Augustine (354–430 C.E.)

Augustinus Aurelius Hipponensis (Augustine of Hippo or Saint Augustine) was a Christian church father, bishop, philosopher, and rhetorician whose ideas and writings have exerted enormous influence on Western philosophy and religion. He integrated ideas from Platonic philosophy with Christian theology, using both reason and faith to articulate an ethics for loving God and neighbor. His writings also develop ideas on time, free will, the problem of evil (POE), religious epistemology, social and political theory, and other topics of perennial philosophical interest.

Any attempt to summarize Augustine is necessarily an exercise in leaving something out. One approach is to apply to Augustine an idea he applied to the Bible. With all its immeasurable tracts of information, Augustine thinks two things summarize everything the Bible teaches: the love of God and neighbor. His thoughts may also be summarized in terms of his efforts to promote the love of God and neighbor.

This article begins with a survey of Augustine’s life and writings. Next, the article considers his relationship to earlier philosophy and to Platonic philosophy in particular; provides an overview of his teachings on love and desire; and then considers a selection of his influential ideas on religious epistemology, the POE, political philosophy, divine timelessness, Trinitarianism, Christ and church, free will and predestination, and how to read the Bible.

Table of Contents

1. Augustine’s Life and Works
   1. From Augustine’s Birth to His Mother’s Death
   2. From His Mother’s Death to His Ordination as Bishop
   3. Ecclesial Ministry and Writings
2. Augustine and Platonism (and Other Philosophers)
3. Love and Desire
   1. A Rich Vocabulary
   2. The Ordo Amoris in Augustine’s Writings
   3. The Ordo Amoris: Creation, Fall, and Redemption
4. Augustine’s Enduring Ideas
   1. Religious Epistemology
   2. The Problem of Evil
   3. Political Philosophy
   4. Divine Timelessness
   5. Trinitarianism
   6. Christ and Church
   7. Free Will and Predestination
   8. How to Read the Bible
5. The Future of Augustine
6. Conclusion
7. References and Further Reading
   1. Primary Sources
   2. General Books and Introductions
   3. The Modern Debate on Augustine’s Relation to Neoplatonism
   4. Studies on Augustine’s Theology

1. Augustine’s Life and Works

Augustine was a massively prolific writer whose life and writings go hand-in-hand; he is highly unusual among ancient thinkers in terms of how much has been preserved both from and about him. His own Confessiones (Confessions) is the most important source on his life, to which the Life of Saint Augustine by his follower and friend Possidius is a close second. Augustine’s other writings provide a good deal of information as well. One of his books introduces most of the other books, including some observations on the time and purposes of their writing. This is the Retractiones (Retractions), a Latin title better translated as “Reconsiderations.” (Retractiones summarizes, chronicles, and reconsiders much of Augustine’s books, but does not retract very much.) It is an invaluable resource for Augustine scholars, although it does not introduce his extensive sermons and letters. The classic biography by Peter Brown [1967] (2000) and other modern biographies are referenced in section 7b.

a. From Augustine’s Birth to His Mother’s Death

Augustine’s mother Monica was married to Patricius (Patrick), a man of Italian descent. Patrick and Monica’s home was Thagaste, a city in Roman North Africa (now Algeria). They had second son named Navigius, and one daughter. Augustine’s sister lived a pious life, as recorded by Possidius, although he does not give us her name.

Monica was a very pious Christian woman; Patrick was an adulterer with an anger problem. Patrick eventually became a Christian (largely through the prayers and piety of his wife), but it was Monica who exerted the stronger religious influence on Augustine. Although he was raised on Christian teachings from infancy, he was not baptized.

Augustine was a bright child and received the finest education available. The classical education system employed the Trivium (the threefold way) consisting of grammar (the study of language), dialectic (or logic), and rhetoric. Rhetoric was more than a way for sleazy lawyers and politicians to fleece people. Although it could be used to such ends, as Augustine was well aware, it was also an important part of honest law and statesmanship. Rhetoric also involved making tricky topics simple, making the truth look good, and careful interpretation of texts. See sources such as Kolbet (2010) and Cameron (2012, chap. 2) for a fuller introduction to classical rhetoric. Young Augustine excelled in the study of Latin works such as Virgil’s Aeneid and in rhetoric. In the Confessiones, the mature Bishop Augustine carefully explains what he thinks was good about his education, and rather a lot of bad. (Being able to count, write, and speak—good. Caring more about failing to pronounce the H in homo/hominis (man or human being) than about hating a particular human being—bad.)

