realism about the historical sources combined with a psychological constructivism—was indeed cultivated by the instructors at Schulpforta. As Nietzsche’s close friend Karl von Gersdorff would later recall, “[Kobertsein] was pleased in the highest and full of praise for the erudition, the perspicacity, the deductive character and stylistic elegance of his student” (Janz 1993, I 96).

From his work at Schulpforta one can at least begin to outline Nietzsche’s historiographical education in contradistinction to other reigning views. In contrast to Enlightenment historiographers like Voltaire or Gibbon, the young Nietzsche never valorizes his historical figures to make them stand as moral exemplars for our own edification in humanistic ideals. None of the personalities he constructs are enlightened models of rational clarity; each evoke much darker and more earthly psychological compulsions. Nietzsche’s early philological scholarship is in this way more reminiscent of romantic historiography, a likely mark of Koberstein’s influence. Along with Carlyle, Michelet, Schiller, Goethe, and Macaulay, the young Nietzsche conceived the constructive task of the historian as that of a dramaturge who imbues his characters with personality in order to re-enliven formerly lifeless aspects of the past. In the 1850’s and 60’s, the meta-historical theory simultaneously most popular among philosophers and most tendentious among historians was doubtless that put forward by the Hegelian-Marxists. It is apparent that Nietzsche’s Ermanarich project—or for that matter any of his published philology—does not bear even the slightest resemblance to a teleological account, whether idealist or materialist. Ermanarich is not some moment in the march of history, nor some typological phenomenon characteristic of an epoch. Indeed, the conservative religious and constitutionalist leanings of Schulpforta would hardly have been conducive to the Hegelian-Marxist way of thinking.

2. Bonn and Leipzig

Friedrich August Wolf is typically considered the father of German philology. Wolf provided the study of antiquity, more than a generation before Ranke did for historiography generally, its first systematic set of methods and its first aspiration to achieve the same sort of demonstrable progress and rigor as the natural sciences. Wolf’s two most important descendants, Gottfried Hermann and August Boeckh, founded two groups of scholars with antipodal methodologies: the Sprachphilologen and the Sachphilologen respectively. For the former, the scientific status of philology entailed both certainty and objectivity, which in turn meant avoiding as much as possible the intrusion of subjective interpretations of evidence. To do that, the Sprachphilologen narrowed their net of acceptable evidence to that which allegedly needed no interpretation, to that form of evidence whose meaning would allegedly be manifest to whoever could observe it: the written word. The Sachphilologen, on the contrary, considered science as a means of circumscribing the whole of experience. That whole, with respect to antiquity, could be elucidated in part through written accounts, to be sure, but only in part. What counted equally as evidence were the artifacts of antiquity: the plastic arts, the architecture, the coinage, even the clothing, athletics, tools, and playthings. None of these phenomena speaks for itself in the way the written word does. Each requires the understanding of the historian to reconstruct what their meaning might have been—each historical phenomenon, in other words, is meaningful only within a scheme of hermeneutical interpretation. Something of the objectivity and exactitude is lost therein; but the sacrifice is repaid by attaining a more comprehensive sense of antiquity through the totality of its artifacts.

The overwhelming portion of training Nietzsche received in the methods of professional historiography was philological. But in place of a single unitary lesson, Nietzsche found himself immersed directly in a debate about the meaning of the field itself during his education at both Bonn and Leipzig. His teacher Friedrich Ritschl was the student of Hermann and of Hermann’s student Karl Christian Reisig. Otto Jahn, like Nietzsche a Schulpforta graduate, went on to study with Hermann in Leipzig and Lachmann in Berlin. But Jahn was also a student of Boeckh at Berlin, and was considered alongside his friend Theodor Mommsen one of the defenders of Sachphilologie.

Ritschl’s pedagogy mimicked Wolf’s in its holistic approach to shaping not just scholars but men. Yet in his scholarship, he was clearly an adherent of the rigor and discipline of Hermann’s Sprachphilologie. Jahn was equally scientific in terms of rigor. But in keeping with Sachphilologie, he ventured beyond the written word and investigated the wholeness of culture, especially by applying philological methodology to the objects of archeology. In the school year of 1864-5, the same year that Nietzsche entered Bonn, Ritschl and Jahn engaged in a petty yet field-altering squabble that came to be known as the Bonnerstreit. Although Nietzsche took Jahn’s side in the matter—as he wrote to Gersdorff, “Here in Bonn the biggest flap, the worst cattiness about the Jahn-Ritschlstreit still dominates. I consider Jahn unconditionally right” (an Gersdorff 25.5.1865, KSB 2, 56)—he nevertheless had no palpable interest in Jahn’s archeological, artistic, or numismatical studies. His philological articles in those years on Theognis and Diogenes Laertius show a methodological allegiance to Ritschl’s Sprachphilologie, and retain the basic strategy of his earlier effort on Ermanarich in that they rely both on a skeptical realism about the authenticity of the texts and the construction of a Charakterbild in order to supply the psychological motivations for the agents’ behaviors in the historical stories. Both of Nietzsche’s projects were lauded by Ritschl, who transferred to the University of Leipzig, and indeed both were published in his still-active journal, Rheinisches Museum für Philologie. On their merits, Nietzsche famously graduated from Leipzig without a formal dissertation and was given appointment at the University of Basel as a replacement for another of Ritschl’s students, Adolf Kiessling.

3. Basel

In 1869, Nietzsche presented the lecture “Homer und die klassische Philologie” (KGW II/1, 247-69), full of hope for the potential of a renewed and invigorated field. Toward the end of the lecture, however, he declares that that goal must be accomplished by recognizing a new philosophical basis, that “each and every philological activity should be enclosed by and proceed from a philosophical worldview” (KGW II/1, 268). The reference is clearly to Schopenhauer, whom he had begun to read already in the Fall of 1865. Nietzsche and most of his associates at the time sought to combine Schopenhauer’s teaching with historiography. His childhood friend Paul Deussen studied oriental history and culture with Swami Vivekananda—and would found the Schopenahuer-Gesellschaft in 1911. Richard Wagner, who fancied himself at times the reviver of the ‘true’ historical Germanic culture, sent a personal copy of his Nibelungen directly to Schopenhauer, and sometimes touted that his opera was the expression of Schopenhauer’s aesthetics. Erwin Rohde, himself the author of what remains one of the finest scholarly books on Ancient mystery cults and ‘Dionysian’ culture, Psyche: Seelencult und Unsterblichkeitsglaube der Griechen (1890-4), was a lifelong Schopenhauerian. Johann Jacob Bachofen’s psychology of the dark anti-rational undercurrents of ancient history in his Das Mutterrecht (1861) and his critique of scientific ‘objectivity’ both intimate Schopenhauerian influence. And although he is sometimes thought to be anti-philosophical, Jakob Burckhardt was an overt Schopenhauerian—as well as the most renowned cultural historian of his generation.

Nietzsche and Burckhardt had similar upbringings insofar as their introductions to the critical methods of philology extinguished the flame of their devotion to Christianity. Like Burckhardt, too, Nietzsche came to view the obsessive source criticism of Sprachphilologie as a necessary correction of romantic historiography, but also as a potentially detrimental step in the development of an individual scholar and, eventually, in the development of culture. The concern for both at this time is not to report the past with an unattainable degree of objectivity, “wie es eigentlich gewesen ist,” as Burckhardt’s teacher Leopold von Ranke demanded. Rather, “a single source happily chosen can,” for Burckhardt, “do duty for a whole multitude of possible other sources, since he who is really determined to learn, that is, to become rich in spirit, can by a simple unction of his mind, discern and feel the general in the particular” (Burckhardt 1930-4, VII 15). Burckhardt sought to intuit that which was constant, universal, and typical from the welter of particular passing forms. Like Schopenhauer, who himself—despite a massive historical erudition and a cordial acquaintance with Wolf—had almost nothing positive to say about historiography, Burckhardt believed that only the timeless and universal could rise to the level of truth, hence his and Nietzsche’s focus on Kulturgeschichte rather than the passing intrigues of political history. Furthermore, like Nietzsche (at least in these years), but in contradistinction to Schopenhauer, Burckhardt believed that the proper study of history could reveal precisely that: typological traits within people, forms of personalities, and characteristics of epochs. As Burckhardt writes, “Our point of departure is the one and the only thing which lasts in history and is its only possible center: man, this suffering, striving and active being, as he is and was and will forever be” (Burckhardt 1930-4, VII, 3). Indeed, as Nietzsche echoes in his preface to his Philosophy in the Tragic Age of the Greeks (1873), “I am going to emphasize only that point of each of their systems which constitutes a piece of character and hence belongs to that non-controvertible, non-discussable evidence which it is the task of history to preserve: […]” (PtG, P; KSA 1, 801f). For both Burckhardt and Nietzsche, what was most worthy of being taken up by history was never the common or mundane person, but the ‘great man’. For Burckhardt this mainly meant the leading figures of Renaissance Italy, while for Nietzsche, Pre-Socratic Greeks appeared like giants calling to each other in the spirit of competition from atop high mountain peaks.

However true to the philosophy of Schopenhauer Burckhardt styled himself, his conception of the historian’s ability to intuit common formal patterns within the myriad variegations of historical personages was closer to Goethe’s morphology than to Schopenhauer’s aesthetische Anschauung (Gay 1974, 178f). For Goethe, the close observation of the biological development of organic objects, as much as the composition of the dramatic development of a literary character, would reveal Urphänomene or the primary forms of the phenomenon which guided their development. In his dramatic works, Goethe sought to portray the Steigerung of typological characters like Werther, Tasso, or Goetz, whose development over time is not the alteration or transformation of character but its intensification over time. Burckhardt thought the historian’s task was similar insofar as the careful study of historical documents would reveal typological traits among great people, the course of whose development only intensified what was necessarily there from the start.

For Schopenhauer, by contrast, aesthetic intuition was never about discovering typical recurrences in history or a developmental intensification, but gazing beyond the ‘veil of Maya’ in a partial break from the spatio-temporal forms of subjective willing. Aesthetic intuition for Schopenhauer was a non-intellectual and thus non-discursive Auffassung of the Ideas which constitute the first objectification of the one panenthetic Will (that is, the will of a God who is everywhere and in everything). Aesthetic apprehension can only occur when these instrumental satisfactions in the here and now have been removed entirely, when the will of the spectator is silenced. In contrast to art, historiography was merely like science insofar as it only ever studied its objects subjectively, that is, insofar as they might satisfy the demands of the individuated will (Schopenhauer 1977, X/2 459f). Just as the sciences study their objects in order to use them, benefit from them, or solve problems with them, historians only research the topics they do with an eye toward explaining what was previously unknown, solving mysteries, or perhaps toward finding insights to contemporary problems. Indeed, precisely because of the subjective and necessarily temporal judgments of history, Schopenhauer, in opposition to both Burckhardt and Nietzsche at this time, esteemed history insufficient to attain the “deep truths” of the world in the manner of great art. “Wherever it is a question of knowledge of cause and effect or of grounds and consequences of any kind,” writes Schopenhauer, “that is to say in all branches of natural science and mathematics, as also in history, or with inventions, etc., the knowledge sought must be an aim of the will” (Schopenhauer 1977, X/2, 459f). Burckhardt and Nietzsche both thought that history failed to attain the level of science, but for different reasons. Unlike science, history is unable to construct laws by which the historian might predict future cases, and, more importantly, should not try to be scientific since its proper aim was not understanding but creating values. But although Burckhardt had nothing to do with the mystical elements of Schopenhauer’s thought, his younger Basel colleague was less concerned with scholarly restraint.

To Burckhardt’s and Ritschl’s consternation, Nietzsche tried to co-opt the Schopenhauerian aesthetic-metaphysical mysticism in his first ‘historical’ work, The Birth of Tragedy (1872). “But our Nietzsche!” Ritschl would write to Wilhelm Vischer, the man who a few years before hired Nietzsche at Basel, “It’s remarkable how in one person two souls live next to each other. On the one side, the strictest method of academic scientific research…on the other this fantastically-overreaching, over enthusiastic, beat-you-senseless, Wagnerian-Schopenhauerian art-mystery-religion-crap [Kunstmysterienreligionsschwärmerei]! […] What really makes me mad is his impiety against his true mother, who had suckled him at her breast: philology” (KSA 15, 46f). The justification for Nietzsche’s claims about the ‘inner’ or ‘real’ nature of tragedy was never intended to have utilized the same methodology as his earlier philology, no longer aiming at a correspondence between the account and what the evidence portrays to be real, as Ritschl sensed easily enough. In claiming that the real origin of tragedy is a happy confluence of Dionysian and Apolline drives at a particular moment in history, Nietzsche instead makes an intuitional claim that transgresses the boundaries of naturalistic explanation. Nietzsche, as Jahn’s student Ulrich von Wilamowitz Moellendorff famously charged, shunned source criticism, neglected linguistic analysis, couldn’t be bothered to footnote, was generally ignorant of archeology, and “revile[d] the historical-critical method, denouncing any intuition which deviates from his own, and [ascribed] a ‘complete misunderstanding of the study of antiquity’ to the age in which philology in Germany, due to Gottfried Hermann and Karl Lachmann was raised to an unprecedented height” (Wilamowitz-Moellendorff 1872, 5). Beyond traditional historical versions of intuition in the manner of Herder or Burckhardt, Nietzsche’s believes his own intuitions about tragedy are true precisely insofar as he has left the phenomenal realm behind and become identified with the inner nature of the tragic world in-itself. Through a sort of mystical echo of the ancient standard of truth as identity between the subject and object, the principle that “like is known by like,” Nietzsche thinks he can communicate the real inner Idea of tragedy:

Only insofar as the genius, during the act of artistic procreation, merges fully with that original artist of the world does he know anything of the eternal essence of art; for in this condition he resembles, miraculously, that uncanny image of fairy-tale which can turn its eyes around and look at itself; now he is at one and the same time subject and object, simultaneously poet, actor, and spectator. (BT 5, KSA 1, 47f.)

Like Wagner, who in his own aesthetic ecstasy was claimed by Nietzsche to have attained a “sort of omniscience [Allwissenheit] … as if the visual power of his eyes hovered not only upon surfaces, but ‘ins Innere’” (BT 22, KSA 1, 140), Nietzsche believed himself to inhabit the sort of aesthetic state of Schopenhauer’s genius. “I had discovered the only historical simile and facsimile of my own innermost experience,—and this led me to apprehend the amazing phenomenon of the Dionysian…” (EH ‘Geburt’ 2, KSA 6, 311). Another retrospective evaluation claims the work was, “Constructed entirely from precocious, wet-behind-the-ears personal experiences, all of which lay at the very threshold of what could be communicated.” This was apparently because the work was not scientific-philology but was, “located in the territory of art […] perhaps a book for artists with some subsidiary capacity for analysis and retrospection (in other words, for an exceptional type of artist […]), full of psychological innovations and artist-mysteries, with an artist’s metaphysics in the background…” (BT ‘Versuch’ 2, KSA 1, 13).

4. Physiognomy and Teleology

Shortly before the Birth of Tragedy, Nietzsche wrote to Erwin Rohde that “Scholarship, art, and philosophy are growing together inside me to such an extent that one day I’m bound to give birth to centaurs” (Letter to Rohde, January 15^th, 1870; KSB 3, 95). Indeed, the book was just that, though it was no longer something to be proud of. Almost immediately after, Nietzsche rescinded his artistic-mystical view about the historian’s ability to intuit the real Ideas, in Schopenhauer’s technical sense, of the nature of tragedy beyond the mediated observation of the past through historical evidence. “For the readers of my earlier writings I wish to expressly clarify that I have abandoned the metaphysical-artistic views that fundamentally govern them” (N Ende 1876-Sommer 1877 23[159], KSA 8, 463). His increasingly skeptical attitude toward the mystical aspect of Schopenhauer’s philosophy led Nietzsche to revise major aspects of his own thought.

In 1874’s vom Nutzen und Nachteil der Historie für das Leben, Nietzsche presents three ‘types’ of historian, the critical, antiquarian, and monumental. None of these “merges with the original artist of the world”; none becomes the “subject and object” of their historical study. Instead, each type of historian represents the past according to the rules of an inner necessity, exaggerating or downplaying certain aspects of the past in order to tear down idols, preserve them, or build them up. Each type of historian and their accordant way of representing the past has its advantages and disadvantages for themselves and for the cultures in which they live, but none is able to represent the past as it ‘really’ was since into each of their judgments intrudes their psychologically-determined desires and interests.

If it is, as Nietzsche begins to think, that all judgments are constituted by unconscious psychological dynamics, then the ‘subject-free’ ideal of objectivity must be jettisoned. Certainly, the Schopenhauerian aesthetic escape from individual subjectivity will be impossible; but so will the Rankean ‘disinterested’ vision of scientific objectivity. The best one can hope for historians, Nietzsche thinks, is that the subjective facticities that distort their judgments would be in some sense ‘healthy’, or at least healthier than those judgments that infect modern schoolbooks. Only the strong have the right sort of subjective dynamics that would enable a healthy interpretation of historical events. “If you are to venture to interpret the past you can do so only out of the fullest exertion of the vigor of the present: only when you put forth your noblest qualities in all their strength will you divine what is worth knowing and preserving in the past. Like to like! Otherwise, you will draw the past down to you. Do not believe historiography that does not spring from the head of the rarest minds…” (UB II 6, KSA 1, 293f).

By looking at the psychological conditions within which historians construct their accounts, Nietzsche effectively focuses the ‘historical sense’—“the capacity for quickly guessing the order of rank of the valuations according to which a people, a society, a human being has lived” (BGE 224, KSA 5, 157)—on the historians themselves. “History belongs above all to the active and powerful man,” Nietzsche proclaims—like Schiller or Goethe who view the past as a model for inspiration, not merely to imitate, but as an “incentive to do as others have done and do it better” (UB II, 2, KSA 1, 259). Among those with highly-ranked drives Nietzsche declares Burckhardt (see among many examples, N Frühling-Sommer 1875 5[58], KSA 8, 56), Thucydides (e.g., GD Antike 2, KSA 6, 155f), Hekataeus (KGW II/5, 229f), Tacitus (N 1885 43[3], KSA 11, 702), Hippolyte Taine (JGB 254, KSA 5, 198), and Ritschl (EH ‘klug’ 9, KSA 6, 295). Among those badly ranked are Karl Lachmann (N März 1875 3[36], KSA 8, 24), the historian of ancient philosophy Eduard Zeller (KGB II/1, 124), and Overbeck’s confidant Heinrich von Treitschke (EH ‘Wagner’ 3, KSA 6, 361). Relegated to a secondary consideration is whether these historians’ ‘facts’ are accurate; what is time and again foregrounded is the order of rank of the values and drives according to which their historiographical accounts are constructed.

The same is true of Nietzsche’s evaluation of teleological historiography. Although David Friedrich Strauss (see the entirety of UB I, KSA 1, 159-242) and Hegel (see N Frühling-Sommer 1875 5[58], KSA 8, 57) are also targets, much of what Nietzsche says in the latter chapters of Nutzen und Nachteil about teleological historiography is directed against Eduard von Hartmann (see also N 1884 26[326], KSA 11, 236; N November 1887-März 1888 11[61], KSA 13, 30). Hartmann’s philosophical history of consciousness was largely a synthesis of Schopenhauer’s depiction of the blind world will and Hegel’s teleological unfolding of both mind and the rational course of history itself (Hartmann 1923, I 329). Spiritual and moral progress are guaranteed by the Divine Will, whose ideas are instantiated first within the unconscious desires and drives of early peoples and then in an ever-increasing degree of conscious reflection within civilized nations. The aims of the Divine Will are accomplished, consciously or otherwise, regardless of whatever individuals would like to make of their futures.

Hartmann and the sort of Hegelian teleological historicism he represents have, of course, gone out of fashion. It would be rather absurd in today’s more naturalistic historiographical climate to try to prove that a particular decision by a particular agent was the effect of the Divine Will’s cosmic plan; but the focus of Nietzsche’s critique lay elsewhere. In keeping with his view that judgments are necessarily a function of the psychological fundament of their authors, Nietzsche targets the underlying motivations that would lead Hartmann, and for that matter Hegel, to interpret the historical world as teleological in the first place. What he discovers in these teleological historians is a ‘cynical’ outlook on life generally. Instead of a grim determination to affirm their lives they surrender themselves to the recognition that nothing they do is anything more than a preordained stepping-stone on the march toward the absolute. Teleological historians are driven by a nihilistic desire, by the need, Nietzsche contends, to absolve their own wills: “die volle Hingabe der Persönlichkeit an den Weltprozess” [the total sacrifice of individuality to the world-process] (UB II 9, KSA 1, 316). This surrender of today for the sake of some promised future ideal is a secularized version, Nietzsche ultimately thinks, of the Christian faith in heaven.

Although positivism and teleology are nearly antonyms today, this was not the case in Nietzsche’s century. Comte, and his sociological and economical descendants such as Durkheim and Marx, each envisioned an epochal and progressive scheme of history—a sort of one-way street from a repressed past to an enlightened future. Both, however, were careful to replace Hegel and Hartmann’s extra-natural teleological movers in history with a positivist or materialist theory of explanation respectively. In doing so, they considered their developmental schemes both equally demonstrable and as necessary as those of the natural sciences. “All historical writing,” Marx tells us, “must set out from these natural bases and their modification in the course of history through the action of men” (Marx & Engels 1845, 36). “Scientific history, or sociology,” according to Durkheim, “must be founded upon the direct observation of concrete facts” (Durkheim 1972, 78). Such scientific historical representations rested on their shared hope of ascribing causes that governed the behaviors of either individuals or groups as they undergo their progressive development, and that hope can be traced back to H.T. Buckle, the original ‘scientific historian’, whom Nietzsche himself recognizes in this context (See GM I 4, KSA 5, 262).

Nietzsche rejected grand architectonics whose purpose seemed only to convince people that they will someday soon be better off. He also criticized the efforts to regard the past as unfolding even to non-teleological laws insofar as their effort to deduce nomothetically betrayed either their desire to predict and thereby control future events or else their fear of the unknown. “In other disciplines, generalizations [Allgemeinheiten] are the most important thing since they contain the laws [Gesetze]. But if such assertions as that cited are meant to be valid laws, then we could reply that the historian’s work is wasted. For whatever truth is left in such statements, after subtracting that mysterious and irreducible residue we mentioned earlier, is obvious and even trivial since it is self-evident to anyone with the slightest range of experience” (UB II 6, KSA 1, 291f). While there may have been a certain admiration for positivism’s rigorous and anti-metaphysical methodologies, Nietzsche says very little about any of these proto-sociologists. Most notoriously, Nietzsche never names Marx a single time anywhere in his writing.

5. Réealism and Genealogy

Nietzsche’s rejection of nomothetic schemata that purport to explain historical change, whether metaphysical or naturalistic, does not imply he was a radical outlier of the ‘historical’ 19^th-Century. Every bit as historically-concerned as the teleologists, he thinks “philosophy, or that alone which I count it to be, [is] the most general form of history, the attempt to somehow describe and abbreviate in signs the Heraclitean world of becoming…” (N 1885 36[27], KSA 11, 562). Nietzsche’s attempt at historicizing philosophy would endure longer than his friendship with the man who helped to inspire it. For alongside Paul Rée he came to the conviction that values, whether moral, political, aesthetic, or even metaphysical, were a function of drives which were themselves conditioned subconsciously throughout a long historical process. Old religious and Platonic beliefs in good and evil as static metaphysical entities were, for both Rée and Nietzsche, to be replaced with a naturalistic and developmental account about how present-day values derive from a convoluted process of practical and often egoistical considerations. But where for Rée, like Darwin and Lamarck before him, acquired habits become inherited traits due to their role in helping both individuals and societies survive better relative to their competitors, Nietzsche viewed the historical inculcation of moral sentiments as a reflection of group attempts to instantiate power-aims.

In keeping with his exhortation that philosophy become historical, Nietzsche variously endeavors to construct a ‘history of the moral sensations’, a ‘natural history of morals’, and most famously, a Genealogy of Morals (1887), a book whose mission is derived from a deeply historicist conviction. “[W]e need to know about the conditions and circumstances under which the values grew up, developed, and changed…” (GM P 6, KSA 5, 253). To that end, Nietzsche would seem to require a set of demonstrable historical premises: that there really was a time during which a masterly set of values dominated and a later time at which it became displaced by the widely-flung inversion of those values known as slave morality. Indeed he claims to seek, “morality as it really existed and was really lived,” “the real history of morality,” which can “actually be confirmed and has actually existed” (GM P 7, KSA 5, 254).

But doing so enmeshes Nietzsche in considerable meta-historical problems, some of which he himself poses. The Genealogie is above all an attempt to articulate the history of the development of moral values in a way that undermines his contemporaries’ faith in the absoluteness of their own values. It does so on two levels: first by offering an historical explanation that reveals the intrinsically historical rather than absolute character of moral values. Nietzsche had formidable allies on this score in Rée and the ‘English School’ of moral psychology—represented foremost by Herbert Spencer—both of whom followed Charles Darwin’s intimation that even morality should be viewed as an evolutionary phenomenon. But whereas their interpretation of that evolution seemed to guarantee the progressive status of fundamentally Christian values like altruism, honesty, cooperation, and compassion, Nietzsche’s own psychologizing-historiography uncovered a darker underside of morality. In fact, as has been thoroughly argued, the text itself represents something like a new-Darwinism (Richardson 2004) or anti-Darwinism (Johnson 2010), insofar as it rejects evolutionary progress and substitutes a vision of the ‘competition of wills’ as a mechanism to explain historical change. Nietzsche rejects the Darwinian accounts by dismantling their presumptions about the origin of value resting with the recipient rather than the doer of ‘good’ or ‘bad’ deeds, about nature aiming at preservation rather than overcoming, about the passivity and accidental character of propagatory success, and about the possibility and value of altruism within social frameworks. The success of this refutation rests in its being somehow a ‘better’ historical account than social-Darwinian alternative, that is, a more accurate and comprehensive historical account than theirs. Given that Nietzsche offers scant historical data that would support his own interpretation of events—the few proffered etymologies would hardly prove much—his account, as an objective history of morality largely fails to demonstrate Nietzsche’s counter-hypotheses.

It is on the second level, a meta-historical level, that Nietzsche’s Genealogie proves its enduring originality. Nietzsche shows that the very attempt to reconstruct the story of development of morality “as it really happened” is occluded by the recognition that the narrator of events is intrinsic to the story, that the historian himself is no will-less, objective, static point of observation, but was himself a perpetually becoming, value-laden dynamic of subjectivity, who is every bit as historical and drive-constituted as the values he was trying to explain. Contrary to Darwinians of any stripe, Nietzsche recognized that historiography is never about ‘getting the facts straight’, ‘wie es eigentlich gewesen ist’, but about interpreting it according to the drive-informed perspective in which the historian was embedded. Whereas the Darwinians interpreted the historical evolution of morality as if they themselves stood outside of it, for Nietzsche, “[W]e count—after the fact—all the twelve trembling strokes of the clock of our experience, our lives, our being—alas! In the process we keep losing the count. So we remain necessarily strangers to ourselves, we do not understand ourselves, we have to keep ourselves confused” (GM P 1, KSA 5, 247). Values and also that conception of ourselves as the architects of values dynamically affects the way by which one interprets those values, such that the attempt to re-present the ‘first bell’, that original value, free of the distortions of generations of overwriting, reformulating, and above all re-valuing those values, becomes impossible.

How have the moral genealogists reacted so far in this matter? Naively, as is their wont: they highlight some ‘purpose’ in punishment, for example, revenge or deterrence, then innocently place the purpose at the start, as causa ﬁendi of punishment, and—have ﬁnished. But ‘purpose in law’ is the last thing we should apply to the history of the emergence of law: on the contrary, there is no more important proposition for every sort of history than that which we arrive at only with great effort but which we really should reach,—namely that the origin of the emergence of a thing and its ultimate usefulness, its practical application and incorporation into a system of ends, are toto coelo separate; that anything in existence, having somehow come about, is continually interpreted anew, requisitioned anew, transformed and redirected to a new purpose by a power superior to it; that everything that occurs in the organic world consists of overpowering, dominating, and in their turn, overpowering and dominating consist of re-interpretation, adjustment, in the process of which their former ‘meaning’ and ‘purpose’ must necessarily be obscured or completely obliterated. […] But every purpose and use is just a sign that the will to power has achieved mastery over something less powerful, and has impressed upon it its own meaning of a use function; and the whole history of a ‘thing’, an organ, a tradition can to this extent be a continuous chain of signs, continually revealing new interpretations and adaptations, the causes of which need not be connected even amongst themselves, but rather sometimes just follow and replace one another at random. (GM II, 12; KSA 5, 312)

As this passage offers the most expansive explication of his mature historical theory, it is worth careful investigation. There seem to be three interrelated theses here. First, history practiced rightly must accord the genuine nature of reality. Other ‘genealogists’, who in this context are represented primarily by Nietzsche’s one-time friend Paul Rée and the Darwin-inspired moralists such as Herbert Spencer, are in a better position than ahistorical philosophers such as Plato and Spinoza insofar as they rightly recognize the fluidity of moral concepts. However, where the naively realist genealogists go wrong is in unreflectively presuming that their own interpretations of those moral concepts are somehow true for all time and all people, in other words, that their interpretations of the flow of history somehow stand outside the flow of history (see also Johnson 2010, 116-148; Born 2010, 202-52).

Second, Nietzsche’s mature genealogy adapts what might be called an anti-realist theory of historical explanation and description. Terms like ‘cause’, ‘effect’, and ‘purpose’ are not elements of a ‘real’ world, but signs that have been found useful for communicating meaning intersubjectively. Descriptions like ‘terrorist’, ‘revolution’, and ‘democracy’ identify in language what is actually a non-identical set of loosely-connected phenomena.

Third, and as a consequence of the first two theses, there can be no single ‘absolute’ interpretation of the past. Interpretations are a function of the historical world. Like all phenomena, they change and transmogrify over time in accordance to the deep and often unconscious demands of the agents who construct, accept, or reject those interpretations. The example of punishment in this passage illustrates particularly well how the meaning of a single word shifts over epochs and cultures. What accounts for that shift is the fluctuating power dynamics both within particular historians and among the wider sphere of what a culture considers an historical ‘fact’ over time.

Despite his conviction that philosophy must be historical, then, Nietzsche simultaneously understood writing philosophy historically to be a deeply problematic endeavor. Any attempt to describe or explain a historical event amounts to an illegitimate de-contextualization, an attempt to affix the unaffixable with allegedly static concepts. As he would write to his friend, the historical theologian Franz Overbeck, “At last my mistrust now turns to the question whether history is actually possible? What, then does one want to ascertain [feststellen]?—something, which in a moment of happening, does not itself ‘stand fast’ [‘feststand’]?” (an Overbeck 23.02.1887, KSB 8, 28). The situation is made worse in recognizing that not only is the reality to be described in a state of flux, but the one who recognizes it is in a similar state of flux. Not only has Heraclitus’s river changed, so has the subjectivity of the one who has entered it.

A similar cluster of problems was faced by Neo-Kantian thinkers in the years just following Nietzsche’s Genealogie. Wilhelm Windelband, Heinrich Rickert, and the quasi-Neo-Kantian Wilhelm Dilthey were each keen in their own ways to view historical judgment as a function of subjective facticities rather than as a mirror of an objective past. Each sought, like Nietzsche, to distinguish history from science both in terms of the methodology of its investigations and the sorts of objects it studies. Where science seeks to explain by deduction from general rules, history only contains such generalities in imprecise abstractions. Due to the singularity of every object under its purview, history cannot hope to explain scientifically by means of deduction under general laws. As Windelband phrases it in his inaugural address as rector at Strasbourg, “The nomological sciences are concerned with what is invariably the case. The sciences of process are concerned with what once was the case” (Windelband 1894, 175). The former sciences were famously designated nomothetic, the latter, like historiography, called idiographic. Finally, while historiography does involve the search for explanations in terms of causes, those causes must be regarded as value-imbued. “History,” Rickert writes, “with its individualizing method and its orientation to values, has to investigate the causal relations subsisting among the unique and individual events with which it is concerned. These causal relations do not coincide with any universal laws of nature…the selection of what is essential in history involves reference to values even in the inquiry into causes…” (Rickert 1889, 94; see also Windelband 1884, 205). In place of a universal dogmatic positivist explanation, philosophers of history following the neo-Kantians address which causal account best satisfies the subjective standards of the historians and of their audience. Compare this to Nietzsche’s claim in Ecce Homo, that “we are not looking for just any type of explanatory cause, we are looking for a chosen, preferred type of explanation, one that will most quickly and reliably get rid of the feeling of unfamiliarity and novelty, the feeling that we are dealing with something we have never encountered before,—the most common explanation” (GD Irrthümer 5, KSA 6.93).

6. Reception

Nietzsche rejects attempts to construe a past in-itself without acknowledging the tangled but inextricable web of interpretations cast upon it by later interpreters. “[T]he origin of the emergence of a thing and its ultimate usefulness, its practical application and incorporation into a system of ends, are toto coelo separate; anything in existence, having somehow come about, is continually interpreted anew, requisitioned anew, transformed and redirected to a new purpose” (GM II 12, KSA 5, 313). Any attempt to isolate Nietzsche’s historiographical ideas for the sake of contextualizing them would accordingly demand a reckoning of the many drives of its very many interpreters over the past century or so. Such a genealogical account of Nietzsche’s historiography would be severely unwieldy, if not impossible. It nevertheless serves to mention at least two of the most prominent lines of the interpretive reception of Nietzsche’s meta-history.

Although a broad generalization, continental thinkers from the 1930’s to the 1970’s such as Heidegger, Jaspers, Sartre, Arendt, Levinas, Ricouer and Patočka took their cue from Nietzsche’s demand that the human person be considered within the framework of his or her historicity. Specifically, they each appear influenced by Nietzsche’s 1874 characterization of the human animal as the one unable to ignore his or her temporality; being human means being forever tied to a continual process of becoming, the awareness of which it is our unique burden to bear (UB II 1, KSA 1, 248f). In fact, this single idea is arguably the most essential and unifying theme among all mid-20^th Century continental thinkers. One must understand her existential condition as oriented in her birth and propelled toward her future possibilities, which fall under the inescapable common horizon of death. Orienting oneself to one’s history becomes the essential existential project.

Among later postmodern continental thinkers such as Foucault, DeMan, Lacoue-Labarthes, Lyotard, Derrida, and among the most noted contemporary postmodern meta-historians like Hayden White, Frank Ankersmit, and Keith Jenkins, the anthropological focus increasingly shifts to an epistemological one. The view of history as a mirror of the real events of a real objective past is ridiculed as an outdated conservative ideal. Historiography has historically not been used to discover truth, pure and unadulterated—and indeed cannot be. Historical writing hitherto has consisted in a set of authoritative narratives constructed in order to justify existing biases and power structures. Consistent with their interpretation of Nietzsche’s genealogical project, they see the West in a moment of cultural crisis, one which historiography has uncovered and which it must of itself help resolve. Historiography’s task is thus no longer to simply records facts, they hold, but to unmask the so-called ‘objective’ systems of values by deconstructing or revealing as mythic the ideological foundations on which they were built. After those grand-narratives have been exposed, historiography’s myth-making capacities are to be refocused to allow previously underrepresented groups to construct the story from their own perspectives. One senses here the rather freely-interpreted application of Nietzsche’s claim that “the more eyes, different eyes we learn to set upon the same object, the more complete will be our ‘concept’ of this thing, the more ‘objective’” (GM III 12, KSA 5, 365), but they are nevertheless correct to acknowledge the debt their own conception of power-interpretation owes to Nietzsche.

7. References and Further Reading

BAW: Historisch-kritische Gesamtausgabe: Werke, 5 vols., edited by Joachim Mette et al. (Berlin, 1933–43).
KGB: Kritische Gesamtausgabe: Briefwechsel, edited by Giorgio Colli and Mazzino Montinari (Berlin, 1975ff).
KGW: Kritische Gesamtausgabe: Werke, edited by Giorgio Colli and Mazzino Montinari (Berlin, 1967ff).
KSA: Sämtliche Werke: Kritische Studienausgabe, 15 vols., edited by Giorgio Colli and Mazzino Montinari (Berlin, 1988).
KSB: Sämtliche Briefe: Kritische Studienausgabe, 8 vols., edited by Giorgio Colli and Mazzino Montinari (Berlin, 1986).

a. References

Born, Marcus Andreas, Nihilistisches Geschichtsdenken: Nietzsches perspektivische Genealogie (München: Wilhelm Fink, 2010).
Burckhardt, Jakob, Gesamtausgabe in 14 Bände, edited by Emil Dürr et al. (Stuttgart/Berlin/Leipzig: Deutsche Verlaganstalt, 1930-4).
Durkheim, Émile, Selected Writings, edited by Anthony Giddens (Cambridge (Cambridge University Press, 1972).
Gay, Peter, Style in History: Gibbon, Ranke, Macaulay, Burckhardt (New York /London: W.W. Norton, 1974).
Hartmann, Eduard von, Philosophie des Unbewussten: Speculative Resultate nach inductiv-naturwissenschaftlicher Methode in 3 Bände (Leipzig: Kröner, 1923).
Janz, Curt Paul, Friedrich Nietzsche. Biographie in drei Bände (Munich: Carl Hanser, 1993).
Johnson, Dirk R., Nietzsche’s Anti-Darwinism (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010).
Marx, Karl & Engels, Friedrich, The German Ideology, translated by S. Ryazanskaya (New York: Prometheus, 1998).
Richardson, John, Nietzsche’s New Darwinism (New York/Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2004).
Rickert, Heinrich, Science and History: Critique of Positivist Epistemology, translated by G. Reisman (New York: Van Nostrand, 1962).
Schopenhauer, Arthur, Zürcher Ausgabe. Werke in zehn Bände, edited by Hübscher et al. (Zürich: Diogenes Verlag, 1977).
Wilamowitz-Moellendorff, Ulirch von, “Future Philology! A Reply to Friedrich Nietzsche’s ‘The Birth of Tragedy’,” translated by Gertrude Postl et al., New Nietzsche Studies 4[1] (2000): 1-32.
Windelband, William, An Introduction to Philosophy, translated by J. McCabe (London: Unwin, 1921).
Windelband, William, “History and Natural Science,” translated by G. Oakes, History and Theory 19[2] (1980): 165-85.

b. Further Reading

Bahnsen, Julius, Zur Philosophie der Geschichte: Eine kritische Besprechung des Hegel-Hartmann’sche Evolutionismus aus Schopenhauer’schen Principien (Berlin: Duncker, 1872).
- One of Nietzsche’s principle sources for both his criticism of teleology and his formulation of a naturalistic theory of historical explanation.
Benne, Christian, Nietzsche und die historisch-kritische Philologie (Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 2005)
- Exposits and analyzes the way Nietzsche’s early philological training enters his mature philosophical thinking.
Bernoulli, Carl Albrecht, Das Dreigestirn: Bachofen, Jakob Burckhardt, Nietzsche (Basel: Schwabe & Co., 1931).
- A reliable and comprehensive account of the personal and intellectual interrelations of these three Basel professors.
Blondel, Éric, The Body and Culture: Philosophy as Philological Genealogy, translated by Sean Hand (Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1991).
- Highly insightful attempt to assimilate Nietzsche’s philological training with a postmodern account of his perspectivism.
Born, Marcus Andreas, Nihilistisches Geschichtsdenken: Nietzsches perspektivische Genealogie (München: Wilhelm Fink, 2010).
- A Foucault-influenced account of Nietzsche’s critique of Hegelian teleology and the historical ramifications of the death of God.
Brobjer, Thomas H. (2004): “Nietzsche’s View of the Value of Historical Studies and Methods” In: Journal of the History of Ideas. Bd. 65 (2), 301-22.
Brobjer, Thomas H., “Nietzsche’s Relation to Historical Methods and Nineteenth-Century German Historiography,” History and Theory 46 (2007): 155–79.
- Both pieces by Brobjer present a wealth of information about Nietzsche’s historiographical context, reading, and influences.
Campioni, Guiliano, Paolo D’Iorio, Maria Cristina Fornari, Francesco Fronterotta & Andrea Orsucci (eds.) (2003): Nietzsches persönliche Bibliothek. Berlin (Walter de Gruyter Press).
- A comprehensive collection of Nietzsche’s personal library, essential for reconstructing what Nietzsche read about history and historoical theory.
Cancik, Hubert, Nietzsches Antike: Vorlesung (Stuttgart: J.B. Metzler Verlag, 1995).
- An examination of Nietzsche’s philological activities from one of the world’s leading historians of philology.
Dries, Manuel (ed.), Nietzsche on Time and History (Berlin: De Gruyter Press, 2008).
- A fine collection of essays from leading and upcoming scholars, many of which address Nietzsche’s thinking about history.
Drossbach, Maximillian, Über scheinbaren und wirklichen Ursachen des Geschehens in der Welt (Halle: Pfeffer, 1884).
- A naturalistic rejection of teleological historical explanation that Nietzsche read shortly before the composition of On the Genealogy of Morals.
Emden, Christian, Friedrich Nietzsche and the Politics of History (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2008).
- A highly-informative contextualized account of Nietzsche’s historical theory, with special reference to the culture and politics of Basel during Nietzsche’s tenure.
Geuss, Raymond, “Nietzsche and Genealogy,” European Journal of Philosophy 2 (1994): 275–92.
- An especially clear account of Nietzsche’s explanatory strategies in the Genealogy of Morals.
Gossman, Lionel, Basel in the Age of Burckhardt: A Study in Unseasonable Ideas (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2000).
A foundational account of Nietzsche’s intellectual milieu in the 1860’s-70’s.
Hartmann, Eduard von, Philosophie des Unbewussten: Speculative Resultate nach inductiv-naturwissenschaftlicher Methode (Berlin: Carl Duncker, 1869).
- One of Nietzsche’s most important sources of teleological historiography and the main target of his ire in the second Untimely Meditation.
Jensen, Anthony K., Nietzsche’s Philosophy of History (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2013).
- A comprehensive account of Nietzsche’s historical theory and its shifts over the course of his career.
Jensen, Anthony K. & Heit, Helmut (eds.), Nietzsche as a Scholar of Antiquity (New York / London: Bloomsbury Publishing, 2014).
- A collection of articles that covers the scope of Nietzsche’s publications and lecture notes during his time as a classical philologist.
Lipperheide, Christian, Nietzsches Geschichtsstrategien. Die rhetorische Neuorganisation der Geschichte (Würzburg: Königshausen & Neumann, 1999).
- A narrativist and constructivist reading of Nietzsche’s philosophy of history.
Meyer, Katrin, Ästhetik der Historie: Friedrich Nietzsches ‘vom Nutzen und Nachteil der Historie für das Leben’ (Würzburg: Königshausen & Neumann, 1998).
- An analysis of the second Untimely Meditation from the perspective of Nietzsche’s aesthetic theory.
Nehamas, Alexander, “The Genealogy of Genealogy: Interpretation in Nietzsche’s Second Untimely Meditation and in On the Genealogy of Morals,” in Nietzsche, Genealogy, and Morality, edited by Richard Schacht (Berkeley: University of California Press, 1994), 269–83.
- Considers Nietzsche’s genealogical mode of philosophizing as a more elaborate but nevertheless consistent expression of his earlier philological methodology.
Pletsch, Carl, Young Nietzsche: Becoming a Genius (New York: The Free Press, 1991).
- An intellectual biography of Nietzsche’s early years, with special attention to his schooling and time at Basel.
Porter, James I., Nietzsche and the Philology of the Future (Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2000).
- Remains the decisive account of Nietzsche’s philological study, articles, and lectures.
Reinhardt, Karl, “Nietzsche und die Geschichte,” in his Vermächtnis der Antike. Gesammelte Essays zur Philosophie und Geschichtsschreibung (Göttingen: Vandenhoeck & Ruprecht, 1960), 296–309.
- A dated, but still informative critique of Nietzsche’s contribution to philology from one of the leading classicists of the 20^th Century.
Ritschl, Friedrich, Opuscula Philologica, 5 vols., edited by Kurt Wachsmuth (Leipzig: Teubner, 1879).
- The badly-neglected collected works of Nietzsche’s teacher, containing, among many other things, observations and exhortations about the contemporary practice of classical philology as Nietzsche would have known them.
Saar, Martin, Genealogie als Kritik: Geschichte und Theorie des Subjekts nach Nietzsche und Foucault (Frankfurt/New York: Campus Verlag, 2007).
- An admirable attempt to compare the historical theories of Foucault and Nietzsche from the standpoint of their respective notions of subjectivity.
Salaquarda, Jörg, “Studien zur Zweiten Unzeitgemäßen Betrachtung,” Nietzsche-Studien 13 (1984): 1–45.
- The most comprehensive account of the genesis and context of the second Untimely Meditation in any language.
Schrift, Alan, Nietzsche and the Question of Interpretation: Between Hermeneutics and Deconstruction (New York/London: Routledge, 1990).
- A decisive continental treatment of Nietzsche’s thinking generally, with special attention to Nietzsche’s theory of historical interpretation.
Sommer, Andreas Urs, Der Geist der Historie und das Ende des Christentums. Zur „Waffengenossenschaft“ von Friedrich Nietzsche und Franz Overbeck (Berlin: Akademie Verlag, 1997).
- A highly-informed comparison of Nietzsche and the theological historian Franz Overbeck concerning especially teleology and Christian historiography.
Stambaugh, Joan, The Problem of Time in Nietzsche, translated by John F. Humphrey (Philadelphia: Bucknell University Press, 1987).
- A seminal examination of the interrelation of history, temporality, subjectivity, and willing in Nietzsche.
White, Hayden, Metahistory: The Historical Imagination in Nineteenth-Century Europe (Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1973).
- Includes an attempt to read Nietzsche as a precursor to post-modern historical narrativity. White is one of the leading philosophers of history in the world.

Author Information

Anthony K. Jensen
Email: Anthony.Jensen@providence.edu
Providence College
U. S. A.

Mulla Sadra (c. 1572—1640)

Mulla Sadra made major contributions to Islamic metaphysics and to Shi’i theology during the Safavid period (1501-1736) in Persia. He started his career in the context of a rising culture that combined elements from the Persian past with the newly institutionalized Shi’ism and Sufi teachings. Mulla Sadra was heir to a long tradition of Islamic philosophy that from the beginning had accommodated the speculations of Greek philosophers, especially Neoplatonic philosophers, for the purpose of understanding the world, particularly in relation to the creator and the Islamic faith. Islamic philosophy originated in the rational endeavours to reconcile reason and revelation though the results did not always satisfy theologians, but ironically widened the gaps between reason and revelation.

Mulla Sadra, too, was deeply concerned about both reason and revelation, and he tried a new way of reconciliation by openly employing a synthetic methodology in which mysticism played an important part. For him and his followers, human knowledge is tenable only as long as it goes back to the indirect grasp of reality which in itself is not subject to conceptualization. Nevertheless, Mulla Sadra was dedicated to the traditional forms of logical arguments that are based on premises evident to the mind rather than on beliefs which come from religious faith and tradition. For example, his use of Qur’anic verses and religious ideas, though it is an important part of his system, is mainly confined to a secondary or supportive position. As for mysticism, the extensive use of mystical concepts and terminology is acceptable from the point of view of those thinkers who believe that mystical inspiration, intellectual intuition, and revelation, originate in one and the same source, hence their celebration of Mulla Sadra’s work as “prophetic philosophy.” As a result, the scope of Mulla Sadra’s work is wider than his predecessors. In addition to metaphysics, he wrote extensively on the Qur’an and the Tradition and no other major philosopher before him had been so productive in the field of religion.

While focusing on Mulla Sadra’s metaphysics including his ontology, epistemology, psychology, this article also brings to light the philosopher’s solutions to theological problems. Owing to these solutions, not only did Islamic philosophy manage to survive against religious and political odds, but also Shi’i theology never lost its foothold on the intellectual ground. Although the organic unity of Mulla Sadra’s system rests on all the various components of his thought, his independent works on exegesis, mystical treatises, and his commentaries on preceding philosophers, are outside the scope of this article.

Biography
Synthetic methodology
Ontology
Epistemology
1. Mental Being
2. Unity of the Knower and the Known
Soteriological Psychology
1. Substantial Motion and the Soul
2. The End of the Human Soul
Major Theological Issues
Commentaries on the Qur’an and Tradition
Legacy
References and Further Reading

1. Biography

Muhammad ibn Ibrahim ibn Yahya al-Qawami al-Shirazi, commonly known as Mulla Sadra, was born and grew up during the golden days of the Safavid period, Iran’s first Shi’ite dynasty (c. 1501-1736). As the only son of a noble family, he received both intellectual and financial support towards a good education that started in his home town, Shiraz, in southeastern Iran. Though Shiraz had a glorious past with regard to philosophy, in Mulla Sadra’s day it was not the best place for satisfying his intellectual desire. In his quest for advanced religious and philosophical training he left Shiraz for Qazvin and then moved to Isfahan where he studied with the most eminent intellectual figures of the day, Mir Damad (d. 1631) and Shaykh Baha’̓i (d. 1576) who were also affiliated with the court of the Safavid King, Shah Abbas I (c. 1587-1629). While Mulla Sadra’s philosophical character evolved in conversation and debates with Mir Damad, he owed to Shayk Baha’i his broad knowledge of exegesis (tafsir), tradition (hadith), mysticism (irfan) and jurisprudence (fiqh). There is yet no historical evidence that he ever studied with Mir Findiriski (d. 1640/1), the other leading intellectual of the time. However, the frequency of associating the two by scholars such as Henry Corbin (d. 1978) suggests an inclination on their part towards providing a perfect picture of the philosopher’s integration in the intellectual life of Isfahan with all the pivotal thinkers involved in shaping what has been called “the full flowering of prophetic philosophy” in Mulla Sadra’s hands (Nasr 2006).

In 1601, upon the death of his father, Mulla Sadra returned to Shiraz. Later he related his experience during the time spent in Shiraz in a doleful and critical voice denouncing the intellectual atmosphere of the city for being hostile, suppressive, and philistine with regard to philosophy (al-Asfar I 7). He decided to leave Shiraz for a life of solitude and contemplation in Kahak, a quiet village near the city of Qom. The peace and quiet of life in Kahak gave Mulla Sadra the opportunity to start the composition of his most foundational work, al-Hikmat al-muta ‘aliya fi’l-asfar al-‘aqliyya al-arba (Transcendent Wisdom in the Four Journeys of the Intellect). There he also found some of his life-long students who became well-known scholars of their own time.

This period was followed by several journeys between Shiraz, Isfahan, Qom, Kashan, and most importantly, seven pilgrimages to Mecca. Apparently, this itinerant stage played an important part in his intellectual and spiritual growth that is also suggested by the “journey” metaphor in the title and divisions of al-Asfar. It was also during this period that Mulla Sadra accepted the invitation to teach at Khan School, which was built in Shiraz on the order of the new governor, Allahwirdi Khan, in Mulla Sadra’s honour and for the purpose of his lectures.

Mulla Sadra had a family of six children, three sons and three daughters. All his sons became scholars and his daughters were married to three of Sadra’s students whom he treated as family even prior to the marriages. We know that two of these students Muhsin Fayz Kashani (d. 1679/80 ) and Abd al-Razzaq Lahiji (d. 1661/2 ) succeeded their father-in-law as two influential figures of their time though different to him in their philosophical orientation and working under more pressure due to the growing antagonism to philosophy and mysticism under Shah Abbas II (c. 1642-1666).

The intellectual network consisting of Mulla Sadra, his teachers and students that was later dubbed “the School of Isfahan” was formed in a unique political and religious context. Philosophers such as Mir Damad and Mulla Sadra managed to get their voices heard by their contemporaries and posterities in spite of the conservative religiosity of the newly established Shi’ite rule partly owing to the religious and political state of affairs. Since the Safavids strove to establish their identity as a Persian-Shi’ite state in contrast to the Sunni caliphate of the Turks and Arabs, they were in need of philosophy as a stronghold of knowledge that could reinforce, not to say generate, power through systematic thought. At least during the formative and golden days of the Safavid period the attacks on philosophers targeted their Sufi leanings rather than their endeavours to reconcile metaphysics with Shi’ite theology.

A prolific writer, Mulla Sadra composed a large number of treatises on ontology, epistemology, cosmology, psychology, eschatology, theology, mysticism, the Quran and the Tradition. However, many of his philosophical and theological works are repetitions of or elaborations on chapters from his magnum opus al-Hikmat al-mutaliyah fi’l-asfar al-arba‘a al-‘aqliyyah, commonly referred to as al-Asfar that is printed in nine volumes. Rather than simply holding Mulla Sadra’s theses, the latter work is an encyclopaedia of different schools of Islamic philosophy and theology. With the exception of Risala-yi si asl (Treatise on the Three Principles) which is in Persian, he wrote all his works in Arabic that was the lingua franca of the Muslim world at that time. He also wrote extensive commentaries on the Qur ‘an and the tradition among which respectively al-Mafatihal-ghayb (Keys to the Invisible) and his voluminous commentary on the famous collection of Shi’ite tradition, Usul al-kafi by Kulayni (d.939) are the most important.

After a pious life of dedication to acquiring and expanding philosophy and Islamic sciences, Mulla Sadra died in Basra on the way to his seventh pilgrimage to Mecca. His death was once believed to have occurred in 1640 with his body being buried in Basra. However, modern scholarship offers new evidence, though not conclusive evidence, in support of the date of 1635-6 and his burial being in Najaf (Rizvi 2007 30).

2. Synthetic methodology

Mulla Sadra was determined to construct a spacious house of “transcendental philosophy” that could accommodate the apparently conflicting paths in Islamic history towards the ultimate wisdom. He was also heir to a long tradition of philosophy in Persia which had adopted the methodology of Greek philosophy and interpreted it not only in accordance with the Islamic faith, but also implicitly and partly in continuation of the antique Persian traditions. Similar to his past philosophical masters Ibn Sina (d. 1037) and Suhrawardi (d. 1191), but unaware of Ibn Rushd‘s (d.1198) criticism of Neoplatonism in Islamic philosophy, Mulla Sadra relied on Neoplatonic precepts which had been taken for Aristotelian ideas by preceding philosophers. In particular, he followed Suhrawardi by adopting a holistic method of philosophy in which reason is accompanied by intuition, and intellection is the realization of the quintessence of the human soul, with prophecy (nubuwwa) and sainthood (wilaya) as the noblest manifestations of it. It is based on this holistic attitude that on the one hand, Mulla Sadra synthesizes the two main schools of Islamic philosophy, namely, the Peripatetic and Illuminationist schools, and on the other hand, bridges the gaps between philosophy, theology, and mysticism. While Mulla Sadra’s philosophical methodology is rational in the sense of building his arguments on premises that consist in evident propositional beliefs, he does not reduce philosophical process to mere abstract logical reasoning. The pivotal place of intuition in his philosophical methodology is especially reflected by the influence of Ibn Arabi (d. 1240) throughout his works and by the fact that he regarded Ibn Arabi’s writings as having a philosophical character with a “demonstrative force” (al-Asfar I 315). Whether we understand Mulla Sadra’s use of intuition as “a higher form of reason” in the Platonic sense (Rahman 1975, 6), or as a prophetic experience that turns philosophy into “theosophy” (Nasr 1997, 57), in reality there is no actual separation between reason and intuition in Mulla Sadra’s philosophy. Rather than considering ratiocination (that is, the process of exact thinking) and intuition as independent ways leading to different visions of the truth, for him they merge into one path complementing and completing each other.

Although no Islamic philosopher had ever announced reason and revelation, philosophy and prophecy in conflict with each other, in practice, several philosophical doctrines were regarded by theologians as blasphemous due to contradiction with the theological formulations of Quranic teachings. By synthesizing the findings of his predecessors and relying on his holistic methodology, Mulla Sadra addressed several controversial issues that had opened a wide gap between philosophy and theology, reason and faith. His conciliatory attitude is manifest in his writings that are replete with scriptural and theological references alongside and in harmony with the teachings of Ibn Sina, Suhrawardi, Ibn Arabi, and other Muslim thinkers.

3. Ontology

a. Primacy of Being

Although Aristotle identifies the external existence of a thing with its primary substance, he distinguishes between two questions we can ask with respect to everything: “What it is” and “whether it is (or exists)”. This conceptual distinction was later extended to the extra-mental realm of contingent beings by Islamic philosophers, most insistently Ibn Sina, and following him scholastic philosophers such as Aquinas (d. 1274). For Ibn Sina, essence, or quiddity (mahiyya), is universal in the mind while particular in the external world once being is bestowed on it by the Necessary Being who is identified with the God of Abrahamic faith. Except for God who exists in His own right, every other being is composed of essence and being, hence contingent in the sense of dependence on the Necessary Being for their existence.

The distinction was taken for granted after Ibn Sina but turned into a controversial issue when philosophers in the Illuminationist school questioned the external reality of being over and above essence. Suhrawardi and following him Mir Damad argued that being was only a mental construct and the distinction between essence and being was only possible in the conceptual domain. Since then, Islamic philosophers have roughly been categorized as adherents of either the primacy of essence or the primacy of being. Influenced by his philosophy master, Mulla Sadra started as an advocate of essentialism but soon diverged towards the opposite doctrine that he made famous as “the primacy of being” (asalat-i wujud). He built on this foundation the whole of his philosophical system.

Starting with the concept of being, Mulla Sadra attributes two major characteristics to it. Firstly, being is beyond logical analysis, hence indefinable, due to its simplicity and supra-categorical status. It is self-evident and prior to any other concept in the mind. Secondly, it is a univocal concept in the sense that it has one and the same meaning in all its applications, whether we apply it to God or to any other entity. The first characteristic seems to place being as such totally outside the grasp of discursive thought. The second one leaves the philosopher with the hope that in case he finds an alternative path towards being, he will be able to bridge the ontological gap made by certain theologians between the Creator and the created.

As for the reality of being in the external world, Mulla Sadra not only follows Ibn Sina in considering being as a reality, but adheres to his other master, Ibn’Arabi in considering being as the only reality, the doctrine which is commonly referred to as “the unity of being” (wahdat al-wujud). Nevertheless, Mulla Sadra’s ontological monism does not imply that essences are illusions, as it is held in radical forms of Sufism. For Mulla Sadra, though essences are not genuine in their existence, they still exist as delimitations of the Real Being that is the ground of all that exists. Using a poetic analogy, the indefinite Reality is a colorless light while essences are the colourful glasses through which the single light appears as diverse phenomena. Conceptual differentiation, without which thinking and speaking would be impossible, is owing to this semi-reality of essences. To sum up, while being is the principle of unity, essence or quiddity is the principle of difference.

Mulla Sadra has several arguments for the primacy of being and its unrivalled reality. The most comprehensive list of the arguments appears in his al-Mashair, a useful summary of his ontology, and several arguments are included in al-Asfar. For the premises of his arguments, Mulla Sadra relies on the classical understanding of essence as a universal without external effects within the mind. On this ground, the real horse can give you a ride while the universal horse in the mind is incapable of that because real particularity, external properties and real effects are owing to being and cannot be in the mind. In conclusion, being is the ground of reality, or better to say, reality itself, while essence only belongs to the conceptual realm and as Mulla Sadra put it “the term ‘existent’ is applied to essence only with respect to its relation to being [itself]” (al-Asfar VI 163).

b. Gradation of Being

The univocal concept of being applies to its instances in the same sense because of the unity of its reality, and conceptual differences are only due to essences. On the other hand, essences have no reality of their own. Based on these two premises, one could conclude that diversity is not real. Gradation, or modulation, of being (tashkik al-wujud) is Mulla Sadra’s way to avoid this counterintuitive result and to create a system in which the monistic worldview of Sufism is reconciled with the realistic pluralism of classical philosophy and our common sense. According to this doctrine, though one simple reality, being comes in grades, in a similar way that sunlight and candlelight are the same reality of different grades. In effect, there are only differences by degrees, while essences, as concepts in the mind, reflect gradations as contrasts. As Mulla Sadra put it,

The instances of being are different in terms of intensity and weakness as such, priority and posteriority as such; nobility and baseness as such, although the universal concepts applicable to it and abstracted from it, named quiddities, are in contrast essentially, in terms of genus, species, or accidents. (al-Asfar IX 186)

Before Mulla Sadra, Suhrawardi introduced the concept of gradation into the logic of definition and considered essence as capable of applying to instances by different degrees. For example, he regarded a horse more of an animal than a fly. His ontology was based on light as the hierarchical reality of universe with realms of existence as different ranks of it. Inspired by Suhrawardi’s challenge of classical philosophers such as Ibn Sina who would not allow gradation in the same essence, but in contrast to the former’s belief in the ontological primacy of essence or quiddity, Mulla Sadra replaced the hierarchical light of Suhrawardi with the hierarchical being. Accordingly, Reality is one and the same thing but possessed of different degrees of intensity, which justifies diversity within unity.

The doctrine of gradation not only supports the reality of diversity, but also points out the all-encompassing simplicity of being qua being. Hence the famous dictum that is frequently repeated in Mulla Sadra’s works, “the Simple Reality (basit al-haqiqa) is all things but none of those things in particular” (al-Asfar VI 111).

c. The Absolute and the Relational

Given that for Mulla Sadra reality consists in different grades of the same being, the nature of causality becomes an urgent question for him. Mulla Sadra’s formulation of causality reveals the strong influence of Ibn Arabi’s unity of being (wahdat al-wujud). Mulla Sadra begins with causality in the sense of existentiation (ijad) according to which contingent essences are brought into existence once their existence is necessitated by the Necessary Being. However, since in Mulla Sadra’s system, essences only belong in the conceptual domain, the relationship between cause and effect cannot be explained based on the metaphysical duality of being/essence. Therefore, he finally replaces this duality by the distinction he makes between two senses of being, the independent and the relational. At the cosmic level, the only independent being is the Absolute Being, while the rest, no matter of what intensity, are only relational.

Mulla Sadra’s introduction of this distinction into Islamic philosophy was inspired by the linguistic division between the meaning of “to be” in the sense of existence as a real predicate, and “to be” as a copula, the latter being nonexistent as a word in Arabic and only suggested though predication. Relational being is a “being-in-another” in the sense of being nothing other than a relation to another being. For example, in saying that “snow is white”, the predicative relation that is expressed by “is” has no existence apart from “snow” and “white”. Mulla Sadra regards all beings as nothing but an existential relation to the Absolute Being. For Him, “He is the Truth and the rest are His manifestations. He is the Light and the rest are the streaks of that Light…” (al-Masha’ir 450).

4. Epistemology

Mulla Sadra’s epistemology is not prior to but based on his findings about the nature of reality. Though this may sound like begging the question from the perspective of modern philosophy, it is consistent with the totality of Mulla Sadra’s system in which everything including knowledge itself is a form of being. It is for this reason that he studies knowledge as a subject of first philosophy, namely, the study of being qua being. He diverges from what he criticises in Ibn Sina as the negative process of abstraction (al-Asfar III 287) in favour of the positive presence of noetic or mental beings in the mind. For Mulla Sadra, knowledge is the realization of an immaterial being which corresponds to the extra-mental reality because it is the higher grade of the latter being.

Mulla Sadra’s main contribution to Islamic epistemology lies in his diversion from the Aristotelian dualism of subject and object, in other words, knower and the known (̒aqil wa ma’quil). He rejected the dominant theory of knowledge as the representation of the abstracted and universal form of particular objects to the mind. This innovation, though on a different ground and based on a different foundation, is comparable to the 20th century efforts made in the area of phenomenology and existentialism to get over the epistemological scepticism resulting from Cartesian dualism.

a. Mental Being

In classical Islamic epistemology knowledge is divided into “knowledge by presence” that consists only in the immediate access of the soul to itself in the sense of self-consciousness, and “knowledge by acquisition” that originates in sense perception and provides the subject with an abstracted representation of the external objects, that is, the intelligible universal at the level of intellect. In line with the Neoplatonic trend of thought adopted by Suhrawardi, Mulla Sadra replaced representation by direct presentation (hudur). For Mulla Sadra, all knowledge is, at bottom, knowledge by presence because our knowledge of the world is a direct access to what is called mental beings.

In contrast to the Peripatetic mental form or concept as a universal produced by abstraction, mental being is an immaterial and particular mode of existence with a higher intensity than the external object corresponding to it. According to Mulla Sadra, mental being is the key to the realization of all levels of knowledge including sense perception, imagination, and intellection. Upon encounter with the external world, the soul creates mental beings in a similar manner that God creates the world of substantial forms both material and immaterial (al-Shawahid al-rububiyya 43). Thus, rather than correspondence between the external object and its represented form in the mind, for Mulla Sadra the credibility of knowledge lies in the existential unity of different grades of the same being, one created by the soul and the other existing in the external world.

Although the human soul has the potentiality of creating modes of existence also in the absence of the matter, as in the case of miracles, for the average human soul, as long as she lives in the material world, contact with matter is necessary for activating the creative process of generating mental beings. In this respect, Mulla Sadra’s epistemology should not be conflated with subjective idealism in that for him the physical being is a reality though of a lesser intensity than its counterpart in the soul.

b. Unity of the Knower and the Known

Mulla Sadra revolutionized epistemology with regard to the relationship between the knowing subject and her object based on the doctrine of the unity of the knower and the known previously held by the Neoplatonic Porphyry (d. 305) but strongly rejected by Ibn Sina. Siding with the former, Mulla Sadra redefines the status of knowledge. Previously, mental form was defined as a psychic quality that occurs to the immaterial substance of the soul as a mere accident (̒arad), incapable of making any changes to the soul’s essence. Conversely, for Mulla Sadra, knowledge that is made up of mental beings functions as a substantial form that actualizes the potential faculties of the soul. Similar to form and matter in the physical world, there is no real separation between the knower (soul or mind) and the immediately known object of it, that is, the mental being. To put it in a nutshell, knowledge is a single reality that, in its potentiality, is called “the knower” (‘lim) or “the intellect” (‘aqil) while in its actuality, it is “the known” (ma’lum) or the “intelligible” (ma’quil). Owing to this unity, rather than being a fixed substratum for accidental mental forms, the mind in its reality is identical to the sum of all the mental beings that are realized in it. In other words, there is no such thing as an actual mind in the absence of knowledge.

This existential unification holds at all the levels of knowledge that is confined by Mulla Sadra to sense perception, imagination, and intellection. The faculty of sense perception is a potentiality of the soul that is unified with the perceptible forms (or beings) in the occasion of contact with the sensible world. Once sensible forms (beings) are realized, a higher grade of mental beings called “the imaginal beings” are actualized in unity with the imaginative faculty of the soul. The same unification holds at the level of intellection between the intelligible forms (beings) as the actual and the intellect as potential. From this level, the human soul is capable of acquiring higher degrees of knowledge that prepares her for the final unification with the Active Intellect that is the reservoir of all knowledge, and as a result, the activator of the human mind during the creative process of knowledge formation. This epistemic elevation is at the same time the journey of the soul towards higher grades of being and spiritualization.