Augustine gives a moving account of the many sins of his youth. The most repeated and obvious sin is fornication, and he hints (3.3.5) of at least one act that was particularly egregious. Yet in Book II of Confessiones, Augustine primarily focuses his attention on the theft of pears—not on fornication. Why? Because Augustine’s theft ties his sin to that of Adam and Eve in Genesis 3; he was participating willfully in the common sin of all humanity. Augustine describes how he and some friends late at night robbed a neighbor’s pear tree, taking away many pears but eating few. He analyzes at length the motives and nature of this sin. Sin, he explains, is a disordered love of lesser goods. The pears were good, and in any act of sin a sinner is pursuing some good thing; the problem arises when lesser goods are pursued with a desire fit only for greater ones.

His sins continued when he came to the larger and more sophisticated Carthage—the Roman Carthage established after the Punic wars. His first stint in Carthage was during his last few teenage years as a student. After that he returned for a while to Thagaste, where he worked as a teacher of rhetoric. He then took up a more prominent position as a teacher of rhetoric in Carthage—he was now a man with a profession, living in a city rife with sin—in his later telling of the story. Augustine took a mistress—or if you like, a concubine or common-law wife—to whom he was faithful as long as they were together. She bore their son Adeodatus, a promising young man who died young, but lived long enough to be baptized with his father, and to be featured as Augustine’s interlocutor in his book De magistro (On the Teacher). This woman was later sent away (a decision in which Monica seems to have been involved) to make room for Augustine to have a proper marriage, leaving Augustine heartbroken.

While at Carthage during his student years, young Augustine read the Hortensius of Cicero as part of the normal course of study in rhetoric. Cicero was a great rhetorician and (at some risk of oversimplification) the founder of Roman philosophy. Hortensius was an exhortation to philosophy, and this book converted Augustine: From then on, he was a seeker of wisdom.

Having been familiar with Christian concepts from birth, Augustine immediately proceeded to seek the true religion, which he was persuaded would be that of Jesus. However, when he read the Bible, he was turned off by its lowly language, quite the opposite of Cicero’s magnificence. He turned away from the Scriptures and joined the Manicheans—a religious tradition that was, to Augustine’s later mind, a heresy. The Manicheans claimed to be the true followers of Jesus and spoke constantly of Jesus and the Holy Spirit. At the same time, the Manicheans rejected the Old Testament and considered the God of the Old Testament to be evil—a different God from the God of the New Testament. Manicheanism, in its dualism, was much like another dualistic religious tradition that had influenced it—Zoroastrianism. In Manicheanism as in Zoroastrianism, the good and the evil supernatural powers are on roughly equal terms; evil is a substance opposed to the good. Manicheanism also held that matter is bad, the work of the evil creator God of the Old Testament. The reader may consider Augustine’s polemical account of Manicheanism alongside modern scholarship such as Cameron (2012, 100-109). Gnosticism, another early church heresy, was also an influence on Augustine.

Manicheanism’s goal was to free souls from matter; ironically, it had an unvaryingly materialistic way of thinking. Its goal was to avoid the evils of the body, but it tended to encourage sensual behavior. Yet it had a sophisticated air of cleverness and wisdom—a religion fit for intellectuals, not suitable for the uneducated populace in the catholica ecclesia (the Augustinian language for the universal or Catholic church). This was enough to seduce Augustine, and he remained a Manichean for about nine years.

During that time his mother continued to pray for his conversion to the true faith. Her tearful prayers, a bishop assured her, would not fail. Augustine’s career as a rhetorician continued to rise. He moved to Italy where he began attending the sermons of Bishop Ambrose of Milan to hear his rhetoric—but the teachings of Ambrose began to work their way into Augustine’s soul. Between his mother, Ambrose, some friends, a kind and wise old priest named Simplicianus, and other healing influences, he began to recognize the errors of the Manicheans and to respect orthodox Christianity. He abandoned Manicheanism; for a while he thought highly of the Academics, a skeptical school of philosophy of which Cicero had been a member.

Augustine, in his journey towards orthodox Christianity, still needed to overcome two obstacles.