5. Soteriological Psychology

In the pre-modern context, one should understand the term “psychology” in the sense of inquiry into the nature and mechanism of the metaphysical soul in its relation to the body. Moreover, informed by the Islamic doctrines and inspired by mysticism, Islamic philosophers regarded the human soul as capable of elevation through acquiring knowledge and spiritual practice. Mulla Sadra’s psychology is not an exception to this tradition; however, in his system, the human soul is given a more dominant role within the cosmic drama that unfolds along a salvific process of perfection.

a. Substantial Motion and the Soul

Mulla Sadra describes the soul as one simple but graded reality that in its unity includes diverse mental faculties. He also regards the soul as bodily in its origin, but spiritual in subsistence. This picture of the soul’s substance is unprecedented in the philosophy before Mulla Sadra. It is built on the doctrine of substantial motion that is one of the hallmarks of transcendental philosophy. According to this doctrine, all nature, including substances and accidents, is in motion. As bodily in its origin, the soul too moves from one form to another as long as it is living in this world. The substance of the soul is an existentially graded reality in which the changes take place through the superimposition of one form over the previous one rather than one replacing the other. Therefore, the unity of the soul is maintained despite the changes and her identity is preserved.

Though starting from the Aristotelian view of the soul as the form of the body, in his psychology, Mulla Sadra departs from the former in attributing to the human soul the power of growing out of the bodily attachment. Along with the expansion of knowledge and spiritual evolvement, the soul moves up to higher grades of being. The rational human soul is actualized when we reach maturity (around the age of forty), but this is not the end. At this stage, we are actually human but potentially angels or devils.

b. The End of the Human Soul

For Mulla Sadra, the ultimate happiness of the human souls is to join in the beatific life of the Intellects. This is in agreement not only with Aristotle’s definition of happiness, but also with a Neoplatonic doctrine according to which the individual souls are only particular determinations of the universal soul that descends to the imperfect level of nature by joining the bodies. Therefore, the individual human soul, though starting as a bodily being in the world, is still invested with an otherworldly spirituality due to the noble state of the universal soul before the descent. The inherent inclination toward reunion with the Active Intellect, that is, the realm of Divine Knowledge, puts the soul back on the “arch of ascent”. However, the ascent toward reunion is not guaranteed for each and every human soul since there are many phases that each soul should pass successfully in order to substantially evolve and reach up to higher ranks of being.

Mulla Sadra’s delineation of the soul’s journey resonates with ideas of Islamic mysticism which in turn is indebted for its theoretical formulation to Neoplatonic ideas. The title of his magnum opus, al-Asfar, together with its main divisions is a proof to the mystical attachment as the philosophical narrative unfolds in terms of the famous four journeys of the soul, namely, the quest in search of the ultimate Truth or God and the final reunion with Him. In al-Asfar, the first journey that is from the created to the Creator is devoted to the concept and reality of being. The second journey is from the Creator to the Creator through the Creator, and discusses essence. The third journey is from the Creator to the created with the Creator and is about God and His Attributes, and finally the journey from the created to the created with the Creator that is focused on the destiny of the humankind.

Furthermore, Mulla Sadra explains the afterlife of the human soul based on Ibn’Arabi’s metaphysics of imagination that introduces the imaginal world (̒alam al-mithal) in between the Intellectual realm on top and the material world at the bottom. In line with Ibn’Arabi and Suhrawardi, while in contrast to Ibn Sina, Mulla Sadra believes in a bipartite reality of imagination according to which imaginative forms can exist both as subjective, or attached to the human mind, and as objective, or independent, comprising the detached domain of imagination, that is, the imaginal world. The creative imagination of the human soul, which is the source of prophecy and miracles in this world, is also the key to the bodily resurrection of the soul in the next world. While in this world only the prophets and saints are capable of bringing their imagination into life, in the next world where the material bodies are no more existent, every soul will be capable of creating her imaginal body.

The bodily resurrection of the soul should not be conflated with any forms of reincarnation which is strongly rejected by Mulla Sadra. He uses the analogy of “reflections in the mirror” (al-Mazahir al-ilahiyya, 126) to show the necessary correlation between the otherworldly body and the spiritual grade of the individual soul. Rather than transmigrating into another body, the soul creates its very own body that becomes an objective image of her intentions and deeds in the previous life. That is the reason why the lesser souls will be resurrected as animals while the noble ones will simply join in the life of Intellect with no bodies at all. Thus, the hierarchy of resurrected souls in the next world corresponds to the hierarchy of souls in this world. There is a subtle problem here concerning the nature of imagination and the “mirror-like” nature of the soul in terms of eschatology. Mulla Sadra’s use of mirror imagery with respect to other-worldly bodies is his response to Suhrawardi on the same issue and draws on the endeavours of Ibn’Arabi and his commentator Dawoud al-Qaysari (d. 1350) to solve an earlier problem in Islamic philosophy (Rustom 2007).

6. Major Theological Issues

Islamic philosophy is rooted in the early endeavours of Mu’tazilite theologians who borrowed the instrument of Greek logic and terminology in order to formulate the doctrines of faith in a manner palatable for human reason. Of primary importance was proof to the existence and oneness of God, the nature and function of His Attributes, and the nature and mechanism of prophecy. Not only have different schools of theology offered divergent solutions to theological problems, but also theology has been in conflict with philosophy over several key issues. One of the novelties of Mulla Sadra’s work was the systematic effort to resolve long-held conflicts between philosophers and theologians. Moreover, unlike his philosophical predecessors, he did not leave any religious doctrine to mere faith and believed in the possibility of rational explanation for all. His proof for the doctrine of bodily resurrection is a good example of this positive attitude. On the whole, Mulla Sadra does not see a chasm between philosophy and theology; rather, his theology is both the continuation and the ultimate result of his philosophical doctrines.

Mulla Sadra dismissed all the previous proofs to the existence of God as resting on wrong assumptions, or at best insufficient. He even criticised Ibn Sina’s “proof of the righteous” (al–Asfar VI 13) because of its reliance on the concept rather than the reality of being. However, Mulla Sadra’s proof, which he calls by the same name, shares the a priori character of Ibn Sina’s proof. An a priori proof (burhan-i limmi) does not infer the existence of the Creator (cause) from the existence of any particular created thing (effect). For Mulla Sadra, the “proof of the righteous” is called by this name because it has the privilege of arguing for the existence of God through God Himself. Based on Mulla Sadra’s ontology, the reality of being is necessary, and it is of different grades. The delimited and imperfect grades do not exist in their own right, but only as relations to the most perfect or Absolute Being. Therefore, the Absolute Being or God must necessarily exist. Starting from the reality of being, this argument infers the existence of God from God Himself because “the real being and the Necessary Being apply to the same thing”, that is, God (al-Mabda’ wa’l-ma’ad 30).

As for the oneness of God (tawhid), that is, the first article of faith in Islam, Mulla Sadra further relies on his ontological views to argue against both the intrinsic and extrinsic plurality with respect to God. His argument is based on the transcendental inclusiveness of the Absolute Being. God as the Absolute Being is a simple reality in the sense of being without parts while including all things. As the most intense and the only independent being, God is inclusive of every form of existence while excluding only the imperfections and contingencies. Therefore, to assume another being next to God would be logically absurd. In Mulla Sadra, the theological doctrine of Divine Oneness can be identified with the mystical-philosophical doctrine of the oneness of being that is the only way in which the oneness of God can be understood without wrongly imagining it as a numerical concept.

a. The Essence and the Attributes

The simplicity of the Absolute Being in the sense of being comprehensive of all is also the key to explaining God’s Attributes in relation to each other and to the Essence (dhat). Though the Attributes must be infinite in number and scope, human beings only know of a limited number of them through the Qur’an. The nature of Divine Attributes has been a subject of controversies between different theological schools. They differ over the objectivity of the Attributes in the sense of independence from God’s Essence. In al-Asfar and al-Mabda’ wa’l-ma ‘ad, Mulla Sadra has elaborated on several Attributes including Life, Knowledge, Will, Speech, Vision and Hearing. He tries to prove the reality of the Attributes in a way that would not defy the unity of God’s Essence. He resolves this theological paradox of diversity in unity with regard to God’s Essence by resorting to the simple reality of God’s Being. In a similar way to the unity of the soul with the diverse psychic properties like knowledge and will, all the Attributes of God are not only unified with the Essence, but unified with each other. The corollary to this conclusion is that, in its ontological unity with the infinite and necessary Reality of God, each Attribute must be infinite and necessary. For example, God has necessary and infinite knowledge of all. According to Mulla Sadra, God knows the world through the knowledge of Himself and as his Essence includes all, he has knowledge of all without any limits. Nevertheless, the objects of divine knowledge exist at the level of Essence in a state of existential togetherness (wujud al-jam’i) with a higher grade of being than their existence as distinct essences in the created world. This is the way Mulla Sadra tried to resolve a long-held conflict between philosophy and theology regarding God’s detailed knowledge of the world. In a similar fashion, Mulla Sadra redefines other Attributes of God in the context of transcendental philosophy with the hope of reconciling philosophy with theology.

b. Temporal Origin of the World

One of the earliest and harshest theological indictments of Islamic philosophy was carried out by the Ash’arite theologian, Abu Hamid Muhammad ibn Muhammad al-Ghazzali, (d. 1111) in his al-Tahafat al-falasifa (The Inconsistency of Philosophers). One of the most important faults he finds in philosophers such as Ibn Sina is the doctrine of the eternity of creation. According to this doctrine that was accepted by all Peripatetic philosophers the universe was created in eternity, which means that creation had no beginning in time. This doctrine has been criticised by theologians due to its conflict with the scriptural picture of creation, both in the Bible and the Qur’an.

Mulla Sadra takes a middle path between reason and revelation by resorting to his doctrine of substantial motion. According to Mulla Sadra, every particle of nature is in constant motion along their timeline which he regards as the fourth dimension of the bodily substance. Motion is not an accidental property given to nature over and above its substance; rather, it is essential to it and caused at the same ‘time’ with the creation of the bodily substance. Motion is by definition temporal, and substantial motion is the renewal of every particle of nature in time. Thus, Mulla Sadra concludes that every particle of nature is being recreated at every moment, which is the meaning of temporal origination. The world as a whole is nothing more than its parts, so the origination of the whole world in time is an absurd question.

c. Bodily Resurrection

Bodily resurrection is an article of Islamic faith that is regarded by theologians as a requisite for the fulfilment of the scriptural promises and threats regarding reward and punishment in the next world. As a theological issue, bodily resurrection has caused serious conflicts between philosophy and theology particularly following Ghazzali’s criticism of Ibn Sina on this issue. According to Ibn Sina, bodily resurrection is a matter of faith that Muslims must believe in, but from a logical point of view, it is impossible.

Mulla Sadra follows Ghazzali in holding that scepticism over bodily resurrection is not acceptable from either the religious or logical point of view (al-Mazahir al-ilahiyya 125). However, he reinterprets bodily resurrection in terms of the imaginative creation of the otherworldly body by the soul. Though immaterial, the imaginal body is possessed of the three dimensions of the physical body that make it subject to a variety of feelings similar to our dream-world experiences. This will especially serve the purpose of punishment for the imperfect souls who spoiled the prospect of an intellectual/heavenly life through their carnal obsessions in the previous world. Some souls may be pardoned after serving their time in Hell by God’s Grace and the intermission of angels and nobler souls. As for the others, they will stay in Hell with their imaginal bodies forever. Despite his efforts, Mulla Sadra’s picture of resurrection is not in complete conformity with that of theology. Especially, his intellectual Paradise is not different to that of the classical philosophers. Great souls are not satisfied with carnal pleasures even in this world, so their reward in the next world cannot be a carnal one.

d. Prophethood, Imamate, and Sainthood

Influenced by Ibn ‘Arabi’s doctrine of “the Perfect Human” and its incorporation into Shi’i imamate by Sayyid Haydar Amuli (d. 1385), Mulla Sadra explains prophethood, imamate, and sainthood as related aspects of the same reality. Prophets, Imams, and Saints are instances of the category of the Perfect Human (al-insan al-kamil) whose soul is inclusive of the three levels of creation, that is, the intellectual, the imaginal, and the sensory worlds. Mulla Sadra, regards prophethood as “exoteric guidance” (al-Shawahid al-rububiyya 492) which is necessary for the average people. Intellectual truths that are revealed to prophets through the unification of their intellect with the Angel of revelation, identical to the Active Intellect of philosophy, descend to the level of imagination and sense perception in order to be communicated to the people.

The esoteric side of prophecy is not only the innermost spiritual meaning of it, but also the purpose of creation. Although Muslims believe that Muhammad was the last prophet of God, according to Mulla Sadra, after the death of Muhammad, revelation continued in the form of inspiration that endows the Imam and Saint with the same infallibility as the Prophet. Thus, the content of the divine communication is the same in all three, but the form is slightly different. Prophets have a clearer vision of the Angel of revelation in comparison to the Imams and Saints (al-Shawahid al-rububiyya 480).

7. Commentaries on the Qur’an and Tradition

In many cases philosophers have resorted to the Qur’an in order to reinforce their philosophical arguments. On the other hand, there is a long tradition of Qur’anic exegesis ranging from technical linguistic analysis to rational and esoteric hermeneutics (ta’wῑl) that comprises a sophisticated and independent discipline. Mulla Sadra is a special case as a philosopher who has dedicated independent treatises to Qur’anic commentaries. Moreover, there is a mutual reinforcement between his philosophy and his reading of the Qur’an in the sense that not only his approach to the Qur’an is philosophical, but also his philosophy has a Qur’anic base (Rustom 2012). Mulla Sadra does not see any conflicts between the teachings of the Qur’an and his philosophical system. Apart from several commentaries on chapters and verses from the Qur’an, Mulla Sadra also wrote about the theoretical and practical criteria of exegesis. His major theoretical work is Mafatih al-ghayb (Keys to the Invisible).

As for Mulla Sadra’s work on the tradition (hadith), his monumental commentary on al-Usul al-kafi by Kulayni is the most important. Kulayni’s work is the first Shi‘i collection of Hadith and focuses on theology and jurisprudence. It has served as a textbook at the religious seminaries around the Shi’i world for centuries, and Mulla Sadra’s commentary on this work has secured him a good place among the experts in Hadith scholarship.

8. Legacy

Mulla Sadra’s influence on his immediate students, including his sons-in-law, Fayz Kashani and Lahiji, owed more to the mystical aspect of his works. As for his philosophical doctrines, he was only followed by the less famous among his students such as Husayn Tunikabuni (d.1693). Especially, in the late Safavid period due to the intellectually suppressive atmosphere created by influential clerics, most prominently Muhammad Baqir Majlisi (d. 1198), philosophical and particularly mystical thoughts were antagonized by the ruling system and the clerics alike.

Nevertheless, the legacy of the philosopher was kept alive until, in the Qajar period (c. 1785-1925), a more welcoming attitude facilitated the revival of his works in the hands of his followers who worked as Sadrian scholars. In addition to editing and expounding the latter’s works, as teachers they also initiated a chain of scholars that has continued until today. Among contemporary scholars and Sadrian philosophers, Muhammad Husayn Tabataba’i (d. 1981) is one of the most widely read. His books, which are based on Mulla Sadra’s philosophy with some modifications, are still being taught as compendiums of Islamic philosophy at the departments of philosophy in Iran. Mulla Sadra studies particularly flourished after the Islamic Revolution of 1979. Since then, he has been widely taught both at the religious seminaries and universities with governmental funds supporting the foundation of institutes and international conferences. Among these, Sadra Islamic Philosophy Research Institute, established in 1994 in Tehran, and the World Congress on Mulla Sadra in 1999 are the best examples.

After Mulla Sadra’s death, India was the first place outside Iran to show his influence. A remarkable number of expositions and commentaries have been written on one of his marginal works called Commentary on Sharh al-Hidayah in India where it has been taught as a course book of Islamic philosophy for several centuries. Later, the Shi’i seminaries of Iraq in the city of Najaf and some influential thinkers in Pakistan also welcomed Mulla Sadra’s philosophy.

Mulla Sadra was introduced into the West at the end of the nineteenth century by the German orientalist, Max Horten (d. 1945) with an emphasis on the mystical aspect of the philosopher’s work. Later during 1960’s and 70’s, the collaboration of the French scholar Henry Corbin (d. 1978) with Toshihiko Izutsu (d.1986 ) from Japan and Seyyed Hossein Nasr (b. 1933) from Iran, led to a full-fledged introduction of Mulla Sadra into Western academia as part of a wider project of reviving “perennial wisdom”. Following their work, Mulla Sadra has been translated, taught, and discussed in academic journals and circles both in Europe and North America. The contemporary generation of Mulla Sadra scholars, though approaching Mulla Sadra from different points of view, are illuminating various aspects of the philosopher’s work.

9. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Philosophical Works

Mulla Sadra, Risala-yi si asl. Seyyed Hossein Nasr (ed.). (Tehran: Mulla Sadra Research Institute, 1381AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, al-Hikmat al-muta’aliya fi asfar al-aqliya al-arba’a. 5. Muhammad Reza Muzaffar (ed.). 9 vols. (Beirut: Dar al-ihya ‘ al-turath al-Arabi, 1999).
Mulla Sadra, al-Hikmat al-‘Arshiyya. Ghulam Ahani (ed.). (Isfahan: Isfahan University press, 1340 AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, Sharh al-Hidaya.Ahmad Shirazi (ed.). (Facsimile repr. Qom: Intishsrat-i Bidar. 1313 AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, al-Mabda’ wa’l-ma’ad. Ahmad Hosseini Ardakani (ed.). (Tehran: Sitad-i Inqilab-i Farhangi, Markaz-i Nashr-i Danishgahi, 1983).
Mulla Sadra, Tafsir al-Qur’an al-karim. M. Khajavi (ed.). 7 vols. (Qom: Intisharat-i Bidar, 1988).
Mulla Sadra, al-Mazahir al-ilahiyya. 3. Sayyid Jalal al-Din Ashtiyani (ed.). (Qom: Office of Islamic Propagation of the Seminary of Qom, 1387 AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, al-Shawahid al-rububiyya. Javad Mosleh (trans.). (Tehran: Soroush Press, 2006).
Mulla Sadra, Majmu’a-yi rasa’il-i falsafi-yi Sadr al-muta’allihin. Hamid Naji Isfahani (ed.). (Tehran: Hikmat, 1385AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, al-Masha’ir.Sayyid Jalal al-Din Ashtiyani (ed.). (Qom: Office of Islamic Propagation of the Seminary of Qom, 1386 AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, Mafatih al-ghayb. Muhammad Khawjavi (ed.). (Beirut: Mu ‘assasat al-Tarikh al-Arabi, 2002 rpt).
Mulla Sadra, Sharh-i Usul al-Kafi. Muhammad Khawjavi (ed.). 4 vols. (Tehran: Pizhuhishgah-i Ulūm-i Insani va Mutala’at-i Farhangi, 2004).

b. English Translation of Primary Literature

Mahdi Dasht Bozorgi and Fazel Asadi Amjad, Divine Manifestations: Concerning the Secrets of the Sciences of Perfection (London: ICAS Press, 2010).
William Chittick, The Elixir of the Gnostics (Provo: Brigham Young University Press, 2003).
Ibrahim Kalin, Knowledge in Later Islamic Philosophy. Mulla Sadra on Existence, Intellect, and Intuition (New York: Oxford University Press, 2010).
T. Kirmani, The Manner of the Creation of Actions (Tehran: SIPRIn, 2004).
J. Lameer, Conception and Belief in Sadr al-Din Shirazi (Tehran: Iranian Academy of Philosophy, 2005).
Parviz Morewedge, The Metaphysics of Mulla Sadra: The Book of Metaphysical Prehensions (New York: Society for the Study of Islamic Philosophy and Science, 1992).
James Morris, The Wisdom of the Throne (Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1981).
Seyyed Hossein Nasr and Ibrahim Kalin, Metaphysical Penetrations: A Parallel English-Arabic Text by Mulla Sadra (Provo: Brigham Young Press, 2013).
Latimah Peerwani, On the Hermeneutics of the Light Verse of the Qur ‘an (London: ICAS Press, 2004).
Colin Turner, Challenging Islamic Fundamentalism: The Three Principles of Mulla Sadra (London: Routledge, 2011).

c. Secondary Books in European Languages

Alparslan Açikgenç, Being and Existence in Sadra and Heidegger: A Comparative Ontology (Kuala Lumpur: International Institute of Islamic Thought and Civilization, 1993).
Reza Akbarian, The Fundamentals of Mulla Sadra’s Transcendent Philosophy (London: Xlibris, 2009).
Reza Akbarian, Islamic Philosophy: Mulla Sadra and the Quest of “Being” (London: Xlibris, 2009).
Cécile Bonmariage, Le Réel et les réalités: Mulla Sadra Shirazi et la structure de la réalité (Paris: Vrin, 2008).
Maria Massi Dakake,”Hierarchies of Knowing in Mulla Sadra’s Commentary on Usul al-Kafi.” Journal of Islamic Philosophy 6 (2010).
Mahdi Dehbashi, Transubstantial Motion and the Natural World (London: ICAS Press, 2010).
Max Horten, Das philosophische System von Schirázi (Strasbourg: Trübner, 1913).
Christian Jambet, The Act of Being: The Philosophy of Revelation in Mulla Sadra. Jeff Fort (trans.). (New York: Zone Books, 2006).
Christian Jambet, Mort et résurrection en islam: L’audelàselon Mulla Sadra (Paris: Albin Michel, 2008).
Christian Jambet, Se rendre immortel (Saint Clémentde Rivière: Fata Morgana, 2002).
Ibrahim Kalin, Knowledge in Later Islamic Philosophy. Mulla Sadra on Existence, Intellect, and Intuition (New York: Oxford University Press, 2010).
Muhammad Kamal. From Essence to Being: The Philosophy of Mulla Sadra and Martin Heidegger (London: ICAS Press, 2010).
Muhammad Kamal, Mulla Sadra’s Transcendent Philosophy (Aldershot: Ashgate, 2006).
Sayeh Meisami, Mulla Sadra (Oxford: Oneworld, 2013).
Mahmoud Khatami, From a Sadrean POint of View: Toward an Ontetic Elimination of the Subjectivistic Self (London: London Academy of Iranian Studies, 2004).
Megawati Moris, Mulla Sadra’s Doctrine of the Primacy of Existence ( KualaLumpur: ISTAC, 2003).
Zailan Moris, Revelation, Intellectual Intuition and Reason in the Philosophy of Mulla Sadra: An Analysis of the al-Hikmahal‘Arshiyyah (London: RoutledgeCurzon, 2002).
Seyyed Hossein Nasr, Sadr al-Din Shirazi and His Transcendent Theosophy. 2nd ed. (Tehran: Institute for Humanities and Cultural Studies, 1997).
Fazlur Rahman, The Philosophy of Mulla Sadra (Albany: State University of New York Press, 1975).
Sajjad Rizvi, Mulla Sadra Shirazi: His Life and Works and the Sources for Safavid Philosophy (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2007).
Sajjad Rizvi, Mulla Sadra and Metaphysics: Modulation of Being (London: Routledge, 2009).
Mohammed Rustom, “Psychology, Eschatology, Imagination, in Mulla Sadra Shirazi’s Commentary on the Hadith of Awakening,” Islam & Science, vol 5 (summer 2007) No 1.
Mohammed Rustom, The Triumph of Mercy: Philosophy and Scripture in Mulla Sadra (Albany: State University of New York Press, 2012).
Mahdi Ha’iri Yazdi, The Principles of Epistemology in Islamic Philosophy: Knowledge by Presence (Albany: State University of New York Press, 1992).

Author Information

Sayeh Meisami
Email: smeisami1@udayton.edu
University of Dayton

Zhang Junmai (Carsun Chang, 1887—1969)

Zhang Junmai (Chang Chun-mai), also known as Carsun Chang, was an important twentieth-century Chinese thinker and a representative of modern Chinese philosophy. Zhang’s participation in “The Debate between Metaphysicians and Scientists” of 1923, in which he defended his Neo-Confucian views against those of Chinese progressives and scientists, made a strong philosophical impression on an entire generation of Chinese intellectuals by championing the value of traditional Confucian truth claims and asserting the limits of scientific knowledge. Subsequently, Zhang’s two-volume study of The Development of Neo-Confucian Thought (1957) and his Manifesto for the Reappraisal of Chinese Culture (1958) cemented his identification with Confucianism, and the view of Confucianism as compatible with modernity, in the English-speaking philosophical world. Despite his association with Confucianism, Zhang was deeply influenced by the work of the French thinker Henri Bergson and exponents of German Idealism, particularly Immanuel Kant and Georg Wilhelm Friedrich Hegel. Zhang is best known today, however, not for his original philosophical work but rather for his political activities during China’s Republican era (1912-1949), through which he and his “Third Force” party attempted to mediate between the polarized Nationalist and Communist factions in the Chinese political landscape, as well as his promotion of Neo-Confucian studies in the West. His personal motto was, “Do not forget philosophy because of politics, and do not forget politics because of philosophy.” Due perhaps to his acknowledgment of Western influences as well as his involvement in politics, Zhang remains one of the modern Confucian movement’s most understudied figures, especially in comparison to his contemporaries Feng Youlan and Mou Zongsan. Yet his dual participation in both philosophy and politics makes him an exemplary Confucian and an embodiment of the Neo-Confucian ideal of “the unity of knowledge and action” (zhixing heyi).

Early Life
The Debate of 1923 and Zhang’s Moral Metaphysics
Political Philosophy
Confucianism and Chinese Modernity
Influence and Key Interpreters
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Works
2. Secondary Studies

1. Early Life

The man known as Zhang Junmai was born Zhang Jiasen, son of a merchant family in the Jiading district of China’s Jiangsu Province, on January 18, 1887. His early education included the memorization of the Four Books and Five Classics of traditional Confucianism. At the age of eleven, however, his forward-thinking family sent him to study Western history and science as well as the English language, although he continued to read the work of influential Neo-Confucian thinkers such as Zhu Xi. At the age of fifteen, he passed the district-level civil service examination and earned the basic shengyuan or xiucai degree, which entitled its bearers to exemption from corvée labor and corporal punishments and granted them access to local government facilities. After continuing his studies for a few more years, Zhang taught English in Hunan Province for two years before traveling to Tōkyō, Japan in 1906 and enrolling in Waseda University’s undergraduate program in economics and political science. Like many other Chinese intellectuals of that era, he intended to take advantage of Japan’s recent and rapid modernization by studying Western thought while remaining within an East Asian cultural context.

In Japan, Zhang befriended the constitutional monarchist Liang Qichao (1873-1929), a political reformer whose activities led to his exile in 1898. Zhang began to publish articles in Liang’s biweekly, New Citizen (Xinmin Congbao), including translations of excerpts from John Stuart Mill’s Considerations on Representative Government. Zhang’s other activities within expatriate Chinese circles included participation in the creation of the Political Information Society (Zhengwen she), which competed with Sun Yat-sen’s United League (Tongmeng hui) for the hearts and minds of reform-minded Chinese of the period. After graduating from Waseda in 1911, he returned to China and successfully passed the entrance examination for the Hanlin Academy, a prestigious Confucian college founded in the eighth century. However, the Hanlin Academy, like other official Confucian institutions, soon fell victim to the Chinese Revolution, which swept away this and other vestiges of imperial rule in favor of a more democratic and scientifically-minded “New China.” Unable to pursue his dream of becoming a government official, Zhang returned to his ancestral home, where he was appointed chairman of the local parliament. Soon afterward, Zhang’s publication of an article critical of government policy toward Mongolia led to his proscription, and he fled to Germany to avoid repression.

In Germany, as in Japan, Zhang once more pursued academic studies, registering at the University of Berlin for preparatory coursework that would lead to enrollment in the University’s doctoral program in law and political science. World events disrupted his plans yet again when the First World War broke out in 1914. Zhang turned his attention to the ongoing conflict, publishing articles in about the European political and military situations in Chinese newspapers. In 1915, Zhang traveled to England before returning to China one year later to assume the editorship of the newspaper New Current Affairs (Shishi xinbao) and teach law at Beijing University. With the conclusion of hostilities in 1919, Zhang toured Europe in the company of Liang Qichao and other Chinese intellectuals and attempted to intervene in the transfer of sovereignty over China’s Shandong Province (the home region of Confucius) from Germany to Japan by the Peace Conference of Versailles that ended the war. Having recently produced a Chinese translation of the American president Woodrow Wilson’s “Fourteen Points,” which justified the Allies’ use of force in the name of democracy and national self-determination, Zhang was devastated and rapidly lost interest in politics, turning his attention “from social sciences to philosophy,” as he later called this crucial transition in his life.

In January 1921, Zhang met with Rudolf Eucken (1846–1926) in Jena, Germany. This encounter was perhaps one of the most important turning points in Zhang’s life. After a brief interview, Zhang decided to stay in Jena to learn philosophy under Eucken’s patronage. Studying with Eucken opened Zhang’s mind to new sets of ideas, especially those of Henri Bergson (1859-1941), and questions of life, ethics and culture gained a more important place in his thought. In 1922, Zhang collaborated with Eucken in the writing of a book in German entitled Das Lebensproblem in China und in Europa (The Problem of Human Life in China and Europe). The first half of the book, written by Eucken, was a short introduction to the history of European conceptions of life, while the second half, written by Zhang, dealt with the outlooks on life found in the work of major Chinese philosophers. Although Zhang’s treatment of Chinese thought was mainly historical in perspective, this text marks the first occasion on which he drew parallels between Confucian traditions and the philosophy of Kant. Here, Zhang argued that Confucius’ dictum that “what the superior man seeks is in himself, while what the petty man seeks is in others” (Analects 15:21) was comparable to Kant’s claim that the sources of morality are to be found within oneself. Thus, in Zhang’s view, both Confucianism and Kantianism see human morality as grounded in human nature and thus autonomous.

Despite Zhang’s immersion in philosophical studies, he remained active in politics. During his time in Germany, he met with many activists and leaders, including the social democrat Philip Scheidemann (1865–1939) and the architect of Germany’s post-war constitution, Hugo Preuss (1860–1925). These encounters with Weimar Republic intellectuals helped to form Zhang’s conceptions of socialism and exerted a lasting influence on his dual life in politics and philosophy. Both aspects of this dual life were expressed in his participation in “the Debate between Metaphysicians and Scientists” of 1923.

2. The Debate of 1923 and Zhang’s Moral Metaphysics

Having returned to China, in February 1923 Zhang gave a speech at Beijing’s Qinghua School (later Qinghua University) about the differences between science and what he called “outlooks on life” (rensheng guan). In this speech, Zhang claimed that the former is characterized by “objectivity,” “logic,” “analytic methods,” “causality,” and “uniform phenomena,” while the latter are “subjective,” “intuitive,” and “synthetic,” based on “free will.” Moreover, he defended the idea that, in her path to modernization, China should not only consider the sciences but also ought to define a new way, based on the “outlooks on life” of ancient Chinese sages. Zhang’s position drew considerable criticism from intellectuals associated with the anti-traditional May Fourth Movement, especially the famous geologist Ding Wenjiang (1887–1936). The difference of opinion between Zhang and Ding developed into a major political and philosophical event in the intellectual history of Republican China and became known as “the Debate between Metaphysicians and Scientists.” This debate played an important role in the emergence of a neo-conservative trend in modern Chinese thought by raising the questions of what place science ought to have in modern Chinese society and whether scientism and positivism ought to influence modern Chinese worldviews. The debate also played an important role in the development of Zhang’s philosophy insofar as it prompted the first publication of Zhang’s philosophical views in Chinese.

By 1923, Zhang’s conception of himself as a “realist idealist” (weishi de weixin zhuyi)—one who refused to sacrifice empirical issues for the sake of his deeply-held ideals—was fully established. Because of Zhang’s attraction to the thought of Bergson and Eucken, he was often criticized as an “anti-rationalist” (fan lixing zhuyi zhe). What his critics appear to have had in mind was not an opposition to reason on Zhang’s part, but rather his concern to avoid the over-use of the “process of abstraction” (chouxiang licheng). On Zhang’s view, when considering abstractions such as “Humanity” or “Nature,” one should always keep in mind that they are real and in front of us. Instead of building abstract systems and concepts, Zhang wanted to construct a philosophy that would embrace the reality and the fullness of the universe.

Zhang founded his “realist idealist” philosophy on the basis of a classically dualistic conception of the world. On the one hand, there is matter (wuzhi or wu); on the other hand, there is spirit (jingshen) or mind (xin). Zhang rejected monistic conceptions of the world as incoherent, going so far as to translate the English philosopher C. E. M. Joad’s Mind and Matter, which advocated the same position, in 1926. Zhang’s dichotomy between mind and matter is a structural division in his philosophy, which generates a series of opposing notions: matter is outside (wai) of the self and is fixed (ding), while mind or spirit is always inside (nei) the self and in motion (dong). The material world of nature is governed by causality, while the spiritual world of humanity is conducted by free will (ziyou yizhi). In later years, when discussing the relation between liberty (ziyou) and power (quanli) in political philosophy, Zhang categorized the former as belonging to the realm of spirit and the latter as relative to matter. His division between science and “outlooks on life” thus is an extension of these binary oppositions that are basic to his thought.

Zhang regarded science (kexue) as a plural signifier and subdivided it into two types: “material sciences” (wuzhi kexue) and “spiritual sciences” (jingshen kexue). This opposition was based on the German distinction between “natural sciences” (Naturwissenschaften or Exactewissenchaften) and “spiritual sciences” (Geistwissenchaften). While his opponents advocated science as one universal epistemology based on specific methodology, Zhang argued that one should consider sciences according to their objects, which could be any of three types: “inert” (si zhi wu), “alive” (huo zhi wu), or “alive and thinking” (youhuo yousi zhi wu). Incapable of moving by themselves, inert objects are bound to follow the rules of causality. Their movements can be explained by natural laws, and it is the purpose of material sciences to discover and analyze these laws. For instance, astronomy aims at explaining how planets gravitate around the sun. On Zhang’s account, physics and astronomy are the most archetypal material sciences.

Although plants and animals lack “mind” in Zhang’s sense, they are alive nonetheless, so for Zhang, their analysis raises further issues. Unlike inert objects, plants and animals can move on their own, so despite the fact that causality applies to them, it doesn’t explain everything. But Zhang insisted that the presence of life in itself couldn’t be questioned by science. Following the ideas of the German vitalist Hans Driesch (1867–1941)—who was at that time visiting in China, where Zhang served as his translator—Zhang seems to believe that there is an entelechy, a driving principle that directs life and its development without being part of the soul or the organism, the existence of which precludes questioning its manifestation. To Zhang, the very foundations of life were completely impossible to analyze. Therefore, biology was not literally “the science of what is alive” but only the science that analyzes the material structure and development of living animals and plants

As for what Zhang called “spiritual sciences”—by which he meant something like social sciences—these moved beyond the realm of matter and were capable of analyzing humanity itself. Yet all the natural laws that could be found in those sciences were always linked to a material aspect of life. For instance, Zhang accepted that there were laws of development in economy; economy and society were at some point to follow specific patterns. But he insisted that these laws could only be found because there are material and fixed data to analyze. Economics, for example, deals with manufactured goods. On Zhang’s account, spiritual sciences could discover and analyze laws of nature only if their object was somehow linked to something material. Even if there are laws that condition the development of social phenomena, human beings still can use their minds and free will to modify the situation. For that reason, social laws or historical patterns can only be sought in the past. Following Bergson, Zhang noted that the human spirit is in perpetual transformation (xin zhi wanbian): it is impossible to divide thought into fixed mental states, as our minds are always on the move (dong). Having no place to settle, no analysis can be made. Therefore, for Zhang, there cannot be any real psychology, but only physiology, a study of the relation between stimuli and the mind. According to Zhang, science cannot predict the future of humanity, which is why he rejected Marxism.

In contrast to such “sciences,” Zhang outlined his understanding of “outlooks on life” as a coherent alternative to claiming that everything could be understood and controlled by Science. In her fight for a new culture (xin wenhua), China was to cast away naturalism and positivism, and develop a new “outlook on life,” based on both Western modernity and the teachings of the ancient Chinese sages, that did not exclude or condemn metaphysics. Zhang even claimed that the introduction of Bergson’s and Eucken’s philosophies to China could give birth to “Neo-Song [Dynasty] Learning” (xin songxue 新宋學), just as the introduction of Buddhism to China had permitted the emergence of the original Neo-Confucianism of the Song dynasty (songxue).

In Eucken’s philosophy, humanity is a being at the frontier of matter and spirit, and is in a perpetual struggle to achieve a spiritual life that can overcome his material nature. By promoting metaphysics, Zhang wished to foster human spiritual life and dismiss a scientistic conception of the world that would bind human beings in the web of material causality. Borrowing from Eucken’s Die Lebenschauungen der grossen denker (Outlooks on Life of the Great Thinkers, 1890), Zhang defined “outlook on life” as follows:

The observations, holds, hopes, and demands that I have toward the persons and the objects external to myself—that’s what I call an outlook on life. (Zhang 1981, p. 935)

Outlooks on life are not under the control of sciences. They find their source in the self (wo). Considering that “toward the world, man’s life is inner as spirit and outer as matter” (ibid.), outlooks on life are in fact what link our spiritual life with the material world. Even if people of the past can be models to follow (Zhang 1981, p. 913), everyone ought to develop his own outlook on life according to what his heart-mind (xin) tells him. That is what Zhang called the mandate of moral conscience (liangxin zhi ming). For Zhang as for other Confucians, the heart-mind is the center of the self; every moral thought and volition is generated from it. Having three principal functions, knowledge (zhi 智), emotions (qing 情) and will (zhi 志), it is what makes us human. In total opposition to the view defended by Hu Shi (1891-1962) at that time, Zhang argued that the difference between humans and animals is qualitative, not quantitative. The use of such concepts and terminology shows how deep the influence of Mencius’ and Wang Yangming’s moral thought on Zhang was. As a thinker who was steeped in Confucian tradition, Zhang considered human beings to be good by nature and wanted to promote Neo-Confucian metaphysics as a means to cultivate oneself (xiushen).

Finally, a word should be said about Zhang’s debt to Kant, which was the result of his lifelong infatuation with this eighteenth-century German thinker. Zhang’s epistemology was mainly drawn from Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason (1781); he considered Kant to be the man who “had succeeded in harmonizing British empiricism and German rationalism” (Zhang 1981, p. 949). For Zhang, knowledge is the result of an encounter between material sense information and the innate categories of the mind. Human beings have innate categories or “concepts of reason” (lixing zhi gainian) that enable them to understand, classify, and aggregate all of their sensations (ganjue). It is these concepts of reason that link sensations to meanings (yiyi). Later, Zhang suggested that knowledge, built up from the encounter of sensations and concepts of reason, is always internal to one’s mind. For instance, in 1957, he wrote that the Song dynasty Confucian thinker Ch’eng I’s statement ”Human nature is reason” [(xing ji li ye], “means nothing other than the rationalist doctrine that forms of thought exist a priori in the mind” (Chang 1957, p. 35). For Zhang, the key philosophical question was that of the relationship between a mind able of knowing (zhizhi zhi xin) and the myriad things (wanwu zhi you) or phenomenal universe, through which knowledge of all that exists, materially and spiritually, could be integrated. Assuming that the principle of mind (xin li) is universal, Zhang anticipated that the development of thought ought to be somehow similar in every culture. This argument would form the basis of his claim that a genuine Chinese modernity was possible.

3. Political Philosophy

Despite Zhang’s leap “from social sciences to philosophy,” he did not abandon political life. On the contrary, he participated in the drafting of a new Chinese constitution and wrote

On the Meaning of Constitutions (1921). He struggled to introduce socialism in China. Very much taken with the newly-established Weimar Republic in Germany, Zhang wished to establish a very similar political system in China. In 1923, he opened a “Political Institute” in the suburbs of Shanghai, the aim of which was to form a new political elite that would be able to shape the nation’s affairs in future years. Under its auspices, Chinese students were exposed to political philosophy, economics, sociology, and international relations as well as Zhang’s critiques of both the Chinese Communist Party and the Guomindang (Kuomintang, KMT) or Chinese Nationalist Party, which contended against each other for political and later military supremacy throughout the 1920s, ’30s, and ’40s. After the KMT occupation of Shanghai in 1927, Zhang was forced to close the Institute and ventured into underground political activities. With Li Huang (1895—1991), a leader of the Chinese Youth Party (Zhongguo qingnian dang), he illegally published a journal, The New Way (Xinlu), in which he proclaimed his political values:

[D]emocratic government, opposition to both one-class and one-party dictatorships, freedom of speech and association, opposition to the denial of these basic human rights under the pretext of party or military rule, the opposition to party control of education, of judicial affairs, of civil servants, and the use of the army for personal or party purposes. (Chi, p. 141)

These points can be regarded as the key ideas of Zhang’s political thought at the time. In opposition to nationalist and communist conceptions of the political power in China, Zhang totally forbade the political parties to indoctrinate their members, to use military force or to practice dictatorial politics—all of which may have prevented Zhang’s own political parties from ever succeeding in the brutal political climate of China during the 1930s. Frustrated by chronic repression at the hands of the KMT, Zhang fled China once again and returned to Germany, where he obtained a position as Professor of Chinese Philosophy at the University of Jena through the assistance of Eucken’s former students. Eventually, he returned to China just before Japanese invasion of Manchuria in September 1931. In this politically-charged and highly unstable climate, Zhang assumed professorial duties in philosophy at Yanjing University in Beijing, teaching mostly about Hegel, before being ejected from his position as a result of his critical stance vis-a-vis the KMT government. Siding with the warlord Chen Jitang, the de facto ruler of Guangdong Province, Zhang again found work as a professor of philosophy, this time teaching Neo-Confucianism—first at Sun Yat-sen University and later at his own Learning Ocean Academy (Xuehai Shuyuan).

At this institution, which blended traditional Confucian education with what Zhang saw as the best of Western learning (humanities, social sciences, and physical education), he was able to put into practice what he had defended during the debate of 1923: an education that would place equal and shared emphasis on the humanities (especially metaphysics), the arts, sports, and of course the sciences. In 1939, Zhang opened another such school: the Institute of National Culture (Minzu Wenhua Xueyuan), the guiding documents of which stated:

The objectives of this academy are as follows: one, to achieve one’s personality; two, to temper and foster intelligence in order to contribute to the world scholarship; three, to deploy these activities, in which moral and knowledge are one, to participate grandly in the ordering of the world (or statecraft). (Zhang 1981, p. 1435)

To participate in the world, either as politicians or as scholars, students were first to develop their personality. For Zhang, such psychological development, along with physical ability and intellectual knowledge, were all necessary to become a full human being. Self-cultivation through education, in turn, was key to the development of Chinese democracy, which was Zhang’s primary political commitment. In his political philosophy, there is a very strong bond between the people and the idea of the State. Democracy should not be implemented from above, but rather it should arise from the heart-minds of citizens. Influenced by Confucian ethics, Zhang appears to have viewed democracy through the prism of the canonical Confucian text known as the Daxue (Great Learning), which states:

To bring the world at peace, one should first govern one’s State; to govern one’s State, one should first order one’s family; to order one’s family, one should first cultivate oneself.

Zhang believed that the Chinese people would permit the emergence of democracy as the result of their own self-cultivation. For him, the State was no longer understood as a simple technical term of political science. It was the realization of the spirit of a people, founded on the basis of law and morality. Borrowing the Hegelian idea that “State is the realization of the Spirit [or Reason]” (guojia zhe jingshen zhi shixian ye), Zhang linked the question of the State with a certain humanism and a valorization of Chinese culture. The emergence of a new political system was to be the result of a New Culture (xin wenhua), from which would emerge a new outlook on life. Unfortunately, Zhang’s academies never stayed open very long. The Ocean Learning Academy was active for only two years, while the Institute of National Culture was closed in 1942, after three years of operation.

4. Confucianism and Chinese Modernity

As was the case with Zhang’s moral metaphysics and political philosophy, so also in his understanding of culture did Zhang cleave closely to his Confucian heritage. His philosophy of culture upheld a certain conservatism, according to which both Chinese cultural unity and Chinese social development could proceed organically from a shared basis in Neo-Confucian thought. In The Chinese Culture of Tomorrow (1936), which can be regarded as a response to Liang Shuming’s Eastern and Western Cultures and Their Philosophies (1921), Zhang defended this view:

Spiritual freedom [jingshen ziyou] is the foundation of a national culture [minzu wenhua] and therefore it should be the central principle to direct the politics, the sciences and the arts of China from now on. (Zhang 2006b, p. 1)

Zhang argued that a culture is a spiritual entity that is created by, and evolved through, the free contributions of its people—not a static expression of an ahistorical will, as Liang claimed. The nation is in fact the group of persons that build a cultural unity and live together within it. The influence of the Western philosophers of history Oswald Spengler (1880-1936) and Arnold Toynbee (1889-1975) can be seen in Zhang’s view. Zhang understood European modernity to be the result of a threefold historical process, which consisted of (1) religious reform (zongjiao gaige), (2) scientific development (kexue fazhan), and (3) the emergence of democratic government (minzhu zhengzhi). The challenge for China, therefore, lay not with importing European modernity, but rather with completing its own historical process of development in evolutionary terms specific to Chinese culture.

Like many Chinese intellectuals of the early twentieth century, Zhang advocated the need for a “New Culture”; like his rival Liang, Zhang believed that Chinese culture would become the global culture of the future. However, Zhang believed that this “New Culture” would develop only in response to the intellectual challenge represented by the West, just as Neo-Confucianism had developed in response to the intellectual challenge represented by the introduction of Buddhism from India—an historical event to which Zhang repeatedly referred as a positive precedent for China’s ability to adapt to foreign systems of thought. As “the culture of harmony,” Chinese culture would find the middle way (zhezhong) between all global philosophical and cultural trends—but only if she initiated the first step in the threefold historical process by rediscovering and reviving the “Chinese national spirit” (Zhonghua minzu jingshen), which Zhang identified with Neo-Confucianism. After China revived the quintessence of her past culture—that is, Neo-Confucianism as interpreted by Zhang—she would be able to formulate a new outlook on life, which in turn would give birth to a new culture. From this new culture, a new political system and a new economic organization soon would follow.

However, unlike many Chinese intellectuals of the era who defended a racial conception of the nation, Zhang had no interest in the question of blood lineage. As he pointed out in The Chinese Culture of Tomorrow (1936) and The Way to Establish the State (1938), one could not find any racial unity in China; since various “barbarian” invasions had produced a “blood mix” in the population, the blood of the Han ethnic majority was no longer “pure.” Constructing a blood-based nationalism would be irrelevant and self-destructive, but constructing a culture-based nationalism was another matter:

I won’t dare say that in History there was such a thing as a pure blood Han nation, however I can attest that there is a Han Culture, which embodies the language spoken, the characters used, the calendar, the customs, the rites and so on. (Zhang 2006d, p. 9)

Zhang’s activity as a non-aligned political thinker was curtailed by the end of cooperation between the KMT and the Chinese Communist Party in 1941, and he was placed under house arrest because of his opposition to KMT policies. In 1944, he was released and traveled to the United States, where he attended the founding meeting of the United Stations. While in the United States, Zhang renewed his interest in constitutionalism and spent much of his time studying the American Constitution. After returning to China in 1946, he began to argue that a conception of human rights, or at least its seeds, could be found in the Chinese intellectual tradition, especially in the thought of Mencius. His work became the basis of the Constitution of the Republic of China adopted in 1946, which is still in effect in Taiwan today. The implementation of the Constitution failed to resolve China’s ongoing civil war, however, and with the triumph of Communist forces in 1949, Zhang fled to a life of exile in Hong Kong.

In Hong Kong, Zhang produced The Third Force in China and initiated the modern Chinese discourse on democracy’s roots in Chinese tradition. Having identified elements of democratic sensibilities in ancient Chinese texts, Zhang held out hope that the establishment of democracy in China still was possible despite the victory of Communism on the mainland. He even suggested that the Enlightenment and the development of democratic ideas in the West during the eighteenth century were made possible due to the introduction of Confucian thought to Europe by Jesuit missionaries a century earlier. Thus, in Zhang’s view, Confucius and Mencius were the hidden sources of the West’s Enlightenment. Moreover, Zhang regarded Marxism as being in total opposition to the “Chinese outlook on life,” and anticipated the eventual decline of Communist ideology in China. In 1957 and 1962, he issued in English the two volumes of his magnum opus on the intellectual history of China, The Development of Neo-Confucian Thought, which opens with the following sentence:

China is the land of Confucianism. (Chang 1957, p.15)

In Zhang’s biographically-focused and comparatively-oriented account of Neo-Confucianism, rooted in his conception of “outlooks on life” in the East and the West, he criticized Communism as an alien system of thought that would not take root in Chinese culture, which he believed was characterized by Confucianism despite the influence of other traditions. Identifying himself as a twentieth century “Neo-Confucian,” Zhang continued to advocate what he saw as a genuine Chinese Confucian modernity until his death at age eighty-two in the United States in 1969, which also marked the height of the Communists’ “Cultural Revolution” campaign against Confucianism and other emblems of Chinese tradition.

5. Influence and Key Interpreters

Zhang’s involvement in the production of A Manifesto on the Reappraisal of Chinese Culture (1958), a document that aimed to promote an appreciation of Chinese culture among Western intellectuals, marks him as one of the key influences on the modern “New Confucian” movement, which seeks to promote Confucianism as a spiritual tradition that is fully compatible with democracy, science, and other aspects of modernity. Zhang’s participation in this movement probably stands as his foremost legacy in the world of contemporary Chinese philosophy.

Despite Zhang’s stature as a founder of New Confucianism and a promoter of Neo-Confucian studies in the West, he is little studied today, especially by Western scholars. Most Western research on Zhang’s thought has focused on his political philosophy and activism—an approach exemplified by the work of Roger B. Jeans (1997). Studies that depart from this rule include those of Umberto Bresciani (2001) and Edmund S.K. Fung (2003). German scholars have taken a particular interest in the ways in which Zhang’s work might apply to resolving modern problems, such as the deterioration of social relationships and the spiritual vacuum perceived in contemporary societies. Werner Messner (1994) has devoted attention to the tension between the process of modernization and the will to find a specific way (Sonderweg) for China in the thought of modern Chinese philosophers, especially Zhang.

Unsurprisingly, interest in Zhang’s work has been greater in the Chinese-speaking world, especially outside of mainland China. Zhang’s friends and associates produced much of the early scholarship on his thought. Xue Huayuan’s 1993 study of Zhang’s political activity ranks with Jeans’ work among the major research on Zhang produced to date. Within mainland China, for many years Zhang’s thought was proscribed because his idealist views and “bourgeois” background. Even after studies of Zhang by mainland Chinese scholars began to appear in the 1990s, many—such as those by Lü Xichen and Chen Ying (1996)—were harshly critical of his shortcomings as seen from a Marxist perspective. More recently, Zheng Dahua (1997, 1999) has produced more sympathetic scholarship on Zhang’s thought, while Chai Wenhua (2004) has explored Zhang’s conception of culture in particular. Most recently, Weng Hekai’s work (2010) focuses on Zhang’s contributions to the question of Chinese nation-building, especially the influence of John Stuart Mill to Zhang’s thinking about this issue. As interest in Zhang’s special concerns, such as Chinese cultural unity, constitutionalism, and an authentically Chinese modernity, intensifies in contemporary China, interest in Zhang’s legacy is sure to increase there and elsewhere.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Works

Chang, Carsun. The Third Force in China, New York: Bookman Associates, 1952.
Chang, Carsun. The Development of Neo-Confucian thought. 2 vols. New York: Bookman Associates, 1957-1962.
Chang, Carsun. Wang Yang-ming: Idealist Philosopher of Sixteenth-Century China. Jamaica, NY: St. John’s University Press, 1962.
Chang, Carsun, and Rudolf Eucken. Das Lebensproblem in China und in Europa, Leipzig: Quelle & Meyer, 1922.
Chang, Carsun, and Kalidas Nag. China and Gandhian India. Calcutta: The Book Company, 1956.
Zhang, Junmai. Guoxian yi (1921). In Xian Zheng zhi dao (Beijing: Qianghua daxue chubanshe, 2006a).
Zhang, Junmai. Minzu fuxing de xueshu jichu (1935). Beijing: Zhongguo renmin daxue chubanshe, 2006b.
Zhang, Junmai. Mingri zhi Zhongguo wenhua (1936). Beijing: Zhongguo renmin daxue chubanshe, 2006c.
Zhang, Junmai. Li guo zhi dao (1938). In Xian Zheng zhi dao (Beijing: Qianghua daxue chubanshe, 2006d).
Zhang, Junmai. Yili xue shi jiang gangyao (1955). Beijing: Zhongguo renmin daxue chubanshe, 2006.
Zhang, Junmai. Bijiao Zhong Ri Yangming xue. Taibei: Taiwan shangwu yinshu guan, 1955.
Zhang, Junmai. Bianzheng weiwu zhuyi bolun. Hong Kong: Youlian chubanshe, 1958.
Zhang, Junmai. Zhongguo zhuanzhi junzhu zhengzhi pingyi. Taibei: Hongwen guan chubanshe, 1986.
Zhang, Junmai. Rujia zhexue zhi fuxing. Beijing: Zhongguo renmin daxue chubanshe, 2006.
Zhang, Junmai, and Wenxi Cheng. Zhong Xi Yin zhexue wenji. 2 vols. Taibei: Taiwan xuesheng shuju, 1970.
Zhang, Junmai, and Huayuan Xue. Yijiusijiu nian yihou Zhang Junmai yanlun ji. Taibei : Daoxiang chubanshe, 1989.

b. Secondary Studies

Bresciani, Umberto. Reinventing Confucianism: The New Confucian Movement. Taipei: Taipei Ricci Institute for Chinese Studies, 2001.
Chai, Wenhua. Xiandai xin ruxue wenhua guan yanjiu. Beijing: Xinhua shudian, 2004.
Chen, Huifen. “Minzu xing, Shidai xing, Zizhu xing: 1930 niandai Zhang Junmai de wenhua jueze.” Taiwan shida lishi xuebao 28 (June 2000): 109–158.
Chen, Xianchu. Jingshen ziyou yu minzu fuxing – Zhang Junmai sixiang zonglun. Changsha: Hunan Jiaoyu chubanshe, 1999.
Chi, Wen-shun. Ideological conflicts in Modern China: Democracy and Authoritarianism. New Brunswick: Transaction Books, 1986.
Fang, Shiduo, ed. Zhang Junmai zhuanji ziliao. 8 vols. Taibei: Tianyi, 1979-1981.
Frohlich, Thomas. Staatsdenken im China der Republikzeit (1912–1949): Die Instrumentalisierung philosophischer Ideen bei chinesischen Intellektuellen. Frankfurt: Campus Verlag, 2000.
Fung, Edmund S.K. “New Confucianism and Chinese Democratization: The Thought and Predicament of Zhang Junmai.” Twentieth Century China 28/2 (April 2003): 41-71.
He, Xinquan (Ho Hsin-Chuan). “Zhang Junmai de Xinruxue qimeng jihua : yi ge xiandai vs. Houxiandai shidu.” Taiwan dongya wenming yanjiu xuekan 8/1/15 (July 2011): 209-234.
Hung, Mao-hsiung. Carsun Chang (1887–1969) und seine Vorstellung vom Sozialismus in China. Ph.D. diss. Ludwig-Maximilians-Universität, 1980.
Jeans, Roger B. Syncretism in Defense of Confucianism: An Intellectual and Political Biography of Early Years of Chang Chünmai, 1887-1923. Ph.D. diss., George Washington University, 1974.
Jeans, Roger B. Democracy and socialism in Republican China: the politics of Zhang Junmai (Carsun Chang), 1906-1941. Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield, 1997.
Jiang, Yongzhen. “Zhang Junmai.” In Shounan Wang, ed., Zhongguo lidai sixiang jia (Taipei: Taiwan shangwu yinshu guan faxing, 1987), 10: 6230-6352.
Liu, Yilin, and Qingfeng Luo. Zhang Junmai pinglun. Nanchang: Bai hua zhou wenyi chubanshe, 1996.
Lü, Xichen, and Ying Chen. Xin ruxue: Zhang Junmai sixiang yanjiu. Tianjin: Tianjin renmin chubanshe, 1996.
Meissner, Werner. China zwischen nationalem “Sonderweg”, und universaler Modernisierung – Zur Rezeption westlichen Denkens in China. Munich: Wilhelm Fink Verlag, 1994.
Peterson, Kent McLean. A Political Biography of Zhang Junmai, 1887-1949. Ph.D. diss., Princeton University, 1999.
Tan, Chester C. Chinese Political Thought in the 20^th Century. Melbourne: Wren Pub., 1972.
Weng, Hekai. Xiandai Zhongguo de Ziyou minzu zhuyi: Zhang Junmai Minzu jianguo sixiang pingzhuan. Beijing: Falü chubanshe, 2010.
Xu, Jilin. Wuqiong de kunhuo: Huang Yanpei, Zhang Junmai yu xiandai Zhongguo. Shanghai: Sanlian shudian, 1998.
Xue, Huayuan. Minzhu xianzheng yu minzu zhuyi de bianzheng fazhan: Zhang Junmai sixiang yanjiu. Taibei: Daohe chubanshe, 1993.
Yang, Yongqian. Zhonghua minguo xianfa zhi fu: Zhang Junmai zhuanji. Taibei: Tangshan, 1993.
Ye, Qizhong (Yap Key-chong). “Cong Zhang Junmai he Ding Wenjiang liang ren he Renshengguan yi wen kan 1923 nian ‘Ke Xuan lunzhan’ de baofa yu kuozhan.” Zhongyang yanjiu yuan jindai shi yanjiu shuo jikan 25 (June 1996): 211-267.
Zhang, Rulun. “Zhongguo xiandai sixiang shang de Zhang Junmai.” In Jilin Xu, ed., Ershi Shiji Zhongguo sixiang shi lun (Shanghai: Dongfang chuban zhongxin, 2000), 2:124-153.
Zheng, Dahua. Zhang Junmai zhuan. Beijing: Zhonghua shuju, 1997.
Zheng, Dahua. Zhang Junmai xueshu sixiang pingzhuan. Beijing: Beijing Tushuguan chubanshe, 1999a.
Zheng Dahua. Liangqi qicai – Mingren bixia de Zhang Junmai. Shanghai: Dongfang chuban zhongxin, 1999b.
Zheng, Jiadong. Xiandai xin rujia gailun. Nanning: Guangxi renmin chubanshe, 1990.

Author Information

Joseph Ciaudo
Email: jo.ciaudo@hotmail.fr
Institute of Eastern Languages and Civilizations
France

Music and Social Justice

Protests demanding social justice as the alternative to an unacceptable status quo have been mounted in response to war, political and social inequality, poverty, and other constraints on economic and development opportunities. Although social justice is typically thought of as a political agenda, many justice movements have used music as a way of inviting and maintaining broad-based participation in their initiatives.

Some of this integration of music and social justice has become so deeply embedded in the identity and culture frameworks of particular groups that it is understood today primarily as culturally constitutive. For instance, the tradition of the blues is widely recognized as a distinctively African-American contribution to music, but is not always recognized for its role helping to shape the political consciousness of African-American communities emerging from Reconstruction in the nineteenth century and migrating out of the American South in the twentieth century. The same is true of the interplay between the free jazz of the 1960s and the black-nationalist movement it helped to nurture. Other moments in music and social justice appear in our social and historical narratives less as integration than as accidental convergences which we do not always notice or remember. Examples of music dropping out of the politics, rather than politics dropping out of the music, include cultural inattention to the role music has played in later social protests taking place under the banners of the Occupy movement and UK-Uncut, and to the crucial role that music played in the anti-apartheid movement in South Africa. The paradigm for reciprocity of musical expression and commitment to social justice, on the other hand, is the political protest culture of the United States in the 1960s: the Civil Rights Movement and the anti-Vietnam War movement, in particular.

In his book Rhythm and Resistance, p. 39, Ray Pratt observes that “No music alone can organize one’s ability to invest affectively in the world, [but] one can note powerful contributions of music to temporary emotional states.” It is because of the way music feeds into our emotional lives and because of the sense of social well-being we get from sharing emotional states with others that music so frequently accompanies movements that build, and depend upon, solidarity. This is a contingent association, to be sure, but the absence of logical necessity does not diminish the powerful role music plays in our efforts to build a better world.

Musical Traditions
Contemporary Protest
Academic Attention to Music-Politics Links
References and Further Reading

1. Musical Traditions

Social transformation effected through music—so-called Peace through Art—is an approach that has been under-theorized. One of the few theorizers and practitioners who seeks to advance our understanding of social justice through art and music is John Paul Lederach, whose peace-building work focuses on conflict transformation through sonic capacities to promote social healing. His work with fractured communities emphasizes the restoration of voice, a concept he has found particularly resonant with people who are struggling to repair their violent communities (110, 89). The music and poetry that can aid in this repair is various and highly contextual; to be meaningful to the community who is seeking social justice, the music that accompanies justice-building must be—or be connected to—an organic part of the community’s everyday life. In the interest of providing a sense of the sonic diversity of effective musical backdrops, this account of music and social justice is introduced through a discussion of musical types and traditions.

a. Origins and Impacts of Blues and Jazz

One of the most influential historians of the blues is Amiri Baraka who, writing as Leroi Jones in his first book Blues People, explores the African-American experience of the nation through music. The blues, he explains, is the response of African abductees to their American enslavement, a cultural outpouring developed from work songs and spirituals which represents in microcosm the entire range and nuance of a people’s adaptation to a foreign land they were given no choice but to make into a home. This history of adaptation Baraka traces is one in which the songs become more complex and more secular, leaving aside the theme of deliverance into heaven that characterized African-American musical production in slavery in favor of a more immediately empowering emphasis on self-determination. The blues thus functioned as a repository of cultural engagement, its lyrical content evolving over time to reflect whatever social challenges African-American communities were facing at the time. One notable instance of blues reflecting African-American struggles for respect and legitimacy in the public sphere was the 1941 collaboration between jazz great Count Basie and author Richard Wright (of Native Son fame) on a piece called King Joe (The Joe Louis Blues) that valorized the boxer as the pride of his community at the same moment that anti-lynching campaigns were finally starting to gain traction in the Jim Crow South.

Both Baraka and Albert Murray, another prominent African-American historian of uniquely American music, tell the story of jazz in such a way as to underscore its birth out of the blues. For Baraka, one of the more coherent ways of defining jazz is as a synthesis of European instrumentation and the African-derived polyrhythms that, fundamentally, are the blues—even as jazz developed its own trajectory. Murray’s tracing of this history in Stomping the Blues reiterates this common heritage but concentrates so much on jazz and jazz musicians that a reader who comes to his book looking for an analysis of the blues may feel shortchanged. Yet another treatment of the emergence of the blues and jazz, in Frank Kofsky’s Black Nationalism and the Revolution in Music, tells the story of jazz through a narrative reminiscent of Thomas Kuhn’s Structure of Scientific Revolutions, a story of problem-solving within paradigms that finally, inevitably, break down and must be replaced—as in the case of the shift of musicians like John Coltrane and Ornette Coleman from trying to work their ideas out in bebop to an embrace of free jazz.

Kofsky too endorses the thesis that music and socio-political relations go hand in hand, arguing that we can see in the free jazz that emerged in the early 1960s a kind of “proto-nationalism” which presaged the black nationalist messages of Malcolm X, the Black Panthers, and other “do for self” movements in African-American communities during the 1960s. These movements stressed the need for community self-sufficiency in the face of a systemically racist white majoritarian society and although the black nationalist (a.k.a. black separatist) message was often simplistically opposed to the integrationism attributed to Martin Luther King and the Civil Rights Movement, their community development efforts—after-school arts programs for children, musical benefits to feed people struggling with food insecurity, “neighborhood watch” security efforts—still stand as tangible models for grassroots solidarity. The self-sufficiency message Kofsky finds in jazz proto-nationalism is a celebration of a unique African-American aesthetic, one that contested the aesthetic imperialism of the white critics who promoted the value and determined the negotiating power of the mostly black musicians within the system of white-owned recording and performance institutions. At the height of the free jazz movement, self-sufficiency imperatives were the driving force behind the independent recording facilities and cooperatively owned performance venues with which Coltrane, Coleman, and Charles Mingus, among others, experimented. They were also a factor in the political stances taken by many of the free jazz musicians—anti-war, anti-colonialism, anti-enslavement, and broadly supportive of the Pan-Africanism that flourished in the wake of African decolonization movements. Its most enduring legacy, however, was the credence it gave to a counter-narrative about what constituted aesthetic value. White critics used a theoretical framework developed for Western art music (so-called classical music) to evaluate the originality, authenticity, and artistic complexity of a musical tradition that came out of the African-American experience. But, as a reading of Kofsky’s history together with Henry Louis Gates Jr.’s literary theory in The Signifying Monkey makes clear, the black musicians immersed in the jazz world were developing their own aesthetic—a conception of, for instance, the value of originality that rejects the Eurocentric ideal of the original (as something that has never before been seen in this world) in favor of an understanding that one makes an original contribution when one adds one’s own perspective to an existing cultural product. This revision of what originality means implicates the individual empowerment and attention to existing and nascent community networks that black nationalism’s later advocacy of self-sufficiency promoted.

b. Folk Music, Rock Music, and Protest Songs

The protest songs of folk music have a long history of engagement with social justice struggles for abolition of slavery, universal suffrage, and other human rights agendas, but really began to assert their power during the unionization drives emerging out of the industrialization of wealthy societies. In the United States, some of the most recognizable of these songs that came out of the labor movement include “John Henry” and “Which Side Are You On?” While folk music developed its reputation as the voice of social justice in America in no small part due to the music of Woody Guthrie, Pete Seeger, and Bob Dylan, perhaps the protest song that has had the most profound effect on American political life is the anti-lynching song “Strange Fruit.”

This song’s lyrics were written Jewish schoolteacher Abel Meeropol (who adopted the orphaned sons of Julius and Ethel Rosenberg, the couple executed in 1953 by the US government on the charge that they passed atomic secrets to the Soviet Union) in the 1930s as a response to a grisly photograph of a lynching. Recorded by Billie Holiday and performed as one of her signature pieces, “Strange Fruit” became a widely-heard protest against social injustice, a schooling of audiences about the realities of African-American lives (and deaths) in parts of the United States that practiced lynching (“Strange Fruit: The film” Independent Lens). Jazz critic Leonard Feather once said of “Strange Fruit” that it was “the first significant protest in words and music, the first unmuted cry against racism” (Margolick). Given the history of African-American activism and oratory, Feather’s claim about its ‘first-ness’ is best parsed as hyperbole, but there is no denying the impact this song had on Holiday’s audiences. Margolick recounts fights breaking out in nightclubs after it was performed and Billie Holiday herself being attacked by distraught and traumatized patrons. Despite the emotional toll that singing “Strange Fruit” had on her, Holiday apparently felt a duty to perform it. “I have to sing it,” Margolick quotes her as saying; “[it] goes a long way in telling how they mistreat Negroes down South.” And the impact of the song did play a part in efforts at changing social policy: some of the people who endorsed passage of federal anti-lynching laws sent recordings of “Strange Fruit” to members of Congress, presumably because they felt hearing it would produce an awakening of the legislators’ moral outrage. “Strange Fruit” holds its power, even with the passage of time, and has been called “one of the 10 songs that actually changed the world” (see the November 2003 issue of Q Magazine, a British music magazine).