First, he needed a better understanding of metaphysics. He could not understand evil. The POE had long kept Augustine back from orthodox Christianity and had motivated his agreement with the Manicheans, whose theology was designed to better explain evil. In addition, he could not think of God in any way other than according to materialistic concepts. Augustine needed the ability to comprehend non-physical reality and to think of God in these terms. He also needed to learn to think of evil as the result of the free choice of created beings, not in the Manichean way as some sort of substance opposed to God. Evil is better thought of as a lack, as an absence of good. Above all, what solved this problem for Augustine was Platonic philosophy. He was able to acquire books of the Platonists translated into Latin. These were (most scholars agree) some translations of Plotinus’ Enneads. The idea of non-physical reality in Platonic philosophy gave him what he needed, and his philosophical worries faded away. He experienced a vision of divinity, ascending in the Platonist style to the contemplation of ultimate reality (Confessiones 7.15.21-17.23). Scholars are drawn to this passage for the interaction of Christian and Neoplatonic ideas, considering it in light of Augustine’s remarks on how the Platonists did not have the doctrine that God became man (7.18.24-21.27), and in light of Augustine’s description of the spiritual experience he shared with Monica, as described later in the narrative.

Augustine needed a clear mind, and Platonic philosophy was able to clear it. But more importantly, he needed a clean heart. At this point there was very little keeping him back from Christianity except his own sin, and particularly his longstanding sex addiction. Book VIII of Confessiones movingly describes several things that led up to the pivotal moment, including several stories of sinners who had converted before him. These stories were placed by God in his life now that he might imitate them—such as the story of Saint Antony.

The moment comes one day in a garden in Milan around August of 386 C.E., when Augustine and his dear friend Alypius (a former student) find the ability to turn from sin to following Jesus, guided by his church. Augustine knows that he should become a Christian but is unable to—his sinful will was unwilling to submit to the right way. Ravaged by inward strife, he dramatically asks Alypius why they hold back while unlearned converts go before them, storming the gates of heaven. Quite overcome with emotion, he rushes out into the garden, followed by Alypius. There Augustine gives full vent to the struggle within. Shortly he leaves Alypius, goes a little way off, and flings himself down under a fig tree. After an emotional prayer and more tears, he hears the voice of a child chanting “tolle lege, tolle lege” (take and read, take and read). Unable to remember hearing such a chant, he accepts it as a heavenly command, remembering how Antony’s life had been changed by a single line of Scripture that had seemed addressed to him. Augustine returns to Alypius and picks up the book he had left there—some writings of Paul. He reads the first lines on which his eyes light, from Romans 13. As the King James Version translates Paul, “not in rioting and drunkenness, not in chambering and wantonness, not in strife and envying. But put ye on the Lord Jesus Christ, and make not provision for the flesh, to fulfil the lusts thereof.”

This biblical command finally changes his heart. At that moment all the darknesses (tenebra) of doubt or, better yet, of wavering (dubitatio/dubitationis) flee. From that moment, he is converted, and with him Alypius, who reads a little further and finds a line in Romans 14 which has a similar effect on him. They have now turned to Christ. This does not necessarily make Augustine fully a Christian; in his own way of thinking, that would require baptism, the final step of entering the church.

Baptism becomes a certainty for Augustine, Alypius, and Adeodatus, although according to the church’s custom, it would have to wait until Easter. But Augustine wastes no time reorganizing his life around following Jesus Christ. He resigns from his position as a teacher of rhetoric—a corrupt seller of words. He renounces sex, and retires with Monica, Adeodatus, Alypius, and some other friends to the country estate of his friend Verecundus, located near Milan at a place called Cassiciacum.

In Cassiciacum, Augustine’s career as a Christian philosopher and a theologian, or at least a theologian-in-training, began in earnest; he wrote his first Christian—and his first surviving—writings, known as the Cassiciacum dialogues. (During his years of wandering he had written a short book, De pulchro et apto (On the Beautiful and the Fitting), which was later lost.) The dialogues are four: Contra Academicos (Against the Academics), De beata vita (On the Happy Life), De ordine (On Order), and Soliloquia (Soliloquies). The first of these critiques the Academic skeptics, arguing that it is possible for human beings to gain wisdom. The ultimate point in favor of this possibility is the Incarnation: Jesus, the divine wisdom of God, has come to us. The second investigates Christian ethics, talking about the love of God and promoting faith, hope, and charity. The third tackles the nature of order and the POE, giving some basic Christian principles for thinking through these topics, and laying out a path of ascent towards greater wisdom. The fourth is a remarkable conversation between Augustine and his own reason, considering the lofty matter of the relationship between God and the soul.