In the world of rock music—the style that emerged from mainstream white America’s assimilation of rhythm and blues—there is another paradigmatic intersection of music and social justice that can be understood as a rock parallel to folk music’s “Strange Fruit.” More than forty years ago, Jimi Hendrix and the somewhat thrown-together band that was forming in the wake of the Jimi Hendrix Experience played a two hour set as the final musical act of the Woodstock Festival, a performance most remembered for their improvisation upon the American national anthem, “The Star-Spangled Banner” (Daley 52, 55). This moment that has come to symbolize the essence of Woodstock was a masterful performance, and critique, of an anthem whose lyrics valorize the resilience of a people under attack. Shifting between faithful rendition and strategic distortion, Hendrix forcefully shows his audience the moral inconsistency of a nation that sang this song at the same time as it dropped bombs on the people of other nations. The sounds Hendrix pulls out of the guitar in that iconic performance are reminiscent of explosions and squeals of horror at exactly the points one who is singing along would get to “the rockets’ red glare” and “bombs bursting in air.” The message that seems to have entered the popular imagination as a result of Hendrix’s improvisation on “The Star-Spangled Banner” at Woodstock is very clearly an anti-war, anti-imperialist one. In his book Crosstown Traffic, British music journalist Charles Murray concludes that Hendrix’s performance “depicts, as graphically as a piece of music can possibly do, both what the Americans did to the Vietnamese and what they did to themselves” (C. Murray 24; quoted in Daley 57).

c. Post-industrial Musical Contestation: Disco, Punk, and Hip-hop

The music that accompanied industrial decline in Western industrialized nations—notably the United States and the United Kingdom—articulated two distinct responses to the foreclosure of empowerment and idealism that the counterculture of the 1960s had nurtured. Disco, with its elaborate costumes, exhibitionist focus on dance, and attendant drug culture, represented a turning away from political challenges, a refusal to deal with social problems, and a desire for momentary pleasures. Punk, on the other hand, was a howl of rage from working class youth who saw, and rejected in no uncertain terms, the hypocrisy of the social establishment and the increasing inaccessibility of economic opportunities for the socio-economically disadvantaged. Disco was stereotypically identified with African-American performers (albeit predominantly white consumers) whereas punk was typed as a British phenomenon, although, in fact, both musical constituencies could be found in any of the wealthy nations that were starting in the 1970s to wrestle with de-industrialization, wage stagnation, and the corporate restructuring now known as outsourcing.

Elements of both of these musical responses to social marginalization and injustice are synthesized in hip-hop, the most popular musical form for expression of protest worldwide in the following period. In Black Noise: Rap Music and Black Culture in Contemporary America, sociologist Tricia Rose theorizes the hip-hop universe of her youth as emerging from a post-industrial nightmare in which the ethnic poor were being crowded out of public space, and creative protest was fostered in the effort to reclaim for the people the neighborhoods that were being torn apart to build expressways into the city for affluent suburban commuters (31-33). Into this unacknowledged war on the poor and the marginalized came the interplay of technology, economics, and culture at the origin of hip-hop, what Rose describes as a practice of appropriating cultural refuse for pleasure (22-23). Subways, street corners, abandoned parks were occupied by listeners and dancers as political spaces. The elements of “flow, layering, and rupture” both reflect and contest social marginalization, Rose says; in its origins, the music was both articulating and symbolizing the lived experience of people struggling to hold onto a community identity in the face of “urban development” and gentrification processes (22). The struggle, she insists, was not a final, futile gesture of victims of urban apocalypse, but was the formation of an alternative, communally-forged identity by producers of a conscious “take back the public spaces” movement (Rose 33). It was an intransigent, unapologetic assertion of the right of all human beings to take up public space, to interact with each other and with the music that informed these politicized, reclaimed spaces.

2. Contemporary Protest

As noted in the previous section, much of the protest of injustice that is expressed musically in the early 21^st century is done so through hip-hop. There is, for instance, a Hungarian rapper by the name of Dopeman who performs his discontent with the political homogenization of the country’s post-communist regime. And in Haiti, there was a nationwide rap contest in June 2006, the “Concours Pwojè Lari Pwòp,” in which young people submitted original raps on the topic of cleaning up the environment and the nation voted for their favorite recordings made by twelve finalists—a sort of socially conscious “Haitian Idol” program (Yéle Haiti, 2006). But the resonance that hip-hop has for youth in many different cultures should not blind us to the diversity of music—traditional and improvised—through which justice appeals speak to people. For instance, Foucaultian scholar Ladelle McWhorter opens her book Racism and Sexual Oppression in Anglo-America with an anecdote about attending a vigil for Matthew Shepard, the young college student in Wyoming whose 1998 death was an anti-gay hate crime, recalling that some attendees felt inspired to sing the Civil Rights-era anthem “We Shall Overcome” as an expression of their stand against homophobia. The discussions in this section should therefore be read not as a comprehensive overview, but as a selection of examples that showcase the diversity of musical styles that are speaking justice around the world.

a. Communal and Community-based Music Making in Democratic States

One of the most inspiring instances of music expressing the ethos to which a community aspires can be found in the response of the Norwegian people to the shocking mass murder committed in the summer of 2011 by right-wing extremist Anders Behring Breivik. To the extent that a motivation has emerged for Breivik’s actions—killing 77 people and wounding 200 more in attacks on government buildings in Oslo and a summer camp on the nearby island of Utoeya—he seems to have been driven by a hatred of the multiculturalism Norway has embraced and by a belief that immigration—Muslim immigration, in particular—has had a contaminating effect on society. One of the elements of Norwegian multiculturalism that he cited as the object of his hatred was a song that is taught to children in schools, “Children of The Rainbow.” This song is a Norwegian version of folk singer Pete Seeger’s anti-war song “My Rainbow Race” and it embodies for many Norwegians their shared social commitments to celebrating the diversity of human beings and to teaching their children a similar appreciation.

One might expect a community that has been devastated by mass-murder to react with rage and calls for harsh punishment for the perpetrator, especially given that many of his victims were young people. One might also expect heated public debates about gun control and the need for better early diagnosis and intervention in matters of mental health. What one might not expect to see, but did in fact happen in April 2012, is a gathering of thousands of people in the capital to sing both Norwegian and English versions of the song as a defiant refusal of Breivik’s hate-fueled politics of racial purity. This community response took place in a public square close to the courthouse in which Breivik was being tried, and some participants spoke of their hope that he could hear their response. The larger point, though, was to reaffirm the values of peace and love that the song represents, to reaffirm the community’s commitment to each other in the face of efforts to divide them and distance them from their values.

b. Building Social Solidarity against Neo-liberalism

While the Norwegian example demonstrates the expression of shared existing values, music also has considerable constructive power. It can bind a community or movement which is in the process of being built to the values or ideals that are inspiring the emergent community, a dialectical performance of communities and commitments through music. One such example is the 2012 student protest movement in the Canadian province of Quebec. The student protests began in March as demonstrations against an announced hike in tuition fees at the public universities and colleges, an increase of 75% to be phased in over five years, that would have brought Quebec’s historically much lower tuitions into line with those paid by students in the rest of Canada. This harmonization attempt, apparently reasonable in the eyes of many observers, struck members and representatives of Quebec’s student unions as a violation of the social contract governing the province and a direct assault on their stated goal of low-cost—preferably tuition-free—and accessible post-secondary education. Students at some Montreal institutions refused to attend classes, going on strike to demand a rollback of the announced increases. They began marching in the streets, wearing and displaying in apartment windows or on apartment balconies the sign of the protest, the carré rouge (a red square, usually of felt or wool).

They also began making “music,” a discordant but coordinated noise-making that was adapted from Chilean protests against the Pinochet dictatorship. Every evening at 8pm, people were invited to go out on their balconies and bang pots and pans in a display that was dubbed les casseroles. The purpose of the noise-making in Chilean protests had been to signal that the population was refusing to live in fear of the dictatorship, but in Quebec the point was to assert membership in the community of those who believe that accessible education is a crucial foundation of social egalitarianism. Participation in les casseroles was not limited to protesting students; ordinary citizens took part also as a way of demonstrating their solidarity with the student groups in defending Quebec’s noticeably left-wing social consensus. This sustained protest resulted in an electoral defeat for the premier of the province in September, the historic election of the province’s first female leader, and her announcement that the new government would cancel plans to hike tuition.

c. Confrontations with Authoritarian Regimes

Even when there is no existing or emergent solidarity, there is still a role for music in social protests. For some time, Russian society has been treated to various improvised musical protests against Vladimir Putin’s extra-democratic election triumphs by an all-female punk band known as “Pussy Riot.” These young women performed in masks and mini-dresses at politically-inflected sites in Moscow, and recently faced arrest and a high-profile trial for their performances. They persisted, despite initial warnings, because they have a point to make about the threat to democracy that the Putin oligarchy represents. Most recently they have been in prison for five months and have been sentenced to a two-year-long prison term in a labor camp as the result of a number of impromptu performances in Moscow, in early spring 2012. During one such performance, they took over a rooftop in Red Square opposite a prison where dissidents are incarcerated (BBC America, GMT, 28 February 2012). The most controversial, and the one that has most clearly motivated the charges of “hooliganism,” was a performance in a revered Orthodox church, where they stormed the altar and sang a “punk prayer” that called upon the Virgin Mary to assert herself as a feminist icon and save the nation from Putin. The incarceration they face for their performances has inspired solidarity protests outside Russian embassies in other countries, and seems to have rattled the oligarchy to the point that Putin himself called for leniency in sentencing on the very charges he insisted be brought against them. His public call for mercy is widely seen as political theater, however, and the harshness of their sentence is seen by some commentators on Russian public opinion as a possible spur to building a more outspoken opposition to his rule.

3. Academic Attention to Music-Politics Links

For all of the time in which music has played an integral role in movements for social progress, it is only recently that academic theorizing has begun to take notice of these links. The three major areas of attention to aesthetics-politics overlap are the discourse in social aesthetics (or relational aesthetics) in cultural studies, the broadly interdisciplinary area of improvisation theory, and the “Peace through Art” strand of peace studies. Not all of the scholars working in these areas look primarily at questions of music, but valuable theoretical insights are being produced.

a. Social Aesthetics

Social aesthetics starts with a consideration of the extent to which one’s membership in community—that is, one’s social identity—shapes one’s approach to art-making and art appreciation. This approach is exemplified by French sociologist Pierre Bourdieu’s critical rebuttal of Kantian aesthetics on the grounds that “taste” is not a universal trait which identifies a single standard of artistic merit but is instead indexed to one’s class position. Bourdieu offers a detailed, fine-grained argument for this hypothesis in his 1984 book Distinction, which discusses the results of surveys of respondents from a cross-section of social classes in France of the 1970s. Contrasting working class, bourgeois, and elite preferences in entertaining, decorating, leisure activities, music, and film, Bourdieu argues that what we find beautiful is indeed demonstrably shaped by our class positions and trajectories. This reveals aesthetic preferences as socially-inflected, hence political, regardless of how natural they might seem to their bearers. The net effect of Bourdieu’s intervention is repudiation of a universalist aesthetic hierarchy in which the cultural preferences of the elite class are judged as better than those of the working class, in favor of a relativist indexing of artistic productions to class positions.

While much of the research into musical tastes that explicitly engages the notion of class is being done in the European context, it is not hard to see how this discourse asserts itself in American accounts of taste. The concepts of “highbrow” music—Western art music, or “classical”—and “lowbrow” music—popular, mass-marketed productions, from jazz in the 1930s to rock in the 1950s through 1980s and, most recently, hip-hop—link tastes to education and income levels, which appear in the American lexicon as stand-ins for the concept of class. Understanding this linguistic translation makes it possible for us to employ a social aesthetics reading of some of the claims in the history of American musical production that otherwise seem unmotivated. In particular, John Coltrane’s rejection of the label “jazz” for his music, and his preference for labeling jazz “America’s classical music” can, through this lens, be interpreted as a contestation of the class position to which jazz musicians and their art-making had be relegated. This contestation does not achieve the relativism of Bourdieu’s inventory, but it does underscore the connection between social identity, or community membership, and aesthetic taste.

b. Improvisation Theory

While much of the work in social aesthetics/relational aesthetics is taking place in the discipline of cultural studies, improvisation theory is asserting itself as a self-consciously interdisciplinary endeavor. It draws together musicians, musicologists, philosophers, historians, and cultural theorists, among others, to consider questions of how and why improvisation as both a musical and social practice contributes to social organization overall.

Another developing area is the ethics of improvisation. Tracey Nicholls argues that the examination and adoption of the norms and values that flourish in communities of improvising musicians—those who improvise in the “free jazz” tradition, in particular—can help us to build more responsive, more democratic political societies. To be part of an improvising ensemble demands an openness to others, a willingness to listen carefully, closely, and charitably, and to respond in constructive ways that advance the musical “conversation.” This requires capacities for self-trust and respect for others on the part of every participant. The payoff is an expanded ability to engage difference creatively, instead of through an attitude of fear and hostility, and this in turn leads to a greater ability to deal with the complexity of a fast paced, globalized world. The ideal actor, in both musical improvisation and the sphere of grassroots popular political action, is the figure Cornel West dubs “the jazz freedom fighter”—an individual who pits his or her creative vision and talents against other members of a group in a way that is both competitive and collaborative. As West puts it, “individuality is promoted in order to sustain and increase the creative tension with the group—a tension that yields higher levels of performance to achieve the aim of the collective project” (italics in original, 150-151). In developing our capacities for openness to difference and living with risk (that, for instance, our attempts to negotiate and communicate might fail), this ethics of improvisation grounds subsidiary virtues that are not otherwise encouraged by our social status quo (a way of thinking that teaches us to refrain from taking chances if failure is a live option). Virtues like generosity towards others, willingness to support their risk-taking and their struggles to find creative ways out of impasses, commitment to an enhanced capacity to forgive the mis-steps that inevitably happen in these struggles, and greater respect for the ability to integrate, adopt, or even switch between different perspectives and different types of tools are also encouraged. This is not to suggest that we should dispense with planning but, given that our best-laid plans may fail, there is an enormous value to developing our individual capacities for improvisatory action. In this way, improvisation in music points the way to more resilient and more just societies.

c. Peace through Art

Peace through Art, in particular, social transformation effected through music, is an approach to music and social justice that shares with improvisation theory its inter-disciplinarity. One of the theorizers and practitioners of peace-building who not only takes seriously the role of art and music, but also seeks to advance our understanding of it, is John Paul Lederach whose peace-building work focuses on conflict transformation through social healing—in particular, the question of “how sonic phenomena might be applied to contexts of social change” (90). Lederach’s work with fractured communities emphasizes the restoration of voice, a concept he finds particularly resonant with people who are struggling to repair their violent communities (110, 89). What “voice”—understood both as the individual regaining his or her voice, and the community engaging in meaningful conversation (Lederach 109)—requires is “a container or space within which people [feel] safe but [are] also close enough to hear and receive the echo of each other’s voices” (Lederach 89).

The particular metaphor Lederach favors in his representations of peace processes is one that brings together voice and container: the Tibetan singing bowl. He observes that social healing, like musical resonance, “does not arise from the individual. It emerges from the interaction of many vibrations, individual and collective, held within a community context. In other words, social healing and reconciliation emerge in and around the container that holds collective processes” (Lederach 101). Elaborating on the bowl metaphor, Lederach points to some of the distinguishing characteristics of the multi-directionality that the bowl shares with sound (94). The first is circular movement: “[g]oing in circles and repeating them over and again is not,” he insists, “… a movement of going nowhere,” but has instead “a ritualistic quality … creating a certain kind of space and moment” (Lederach 94). The second is the container itself: “the bowl creates the space or location from which the sound is coaxed and held, but in terms of movement the sensation is one of going deep, made possible by the circling” (Lederach 94). “Deepening becomes a directional focus of the container,” says Lederach (94). The third directional characteristic that makes the bowl a compelling metaphor is rising: “[s]ound not only seems to rise from the bowl,” he explains; “it expands, moves out, touches and surrounds the space within its reach. Sound moves in all directions…. sound is multi-directional and non-linear in its movement” and offers the experience of “feelings of being touched and held” (Lederach 94).

Circling, deepening, and rising are all aspects of percussion that make instruments like drums and the singing bowl often function as “the heartbeat” of musical performances. They are also important aspects of the genuine, voluntary, non-imposed community reconciliation that Lederach prefers to discuss as “conflict transformation.” Going around, repeating over and over, is a way of gathering grassroots support within a community; each time an outreach effort is made, space is created for community members who had previously not been involved to join the movement. The descending movement can be understood as a way of describing the process of developing, through a repetition that may well become ritualized, an emotional loyalty to something that starts out as a social commitment—internalizing the peace-building ambition. And the rising movement can similarly be understood as the inexorable pressure that a fully committed, mobilized grassroots community can exert on a wider population—regional, national, or international—a bending of the discourse to the demands of the grassroots in the same way that the expanding, enveloping musical note arising from the bowl captures the attention of people in the audience who may not have been giving the performance their full attention.

4. References and Further Reading

Attali, Jacques. Noise: The Political Economy of Music. Trans. Brian Massumi. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1985.
- A history of the interplay of music and political life.
Baraka, Amiri [Leroi Jones]. Blues People: Negro Music in White America. New York: Quill/William Morrow, 1999 [1963].
- A classic text in African-American cultural studies.
BBC America. GMT. 28 February 2012.
- A television report on Pussy Riot performances.
Born, Georgina and David Hesmondhalgh. Western Music and Its Others: Difference, Representation, and Appropriation in Music. Berkeley: University of California Press, 2000.
- A collection of essays on difference and culture-crossing in global musical exchanges.
Bourdieu, Pierre. Distinction: A Social Critique of the Judgement of Taste. Trans. Richard Nice. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1984.
- A sociological rebuttal of philosophy of art that identifies an attitude of disinterest as the mark of aesthetic appreciation.
“Breivik trial: Norwegians rally around peace song.” BBC News. 26 April 2012.
- A news report about people’s responses to the trial.
Clibbon, Jennifer. “How a student uprising is reshaping Quebec.” CBC News. 29 May 2012.
- An interview with three cultural commentators on the historical context and current significance.
Daley, Mike. “Land of the free. Jimi Hendrix: Woodstock Festival, August 18, 1969.” Performance and Popular Music: History, Place and Time. Ed. Ian Inglis. Hampshire UK: Ashgate, 2006. 52-57.
- An essay on how this iconic performance shaped the development of popular music.
Gates, Jr., Henry Louis. The Signifying Monkey: A Theory of African-American Literary Criticism. New York: Oxford UP, 1988.
- A scholarly survey of the culturally-distinct communicative practices shaping African-American artistic production.
Kofsky, Frank. Black Nationalism and the Revolution in Music. New York: Pathfinder, 1970.
- A history of the free jazz movement of the 1960s and its socio-political commitments.
Lederach, John Paul and Angela Jill Lederach. When Blood and Bones Cry Out: Journeys through the Soundscape of Healing and Reconciliation. New York: Oxford University Press, 2010.
- An account of peace-building in conflict zones through local musical traditions.
Margolick, David. “Strange Fruit.” Vanity Fair Magazine, September 1998.
- A journalistic account of the history of the Billie Holliday song.
Monson, Ingrid. Saying Something: Jazz Improvisation and Interaction. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1996.
- A musician and music theorist’s account of the transformative effects of music.
“Moscou: les trois Pussy Riot condamnées à deux ans de prison chacune.” métro. 17 August 2012.
- An Associated Press story in a Montréal free daily newspaper.
Murray, Albert. Stomping The Blues. Cambridge MA: Da Capo Press, 1976.
- An analysis of the aesthetic merits of jazz and blues music on their own terms.
Nicholls, Tracey. An Ethics of Improvisation: Aesthetic Possibilities for a Political Future. Lanham MD: Lexington, 2012.
- An argument for the transferability of norms shaping improvising musicians’ communities to political communities, and their transformative possibilities.
Pratt, Ray. Rhythm and Resistance: Explorations in the Political Uses of Popular Music. New York: Praeger, 1990.
- A study of the political uses of popular music by marginalized communities.
Rose, Tricia. Black Noise: Rap Music and Black Culture in Contemporary America. Middletown CT: Wesleyan University Press, 1994.
- An exploration of the history, aesthetics, and political commitments of hip-hop culture, with an emphasis on its musical production.
“Strange Fruit.” Independent Lens.
- A Public Broadcasting System (PBS) documentary exploring the origins and impact of Billie Holiday’s most famous song.
Yéle Haiti Foundation, 2006.
- The grassroots social rebuilding movement organized by Haitian-American rapper Wyclef Jean.

Author Information

Tracey Nicholls
Email: tracey.j.nicholls@gmail.com
Massey University
U. S. A.

Latin American Philosophy

This article outlines the history of Latin American philosophy: the thinking of its indigenous peoples, the debates over conquest and colonization, the arguments for national independence in the eighteenth century, the challenges of nation-building and modernization in the nineteenth century, the concerns over various forms of development in the twentieth century, and the diverse interests in Latin American philosophy during the opening decades of the twenty-first century. Rather than attempt to provide an exhaustive and impossibly long list of scholars’ names and dates, this article outlines the history of Latin American philosophy while trying to provide a meaningful sense of detail by focusing briefly on individual thinkers whose work points to broader philosophical trends that are inevitably more complex and diverse than any encyclopedic treatment can hope to capture.

The term “Latin American philosophy” refers broadly to philosophy in, from, or about Latin America. However, the definitions of both “Latin America” and “philosophy” are historically fluid and contested, leading to even more disagreement when combined. “Latin America” typically refers to the geographic areas on the American continent where languages derived from Latin are widely spoken: Portuguese in Brazil, and Spanish in most of Central America, South America, and parts of the Caribbean. The French-speaking parts of the Caribbean are sometimes included as well, but all mainland North American regions north of the Rio Grande are excluded in spite of French being widely spoken in Canada. Although it is anachronistic to speak of Latin American philosophy before the 1850s when the term “Latin America” first entered usage, most scholars agree that Latin American philosophy extends at least as far back as the sixteenth century when the Spanish founded the first schools and seminaries in the “New World”. Given this widespread agreement that there was “Latin American philosophy” before anyone was using the term “Latin America,” many scholars have argued for including pre-Columbian and pre-Cabralian thought in the history of Latin American philosophy. A number of indigenous cultures (particularly the Aztecs, Mayas, Incas, and Tupi-Guarani) produced sophisticated systems of thought long before Europeans arrived with their own understanding of “philosophy.”

The scholarly debate over whether or not to include indigenous thought in the history of Latin American philosophy reveals that the question of what constitutes Latin American philosophy hinges upon both our understanding of what constitutes Latin America and our understanding of what constitutes philosophy. It is worthwhile to remember that these and other labels are the products of human activity and dispute, not the result of a pre-ordained teleological process. Just as “America” was not called “America” by its indigenous inhabitants, the term “Latin America” emerged in the nineteenth century from outside of the region in French intellectual circles. The term competed against terms like “Ibero-America” until “Latin America” gained widespread and largely unquestioned usage in public and academic discourse in the second half of the twentieth century. More than a debate over mere terms, Latin American philosophy demonstrates a longstanding preoccupation with the identity of Latin America itself and a lively debate over the authenticity of its philosophy. Given the history of colonialism in the region, much of the history of Latin American philosophy analyzes ethical and sociopolitical issues, frequently treating concrete problems of practical concern like education or political revolution.

Indigenous Period
Colonial Period
Nineteenth Century
Twentieth Century
Twenty-First Century
1. Plurality of Philosophies in Latin America
2. Normalization of Latin American Philosophy in the United States
References and Further Reading

1. Indigenous Period

Most histories of Western philosophy claim that philosophy began in ancient Greece with Thales of Miletus (c.624–c.546 B.C.E.) and other pre-Socratics who engaged in sophisticated speculation about the origins of the universe and its workings. There is ample evidence that a number of indigenous peoples in present-day Latin America also engaged in this sort of sophisticated speculation well before the 1500s when Europeans arrived to ask the question of whether it was philosophy. Moreover, a few Europeans during the early colonial period, including the Franciscan priest Bernardino de Sahagún (1499-1590), reported the existence of philosophy and philosophers among the indigenous Aztecs of colonial New Spain. In any case, whether or not most sixteenth-century European explorers, conquistadores, and missionaries believed that there were indigenous philosophies and philosophers, indigenous cultures produced sophisticated systems of thought centuries before Europeans arrived.

The largest and most notable of these indigenous civilizations are: the Aztec (in present-day central Mexico), the Maya (in present-day southern Mexico and northern Central America), and the Inca (in present-day western South America centered in Peru). Considerable challenges face scholars attempting to understand their complex systems of thought, since almost all of their texts and the other artifacts that would have testified most clearly concerning their intellectual production were systematically burned or otherwise destroyed by European missionaries who considered them idolatrous. Nevertheless, scholars have used the handful of pre-colonial codices and other available sources to reconstruct plausible interpretations of these philosophies, while remaining cognizant of the dangers inherent in using Western philosophical concepts to understand non-Western thought. See the article on Aztec Philosophy for an excellent example.

2. Colonial Period

Academic philosophy during the colonial period was dominated by scholasticism imported from the Iberian Peninsula. With the support of Charles V—the first king of Spain and Holy Roman Emperor from 1516 to 1556—schools, monasteries, convents, and seminaries were established across the Indies (as the American continent and Caribbean were known then). Mexico was the main philosophical center in the early colonial period, with Peru gaining importance in the seventeenth century. The adherents of various religious orders who taught at these centers of higher learning emphasized the texts of medieval scholastics like Thomas Aquinas and Duns Scotus, as well as their Iberian commentators, particularly those associated with the School of Salamanca, for example, Francisco de Vitoria (c.1483-1546), Domingo de Soto (1494-1560), and Francisco Suárez (1548-1617). The thoroughly medieval style and sources of their theological and philosophical disputations concerning the Indies and its peoples contrast starkly with the extraordinarily new epistemological, ethical, religious, legal, and political questions that arose over time alongside attempts to colonize and missionize the New World. Much of the philosophy developed in the Indies appeared in isolation from its social and political context. For example, there was nothing uniquely Mexican about Antonio Rubio’s (1548-1615) Logica mexicana (1605). This careful analysis of Aristotelian logic in light of recent scholastic developments brought fame to the University of Mexico when it was adopted as logic textbook back in Europe where it went through seven editions.

a. Scholasticism and Debates on Conquest

One of the most famous philosophical debates of the early colonial period concerned the supposed rights of the Spanish monarchy over the indigenous peoples of the Indies. Bartolomé de las Casas (1484-1566) debated Ginés de Sepúlveda (1490-1573) at the Council of Valladolid (1550-1551). Sepúlveda, who had never traveled to America, defended the Spanish conquest as an instance of just war, outlined the rights of the colonizers to seize native lands and possessions, and claimed that it was morally just to enslave the Indians, arguing on the basis of Thomism, Scripture, and Aristotelian philosophy. Las Casas countered Sepúlveda’s arguments by drawing upon the same theological and philosophical sources as well as decades of his own experiences living in different parts of the Indies. Las Casas argued that the war against the Indians was unjust, that neither Spain nor the Church had jurisdiction over Indians who had not accepted Christ, and that Aristotle’s category of “natural slaves” did not apply to the Indians. No formal winner of the debate was declared, but it did lead to las Casas’ most influential work, In Defense of the Indians, written from 1548-1550.

b. Post-conquest Indigenous Thought

Indigenous perspectives on some of these philosophical issues emerge in post-conquest texts that also depict pre-colonial life and history in light of more recent colonial violence. The work of Felipe Guamán Poma de Ayala (c.1550-1616), a native Andean intellectual and artist, serves as an excellent example. Written around 1615 and addressed to King Philip III of Spain, Guamán Poma’s The First New Chronicle and Good Government consists of nearly 800 pages of text in Spanish accompanied by many Quechua phrases and nearly 400 line drawings. Guamán Poma skillfully combines local histories, Spanish chronicles of conquest, Catholic moral and philosophical discourses (including those of Bartolomé de las Casas), various eyewitness accounts (including his own), and oral reports in multiple indigenous languages, to build a powerful case for maximum Indian autonomy given the ongoing history of abuse by Spanish conquerors, priests, and government officials. This and other post-conquest native texts affirm the ongoing existence of native intellectual traditions, contest the colonial European understanding of indigenous peoples as barbarians, and challenge Eurocentric views of American geography and history.

c. Proto-nationalism

As part of European conquest and colonization a new social hierarchy or caste system based on race was developed. White Spanish colonists born on the Iberian Peninsula (peninsulares) held the highest position, followed by white Spaniards born in the Indies (criollos), both of whom were far above Indians (indios) and Africans (negros) in the hierarchy. First generation individuals born to parents of different races were called mestizos (Indian and white), mulatos (African and white), and sambos (Indian and African). The subsequent mixing of already mixed generations further complicated the hierarchy and led to a remarkably complex racial terminology. In any case, higher education was almost always restricted to whites, who typically had to demonstrate the purity of their racial origins in order to enroll. By the seventeenth century, well-educated criollos were developing new perspectives on the Indies and their colonial experience. Anxious to maintain their status through intellectual ties to the Iberian Peninsula while nevertheless establishing their own place and tradition in America, these thinkers reflected on diverse topics while developing a proto-nationalist discourse that would eventually lead to independence. The work of Carlos de Sigüenza y Góngora (1645-1700) provides an interesting case of criollo ambivalence with respect to American identity. On the one hand, Sigüenza idealized Aztec society and was one of the first criollos to appropriate their past in order to articulate the uniqueness of American identity. On the other hand, this did not prevent Sigüenza from despising contemporary Indians, especially when they rioted in the streets during a food shortage in Mexico City.

d. Proto-feminism

Similar to the way in which scholars have retrospectively perceived a budding nationalism in intellectuals like Sigüenza, Sor Juana Inés de la Cruz (1651-1695) is widely regarded as a forerunner of feminist philosophy in Latin America. Just as non-whites were typically barred from higher education based on European assumptions of racial inferiority, women were not permitted access to formal education on the assumption of sexual inferiority. Basic education was provided in female convents, but their reading and writing still occurred under the supervision of male church officials and confessors. After establishing a positive reputation for knowledge across literature, history, music, languages, and natural science, Sor Juana was publicly reprimanded for entering the male-dominated world of theological debate. Under the penname of Sor Philothea de la Cruz (Sister Godlover of the Cross), the Bishop of Puebla told Sor Juana to abandon intellectual pursuits that were improper for a woman. Sor Juana’s extensive answer to Sor Philothea subtly but masterfully defends rational equality between men and women, makes a powerful case for women’s right to education, and develops an understanding of wisdom as a form of self-realization.

e. Enlightenment Philosophy

Although leading Latin American intellectuals in the eighteenth century did not completely abandon scholasticism, they began to draw upon new sources in order to think through new social and political questions. Interest grew in early modern European philosophy and the Enlightenment, especially as this “new philosophy” entered the curriculum of schools and universities. The experimental and scientific methods gained ground over the syllogism, just as appeals to scriptural or Church authority were slowly replaced by appeals to experience and reason. The rational liberation from intellectual authority that characterized the Enlightenment also fueled desires for individual liberty and national autonomy, which became defining issues in the century that followed.

3. Nineteenth Century

a. Political Independence

In the early nineteenth century, national independence movements swept through Latin America. However, some scholars have categorized these wars for independence as civil wars, since the majority of combatants on both sides were Latin Americans. Criollos, although a numerical minority (roughly 15% of the Latin American population in the early nineteenth century), led the push for political independence and clearly gained the most from it. In contrast, most of the combatants were mestizos (roughly 25% of the population) and indios (roughly 45% of the population) whose positions in society after national independence were scarcely improved and sometimes even made worse.