Augustine was duly baptized (with Alypius and Adeodatus) by Ambrose on Easter of 387 C.E. Then, very shortly before Monica’s death, Augustine and Monica shared a spiritual experience in the town of Ostia, on their way back to Africa. Their souls were lifted up together to God. Monica then died fulfilled—anticipating the resurrection. At this point, the narrative in the Confessiones ends with Book IX; in the remaining four books, Augustine confesses his ongoing sins and considers other matters.

b. From His Mother’s Death to His Ordination as Bishop

Augustine and the others proceeded to Africa. There Augustine took up a monkish life, leading a small community of Christian men in the pursuit of wisdom. This phase of his life lasted about three years. From the tail end of his time in Italy through the early years back in Africa, he wrote a number of books defending and articulating Christianity, working on the ascent to a better knowledge of God, and critiquing Manicheanism. Among the scholarly works relevant to these early days are Kevane (1954) and Topping (2012) on Augustine’s development of a new Christian philosophy of education, Kolbet (2010) on Augustine’s ethics and his efforts to purify and redirect the art of rhetoric, and Cameron (2012) on his biblical hermeneutics.

One project during this phase of his life was never completed—a series of books on the liberal disciplines: grammar, logic, rhetoric, geometry, arithmetic, music, and philosophy. Following up on themes from the Cassiciacum dialogues, these books were meant to help those who strove to ascend by degrees to knowledge of non-physical reality.

Several related projects in this era are something like sequels to Soliloquia. De immortalitate animae (On the Immortality of the Soul) continued Soliloquies by studying the immateriality and immortality of the soul. De quantitate animae (On the Greatness of the Soul) was an effort to understand the soul and its greatness in non-physical terms. (The Latin quantitas/quantitatis can mean either greatness or magnitude; the soul has the former without the latter.) De magistro (On the Teacher) is a remarkable dialogue between Augustine and Adeodatus in which Augustine gives an early account of his view of illumination, an important idea in his religious epistemology. He explains that we cannot learn anything through signs without already knowing what is signified; this suggests the skeptical conclusion that learning anything is impossible, since all learning seems to rely on signs. Illumination, the action of God to produce knowledge in our souls, is the solution to this problem.

De vera religione (On True Religion) is a sequel to Contra Academicos. It defends the superiority of the orthodox church against the Manicheans and argues that Christianity meets the best standards of rationality—those exemplified by Platonic philosophy. De moribus ecclesiae Catholicae (On the Morals of the Catholic Church) and De moribus Manichaeorum (On the Morals of the Manicheans) explain that orthodox Christianity’s teachings and practices are far more successful than Manicheanism at controlling sensual appetites. De libero arbitrio voluntatis (On the Free Choice of the Will), begun at this time but completed some years later, explains the temporal origin of evil in free will. The Manicheans had wielded the POE against Christianity, but Augustine explains that they got it badly wrong by describing evil as a nature in itself—rather than a result of free choice by a nature created good by God.

Augustine treasured the relative freedom of his scholarly religious life. He knew that if he were to be ordained a shepherd in the church there would be many pressing and wearying responsibilities, including the obligations he would assume as a teacher in the church (mindful perhaps of James 3:1, a passage to which he refers in the introduction to Retractiones). He also knew that many churches would be interested in ordaining a religious scholar. Accordingly, he avoided visiting any churches that he knew needed a bishop. Unbeknownst to Augustine, the elderly Bishop Valerius of the city of Hippo had been looking for an assistant, particularly one more skilled at Latin than he. (Valerius’ native tongue was Greek.) One day, Valerius exhorted his flock to find someone to help him. They seized Augustine, who was unwarily in their midst at the time. Augustine was ordained a priest under Bishop Valerius, to the joy of Valerius and his church but against Augustine’s tears. The crowd, Possidius explains, misunderstood his weeping; they thought he wanted higher honors—not realizing he was not after any honors at all. This ordination was according to the custom of the early church. (Ambrose himself had been ordained bishop of Milan, contrary to his own plans for the day, at the demands of a churchly crowd—but that is another story.)