Scholars disagree about whether to understand changes in Latin American thought as causes or as effects of these political independence movements. In any case, Simon Bolívar (1783-1830) is generally considered to be their most prominent leader. Not only was “The Liberator” a military man and political founder of new nations, he was also an intellectual who developed a clear and prescient understanding of the challenges that lay ahead for Latin America not just in his own time but well into the future. Bolívar gained his philosophical, historical, and geographical perspective from both book-learning and extensive travels throughout much of Europe and the United States. Frequently citing the French Enlightenment philosopher Montesquieu (1689-1755) in his political writings, Bolívar believed that good laws and institutions were not the sorts of things that should simply be copied. Rather they must be carefully adapted to particular historical, geographical, and cultural realities. In this light, Bolívar perceived that the immediate costs of Latin American independence included anarchy, chaos, and a general lack of both personal and political virtue. He thus sought to create strong but subtle forms of centralized power capable of balancing new political freedoms. At the same time he sought to establish an educational system capable of developing an autonomous, independent national consciousness from a heteronomous and dependent colonial consciousness that had never been permitted to practice the art of government. Bolívar’s passionate calls for freedom and equality for all Latin Americans, including the emancipation of slaves, were thus consistently coupled with reasons that justified the concentration of authority in a small, well-educated group of mostly criollo elite. The result was that colonial socioeconomic structures remained firmly intact even after independence, leaving a gap between the ideals of liberty and the practical reality experienced by most people.

b. Mental and Cultural Emancipation

By the middle of the nineteenth century, most Latin American countries were no longer colonies, although a few did not achieve independence until considerably later (for example, Cuba in 1898). Nevertheless, there was a widespread sense even among political and intellectual elites that complete independence had not been achieved. Many thinkers framed the problem in terms of a distinction been the political independence that had already been achieved and the mental or cultural emancipation that remained as the task for a new generation. By developing their own diagnosis of the lingering colonial mindset, this generation sought to give birth to a new American culture, literature, and philosophy. Some of the most important were: Andrés Bello (1781-1865) in Venezuela, Francisco Bilbao (1823-1865) and José Victorino Lastarria (1817-1888) in Chile, Juan Bautista Alberdi (1810-1884) and Domingo Faustino Sarmiento (1811-1888) in Argentina, Gabino Barreda (1818-1881) in Mexico, Juan Montalvo (1833-1889) in Ecuador, Manuel González Prada (1844-1918) in Peru, and Luis Pereira Barreto (1840-1923) in Brazil. Among these thinkers, Juan Bautista Alberdi was the first to explicitly address the question of the character and future of Latin American philosophy, which he believed to be intimately linked with the character and future of the Latin American people. (It is worth reiterating the fact that the term “Latin America” still did not exist and that Alberdi spoke about the future of “American philosophy” as a reflection of the “American people” without meaning to include the philosophy or people of the United States). For Alberdi, Latin American philosophy should be used an intellectual tool for developing an understanding of the most vital social, political, religious, and economic problems facing the people of Latin America. (It is worth nothing that Alberdi’s references to “the people” of Latin America were aimed primarily at his fellow criollos, implicitly excluding the non-white majority of the population). Alberdi’s Foundations and Points of Departure for the Political Organization of the Republic of Argentina served as one of the major foundations for Argentina’s 1853 Constitution, which with amendments remains in force to this day.

c. Positivism

Almost all of the thinkers from the generation that sought intellectual and cultural emancipation from the colonial past came to identify with the philosophy of positivism, which dominated much of the intellectual landscape of Latin America throughout the second half of the nineteenth century. Strictly speaking, positivism originated in Europe with the French philosopher Auguste Comte (1798-1859), but it was warmly welcomed by many Latin American intellectuals who saw Comte’s motto of “order and progress” as a European version of what they had been struggling for themselves. While adapting positivism to their own regional conditions, they presented it optimistically as a philosophy based upon an experimental and scientific method that could modernize both the economy and the educational system in order to produce social and political stability. The influence of positivism on Latin America is perhaps most vividly portrayed in Brazil’s current flag, adopted in 1889, which features the words Ordem e Progresso (Order and Progress). However, the literal adoption of Comte’s motto masks the fact that the meaning of positivism in Latin America underwent considerable change under the influence of the English philosopher Herbert Spencer (1820-1903) and others who both sought to reformulate positivism in light of Darwinian evolutionary theory. This later variety of evolutionary positivism was also frequently called materialism, characterized by its rejection of dualist and idealist metaphysics, its mechanistic philosophy of history, its promotion of intense industrial competition as the primary means of material progress, and its frequent explanation of various social and political problems in biological terms of racial characteristics. While the precise understanding of positivism differed from thinker to thinker and the scope of positivism’s influence varied from country to country, there is little question of its overall importance.

The history of positivism in Mexico can be used to illustrate the shifting meaning of positivism in a particular national context. Gabino Barreda (1818-1881) founded the National Preparatory School in Mexico City in 1868 and made a modified form of Comte’s positivism the basis of its curriculum. Barreda understood Mexico’s social disorder to be a direct reflection of intellectual disorder, which he sought to reorganize in its entirety under the authority of President Benito Juárez. Like Comte, Barreda wanted to place all education in the service of moral, social, and economic progress. Unlike Comte, Barreda interpreted political liberalism as an expression of the positive spirit, modifying Comte’s famous motto to read: “Liberty as the means; order as the base; progress as the end.” The philosophical positions held by the second generation of Mexican positivists were quite different, even though they all hailed Barreda as their teacher. Eventually, many of them joined the científicos, a circle of technocratic advisors to the dictator Porfirio Díaz. The most famous among them, Justo Sierra (1848-1912), developed his philosophy of Mexican history using Spencer’s theory of evolution in an attempt to accelerate the evolution of Mexico through a kind of social engineering. Although Sierra initially judged Porfirio Díaz’s dictatorship to be necessary in order to secure the order necessary to make progress possible, in the final years of his life Sierra cast doubt upon both positivism and the dictatorship it had been used to support.

One of the earliest critics of positivism in Latin America was the Cuban philosopher Jose Martí (1853-1895). His criticism was linked to a different vision of what he called Nuestra América (Our America”), reclaiming the word “America” from the way it is commonly used to refer exclusively to the United States of America. Whereas positivists or materialists tended to explain the evolutionary backwardness of Latin America in terms of the biological backwardness of the races that constituted the majority of its population, Martí pointed to the ongoing international history of political and economic policies that systematically disadvantaged these same people. Like Juan Bautista Alberdi had done a generation before, Martí called for Latin American intellectuals to develop their own understanding of the most vital social, political, religious, and economic problems facing the Latin American people. Unlike Alberdi, Martí took a more positive and inclusive view of Latin American identity by giving indios, mestizos, negros, and mulatos a place alongside criollos in the task of building a truly free Latin America. According to Marti, the ongoing failure of the United States to grant equality to Native Americans and former slaves in the construction of its America was just as dangerous to imitate as the European political model. Unfortunately, Martí died young in the Cuban war to gain political independence from Spain, but as an idealist he believed that powerful ideas like liberty must play an equal role in freeing Latin America from the imperialistic impulses of both Europe and the United States.

4. Twentieth Century

A backlash against the intellectual hegemony of positivism marks the beginning of the twentieth century in Latin America. The “scientific” nature of positivism was charged with being “scientistic;” materialism was challenged by new forms of idealism and vitalism; and evolutionism was criticized by various social and political philosophies that supported revolution. As the century wore on, there was a dramatic proliferation of philosophical currents so that speaking of Latin American philosophy as a whole becomes increasingly difficult. Ironically, this difficulty arises during the very same period that the term “Latin America” first began to achieve widespread use in public and academic discourse, and the period that the first historical treatments of Latin American philosophy appeared. In response to the problems inherent in speaking of Latin American philosophy as a whole, scholars have narrowed their scope by writing about the history of twentieth century philosophy in a particular Latin American country (especially Mexico, Argentina, or Brazil); in a particular region (for example, Central America or the Caribbean); in a particular philosophical tradition (for example, Marxism, phenomenology, existentialism, neo-scholasticism, historicism, philosophy of liberation, analytic philosophy, or feminist philosophy); or in and through a list of important figures. Alternatively, attempts to provide a more panoramic vision of Latin American philosophy in the twentieth century typically proceed by delineating somewhere between three and six generations or periods. For the sake of continuity in scope and detail, the present article utilizes this method and follows a six-generation schema that assigns a rough year to each generation based upon when they were writing rather than when they were born (modeled upon Beorlegui 2006).

a. Generation of 1900: Foundational Critique of Positivism

The members of the first twentieth-century generational group of 1900 are often called “the generation of founders” or “the generation of patriarchs,” following the influential terminology of Francisco Romero or Francisco Miró Quesada, respectively. Members of this generation include José Enrique Rodó (1871-1917) and Carlos Vaz Ferreira (1872-1958) in Uruguay, Alejandro Korn (1860-1936) in Argentina; Alejandro Deústua (1849-1945) in Peru; Raimundo de Farias Brito (1862-1917) in Brazil; Enrique José Varona (1849-1933) in Cuba; and Enrique Molina Garmendia (1871-1964) in Chile. The year of 1900 conveniently refers to the change of century and marks the publication of Rodó’s Ariel, which exerted tremendous influence on other Latin American intellectuals. Like those that had come before them, Rodó and the other members of this generation did not write primarily for other philosophers but rather for a broader public in an attempt to influence the courses of their countries. Like Jose Martí, Rodó criticized a particular form of positivism or materialism, which he associated with the United States or Anglo-Saxon America and presented in the barbaric character of “Caliban” from Shakespeare’s The Tempest. In contrast, Rodó presents the civilized “Ariel” as the Latin American spirit of idealism that values art, sentiment, philosophy, and critical thinking. Rodó thus recommends a return to the classical values of ancient Greece and the best of contemporary European (especially French) philosophy. This recommendation is presented in contrast to what Rodó calls nordomanía or the manic delatinization of America, that is, the growing but unthinking imitation of the United States, its plutocracy, and its reductively material and individualist understandings of success.

b. Generation of 1915: New Philosophical Directions

The members of the generation of 1915 are often grouped with the previous generation of “founders” or “patriarchs” but they are presented here separately because they represent a growing interest in the mestizo or indigenous dimensions of Latin American identity. As it had since colonial times, Latin American philosophy in the twentieth century continued to connect many of its philosophical and political problems to the identity of its peoples. But in light of events like the Mexican revolution that began in 1910, some thinkers began to rebel against the historical tendency to view mestizos and indigenous peoples as negative elements to be overcome through ongoing assimilation and European immigration. Principal members of this generation include Antonio Caso (1883-1946), José Vasconcelos (1882-1959), and Alfonso Reyes (1889-1959) in Mexico; Pedro Henríquez Ureña (1884-1946) in Dominican Republic; Cariolano Alberini (1886-1960) in Argentina; Víctor Raúl Haya de la Torre (1895-1979) and José Carlos Mariátegui (1894-1930) in Peru. The first four thinkers just listed were members of the famous Atheneum of Youth, an intellectual and artistic group founded in 1909 that is crucial for understanding Mexican culture in the twentieth century. Drawing upon Rodó’s Ariel—as well as other American and European philosophers including Henri Bergson (1859–1941), Friedrich Nietzsche (1844-1900), and William James (1842-1910)—the Atheneum developed a sweeping criticism of the reigning positivism of the científicos and began to take Latin American philosophy in new directions. The members of the Atheneum also explicitly linked their intellectual revolution to Mexico’s social revolution, thereby recapitulating the nineteenth century concern to achieve both political independence and mental emancipation. Jose Vasconcelos’ most famous work, The Cosmic Race (1925), presents a vision of Mexico and Latin America more generally as the birthplace of a new mixed race whose mission would be to usher in a new age by ethnically and spiritually fusing all of the existing races. Vasconcelos subsumed the 1910 Mexican Revolution in a larger world-historical vision of the New World in which Mexicans and other Latin American peoples would redeem humanity from its long history of violence, achieve political stability, and undertake the integral spiritual development of humankind (replacing prevailing notions of human progress as merely materialistic or technological).

Focusing on Indians rather than mestizos, José Carlos Mariátegui offered a vision of Peru and Indo-America (his preferred term for Latin America) that would reverse the disastrous social and economic effects of the conquest. One of the most important Marxist thinkers in the history of Latin America, Mariátegui tied the future of Peru to the socialist liberation of its indigenous peasants, who made up the vast majority of the country’s population and whose lives were only made worse by national independence. Unlike orthodox scientific Marxists, Mariátegui believed that aesthetics and spirituality had a key role to play in fueling the revolution by uniting various marginalized peoples in the belief that they could create a new, more egalitarian society. Furthermore, Mariátegui grounded his analysis in the historical and cultural conditions of the Andean region, which had developed indigenous forms of agrarian communism destroyed by the Spanish colonizers. Seven Interpretive Essays on Peruvian Reality, published in 1928, highlights the Indian character of Peru and offers a structural interpretation of the ongoing exploitation of indigenous peoples as rooted in the usurpation of their communal lands. Mariátegui argued that administrative, educational, and humanitarian approaches to overcoming the suffering of Indians will necessarily fail unless they overcome the local racialized class system that operates in the larger context of global capitalism.

c. Generation of 1930: Forging Latin American Philosophy

The members of the third twentieth-century generational group of 1930 are often called the “forgers” or the “shapers” (depending upon the translation of Miró Quesada’s influential term forjadores). Members include Samuel Ramos (1897-1959) and José Gaos (1900-1969) in Mexico; Francisco Romero (1891-1962) and Carlos Astrada (1894-1970) in Argentina; and Juan David García Bacca (1901-1992) in Venezuela. After the first two generations of “founders” or “patriarchs” had criticized positivism in order to develop their own personal versions of the philosophic enterprise, the forjadores developed the philosophical foundations and institutions that they took to be necessary for bringing their authentically Latin American philosophical projects to the far better-recognized level of European philosophy. Mariátegui can be understood as a precursor in this respect, since his philosophical influences were primarily European, but his philosophy was rooted in a distinctively Peruvian reality. In their quest to philosophize from a distinctively Latin American perspective, many of the forjadores were greatly influenced by the “perspectivism” of the Spanish philosopher José Ortega y Gasset (1883-1955). Ortega’s impact on Latin American philosophy only increased—particularly in Mexico, Argentina, and Venezuela—with the arrival of Spaniards exiled during the Spanish Civil War (1936-1939). José Gaos was undoubtedly the most influential of these transterrados (transplants), who helped found new educational institutions, publish new academic journals, establish new publishing houses, and translate hundreds of works in Ancient and European philosophy.

The long philosophical career of Juan David García Bacca illustrates the shifting philosophical currents and geographic displacements that forged new developments in Latin American philosophy. Author of over five hundred philosophical works and translations, García Bacca received his philosophical training in Spain, largely under the influence of neo-scholasticism until Ortega woke him from his dogmatic slumber. García Bacca spent the first years of his exile (1938-1941) in Quito, Ecuador, where he began to deconstruct the Aristotelian or Thomistic conception of human nature and replace it with an understanding of man as historical, technological, and transfinite. In other words, García Bacca presented human beings as finite creatures who are nevertheless godlike in their infinite capacity to recreate themselves. In 1941, García Bacca accepted an invitation from the National Autonomous University of Mexico (UNAM) to teach a course on the philosophy of the influential German existentialist and phenomenologist Martin Heidegger (1889-1976). In 1946, García Bacca along with other transterrados founded the Department of Philosophy at the Central University of Venezuela, where he continued to work out his philosophy in dialogue with the traditions of historicism, vitalism, phenomenology, hermeneutics, and existentialism. Following a broad intellectual trend in Latin America after the Cuban revolution of 1959, his understanding of the Latin American context was transformed under the influence of Marxism beginning in the 1960s. García Bacca gave his understanding of human nature as transfinite a substantially new twist by requiring nothing less than the transformation of human nature under socialism. Once again indicating broad intellectual trends in the 1980s, García Bacca began distancing himself somewhat from Marxism and contributed greatly to the history of philosophy in Latin America by publishing substantial anthologies of philosophical thought in Venezuela and Colombia.

d. Generation of 1940: Normalization of Latin American Philosophy

Given the tremendous progress in the institutionalization of Latin American philosophy from roughly 1940 until 1960, this period is frequently referred to as that of “normalization” (again following the influential periodization of Francisco Romero). The generation that benefited was the first to consistently receive formal academic training in philosophy in order to become professors in an established system of universities. These philosophers developed an increasing consciousness of Latin American philosophical identity, aided in part by increased travel and dialogue between Latin American countries and universities (some of it forced under politically oppressive conditions that led to exile). Members of this fourth generation include Risieri Frondizi (1910-1985) and Augusto Salazar Bondy (1925-1974) in Argentina; Miguel Reale (1910-2006) in Brazil; Francisco Miró Quesada (1918- ) in Peru; Arturo Ardao (1912-2003) in Uruguay; and Leopoldo Zea (1912-2004) and Luis Villoro (1922- ) in Mexico. Building upon the philosophies of their teachers, as well as the philosophical conception of hispanidad that many inherited from the Spanish philosophers Miguel de Unamuno (1864-1936) and Ortega y Gasset, this generation developed a critical philosophical perspective that is often called “Latin Americanism.” The philosophy of Leopold Zea is widely taken to be exemplary of this approach. Under the influence of Samuel Ramos and the direction of Jose Gaós at the UNAM, Zea defended his 1944 dissertation on the rise and fall of positivism in Mexico, later translated as Positivism in Mexico (1974). In 1949, Zea founded the famous Hyperion Group of philosophers seeking to shed light upon Mexican identity and reality. Convinced that the past must be known and understood in order to construct an authentic future, Zea went on to situate his work in a panoramic philosophical view of Latin American history, drawing upon the earlier works of Bolívar, Alberdi, Martí, and many others. Zea’s extensive travels and ongoing professional dialogue with other Latin American philosophers across the Continent resulted in many works, including one translated as The Latin American Mind (1963). He also edited a series of works by other scholars on the history of ideas across Latin America, published by El Fondo de Cultura Económica, Mexico’s largest publishing house. Anticipating themes that marked future generations of Latin American philosophy, Zea’s later works such as Latin America and the World (1969) thematized the concepts of marginalization and liberation while situating Latin American philosophy in a global context. In short, Zea consistently sought to develop a Latin American philosophy that would be capable of grasping Latin America’s concrete history and present circumstances in an authentic, responsible, and ultimately universal way.

Zea’s quest for an authentic Latin American philosophy emerged as part of a larger debate over the nature of Latin American philosophy and whether it was something more than an imitation of European philosophy. An examination of one of Zea’s most famous opponents in this debate—Augusto Salazar Bondy—will help set the stage for the subsequent discussion of the philosophies of liberation that emerged in the 1970s with the next philosophical generation. Bondy lays out his position in his book, ¿Existe una filosofía de nuestra América? (1968) [Does a Philosophy of Our America Exist?]. Bondy attacks what he takes to be Zea’s ungrounded idealism and maintains that the existence of an authentic Latin American philosophy is inseparable from the concrete socioeconomic conditions of Latin America, which place it in a situation of dependence and economic underdevelopment in relation to Europe and the United States. This in turn produces a “defective culture” in which inauthentic intellectual works are mistaken for authentic philosophical productions. The problem is not that Latin American philosophy fails to be rooted in concrete reality (a problem that Zea works painstakingly to overcome), but rather that it is concretely rooted in an alienated and divided socioeconomic reality. According to Bondy, the authenticity of Latin American philosophy depends upon the liberation of Latin America from the economic production of its cultural dependence. At the same time, Bondy argues for the inauthenticity of philosophy in Europe and the United States insofar as they depend upon the domination of the Third World. In sum, whereas Zea calls for an authentic philosophical development in Latin America that would critically assimilate the deficiencies of the past, Bondy maintains that liberation from economic domination and cultural dependence is a prerequisite for authentic Latin American philosophy in the future.

Before turning to the next philosophical generation and their philosophies of liberation, it is important to note that there are other major philosophical strands that emerged during the period of normalization (1940-1960). While the period is generally associated with Latin Americanism—which drew upon historicism, existentialism, and phenomenology—other philosophical traditions including Marxism, neo-scholasticism, and analytic philosophy also grew in importance. Important early Latin American analytic philosophers include Vicente Ferreira da Silva (1916-1963) in Brazil, who published work in mathematical logic; Mario Bunge (1919- ) in Argentina and then Canada, who has published extensively in almost all major areas of analytic philosophy; and Héctor-Neri Castañeda (1924-1991) in Guatemala and then the United States, who was a student Wilfrid Sellars (1912-1989) and founded one of the top journals in analytic philosophy, Noûs. Analytic philosophy was further institutionalized in Latin America during the 1960s, especially in Argentina and Mexico, followed by Brazil in the 1970s. In Argentina, Gregorio Kilmovsky (1922-2009) cultivated interest in the philosophy of science, Tomás Moro Simpson (1929- ) did important work in the philosophy of language, and Carlos Alchourrón’s (1931-1996) work on logic and belief revision had an international impact on analytic philosophy and computer science. In Mexico, the Institute of Philosophical Investigations (IIF) and the journal Crítica were both founded in 1967 and continue to serve as focal points for analytic philosophy in Latin America. Notable philosophers at the IIF include Fernando Salmerón (1925-1997), whose major influence was in ethics; Alejandro Rossi (1932-2009), who worked in philosophy of language; and Luis Villoro (1922- ), who works primarily in epistemology and political philosophy. The development of analytic philosophy in Brazil was shaken by the 1964 coup, but resumed in the 1970s. Newton da Costa (1929- ) developed several non-classical logics, most famously paraconsistent logic where certain contradictions are allowed. Oswaldo Chateaubriand (1940- ) has done internationally recognized work in logic, metaphysics, and philosophy of language. Since then, analytic philosophy has continued to grow and develop in Latin America, leading more recently to the 2007 founding of the Asociación Latinoamericana de Filosofía Analítica, whose mission is to promote analytic philosophy through scholarly conferences and other exchanges across Latin America.

e. Generation of 1960: Philosophies of Liberation

After the 1960s, philosophy as a professional academic discipline was well established in Latin America, but it only began to achieve substantial international visibility in the 1970s with the rise of a new generation that developed the philosophy of liberation. The most famous members of this fifth twentieth century generation are from Argentina and include Arturo Andrés Roig (1922-2012), Enrique Dussel (1934- ), and Horacio Cerutti Guldberg (1950- ). The strain of liberation philosophy developed by Ignacio Ellacuría (1930-1989) in El Salvador also stands out as exemplary. In a context marked by violence and political repression, the public philosophical positions of these liberatory thinkers put their lives in jeopardy. Most tragically, Ellacuría was assassinated by a military death squad while chairing the philosophy department of El Salvador’s Universidad Centroamericana. The substantial international impact of the Argentine philosophers of liberation stems in part from their political exile due to the military and state terrorism that characterized the “Dirty War” from 1972-1983. Much like the earlier Spanish transterrados, these philosophers developed and spread their philosophies from their newly adopted countries (Ecuador in the case of Roig, and Mexico in the cases of Dussel and Cerutti Guldberg). Although it should not be confused with the better-known tradition of Latin American liberation theology, Latin American philosophies of liberation emerged from a similar historical and intellectual context that included: a recovery of Latin America’s longstanding preoccupation with political liberation and intellectual independence, the influence of dependency theory in economics, a careful engagement with Marxism, and an emphasis on praxis rooted in an ethical commitment to the liberation of poor or otherwise oppressed groups in the Third World. Yet another parallel strain of Latin American liberationist thought focusing on pedagogy emerged based upon the work of Brazilian philosopher and educator Paulo Freire (1921-1997). Imprisoned and then exiled from Brazil during the military coup of 1964, he developed a vision and method for teaching oppressed peoples (who were often illiterate) how to theorize and practice their own liberation from the dehumanizing socioeconomic conditions that had been imposed upon them. Freire’s book Pedagogy of the Oppressed (1970) drew international attention and became a foundational text in what is now called critical pedagogy.

While Cerutti Guldberg has written the most complete work explaining the intellectual splits that produced different philosophies of liberation—Filosofía de la liberación latinoamericana (2006)—Dussel’s name and work are most widely known given his tremendous efforts to promote the philosophy of liberation through dialogue with famous European philosophers including Karl-Otto Apel (1922- ) and Jurgen Habermas (1929) as well as famous North American philosophers including Richard Rorty (1931-2007) and Charles Taylor (1931- ). By analyzing the relationship between Latin American cultural-intellectual dependence and socioeconomic oppression, Dussel seeks to develop transformational conceptions and practices leading to liberation from both of these conditions. Dussel argues that the progress of European philosophy through the centuries has come at the expense of the vast majority of humanity, whose massive poverty has only rarely appeared as a fundamental philosophical theme. Dussel’s best-known early work Philosophy of Liberation (1980) attempts to foreground, diagnose, and transform the oppressive socioeconomic and intellectual systems that are largely controlled by European and North American interests and power groups at the expense of Third World regions including Latin America. Instead of only pretending to be universal, at the expense of most people who are largely ignored, historical and philosophical progress must be rooted in a global dialogue committed to recognizing and listening to the least heard on their own terms. Influenced by the French philosopher Immanuel Levinas (1906-1995), Dussel highlights the importance of this ethical method, which he calls analectical to contrast it with the totalizing tendencies of the Hegelian dialectic. A prolific author of more than fifty books, Dussel’s later work attempts to systematically develop philosophical principles for a critical ethics of liberation alongside a critical politics of liberation. Dussel’s 1998 book, Ethics of Liberation in the Age of Globalization and Exclusion (translated in 2013), is often cited as an important later work.

While not typically categorized as part of the philosophy of liberation in the narrow sense, Latin American feminist philosophy is an important but typically under-recognized form of emancipatory thought that has existed in academic form for at least a century. In 1914, Carlos Vaz Ferreira (1872-1958) began publicly analyzing and discussing the importance of civil and political rights for women, as well as women’s access to education and professional careers. Vaz Ferreira’s feminist philosophy was published as Sobre feminismo in 1933, the same year that woman gained the right to vote in Uruguay. Given that Vaz Ferreira belongs to the first twentieth century generation of the “patriarchs” of Latin American philosophy, it is worth emphasizing that women were systematically marginalized from the academic discipline of philosophy until much later in the twentieth century, when the feminist movements of the 1970s led to the institutionalization of Women’s Studies or Gender Studies in Latin American universities in the 1980s and 1990s. An important connecting tissue for these movements has been the Encuentros Feminista Latinoamericano y del Caribe, an ongoing series of biennial (later triennial) meetings of Latin American women and feminist activists, first held in 1981 in Bogotá, Colombia. While the diversity that characterizes feminism makes it problematic to make generalized comparisons between Latin American feminism and feminism in Europe and the United States, Latin American feminists have tended to be more concerned with the context of family life and to giving equal importance to ethnicity and class as categories of analysis (Femenías and Oliver 2007).

One of the earliest and most influential Latin American feminist philosophers was Graciela Hierro (1928-2003), who introduced feminist philosophy into the academic curriculum of the UNAM beginning in the 1970s and organized the first panel on feminism at a national Mexican philosophy conference in 1979. Hierro is best remembered for the feminist ethics of pleasure that she developed beginning with her book Ética y feminismo (1985). Criticizing the “double sexual morality” that assigns asymmetrical moral roles based upon gender, Hierro argues for a hedonistic sexual ethic rooted in a love of self that makes prudence, solidarity, justice, and equity possible. The rise of feminist philosophy alongside other feminist social and intellectual movements in Latin America has also led to the recovery and popularization of writings by marginalized women thinkers, including the work of Sor Juana de la Cruz (1651-1695) discussed above. Another important intellectual resource has been the development of oral history projects or testimonios that seek to document the lives and ideas of countless women living in poverty or obscurity. One of the most famous books in this genre is I, Rigoberta Menchú (1983), the testimonial autobiography of a Quiche Mayan woman, Rigoberta Menchú Tum (1959- ), who began fighting for the rights of women and indigenous people in Guatemala as a teenager and went on to win a Nobel Peace Prize in 1992.

f. Generation of 1980: Globalization, Postmodernism, and Postcolonialism

The sixth and last generation of twentieth century Latin American philosophers emerged in the 1980s. While speaking of broad trends is always somewhat misleading given the diversity of approaches and interests, one interesting trend lies in how Latin American philosophers from this generation have contributed to the analysis and criticism of globalization by participating in new intellectual debates concerning postmodernism in the 1980s and postcolonialism in the 1990s. For example, some new philosophers of liberation like Raul Fornet-Betancourt (1946- ) sought to revise fundamental theoretical dichotomies such as center/periphery, domination/liberation, and First World/Third World that were critical in terms of their general thrust but insufficiently nuanced in light of the complex phenomena that go by the name of globalization. Fornet-Betancourt’s own biography points to this complexity, since he was born in Cuba but moved to Germany in 1972, earning his college degree and first PhD in philosophy in Spain, then returning to complete a second PhD in theology and linguistics in Germany, where he is currently a professor who publishes extensively in both German and Spanish. Self-critical of much of his own philosophical training and development, Fornet-Betancourt has rooted himself in Latin American philosophy in order to devise an intercultural approach to understanding philosophy in light of the diverse histories and cultures that have produced human wisdom across time and space. In contrast to globalization, which is a function of a global political economy that does not tolerate differences or alternatives to a global monoculture of capitalism and consumption, Fornet-Betancourt outlines the economic and political conditions that would make genuinely symmetrical intercultural dialogue and exchange possible.

Drawing critically upon discussions of globalization and postmodernism, the discourse of postcolonialism emerged in the final decade of the twentieth century. The basic idea is that globalization has produced a new transnational system of economic colonialism that is distinct from but related to the national and international forms of colonialism that characterized the world between the conquest of America and the Second World War. Among other things, postcolonialism addresses the politics of knowledge in globalized world that is unified by complex webs of exclusion based upon gender, class, race, ethnicity, language, and sexuality. One of the fundamental criticisms leveled by postcolonialism is the way that neo-colonial discourses routinely and violently construct homogeneous wholes like “The Third World” or “Latin America” out of heterogeneous peoples, places, and their cultures. Like postmodernism, postcolonial theory did not initially come from or focus on Latin America, so there is considerable debate about whether or how postcolonial theory should be developed in a Latin American context. A variant of this debate has occurred among Latin American feminists who do not generally view themselves as part of postcolonial feminism, which has been charged with overlooking tremendous differences between the former English and French colonies and the former Spanish and Portuguese colonies (Schutte and Femenías 2010). One of the best-known Latin American thinkers who works critically in conjunction with postcolonial studies is Walter Mignolo (1941- ). He was born in Argentina, where he completed his B.A. in philosophy before moving to Paris to obtain his Ph.D., eventually becoming a professor in the United States. Rather than apply foreign postcolonial theory to the Latin American context, Mignolo has mined the history of Latin America for authors who found ways to challenge or subversively employ the rules of colonial discourse, for example, the native Andean intellectual and artist Felipe Guamán Poma de Ayala (c.1550-1616) discussed above. Mignolo’s book, The Idea of Latin America (2005), excavates the history of how the idea of Latin America came about in order to show how it still rests upon colonial foundations that must be transformed by decolonial theory and practice.

5. Twenty-First Century

a. Plurality of Philosophies in Latin America

In the early twenty-first century, Latin America became home to the ongoing development and institutionalization of many philosophical traditions and approaches including analytic philosophy, Latin Americanism, phenomenology, existentialism, hermeneutics, Marxism, neo-scholasticism, feminism, history of philosophy, philosophy of liberation, postmodernism, and postcolonialism. At the same time, the very idea of Latin America has been posed as a major problem (Mignolo 2005), following historically in the wake of the still unresolved controversy over how philosophy itself should be understood. While the dominant philosophical currents and trends differ both across and within various Latin American countries and regions, all of the major philosophical approaches that predominate in Europe and the United States are well-represented.

b. Normalization of Latin American Philosophy in the United States

The term “Latin American philosophy” has also gained widespread use and attracted considerable research interest in the United States. This is due in large measure to the efforts of a generation of Latino and Latina philosophers who were born in Latin America and went on to become professors in the United States where they teach and publish in better-established philosophical fields as well as in Latin American philosophy. These philosophers include Walter Mignolo (1941- ), María Lugones (1948- ), and Susana Nuccetelli (1954-) from Argentina; Jorge J. E. Gracia (1942- ) and Ofelia Schutte (1945- ) from Cuba; Linda Martín Alcoff (1955- ) from Panama; and Eduardo Mendieta (1963- ) from Colombia. Their philosophical interests and approaches to Latin American philosophy vary greatly and include postcolonial theory, feminism, metaphysics, epistemology, critical philosophy of race, philosophy of liberation, philosophy of language, metaphilosophy, continental philosophy, and critical theory. This generation has also made important contributions to the analysis of, and debate over, Hispanic or Latino/a identity in the United States, especially as it intersects with other complex dimensions of identity including race, ethnicity, nationality, class, language, gender, and sexual orientation.

Borrowing a term from the history of Latin American philosophy, we may eventually be able to speak of the early twenty-first century as the period of normalization for Latin American philosophy in the United States. Given the accomplishments of the generation of mostly Latino and Latina founders, a few philosophy graduate students in the United States have been the first presented with opportunities to receive some formal training in Latin American philosophy and to make it a major part of their research agenda early in their careers. Moreover, the first handful of job listings at universities in the United States have emerged calling for professors who specialize in Latin American philosophy. The early twenty-first century has also been marked by an increasing number of English-language articles and books on Latin American philosophy. Nevertheless, if this trend toward more development of Latin American philosophy is to continue, then large hurdles remain, including a major shortage of primary Latin American philosophical texts available in English translation, a widespread lack of knowledge concerning Latin American philosophy among most professional philosophers in the United States, and the resulting need for most U.S. philosophers interested in Latin American philosophy to maintain an active research agenda and publication record in at least one better-recognized philosophical area or field.

6. References and Further Reading

Alberdi, Juan Bautista. “Foundations and Points of Departure for the Political Organization of the Republic of Argentina.” Translated by Janet Burke and Ted Humphrey. In Nineteenth-Century Nation Building and the Latin American Intellectual Tradition: A Reader. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 2007.
Alcoff, Linda Martín. Visible Identities: Race, Gender, and the Self. New York: Oxford University Press, 2006.
Arciniegas, Germán. Latin America: A Cultural History. Translated by Joan MacLean. New York: Knopf, 1966.
Beorlegui, Carlos. Historia del pensamiento filosofico latinoamericano: una busqueda incesante de la identidad. Bilbao: Universidad de Deusto, 2006.
Beorlegui, Carlos . “La Filosofía de Jd García Bacca.” Isegoría, no. 7 (1993): 151-64.
Bolívar, Simón. El Libertador: Writings of Simón Bolívar. Translated by Frederick H. Fornoff. Edited by David Bushnell. New York: Oxford University Press, 2003.
Bondy, Augusto Salazar. ¿Existe una filosofía de nuestra américa? México: Siglo XXI, 1968.
Burke, Janet, and Ted Humphrey, eds. Nineteenth-Century Nation Building and the Latin American Intellectual Tradition: A Reader. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 2007.
Cerutti Guldberg, Horacio. Filosofía de la liberación latinoamericana. México: Fondo de Cultura Económica, 2006.
Chasteen, John Charles. Born in Blood & Fire: A Concise History of Latin America. New York: W. W. Norton & Company, 2011.
Costa, João Cruz. A History of Ideas in Brazil: The Development of Philosophy in Brazil and the Evolution of National History. Translated by Suzette Macedo. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1964.
Crawford, William Rex. A Century of Latin-American Thought. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1961.
de la Cruz, Sor Juana Inés. The Answer / La Respuesta. Edited and Translated by Electa Arenal and Amanda Powell. New York: Feminist Press at the City University of New York, 2009.
de las Casas, Bartolomé. In Defense of the Indians. Translated by Stafford Poole. DeKalb: Northern Illinois University Press, 1992.
Dussel, Enrique. Ethics of Liberation: In the Age of Globalization and Exclusion. Translated by Alejandro A. Vallega and Eduardo Mendieta. Durham, NC: Duke University Press, 2013.
Dussel, Enrique . Philosophy of Liberation. Translated by Aquilina Martinez and Christine Morkovsky. Eugene, OR: Wipf & Stock Publishers, 1980.
Dussel, Enrique . Politics of Liberation: A Critical Global History. Translated by Thia Cooper. Canterbury: SCM Press, 2011.
Dussel, Enrique, Eduardo Mendieta, and Carmen Bohórquez, eds. El pensamiento filosofico latinoamericano, del Caribe y “latino” (1300-2000): historia, corrientes, temas y filósofos. México: Siglo XXI, 2009.
Ellacuría, Ignacio. Ignacio Ellacuria: Essays on History, Liberation, and Salvation. Edited by Michael E. Lee. Maryknoll, NY: Orbis Books, 2013.
Femenías, María Luisa, and Amy A. Oliver, eds. Feminist Philosophy in Latin America and Spain. New York: Rodopi, 2007.
Fornet-Betancourt, Raúl. Transformación intercultural de la filosofía: ejercicios teóricos y prácticos de filosofía intercultural desde latinoamérica en el contexto de la globalización. Bilbao: Desclée de Brouwer, 2001.
Freire, Paulo. Pedagogy of the Oppressed. Translated by Myra Bergman Ramos. New York: Herder and Herder, 1970.
García Bacca, Juan David. Antología del pensamiento filosófico venezolano. Caracas: Ediciones del Ministerio de Educación, 1954.
Gracia, Jorge J. E. Hispanic / Latino Identity: A Philosophical Perspective. Malden, MA: Wiley-Blackwell, 1999.
Gracia, Jorge J. E., ed. Latin American Philosophy Today. A Special Double Issue of The Philosophical Forum. Vol. 20:1-2, 1988-89.
Gracia, Jorge J. E.. Philosophical Analysis in Latin America. Dordrecht: Reidel, 1984.
Gracia, Jorge J. E., and Elizabeth Millán-Zaibert. Latin American Philosophy for the 21st Century: The Human Condition, Values, and the Search for Identity. Amherst, NY: Prometheus Books, 2004.
Guaman Poma de Ayala, Felipe The First New Chronicle and Good Government [Abridged]. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing Company, 2006.
Hierro, Graciela. Ética y feminismo. México: Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México, 1985.
Hierro, Graciela . La ética del placer. México: Universidad Nacional Autónoma de México, 2001.
Ivan, Marquez, ed. Contemporary Latin American Social and Political Thought: An Anthology. Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, 2008.
Mariátegui, José Carlos. Seven Interpretive Essays on Peruvian Reality. Translated by Marjory Urquidi. Austin: University of Texas Press, 1971.
Martí, José. José Martí Reader: Writings on the Americas. Edited by Deborah Scnookal and Mirta Muñiz. Melbourne: Ocean Press, 2007.
Mendieta, Eduardo, ed. Latin American Philosophy: Currents, Issues, Debates. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 2003.
Mignolo, Walter D. The Darker Side of the Renaissance: Literacy, Territoriality, and Colonization. Ann Arbor: University of Michigan Press, 1995.
Mignolo, Walter D . The Idea of Latin America. Malden, MA: Wiley-Blackwell, 2005.
Moraña, Mabel, Enrique Dussel, and Carlos A. Jáuregui, eds. Coloniality at Large: Latin America and the Postcolonial Debate. Durham, NC: Duke University Press, 2008.
Nuccetelli, Susana, Ofelia Schutte, and Otávio Bueno, eds. A Companion to Latin American Philosophy. Malden, MA: Wiley-Blackwell, 2010.
Nuccetelli, Susana, and Gary Seay. Latin American Philosophy: An Introduction with Readings. Upper Saddle River, NJ: Pearson, 2003.
Nuccetelli, Susanna. Latin American Thought: Philosophical Problems and Arguments. Boulder, CO: Westview Press, 2002.
Portilla, Miguel León. Aztec Thought and Culture: A Study of the Ancient Nahuatl Mind. Norman: University of Oklahoma Press, 1963.
Rodó, José Enrique. Ariel. Translated by Margaret Sayers Peden. Austin: University of Texas Press, 1988.
Salles, Arleen, and Elizabeth Millán-Zaibert. The Role of History in Latin American Philosophy: Contemporary Perspectives. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2006.
Sánchez Reulet, Aníbal. Contemporary Latin American Philosophy: A Selection with Introduction and Notes. Translated by Willard R. Trask. Albuquerque: The University of New Mexico Press, 1954.
Schutte, Ofelia. Cultural Identity and Social Liberation in Latin American Thought. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1993.
Schutte, Ofelia, and María Luisa Femenías. “Feminist Philosophy.” In A Companion to Latin American Philosophy, edited by Susana Nuccetelli, Ofelia Schutte and Otávio Bueno. Malden, MA: Wiley-Blackwell, 2010.
Sierra, Justo. The Political Evolution of the Mexican People. Translated by Charles Ramsdell. Austin: University of Texas Press, 1976.
Vasconcelos, José. The Cosmic Race: A Bilingual Edition. Translated by Didier T. Jaén. Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1997.
Vaz Ferreira, Carlos. Sobre feminismo. Buenos Aires: Editorial Losada, 1945.
Zea, Leopoldo. The Latin-American Mind. Translated by James H. Abbott and Lowell Dunham. Norman: University of Oklahoma Press, 1963.
Zea, Leopoldo . Latin America and the World. Translated by Beatrice Berler and Frances Kellam Hendricks. Norman: University of Oklahoma Press, 1969.
Zea, Leopoldo . Positivism in Mexico. Translated by Josephine H. Schulte. Austin: University of Texas Press, 1974.
Zea, Leopoldo . The Role of the Americas in History. Translated by Sonja Karsen. Edited by Amy A. Oliver. Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, 1991.

Author Information

Alexander V. Stehn
Email: alex.stehn@utrgv.edu
University of Texas-Rio Grande Valley
U. S. A.

Molyneux’s Question

Molyneux’s question, also known as Molyneux’s problem, concerns the possibility that a person born blind might immediately identify a shape previously familiar to them only by touch if they were made to see. Through personal correspondence, William Molyneux initially presented this query to John Locke in 1688. Locke then interposed the question within the Second edition of his An Essay Concerning Human Understanding:

“Suppose a Man born blind, and now adult, and taught by his touch to distinguish between a Cube, and a Sphere of the same metal, and nighly of the same bigness, so as to tell, when he felt one and t’other, which is the Cube, which the Sphere. Suppose then the Cube and Sphere placed on a Table, and the Blind Man to be made to see. Quære, Whether by his sight, before he touched them, he could now distinguish, and tell, which is the Globe, which the Cube (Locke 1694/1979).”

Molyneux’s question soon became a fulcrum for early research in the epistemology of concepts, challenging common nativist intuitions about concept acquisition; asking whether sensory features distinguish concepts and how concepts may be applied in novel experiences. The question was reprinted and discussed by a wide range of early modern philosophers, including Gottfried Leibniz, George Berkeley, and Adam Smith, and was perhaps the most important problem in the burgeoning discipline of psychology of the 18^th century.

The question has since undergone various stages of development, both as a mental exercise and as an experimental paradigm, garnering a variety of both affirmative and negative replies during three centuries of debate and deliberation. A renewed interest has been sparked by very recent empirical work on subjects recently healed of cataracts who failed to identify the shapes at first sight, but were soon re-tested with successful results.

Should we answer Molyneux’s question with a “no,” as was the common response of the 18^th century, or “yes,” as some philosophers today claim? How should the success of these answers be decided? Is the question theoretical or empirical? Can the question be sufficiently answered by science? What is its philosophical importance?

A Complex of Questions
Negative Replies
Affirmative Replies
Development as a Thought Experiment
Development as an Empirical Problem
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. A Complex of Questions

Molyneux’s question prompts a number of perplexing issues in both the psychology and philosophy of perception. It links these fields of study with a variety of questions:

Does sensory experience individuate the senses?
Does sensory experience individuate sensory concepts?
Are sensory-specific concepts, if there are such, accessible to conscious reflection or perceptual learning as to make them immediately usable for recognition tasks by other senses?
Is our sensory knowledge of the external world indirect?

The first two of these questions represent a central consideration for answering Molyneux’s question with a “no.” In the traditional view, which is much less prominent today (see Macpherson 2011), sensory experience is the principal basis for individuating both the senses and concepts. Berkeley (1709), for instance, held to the strongest form of sensory individuation: the senses are metaphysically distinct, some being portals to spatial dimensions (touch) and others non-spatial (vision). In consequence, he infamously defended a metaphysical individuation or heterogeneity between concepts acquired from different senses. A concept of a seen line and a touched line do not together constitute a longer perceived line, existing on distinct axes of existence.

Others embraced a weak epistemological difference between the senses, and hence between sensory concepts; in this view, translation of their content is possible but learning their common meaning requires rational thought (Leibniz) or time and experience (Locke). Just as rational exertion or time and experience are needed to train the use of one sense—one must “teach” one’s own sight to see 3-D figures when viewing “3-D Magic Eye” photos, for instance—visually presented shapes require a degree of perceptual training before they can be recognized correctly as those previously touched. Others held to a stronger distinction between sensory formats, claiming that they are too incompatible to be translated, though the same “meaning” is shared between them, offering a strong epistemological difference between sensory concepts (Lotze). At best, such concepts become correlated, but are never known to correspond to the same objects.

If concepts are heterogeneous (weakly, strongly, or metaphysically), then direct knowledge of objects in the external world is problematic. For instance, if our knowledge of a tomato is acquired from vision and later from touch, then these two different presentations of a tomato might amount to two different concepts of tomato altogether, not to mention the soon-to-be smelled and tasted tomato. This invites the possibility that our knowledge of the external world is indirect, being affected by the peculiarities of our sensory organs and processing mechanisms. By contrast, others have argued that because we have direct knowledge of only one tomato, any phenomenal difference between the senses is circumstantial, like an accent rather than a distinct language, a view defended by John Campbell (1996).

The issues prompted by Molyneux’s question lead to a complex of answers in response. Answers can be neatly (perhaps too neatly) categorized into “no” and “yes,” but they are negations and affirmations of different questions, determined by the basis on which these answers are given. Hence, we find some philosophers answering “yes” for one reason, “no” for another, others claiming that there is no possible answer, and yet others claiming that a plurality of answers is agreeable. In addition, a number of purposed modifications, both empirical and theoretical, further attempt to isolate specific queries within the general question. Given its complexity, we should judge the success of Molyneux’s question based not on its answerability but on its productivity.

2. Negative Replies

The two central reasons for answering Molyneux’s question “no” concern the heterogeneous nature of concepts, either as metaphysically or epistemologically distinct, and the involvement of perceptual learning—the inferring of connections in otherwise disparate sensory representations, involving one or multiple senses. Though these reasons are interrelated, as perceptual learning presumes heterogeneity, they are differentiated by emphasis of the philosopher. These views have evolved in various ways, as new empirical discoveries suggest that unconscious neurological learning processes should be considered separately from conscious “conceptual” processes. The diagram below provides a map of these negative replies.

Molyneux himself stressed the issue of perceptual learning, replying that the felt corner of a cube would not at first appear to the eye in the same way as the seen corner of the cube. Time and experience are the means for acquiring knowledge of the associations between seen and felt properties of shape. Locke agreed to Molyneux’s negative reply, but based on his own reasoning on perceptual learning within the sense of sight alone, claiming that sight initially produces primitive sensations later altered by practice; the first appearance of a sphere is as a “circle variously colored” but is judged after time and experience to be a sphere singularly colored. Those considering Locke’s reply have observed that this description of first sight is pure conjecture, as Locke had no access to his own memory of first sight. Others have argued that were two-dimensional shapes presented to the once-blind, Locke would have replied to Molyneux’s question in the affirmative. But, Locke’s example may (like Berkeley) express the idea that the primitive visual sensations of a sphere are non-spatial altogether, and thus a two-dimensional shape would not help the once-blind identify the shapes.

The question of first sight and perceptual learning, however, has become an empirical issue of late. Current research on neural plasticity, or how adept our brains are at changing in response to novel information, informs Shaun Gallagher’s negative reply. He considers the numerous reports of subjects who fail to recognize shapes after their cataracts are removed, and attributes their recognitional inability to the significant deterioration of their visual cortex. Gallager’s reply is based on a degenerative case of perceptual learning within the visual sense; with disuse the faculty of vision “unlearns” its ability to see. By way of contrast, Marjolein Degenaar argues from this same set of data that cataract surgeries show Molyneux’s question not to be testable; she concludes that there is “no answer” to Molyneux’s question. She follows Julien Offray de La Mettrie who contests the applicability of the cataract operations to Molyneux’s question because of the physiological distress involved, but Degenaar adds that no other experimental paradigm will better suited to testing Molyneux’s question.

Perceptual learning, however, is ineffective if sensory formats are thought to be completely distinct. Berkeley’s argument for the heterogeneity of the senses was based on observations that vision is a non-spatial sense: retinal images are inverted, double images can be generated from two eyes, and distance is inaccessible to sight. Sight depends on correlations with touch so that the body can use sight to interact with spatial features of objects. (Followers of this thought, such as Comte de Buffon, misread these ideas as entailing that infants and the once-blind initially see the world as inverted, doubled, and without distance. Because of this, the basis of Buffon’s own negative reply falls to the “psychologist’s fallacy” that we actually see our retinal images, images known only by an anatomy lesson.)

Consideration of the non-spatiality of the sensations produced by the senses at first sight led Étienne Bonnet de Condillac to retract an earlier affirmative reply. He based his newfound intuition on imagining himself as an eyeless statue, confined to mere tactile knowledge of objects, only able to understand the size, distance, and orientation of objects at a distance by use of rigid sticks that, when crossed like a drafting compass, provided him with the information to calculate their true size/distance ratios. Postulating that sight alone would independently produce the same knowledge (by rays of light replacing the tactile sticks to calculate the size, distance, and shape of objects around him), he could account for common meaning between the senses. With his emphasis on the heterogeneity of the senses, Condillac claimed that the once-blind would be entirely confused by the initial visual appearance of color patch sensations. In 1887, Hermann Lotze argued that all sensations are non-spatial, but soon are correlated with learned “local signs”—representations of behavioral interactions with the spatial features of the external world. Lotze maintained that it takes much time and effort to learn to perceive a spatial world. Since the blind perceive space by touch alone, which is a very different mode than sight, the local signs of the once-blind would be inapplicable to both the new visual sensations and the local signs that they would later produce, leading him to conclude a negative reply to Molyneux’s question.

3. Affirmative Replies

The viability of an affirmative reply to Molyneux’s question is a recent development, spurred largely by a mix of supportive studies in developmental science and neuroscience, and the increased popularity of direct realism in epistemology. Some philosophers are on record as answering on nativist grounds, that either an inborn spatial schemata is required for integrated sensory perception or that inborn mechanisms are necessary for matching otherwise heterogeneous concepts. Common sensibles, representations that are not tied to any sensory format, also ground an important response strategy, but vary with respect to the kind of commonality achieved─whether common concepts of shape properties, common behavioral responses to shapes, or common concepts of shapes. Finally, the use of geometry is viewed as crucial to how the once-blind reason, and directly perceive the external world. These categories of reply are presented below in the diagram.

Though Immanuel Kant himself never explicitly considered Molyneux’s question in writing, his contemporaries considered the question an important test for Kant’s theory that a unified spatial organization is a prerequisite for having any perceptual experience. It seems at first that Kant’s view predicts that the visual perception of the once-blind is ordered in the same way as their tactile perception of the shapes—that is, that both experiences employ the same spatial concepts. Kant’s contemporaries’ speculation of an affirmative reply, however, fails to consider that further time and experience might be required to coordinate the unification of visual and tactile perception. For more discussion, see the work of Sassen (2004).

Rather than employing a conceptual commonality, Adam Smith argued in his essay “On the External Senses” that inborn mechanisms automatically generate correlations between touch and the other senses. Like the rules of perspective that visual artists employ to render depth in paintings, this mechanism must utilize innately known rules for purposes of recognition, a mechanism Smith called “instinctive suggestion.” In a similar vein, Jesse Prinz argued that innately synchronized processing of heterogeneous visual and tactile content creates “convergence zones,” areas that bind input from multiple sensory specific cortexes and project the bound input back to these processors in recall tasks such that each sense-specific representation gets activated at the same time.

Not all philosophers view the heterogeneity of the senses as entailing a heterogeneous conceptual repertoire. Edward Synge, an acquaintance of Molynuex, presented his own affirmative reply, which hinged on distinguishing between “images” which are heterogeneous in the mind and “notions” or “ideas” which allow those at first sight to cognize common features in the tactile and visual images, such as the smooth surface of the sphere and the cornered appearance of the cube. Judith Jarvis Thompson imagines a similar answer, but her argument involves an indirect strategy; she argues that, metaphysically, there is no possible world in which the properties of felt cubes would appear to sight as the properties of spheres, a possibility she took to be entailed by a negative answer, all things being equal.

Gareth Evans’ influential paper of 1985 considered the proposal that the commonality between seeing and touching shapes had to be an ability to egocentrically localize the parts of shape—to know where the parts of a shape are with respect to the subject’s locus of action. In other words, for Evans we perceive shape by where we find parts of shapes to be in egocentric space. To perceive a square, for instance, there must be an internal representation of a corner that is felt “to the right” and then along the edge “to the left,” another corner felt “down,” and then another “to the right.” Our perception of a felt square must be based on the same egocentric relations gained from perception of the seen square. Since the same egocentric relations must be used, our perception of the square is the same for touch and sight. This intuition provides a behavioral basis for an affirmative answer to Molyneux’s question, one which Alva Noë takes as a test case for his enactivist account of perception: the claim that we perceive with our bodily activity, not with our brain.

Francis Hutcheson’s affirmative reply in 1727 to Molyneux’s question was based on the existence of homogeneous shape concepts that are unconnected to the senses by which they are acquired. Shapes can be perceptually characterized in a number of ways, such as bounded colors or collections of textures. However, shape concepts are themselves distinct from these sensory representations. Hutcheson demonstrated this intuition with a set of creative (though by no means persuasive) thought experiments: would a blind, paralytic (and presumably deaf) man, whose sense of reality is based on smell, understand number and its application in geometrical reasoning? Would a blind man unacquainted with the feel of a stringed instrument be able to derive its musical scale upon only hearing its sounds? Hutcheson’s intuitions suggested a “yes” answer to both of these scenarios, and by extension, an affirmative reply to Molyneux’s question.

Like Synge, Leibniz argued for a distinction between images and ideas, claiming that the latter are homogeneous across the senses because of their geometrical content. The importance of rational thought is emphasized by Leibniz’s modifications that the newly sighted be told the names of the shapes presented to them and be acquainted with their new visual experiences so as to be able to apply geometrical inferences to them.

Thomas Reid agreed with Locke that at first sight, shapes would look flat, appearing like a painting lacking perspective. This led him to claim that the once-blind could immediately recognize two-dimensional shapes. If, however, the shapes of seen objects have volume—are three-dimensional—they would look different from how they felt, and would be unrecognizable. But since these differences can be represented geometrically, a blind mathematician would be able to calculate which visible shapes correlate with which tactile shapes. For more discussion, see (Van Cleve, 2007).

John Campbell argued that since our senses achieve a direct relationship to the external world, sensory experience must parallel external features rather than those of particular sense modalities. In particular, the geometrical properties of objects constitute one’s sensory experience. This guarantees that the perception of shape by sight and touch will be uniform in structure because perception provides one with a direct, unmediated relationship to objects in the world. If the external object itself provides the character of the experience, then experiences of objects by sight and touch must have the same character, resulting in the once-blind’s immediate recognition of the shapes at first sight.

John Campbell argued that since our senses achieve a direct relationship to the external world, sensory experience must parallel external features rather than those of particular sense modalities. In particular, the geometrical properties of objects constitute one’s sensory experience. This guarantees that the perception of shape by sight and touch will be uniform in structure because perception provides one with a direct relationship to objects in the world with no mediation. If the external object itself provides the character of the experience, then experiences of objects by sight and touch must have the same character, resulting in the once-blind’s immediate recognition of the shapes at first sight.

4. Development as a Thought Experiment

The diversity of answers to Molyneux’s question further indicates a lack of specificity and the need to carefully articulate precise issues of interest within the question itself. This pressure has thus provoked a number of philosophers to retool the question and control variables in an attempt to isolate specific issues. These developments can be organized around changes made to three crucial features of the experiment: simplifying the three-dimensional shape stimuli, stipulating aspects of the subject engaged in the task, and modifying the experimental procedure.

Furthermore, this focused treatment follows the more traditional view that Molyneux’s question is a thought experiment, though many philosophers invoke experimental paradigms for inclusion into the query being posed. These developments are represented in the diagram below.

Denis Diderot argued in 1749 that if the stimulus shapes were simplified from three-dimensional cubes and spheres to two-dimensional squares and circles, an affirmative answer would not require accounting for Locke’s preoccupation with perceptual learning within the sense of sight. Gareth Evans suggested a further simplification to account for the possibility that the organs of sight might themselves remain ineffective: the once-blind subject may view four internal visual points (phosphenes) configured in a square shape generated by direct neural stimulation of the visual cortex. Evans’ development has generated an entirely new approach to the problem of making Molyneux’s question amenable to empirical experimentation, one that has produced results that are favorable (though not conclusive) to his affirmative reply.

James Van Cleve developed a less invasive strategy for testing the once-blind. He suggested using a single raised Braille dot in proximity to a pair of raised dots for visual presentation to the once-blind, who should then be able to immediately identify which is the single and which the paired dots. This strategy of simplifying shapes, however, comes at the cost of decreasing the amount of available information for recognizing the shapes, increasing the ambiguity of which shape is being represented for the subject. This is a problem that future modifications may address.

Subject Stipulation
Given the ambiguity problem of simplifying shapes, it may seem ironic that Diderot also took the level of intellectual aptitude of the subject to be determinative of recognitional ability. A “dullard”—presumably a subject with cognitive disabilities—would not identify two-dimensional shapes, whereas subjects with normal cognitive ability would, though they would lack reasons for how and would be generally uncertain of their visual judgment. By contrast, a “metaphysician” trained in philosophy would recognize the shapes with certainty but would be unable to articulate common features of the seen and touched shapes. A “geometer” would not only have certainty in his identification but also knowledge of the geometrical features common to sight and touch. Thomas Reid took kindly to this latter stipulation, and in 1764 added detail that included the precise mathematical strategies the geometer might employ.

Physical constraints have also been suggested for Molyneux’s hypothetical subject. Condillac’s “statue” modification required that when considering Molyneux’s question, individual sense modalities should be deployed one at a time without considering those of previous or future experience. This helped express Condillac’s intuition that each mode of sensation contributes to one’s sense of the spatiality of the external world, though the sensations of each sense are entirely distinct. H. P. Grice, by contrast, imagined sensory organs entirely alien to humans; by describing the unique experiences of color-type properties that these organs would produce, he was able to demonstrate just how unfamiliar colors are to the blind, and thereby the distinctiveness of experience for the once-blind at first sight.

Gallagher’s concern with the neurophysiological differences between the once-blind and always-sighted led him to suggest a hypothetical Molyneux subject with no neural degeneration from their blindness so as to compensate for a central variable: all visually deprived subjects face neural deterioration of visual processing centers. Such a subject would be similar to an infant, another subject suggested for inclusion by Gallagher and anticipated by Adam Smith, but distinct in that infants’ neural organization would be primed for sensory integration whereas the hypothetical subject would be neutral in this regard.

Procedural Modification
Though developments to the stimuli and subjects directly influence how the test itself proceeds, independent procedural developments are worth noting for their ability to constrain features left ambiguous by Molyneux’s own rendering of the question. Six years prior to the publication of his famous question, Molyneux raised a related query, “Whether he Could know by his sight, before he stretchd out his Hand, whether he Could not Reach them, tho they were Removed 20 or 1000 feet from him?” (Locke 1688/1978). Molyneux presumably would have also answered the distance variant of his question negatively. More importantly, this helps to qualify Molyneux’s popularized question to indicate that the presentation of shapes is proximate to the subject. Another implicit feature of the question was expressed by Leibniz, who stipulated that the once-blind should be told the names of the shapes being presented for recognition. This gives the subject a hint, so that recognizing the shapes is merely a matter of determining which shape was which, and also indicates that the stimuli are not simply paintings, but real bodies accessible to touch.

Leibniz also added an epistemic condition that the once-blind be allowed a familiarity of the experience of sight and an inferential ability on par with the normally sighted. These additional constraints would prevent circumstantial factors from affecting the test; the once-blind would not be “dazzled and confused by the strangenesss” of seeing. A further constraint by van Cleve emphasized this worry by advocating that that the primary stimuli be the visual appearances of the shapes rather than the presented shapes themselves. This condition controls for the possibility that the processing of visual information is systematically distorted such that to the once-blind, shape corners appear smooth, and smooth sides appear cornered.

Janet Levin recommended a further modification regarding the temporal immediacy with which the once-blind must be tested. We need not satisfy Molyneux’s requirement that the identification of the shapes occur “at first sight” if we can otherwise establish “epistemic immediacy” — knowing something without applying inference or other rational strategies. Levin suggested that epistemic immediacy might be assured by using shape stimuli that are more similar to one another than a cube and sphere. Identifying a square from a square-like shape with convex sides may control for simple inferences, a control that provides novel prospects for future modifications.

5. Development as an Empirical Problem

Experimental considerations of Molyneux’s question quickly followed its publication. However, as no immediate cure of blindness has been forthcoming, two provisos are required to make the question more amenable to empirical investigation: sight is achievable by a slow process of visual restoration, and subjects need not be congenitally blind adult males. In lieu of these conditions, three central developments have been in use: ocular and neural surgery, adaptation to Sensory Substitution Devices, and developmental experiments on infants. The diagram below charts these developments by kind.

Surgery

Thirty-six years after the publication of Molyneux’s question, the English surgeon William Cheselden published a report of his successful cataract operation that was so persuasive George Berkeley considered it confirmation of his negative reply, as did many French philosophers, such as Voltaire. Cheselden’s young subject, who was only partially blind (he was able to distinguish night from day), was not able to recognize objects at first sight, though he knew them by touch. Similar experiments throughout the 18^th, 19^th, and 20^th centuries confirmed Cheselden’s findings for many scientists.

Twenty-first century research reveals more nuanced results. Visual deprivation results in deterioration of the visual cortex. (For instance, one carefully studied patient who was blind for 40 years until undergoing cataract surgery at the age of 43 was able to appreciate the distance and size of objects after about five months of recovery, but remained unable to recognize people by their facial features or to appreciate depth such as line drawings of cubes. See Fine, 2003). This indicates that the areas of the brain dedicated to processing some spatial information remain in a deteriorated state, and that therefore, analysis of the experiences of individuals who once had cataracts may be less relevant to the query posed by Molyneux’s question, which concerns the nature of ideas acquired by sensory perception rather than the separate issue of visual impairment.

Held et al. (2011) re-tooled the cataract paradigm by given newly sighted subjects’ a second chance to identify shapes a few days after their initial failed tests; in the second test, each subject succeeded. The authors conclude a more nuanced answer of “initially no but subsequently yes.” In other words, visual deprivation causes transfer failure rather than preventing the creation of cross-modal representations: “The rapidity of acquisition suggests that the neuronal substrates responsible for cross-modal interaction might already be in place before they become behaviorally manifest (Held 2011: 552).” Their summary conclusion is that the neuronal structure for cross-modal transfer is available, but not utilizable due to its degenerated state caused by visual deprivation. This modified cataract paradigm is in support of an affirmative reply if one’s concern is cross-modal transfer. However, if one’s interest in the question concerns the effects of long-term visual deprivation, the modified paradigm supports a negative answer.

Cataract surgery is not the only surgical paradigm that has been applied to Molyneux’s question. Evans suggested using visual prostheses to directly stimulate the visual cortex, or areas along lower visual pathways such as the optic nerve and retina. This invasive technique has the novel and shocking result of producing “phosphenes”—lightning-like flashes produced in the mind’s eye. Blind subjects reportedly are able to spatially organize phosphenes, recognizing motion and simple shapes. After significant training, they are even able to integrate these mental percepts into their behavior: they can localize, identify, and even grasp the corresponding tactile objects presented to them. Such techniques, however, have yet to undergo clinical trial and so remain merely suggestive of an affirmative reply.

A related theoretical observation concerns whether areas of the brain functionally reserved for processing information from one sense modality like touch can process information from another, like sight. Mriganka Sur found that surgically rerouting information from the retina of ferrets to both their auditory cortex and somotosensory cortex elicited responses in both when the subject was visually stimulated. This provides evidence for “crossmodal plasticity,” the claim that senses are functionally organized to process certain kinds of information such as spatially or temporally organized stimuli, rather than organized solely by inborn connections to sensory organs. Crossmodal plasticity is also supported by the observation that when blind subjects process auditory information, the visual cortex is active; this suggests that cortical rewiring is a natural occurrence. Further support comes from the phenomenon known as “synesthesia,” in which perception by one sensory modality includes the experiential character of another sensory modality—where, for instance, one “hears” colors. Surgical research influenced by Molyneux’s question has significantly advanced our understanding of both the long-term negative effects of sensory deprivation and the cortical plasticity of the brain, allowing for improved visual restoration of the once-blind.

Sensory Substitution Devices (SSDs)

Bach-y-Rita’s invention of a device created to simulate sensory experiences of one sensory modality in another has generated a number of experiments related to Molyneux’s question. One such device, the “BrainPort,” transfers visual information from a mobile camera to an electrode array placed on the tongue. Using BrainPorts, blind subjects are able to recognize objects from a distance by the electric stimulations that they feel on their tongue. Aside from anecdotal reports from SSD users, who say that after practice with the BrainPort they no longer feel the stimulation on their tongue but rather simply “see” the objects before them, there is evidence that when congenitally blind individuals use the device, areas in the brain reserved for visual processing are recruited. In the same study, a control group of sighted subjects were not found to have activation in the visual cortex after practiced use of the device, a result that provides intriguing insight into crossmodal plasticity. The use of SSDs seems to be a kind of Molyneux experiment, one that shows that the blind might recognize tactually familiar shapes by using augmentation device. See (Reich et al., 2012.) The use of these devices, however, is an experimental analogue to Molyneux’s question only to the degree that the device presents information visually—an unlikely claim as they more closely approximate an extension of the sensory modality being used.

Developmental Science

Newborn infants offer a unique window into the development of sensory concepts of shape. Like Molyneux’s question, Andrew Meltzoff’s imitation studies involve testing whether stimuli familiar to touch (such as, in his research, the familiarity of feeling one’s own facial expressions or facial proprioception) transfer to the recognition ability of what is seen at first sight. He demonstrated that infants a few weeks old imitate another person’s facial expressions, such as tongue protrusion and mouth opening, suggesting evidence in support of an affirmative reply. These results, however, have been contested by further research that has not been able to replicate Meltzoff’s findings. In another experiment testing Molyneux’s question, Meltzoff shows that oral tactile familiarity of pacifier textures, whether “bumpy” or “smooth,” influences visual recognition of these shapes, suggesting an affirmative reply. Infants who were orally habituated to the feel of a bumpy pacifier attended to the visually presented bumpy shape more often than to the smoothly textured pacifier, and vice-versa.

These results are consistent with Arlette Streri’s experiments, which involved habituating newborns to the feel of shapes in their right hand while preventing them from seeing them. Both shapes were then presented visually to the infants while their length of gaze and number of gazes were recorded. The shapes that were not held were looked at longer and more often, suggesting that shape concepts acquired by touch were communicated from touch to sight. A control group of infants who were not tactually habituated to shapes looked at the visually presented shapes for equal amounts of time, suggesting that prior tactile experience guided the infant’s attention. These results are consistent with an affirmative reply to Molyneux’s question.

6. Conclusion

A philosopher’s muse, Molyneux’s question continues to inspire insight and direct understanding about the mind and its contents. Future prospects of an empirical solution continually remain just beyond the reach of the cognitive sciences, stretching its methodology while extending the question’s application to novel experimental paradigms. The philosophical rewards from such future work promises to be as rich as those of the past and present.