Thus, Augustine’s precautions failed, and this phase of his life ended. But he shouldered his new responsibilities, establishing a monastery near the church and taking precautions against his own inadequacies. Valerius was amenable to giving Augustine space to study the Scriptures in preparation for this lifetime appointment of preaching responsibilities. Augustine’s request to Valerius for this opportunity is found in Epistula (Letter) 21. Valerius supported Augustine as priest preaching when his own bishop was present (contrary to the custom of the North African churches but consistent with the practices of the Eastern churches).

After having Augustine ordained as priest, Valerius was still concerned that some other church might snatch him up as their bishop. Possidius reports that Valerius managed to hide Augustine on one occasion when another church sent emissaries for that very purpose. Valerius then secretly arranged to have Augustine ordained as co-bishop at Hippo while he, Valerius, still lived. Once again, Augustine was not pleased with this plan. (Possidius records how he later found solid churchly grounds for opposing such moves.) Once again, the church members were enthusiastic, and once again, Augustine was ordained. He was now a bishop of Hippo, and after the death of Valerius he was the bishop of Hippo—stuck with the name by which history has known him—Augustinus Hipponensis (Augustine of Hippo).

c. Ecclesial Ministry and Writings

Augustine’s writings as a priest and then as a bishop were voluminous. A few highlights are considered below.

First, he continued his critiques of the Manicheans and his other works of Christian apologetics. De natura boni (On the Nature of Good) clarifies the distinction between good and evil, explaining how goodness is built into the structure of reality, and that evil is not a thing in itself but only a corruption of a thing. He also held a famous debate with Fortunatus, a Manichean priest, the contents of which are preserved in Disputatio contra Fortunatum Manichaeum (Debate against Fortunatus the Manichean). De utilitate credendi (On the Profit of Believing) explains the necessity of trust or faith (fides/fidei), and defends the rationality of trusting in Jesus Christ, the Bible, and the church. This is also an anti-Manichean book, addressed to Honoratus, whom Augustine himself had led into Manicheanism, whom he is now trying to lead out of it.

Second, Augustine wrote a book on how a preacher should handle the word of God. De doctrina christiana (On Teaching Christianity) explains that the Bible teaches the Trinity—Father, Son, and Holy Spirit—as what we must love above all, the reality without reference to which nothing else should be loved. It also teaches that human beings are to be loved above all else other than God. Augustine further explains that ambiguous passages in the Bible are to be interpreted by these clear teachings. He expounds various principles of biblical interpretation and explains the right uses of secular learning and of rhetoric in the context of a correct understanding of, and faithfulness to, Scripture.

Third, Augustine wrote his masterpiece: Confessiones. Confessiones is thirteen books long; the first nine are autobiographical. There is a rich scholarly literature on how the first nine and the last four books are combined into a single whole. Augustine’s Confessiones considers many things, but confession is the guiding theme that ties everything together. Confession means two things—or one thing with two aspects. A line from one of his sermons on the Psalms (Enarrationes in Psalmos 29 2, 19) explains “confessio gemina est, aut peccati aut laudis” (confession is twofold, either of sin or of praise). Augustine pictures the church moving towards a final heavenly state of pure praise (103 4, 18). For now, both forms of confession are essential, and are not separate. For the Christian, the confession of sin is tied to a celebration of redemption along the lines of “this, Lord, is my sin, from which you have gloriously redeemed me!” This is the model of confessing used in Confessiones, and Augustine wants his readers to practice it themselves.

However, it is also a corporate act for the whole church. Book XIII of Confessiones is helpful in clarifying this; we are to praise God for his mighty acts of redemption for his people, for his creation of the church, and for his continually purifying it and leading it onward to completion. Augustine famously recounts these insights through an allegorical reading of the first chapter of Genesis. (This is not a rejection of literal readings; section 4 h. discusses Augustine’s approach to biblical interpretation.) Augustine reads the creation narrative of Genesis 1 as describing God’s redemption of the church. This is an important clue on the unity of the Confessiones: The biblical commentary at the end reframes the autobiographical books. Augustine’s personal redemption narrative is a part of the church’s redemption narrative and is to be understood in terms of biblical teachings.

Fourth, Augustine wrote a good deal as a result of his involvement in churchly controversies. Besides his critiques of the Manicheans, there were two other major issues.