7. References and Further Reading

Berkeley, George. 1709/1975. “An Essay Toward a New Theory of Vision.” Philosophical Works, Including the Works on Vision. (Edited by Michael R. Ayers.) London: J. M. Dent.
- Defends a negative answer to Molyneux’s question in sections 132-159.
Berman, D. 1974/2009. “Francis Hutcheson on Berkeley and the Molyneux Problem.” Berkeley and Irish Philosophy. New York: Continuum Books: 138–148.
- Interprets Hutcheson’s affirmative answer to Molyneux’s question.
Bruno, M., Mandelbaum, E. 2010. “Locke’s Answer to Molyneux’s Thought Experiment.” History of Philosophy Quarterly 27: 165–180.
- Interprets Locke’s negative answer to Molyneux’s question.
Buffon C. 1749/1971. De l’homme. (Translated by M. Duchet) Paris: Masparo.
- Defends a negative answer to Molyneux’s question in the chapter, “Du sens de la vue.”
Campbell J. 1996. “Molyneux’s Question.” Perception: Philosophical Issues 7. (Edited by Enrique Villanueva.) Atascadero, California: Ridgeview Publishing Company: 301–318.
- Defends direct realism with an affirmation of Molyneux’s question.
Cheseldon, W. 1728. “An Account of Some Observations Made by a Young Gentleman, Who Was Born Blind, or Lost His Sight so Early, That He Had no Remembrance of Ever Having Seen, and Was Couch’d between 13 and 14 Years of Age.” Philosophical Transactions 35: 447–50.
- Presents a famous case of a patient healed of cataracts.
Condillac, E. B. 1754/1930. Condillac’s Treatise on the Sensations. (Translated by Geraldine Carr.) London: Favil Press.
- Defends a negative answer to Molyneux’s question using the famous statue example.
Degenaar, M. 1996. Molyneux’s Problem: Three Centuries of Discussion on the Perception of Forms. (Translated by Michael J. Collins) Boston: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
- Summarizes a history of answers to Molyneux’s Question.
Diderot, D. 1749/1972. “Letter on the Blind for the Use of Those who See.” Diderot’s Early Philosophical Works. (Translated by Margaret Jourdain.) New York: Burt Franklin.
- Recounts the life of Nicolas Saunderson, a blind mathematician, with a variety of proposed changes to Molyneux’s question.
Evans, G. 1985. “Molyneux’s Question.” Collected Papers. (Edited by John McDowell.) New York: Oxford UP.
- Defends an affirmative answer to Molyneux’s question.
Fine, I., Wade, A., Brewer, A., May, M., Goodman, D., Boynton, G., Wandell, B., MacLeod, D. 2003. “Long-term Deprivation Affects Visual Perception and Cortex.” Nature Neuroscience 6 (9): 909–10.
- Describes long-term effects of blindness after sight is restored by cataract surgery.
Gallagher, S. 2005. “Neurons and Neonates: Reflections on the Molyneux System.” How the Body Shapes the Mind. Oxford: Clarendon Press: 153–172.
- Defends an affirmative answer to Molyneux’s question.
Glenney, B. 2013. “Philosophical Problems, Cluster Concepts and the Many Lives of Molyneux’s Question.” Biology and Philosophy 28 3: 541–558. DOI 10.1007/s10539-012-9355x
- Defends a pluralist answer to Molyneux’s question.
Glenney, B. 2012. “Leibniz on Molyneux’s Question.” History of Philosophy Quarterly 29 3: 247–264.
- Interprets Leibniz’s affirmative answer to Molyneux’s question.
Glenney, B. 2011. “Adam Smith and the Problem of the External World.” Journal of Scottish Philosophy 9 2: 205–223.
- Interprets Smith’s affirmative answer to Molyneux’s question.
Grice, H. P. 1962/2011. “Some Remarks About the Senses.” The Senses: Classical and Contemporary Philosophical Perspectives. New York: Oxford UP: 83–100.
- Defends the individuation of the senses based on experience.
Held, R., Ostrovsky, Y., deGelder, B., Gandhi, T., Ganesh, S., Mathur, U. and Sinha, P. 2011.  Newly Sighted Cannot Match Seen with Felt. Nature Neuroscience 14: 551–553.
- Describes a new paradigm for testing visual identification of tactilely-familiar shapes by subjects recently cured of cataracts.
Levin, J. 2008. “Molyneux’s Question and the Individuation of Perceptual Concepts.” Philosophical Studies 139 1: 1–28.
- Defends the claim that the same concepts are deployed when seeing and touching shapes.
Liu, Z., Kersten, D., Knill, D. 1999. “Dissociating Stimulus Information from Internal Representation—A Case Study in Object Recognition.” Vision Research 39: 603–612.
- Describes a modification to Molyneux’s question using phosphenes with results that support an affirmative answer.
Locke, J., 1688/1978. The Correspondence of John Locke 3. (Edited by E. S. De Beer.) Oxford: Clarendon Press: 482–3.
- Molyneux first poses his question in Letter 1064 (7 July, 1688).
Locke, J. 1694/1979. An Essay Concerning Human Understanding. (Edited by Peter H. Nidditch.) Oxford: Clarendon Press.
- Defends a negative answer to Molyneux’s question in II.ix.
Lotze, H. 1887. Metaphysic. (Edited by Bernard Mosanquet.) Oxford: Clarendon Press. Vol. II.
- Defends a negative answer to Molyneux’s question.
Macpherson, F. 2011. The Senses: Classical and Contemporary Philosophical Perspectives. New York: Oxford University Press.
- Presents theories on how the senses are to be individuated.
Meltzoff, A. N. 1993. “Molyneux’s Babies: Cross-modal Perception, Imitation, and the Mind of the Preverbal Infant.” Spatial Representation. Cambridge: Blackwell: 219–235.
- Describes visual identification of tactilely familiar shapes by infants.
Morgan, Michael J. 1977. Molyneux’s question: vision, touch, and the philosophy of perception. New York: Cambridge UP.
- Summarizes a history of answers to Molyneux’s Question.
Noë, A. 2004. Action in Perception. Cambridge, Massachusetts.: MIT Press.
- Defends an affirmative answer to Molyneux’s question.
Prinz, J. 2002. Furnishing the Mind: Concepts and Their Perceptual Basis. Cambridge, Massachusetts: MIT Press.
- Defends an affirmative answer to Molyneux’s question in Chapter 5.
Reich, L., Maidenbaum, S., Amedi, A. “The Brain as a Flexible Task Machine: Implications for Visual Rehabilitation using Noninvasive vs. Invasive Approaches. Current Opinion in Neurology 25 1 2012: 86-95.
- Describes uses and implications of Sensory Substitution Devices.
Sassen, B. 2004, “Kant on Molyneux’s Problem.” British Journal for the History of Philosophy 12, 3: 471–485.
- Interprets Kant’s possible answer to Molyneux’s question.
Streri, A., Gentaz, E. 2003. “Cross-modal Recognition of Shape from Hand to Eyes and Handedness in Human Newborns.” Somatosensory & Motor Research 20 1: 11–16.
- Describes visual identification of tactilely-familiar shapes by infants.
Sur, M., Pallas, S., Roe, A. 1990. “Cross-modal Plasticity in Cortical Development: Differentiation and Specification of Sensory Neocortex.” Trends in Neurosciences 13 6: 227–233.
- Describes an experiment re-routing sensory information from vision to audition and touch in ferrets.
Thomson, J. 1974. “Molyneux’s Problem.” The Journal of Philosophy 71 18: 637–650.
- Defends an affirmative answer to Molyneux’s question.
Van Cleve, J. 2007. “Reid’s Answer to Molyneux’s Question.” The Monist 90 2: 251–270.
- Interprets Reid’s answer to Molyneux’s question.

Author Information

Brian Glenney
Email: brian.glenney@gordon.edu
Gordon College
U. S. A.

Bertrand Russell: Ethics

This article confines itself to Bertrand Russell’s conversion from ethical cognitivism (similar to G. E. Moore) to ethical non-cognitivism (similar to Ayer). Russell’s conversion is not only historically important, as it contributes to the rise of metaethics, but it also clarifies the central issues between cognitivism and non-cognitivism.

Traditionally, ethics has been understood as a branch of philosophy that focuses on normative value in human conduct; it is the search for a rationally defensible view concerning what things are good (worth aiming at), which actions are right, and why. However, the tradition took a peculiar turn in the context of 20^th century analytic philosophy. Here, philosophers began to focus on the meanings of ethical terms and claims, rather than on the elements of right conduct. This was the birth of what we nowadays call “metaethics,” over against which the focus on normative theory—the mainstream of Western philosophical ethics from Aristotle to G. E. Moore—has come to be called “normative ethics. Current fashion divides ethics into three sub branches: normative ethics, metaethics and applied ethics. This distinction became necessary after the rise of metaethics in the first half of the twentieth century. Unlike normative ethics, metaethics mainly concentrates on the meanings of fundamental ethical terms, and on ethical method.

The first mature exposition of Russell’s ethical views is found in his essay “The Elements of Ethics” (1910). “The Elements” expounds an ethics largely based on G. E. Moore’s Principia Ethica. When he wrote it, Russell was, like Moore, a cognitivist in ethics. That is to say, he believed that ethical statements such as “X is good”, express propositions that have truth-value (that is, are either true or false) independent of our opinions and emotions. However, the cognitivist phase of Russell’s thinking did not last long. Soon he moved from ethical cognitivism to ethical non-cognitivism, which denies that ethical statements have truth-value. The change was mainly brought about by Santayana’s criticism of “The Elements” in his book Winds of Doctrine (1913).

An exposition of Russell’s ethical non-cognitivism in its developed form is found in Religion and Science (1935). This was published one year before A. J. Ayer’s Language, Truth and Logic, which was to become the most famous exposition of ethical non-cognitivism in the first half of the twentieth century. There are two aspects of Russell’s ethical ideas as expressed in Religion and Science: (1) that ethical statements are not fact-stating though they seem to be so when expressed in indicative mood, and (2) they are optative or desire expressing.

Russell’s final ethical views are to be found in Human Society in Ethics and Politics (1954), which might be regarded as Russell’s most important ethical writing. In Human Society, Russell adopts as his guiding principle David Hume’s maxim, “Reason is, and ought, only to be the slave of the passions.”

Writings on Ethics
Russell’s Concept of Ethics
Evolution of Russell’s Ethical Ideas
Russell, Ayer and Subsequent Ethics
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Writings on Ethics

Bertrand Russell was a prolific writer. He wrote on different branches of philosophy, including logic, epistemology, metaphysics, ethics, social and political philosophy, philosophy of religion and philosophy of mathematics. His three most important ethical writings are “The Elements of Ethics” (1910), Religion and Science (1935), and Human Society in Ethics and Politics (1954). In “The Elements” Russell expounds an ethics largely based on G. E. Moore’s Principia Ethica. An exposition of Russell’s ethical non-cognitivism in its developed form is found in Religion and Science, whereas Russell’s final ethical views are to be found in Human Society in Ethics and Politics, which might be regarded as his most important ethical writing. Russell had originally intended to include the discussion on ethics in his Human Knowledge, but he decided not to do so because he was uncertain as to the sense in which ethics can be regarded as “knowledge.”

Apart from the works mentioned above, What I Believe (1925), An Outline of Philosophy (1927), “Reply to Criticism” in The Philosophy of Bertrand Russell (1946) and Bertrand Russell Speaks His Mind (1960) contain valuable material on Russell’s ethics.

2. Russell’s Concept of Ethics

Except for a short time as a cognitivist under the influence of G. E. Moore, Russell was consistently an ethical non-cognitivist. That is to say, he did not believe that there is any such thing as objective ethical facts: “When we assert that this or that has ‘value’”, says Russell, “we are giving expression to our own emotions, not to a fact which would still be true if our personal feelings were different.” (Russell 1949, 230-31) This perspective has important implications for his concept of Ethics as a philosophical sub-discipline, and as a purported field of knowledge. In both cases, Russell thinks Ethics fails to qualify.

In his An Outline of Philosophy, Russell begins his discussion of ethics with the following words: “Ethics is traditionally a department of philosophy, and that is my reason for discussing it. I hardly think myself that it ought to be included in the domain of philosophy, but to prove this would take as long as to discuss the subject itself, and would be less interesting.” (180) Russell’s reasons for excluding ethics from the domain of philosophy become clearer in his Religion and Science. Because of his non-cogntivism, Russell thinks that questions as to “values”—that is to say, as to what is good or bad on its own account, independently of its effects—lie outside the domain of science. From this, Russell draws the further conclusion that questions about “values” lie wholly outside the domain of knowledge. And this in turn has implications for the place of Ethics in philosophy.

Russell regarded philosophy as a kind of incomplete science, a search for certainty in the sphere where certain knowledge is not yet achieved but remains possible. However, since Russell rejects the existence of ethics facts, ethical knowledge (certain or otherwise) is not even possible. Therefore, while Russell regarded the argument proving the impossibility of ethical knowledge as part of philosophy, normative theory—the traditional business of philosophical ethics—was excluded from philosophy proper. Thus, although Russell originally intended to include his Human Society in Ethics and Politics in his book Human Knowledge, as he says in the preface to the former, he decided not to do so because he was uncertain as to the sense in which ethics can be regarded as “knowledge.”

In his “Reply to Criticism” in The Philosophy of Bertrand Russell, Russell reaffirms this view, repeating that he would like to exclude all value judgments from philosophy “except that this would be too violent a breach with usage, ” (719), and insisting that the only matter concerned with ethics that can be “properly” regarded as belonging to philosophy is the argument that ethical propositions should be expressed in optative mood, not in the indicative.

3. Evolution of Russell’s Ethical Ideas

The main shift in his ethical thinking was from ethical cognitivism (similar to G. E. Moore) to non-cognitivism (similar to Ayer), but Russell’s ethical ideas did not remain the same throughout his philosophical career.

a. Adolescent View

In his youth, Russell took the utilitarian view that the “happiness of mankind should be the aim of all actions” (Russell 1978, 39) to be so obviously true that he was surprised to find, upon entering Cambridge, that there were alternative ethical theories. At this stage, he took “the greatest happiness of the greatest number” as his ideal.

Russell moved away from his youthful utilitarianism because of what he calls “moral experience.” (Russell 1978, 161)

According to Russell, circumstances are apt to generate perfectly concrete moral convictions, and it is often impossible to judge beforehand what one’s moral opinion of a fact will be.

In a letter written to Gilbert Murray in 1902, Russell says, “what first turned me away from utilitarinism was the persuasion that I myself ought to pursue philosophy, although I had (and have still) no doubt that by doing economics and the theory of politics I could add more to human happiness.” It appeared to Russell that the dignity of which human existence is capable is not attainable by “devotion to the mechanism of life”, and that unless the contemplation of “eternal things” is preserved, humankind will become “no better than well-fed pigs.” However, Russell did not believe that such contemplation overall tends to happiness. As he says, “it gives moments of delight, but these are outweighed by years of effort and depression.” (Russell 1978, 161)

b. Philosophical Essays

The first mature exposition of Russell’s ethical views is found in “The Elements of Ethics,” an essay in his book Philosophical Essays (1910). In “The Elements” Russell expounds an ethics largely based on G. E. Moore’s Principia Ethica.

He believed that (1) “good” is the most fundamental ethical concept and (2) that “good” is indefinable. He further maintained that we know a priori certain propositions about the kind of things that are good on their own account. In addition, that when we make a statement such as “X is good”, we make a statement like “this table is round”, which is either true or false, and whose truth or falsity is independent of our opinions and emotions. So, at the time of writing “The Elements” Russell was, like Moore, a cognitivist in ethics.

According to Moore, the pleasure of human intercourse and the enjoyment of beautiful objects are the most valuable things we know or imagine. Russell, on the other hand, gives no such list of things which are good in themselves, since he holds that his readers are competent to judge what things are good and what bad.

Roughly speaking, Russell’s conception of “right” in “The Elements” is also the same as that of Moore’s conception of right or duty. Irrespective of details, both Moore and Russell regard consequences or results as of vital importance for judging an action as right or wrong. In other words both are teleologists or consequentialists, like the utilitarians.

Russell, however, also allows for what he calls a “subjective” sense of “right.” According to Russell, if a person asks himself, “what ought I to do?” and then acts on his answer, that is to say, what he or she judges to be right after an appropriate amount of candid thought—the appropriate amount of thought being dependent on the difficulty and importance of the decision—then he may be regarded as acting rightly in the subjective sense, even if his action is not objectively right. An action is called “objectively right” by Russell when “of all that are possible it is the one which will probably have the best results.” Moore, on the other hand, makes no such distinction between right in the subjective sense and right in the objective sense.

c. Transition from Cognitivism to Non-Cognitivism

The cognitivist phase of Russell’s thinking did not last long. Soon he started moving from ethical cognitivism to ethical non-cognitivism. The change was mainly brought about by Santayana’s criticism of Russell’s “The Elements” in the former’s book Winds of Doctrine (1913). The main thrust of Santayana’s criticism was that “good” cannot be totally independent of human interests and feelings; and that propositions about intrinsic goodness—if they can be called propositions at all—cannot be true or false in a manner in which propositions in physical sciences are, because they are not statements about certain objective state of affairs but are only expressions of “preferences we feel.” As he says, “to speak of the truth of an ultimate good would be a false collocation of terms; an ultimate good is chosen, found or aimed at; it is not opined.” (Santayana 1913, 143-44)

Santayana is also at pains to emphasize that “good” cannot be totally independent of human interests and feelings. As he says, “For the human system whiskey is truly more intoxicating than coffee, and the contrary opinion would be an error; but what a strange way of vindicating this real, though relative distinction to insist that whiskey is more intoxicating in itself, without reference to any animal; that it is pervaded, as it were, by an inherent intoxication, and stands dead drunk in its bottle!” (Jager 1972, 473)

Another factor, apart from Santayana’s criticism, which stimulated the change in Russell’s ethical thinking, was the impact of the First World War, which Russell passionately opposed. The war forced him to think afresh on a number of fundamental questions. For instance, Russell was forced to revise his views on human nature. As he says in his Autobiography, in his endeavour to understand popular feelings about war, he arrived at a view of human passions similar to that of psychoanalysts. Russell started believing that fundamental facts “in all ethical questions are feelings”, (Russell 1917, 19) and that impulse has more effect in moulding human lives than conscious purpose.

d. What I Believe

The second published work to discuss Russell’s ethics in some detail is What I Believe (1925). In this small book, included in The Basic Writings of Bertrand Russell, Russell clearly says that ethical disagreements about the good life are amenable to argument only when men differ as to the means to achieve a given end. But when there is a real difference as to ends, no argument is possible. “I cannot, therefore,” says Russell, “prove that my view of the good life is right; I can only state my view, and hope that as many as possible will agree.” (Egner and Dennon 1961, 372)

Russell’s view is that the good life is one inspired by love and guided by knowledge. According to Russell, neither love without knowledge nor knowledge without love can produce a good life; but love is in a sense more fundamental, since it will lead intelligent people to seek knowledge in order to find out how to benefit those whom they love.

Russell clarifies that by “knowledge” he does not mean “ethical knowledge.” (In fact, he did not believe that there is, strictly speaking, any such knowledge.) By “knowledge” Russell means “scientific knowledge and knowledge of particular facts.” (374) He considers such knowledge important, because if we desire to achieve some end, knowledge may show us the means, and this knowledge, according to Russell, may loosely pass as “ethical.” “Given an end to be achieved,” says Russell, “it is a question for science to discover how to achieve it. All moral rules must be tested by examining whether they tend to realize ends that we desire.”(374)

So, Russell is already linking “good” with the desired, a theme to which, as we shall see, he returns again and again. He says emphatically “outside human desires there is no moral standard.” (375)

e. An Outline of Philosophy

In An Outline of Philosophy, Russell approaches the problem of ethics with the question, “What is meant when a person says ‘You ought to do so-and-so’ or ‘ I ought to do so-and-so’?” and gives the reply that “primarily a sentence of this sort has an emotional content”; it means “this is the act towards which I feel the emotion of approval.” However, Russell notes, “we do not wish to leave the matter there; we want to find something more objective and systematic and constant than a personal emotion.” (181)

Russell points out that when the ethical teacher says, “you ought to approve acts of such-and-such kinds,” he generally gives reasons for his view, and proceeds to examine “what sorts of reasons are possible.” (181)

In this context, Russell refers to the utilitarian doctrine that happiness is the good and we ought to act so as to maximize the balance of happiness over unhappiness in the world, and says: “I should not myself regard happiness as an adequate definition of the good, but I should agree that conduct ought to be judged by its consequences.” According to Russell, “right conduct” is not an autonomous concept, but means “conduct calculated to produce desirable results.” This leads him to ask, “How can we discover what constitutes the ends of right conduct?”

At this point Russell, first, refers to the fact that on this issue he earlier held views similar to those of G. E. Moore, which he was led to abandon “partly by Mr. Santayana’s Winds of Doctrine.” And then he declares, “I now think that good and bad are derivative from desire.” He points out that there is a conflict between desires of different men and incompatible desires of the same man and says that good is “mainly a social concept, designed to find an issue from this conflict.”(183-84)

Thus, two things are clear. First, Russell, when he wrote What I Believe and An Outline of Philosophy had ceased to be a cognitivist. Second, he had now started moving towards the view that good was a social concept derived from desire. However, in these two books we find only a rough outline of a new theory that is emerging. We find an exposition of Russell’s non-cognitivism in more developed form in Religion and Science.

f. Religion and Science

An exposition of Russell’s ethical non-cognitivism in its developed form is found in Religion and Science (1935), which was published one year before A. J. Ayer’s exposition of the emotivist theory of ethics in Language, Truth and Logic. Russell retains his view from “The Elements” that defining “good” is the fundamental problem of ethics. According to him, once “good” is defined, the rest of ethics follows: we ought to act in the way we believe most likely to create as much good as possible, and as little of its correlative evil. In other words, once we define “good”, framing of moral rules is a matter for science.

However, Russell argues that when we try to be definite as to what we mean by “good”, we land ourselves in great difficulties, because—unlike with scientific questions—there is no factual evidence about value. Disputants can only appeal to their own emotions, and employ rhetorical devices to rouse similar emotions in others. According to Russell, when we assert that this or that has value, we are giving expression to our emotions, not to a fact which would still be true if our personal feelings were different. When a person says “this is good in itself,” he seems to be making a statement like “this is square” or “this is sweet.” Nevertheless, what he really means, according to Russell, is “I wish everybody to desire this” or “Would that everybody desire this.” (235) The first of these sentences, which may be true or false, does not, says Russell, belong to ethics but to psychology or biography. The second sentence which does belong to ethics, expresses a desire for something, but asserts nothing; and since it asserts nothing it is logically impossible that there should be evidence for or against it, or for it to possess either truth or falsehood.

In sum, there are two main aspects to Russell’s metaethical views in Religion and Science. First, ethical statements are not fact-stating (though they seem to be so when expressed in indicative mood). Second, they are instead optative, or desire-expressing. This link between “good” and desire is already familiar from An Outline of Philosophy. Prima facie, according to Russell, anything we all desire is good and anything we all dread is bad. If we all agreed in our desires, says Russell, the matter could be left there, but in fact, desires of human beings conflict. In this conflict each tries to enlist allies by showing that his own desires harmonize with those of other people. Therefore, ethics, according to Russell, is closely related to politics: it is an attempt to bring the collective desires of group to bear upon individuals and, conversely, it is an attempt by an individual to cause his desires to become those of his group. In this way, according to Russell, ethics contains no statement whether true or false, but consists of desires of a certain general kind, namely, such as are concerned with desires of humankind in general.

g. Human Society in Ethics and Politics

Russell’s final ethical views are to be found in Human Society in Ethics and Politics (1954), which might be regarded as his most important ethical work. As he says in the preface of the Human Society, he originally intended to include the discussion of ethics in his book Human Knowledge, but he decided not to do so, because he was uncertain as to the sense in which ethics can be regarded as “knowledge.” The book, Russell claimed, has two purposes: first, to set forth an undogmatic ethic; and second, to apply this ethic to various current political problems.

Russell adopts as his guiding principle David Hume’s maxim that “Reason is, and ought, only to be the slave of the passions.” According to Russell, desires, emotions or passions are the only possible causes of action. Reason is not a cause of action but only a regulator. “The world that I should wish to see,” says Russell, ‘is one where emotions are strong but not destructive, and where, because they are acknowledged, they lead to no deception either of oneself or of others. Such a world would include love and friendship and the pursuit of art and knowledge.” (11)

In effect, what Russell says in Human Society, is not very different from what he says in Religion and Science; when an ethical disagreement is about means for achieving certain ends, it can be resolved by the use of reason; but when the disagreement is about ends reason is of no help, because what ends we pursue depends ultimately on our desires.

As in Religion and Science, Russell is also at pains to emphasize that our desires are not “irrational” just because we cannot give any reason for them. According to Russell, a desire cannot, in itself, be either rational or irrational. We may desire A because it is a means to B, but in the end, when we have done with mere means we must come to something, which we desire for no reasons. Nevertheless, the desire cannot be called irrational merely because no reasons can be given for feeling it.

However, Russell’s dissatisfaction with his own theory of ethics, which earlier finds an expression in “Reply to Criticism” (1946) reappears in Human Society and we find him wondering once again whether there is such a thing as ethical knowledge. In an important passage he says: “It may be that there is some … way of arriving at objectivity in ethics; if so, since it must involve appeal to the majority, it will take us from personal ethics into the sphere of politics, which is, in fact, very difficult to separate from ethics.”(26-27)

Russell sums up his efforts to arrive at an objective ethics in the following fundamental propositions and definitions:

(1) Surveying the acts which arouse emotions of approval or disapproval, we find that, as a general rule, the acts which are approved of are those believed likely to have, on the balance, effects of certain kinds while opposite effects are expected from acts that are disapproved of.

(2) Effects that lead to approval are defined as “good” and those leading to disapproval are as “bad.”

(3) An act of which, on the available evidence, the effects are likely to be better than those of any other act that is possible in the circumstances, is defined as “right”; any other act is “wrong.” What we “ought” to do is, by definition, the act which is right.

(4) It is right to feel approval of a right act and disapproval of a wrong act. (115-16)

According to Russell, these definitions and propositions, if accepted, provide a coherent body of ethical propositions, which are true (or false) in the same sense as if they were propositions of science. He admits that different societies in different ages have given approval to a wide diversity of acts; but, argues Russell, the difference between ourselves and other ages in these respects is attributable to a difference between our beliefs and theirs as to the effects of actions. Thus, Russell is led to the conclusion that there is more agreement among humankind as to the effects that we should aim than as to the kinds of acts that are approved. “I think”, he says, ” the contention of Henry Sidgwick, that acts which are approved of are those that are likely to bring happiness or pleasure, is, broadly speaking, true.” (117)

If it is admitted, Russell points out, that the great majority of approved acts are such as are believed to have certain effects, and it is found, further, that exceptional acts, which are approved without having this character, tend to be no longer approved when their exceptional character is realized; then it becomes possible, in a certain sense, to speak of ethical error. We may say, according to Russell, that it is “wrong” to approve of such exceptional acts, meaning that such approval does not have the effects which mark the great majority of approved acts.

Although on the above theory, ethics contains statements, which are true or false, and not merely optative or imperative, Russell points out that its basis is still one of emotion and feeling. The emotion of approval is involved in the definition of “right” and “wrong” and the feeling of enjoyment or satisfaction is involved in the definition of “good” or “intrinsic value.” Thus, according to Russell, the appeal upon which we depend for the acceptance of our ethical theory is not the appeal to the facts of perception, but to emotions and feelings, which have given rise to the concepts of “right” and “wrong”, “good” and “bad.”

Interestingly, in his Autobiography, Russell summarizes his conclusion in Human Society in Ethics and Politics in the following manner: “The conclusion that I reach is that ethics is never an independent constituent, but is reducible to politics in the last analysis.” (523) He reiterates that there is no such thing as ethical knowledge, and that “reason is, and ought only to be, the slave of the passions.” An ethical opinion, maintains Russell, can only be defended by an ethical axiom, but if the axiom is not accepted, there is no way of reaching a rational conclusion.

There is, according to Russell, one approximately rational approach to ethics, which he calls “the doctrine of compossibility.” Russell defines “compossible desires” as desires which can be satisfied together, that is, those which do not conflict with one another. According to the doctrine of compossibility, the person who wishes to be happy should try to guide his life by the largest possible set of compossible desires. Similarly, a world in which the aims of different individuals or groups is compossible is likely to be happier than one in which they are conflicting. Therefore, says Russell, it should be part of a wise social system to encourage compossible purposes and discourage conflicting ones, by means of education and social systems designed to this end. However, Russell feels that from a theoretical point of view this doctrine affords no ultimate solution, because it assumes that happiness is better than unhappiness, which, according to him, is an ethical principle incapable of proof.

Two things emerge out of this survey of Russell’s ethical thinking: (i) Russell’s concept of “right” remains largely the same throughout his career, and that concept is, broadly speaking, utilitarian: right action is that action which leads to good results; (ii) though Russell consistently regards “good” as the most fundamental ethical concept, his view of what good is or whether we can know at all what good is changes over time. However, his final ethical views on this issue are much closer to utilitarianism than to any other classical ethical theory, as is shown by his approval of Sidgwick’s contention that “acts which are approved of are those that are likely to bring happiness or pleasure.” In place of classical utilitarianism’s “happiness”, Russell prefers to speak of “satisfaction of desires.” In Human Society itself, for example, Russell defines “good” as “satisfaction of desire.” According to him, this definition is more consonant with the ethical feelings of the majority of humankind than any other theoretically defensible definition.

4. Russell, Ayer and Subsequent Ethics

As we have seen, the main shift in Russell’s ethical thinking was from cognitivism to non-cognitivism. Russell shares this non-cognitivist perspective with ethical thinkers such as A. J. Ayer, C. L. Stevenson, R. M Hare and P. H. Nowell-Smith. The common core of non-cognitivism is the denial that ethical claims have factual contents and corresponding truth-values. However, when non-cogntivists turn from telling us what ethical statements are not to telling us what they are, they frequently differ from one another in many of the details. Russell’s non-cogntivism differs from other versions in several ways.

First, Russell’s positive account of ethical statements focuses mainly on desires. Therefore, his analysis of ethical terms is more appropriately described as optative than, for example, emotive (Ayer, Stevenson) or prescriptive (Hare).

Second, Russell’s optative analysis of ethical terms applies mainly to “good” (as an end), which Russell regarded as the most fundamental ethical term. As far as the analysis of “right” is concerned, Russell was a consequentialist throughout his philosophical career.

Third, Russell shows a greater awareness than many non-cognitivists of his era of the social importance or social function of ethical concepts. For example, he clearly says in An Outline of Philosophy that “good” is mainly a social concept “designed to find an issue” [that is, an outcome, a resolution] from conflict of desires—between desires of different persons, and incompatible desires of the same person. He also adds that the primary use of “good” is to label things we individually desire, but, since language is a social institution, “good” gradually comes to apply to things desired by the whole social group.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Egner, Robert E. and Dennon, Lester E. (ed.), The Basic Writings of Bertrand Russell (New York: Simon and Schuster, 1961)
Russell, Bertrand, An Outline of Philosophy (London: Unwin Paperbacks, 1979)
Russell, Bertrand, Human Society in Ethics and Politics (London: George Allen & Unwin Ltd., 1954)
Russell, Bertrand, Justice in Wartime (Nottingham: Spokesman Books, 1917)
Russell, Bertrand, Philosophical Essays (New York: Simon and Schuster, 1966)
Russell, Bertrand, Religion and Science (London: Oxford University Press, 1949) Russell, Bertrand, Bertrand Russell Speaks His Mind (London: Arthur Barker, 1961)
Russell, Bertrand, The Autobiography of Bertrand Russell (London: Unwin Paperbacks, 1978)

b. Secondary Sources

Ayer, A. J., Language, Truth and Logic (England: Penguin Books Ltd., 1976)
Jager, Ronald, The Development of Bertrand Russell’s Philosophy (London:
George Allen and Unwin, 1972)
Moore, G. E., Principia Ethica (London: Cambridge university Press, 1965)
Nath, Ramendra, The Ethical Philosophy of Bertrand Russell (New York: Vantage Press, 1993)
Pigden, Charles R., Russell on Ethics: Selections from Writings of Bertrand Russell (London and New York: Routledge, 1999)
Potter, Michael K., Bertrand Russell’s Ethics (London and New York: Continuum, 2006)
Santayana, G., Winds of Doctrine (London: J. M. Dent & Sons Ltd. 1913)
Schilpp, Paul Arthur (ed.), The Philosophy of Bertrand Russell (Evaston, Illinois: The Library of Living Philosophers Inc., 1946)

Author Information

Ramendra Nath
Email: ramendra@sancharnet.in
Patna University
India

Margaret Cavendish (1623—1673)

Table of Contents

1. Life and Works

2. Natural Philosophy

a. Materialism

b. Vitalism and the Variability Argument

c. Panpsychism

d. God

3. Political Philosophy

a. Religious Liberty

b. Royalism and Aristocracy

c. Gender

4. References and Further Reading

a. Cavendish’s Works in the 17th Century

b. Modern Editions of Her Works

c. Secondary Literature

Author Information

Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646-1716)

Table of Contents

1. Life and Writings

2. Key Principles

3. Metaphysics

a. Substantial Forms

b. Substance as Complete Concept

c. Causality and Pre-Established Harmony

d. Idealism

e. The Nature of Body

f. Efficient and Final Causality

4. Theodicy

a. Leibniz’s Project

b. God

c. Possible Worlds and Optimism

d. Freedom and Necessity

5. Epistemology

a. Ideas and Knowledge

b. Innate Ideas

c. Petites Perceptions

d. Reflection, Memory, Selfhood

6. Ethics

a. Intellect and Will

b. Justice and Charity

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources: Leibniz Texts and Translations

b. Secondary Sources

i. Introductory Texts

ii. More Advanced Studies

iii. Collected Essays

Author Information

Resource Bounded Agents

Table of Contents

1. Cognitive Limitations and Resource Bounds

a. Limitations of Memory

b. Limitations of Visual Perception

c. Limitations of Attentional Resources

2. Idealization

a. Idealization Strategies

b. Problems with the Idealization Strategy

c. Ought Implies Can

3. Accommodating Cognitive Limitations

a. Changing the Normative Standard

i. Simon’s “Satisficing View” of Decision Making

ii. Pollock’s “Locally Global” View of Planning

iii. Cherniak’s “Minimal Rationality” and “Feasible Inferences”

iv. Gigerenzer’s “Ecological Rationality”

b. Failing to Meet the Standard

i. Kahneman and Tversky’s “Heuristics and Biases” Program

4. References and Further Reading

a. References

b. Further Reading

Author Information

Gender in Chinese Philosophy

Table of Contents

1. Introduction

2. Human Tendencies (Nature) and Gender

3. Gender Cosmology

4. Gender and Social Order

5. Family Patterns

6. Chinese Cultural Resources for Feminism

7. References and Further Reading

Author Information