One was Donatism. This was a schismatic church in North Africa, quite powerful in Augustine’s day. Donatism had emerged as a separate church from the catholica (universal or Catholic) church as a result of a controversy rooted in the Roman persecution of Christians in the early 300s C.E. Some churchmen yielded but later returned to the fold. The Donatists held that any such church leader was ineligible to pass on his authority, or even to administer baptism, and they set up a parallel church built on those who had not yielded. One hallmark of their theology is that they thought the true church can only be a pure church, led by pure leaders. One hallmark of their ecclesial practice was that they did not recognize baptisms administered by the catholica church. Their custom was to rebaptize converts. Meanwhile, the catholica church did not rebaptize converts from Donatism. Augustine’s sometimes polemical accounts of Donatism can be considered alongside modern scholarship.

Augustine’s position as a leader in the catholica church made him an active participant in this controversy, and he played his role vigorously. That role was somewhat complicated, as was the whole situation with the Donatists. The schism was essentially a theological matter, but it had its cultural and political aspects. (Christians living in more rural areas or speaking Punic were more likely to be Donatists.) One particularly vexing complication was the Circumcellions, a more extremist and sometimes violent movement associated with the Donatists. Augustine would call the Donatists schismatics (for example, in De vera religione 5.9) or heretics (Enarrationes en Psalmos 18 2, 6)—and explain to a Donatist teacher, in Book II of Contra Cresconium grammaticum Donatistam (Against Cresconius the Donatist Grammarian), how a longstanding schism can become a heresy . He would plead tenderly for their reconciliation to the universal church or call for gentle persuasion (Enarrationes en Psalmos 32 3, 29 or 33 2, 7), and he could learn from the Donatist theologian Tyconius, cited in De doctrina christiana. Augustine could also endorse government force, particularly in response to the Circumcellions. (For introductions to some of these matters, consider Brown [1967] (2000), chaps. 19–21) or Harrison (2000, 145–57).)

Augustine agreed with the Donatists on the purity that should mark the church, but he thought it possible, and in fact true, that the church was not pure—at least not yet. In the fullness of time, God would surely purify his whole church. In the meantime, she is to be loved and honored as the bride of Christ. She must be understood to be universal. Psalm 21 (in the Greek Septuagint numbering used by Augustine, but Psalm 22 in the modern numbering based on the Hebrew Masoretic text) teaches that the whole world will come over to Christ, but the Donatists think his true church occupies Africa only (Enarrationes en Psalmos 21 2, 8). It is sinful pride to trust in human righteousness rather than in Christ himself (10). The unity of the church is paramount. A Christian is obligated to love the church and her unity.

Augustine wrote a number of texts against the Donatists. In one unusual work, he wrote a song (297 lines long) critiquing Donatism so uneducated churchgoers could more easily understand and remember what was wrong with the schism. This was Psalmus contra partem Donati (A Psalm against the Sect of Donatus). Both sides loved Cyprian of Carthage, the great martyred leader of Africa’s church from an earlier generation. Augustine’s De baptismo contra Donatistas (On Baptism, against the Donatists) argues at length that the teachings and actions of Cyprian weigh solidly against the schism. In Contra litteras Petiliani (Against the Letters of Petilian) he responded to the writings of the Donatist bishop Petilian. When the Donatists themselves were torn by a secondary schism, the Maximianists, Augustine used the terms of their own disagreement with the Maximianists to argue against their departure from the catholica church. This occurred in multiple writings including Enarrationes in Psalmos 36 2, 20; Admonitio Donatistarum de Maximianistis (Admonition to the Donatists, Concerning the Maximianists); De Maximianistis contra Donatistas (On the Maximianists against the Donatists); and Contra Cresconium grammaticum et Donatistam (Against Cresconius the Grammarian and Donatist). Augustine also critiqued the Donatists extensively in his sermons. Ployd (2015) is one helpful source on these writings.

Another controversy was Pelagianism. Pelagius, a British theologian, differed from Augustine on the ability human beings still have, after Adam’s sin, to do good. Augustine had been closely involved in one part of the backstory to the Pelagian movement—the dispute between orthodoxy and the Manicheans on the origin of evil. Augustine in earlier years had written extensively on the reality and importance of free will and had devoted himself to a project of moral improvement. It would be easy to think that he believed that human beings have sufficient free will to do good in this life. The Pelagians thought so, and they seem to have thought that Augustine did as well. The spread of their teachings required Augustine to clarify (or some say, to change) his views. Augustine argued at length that, as Charles Spurgeon (1886) would describe a related theology centuries later, salvation is “all of grace.” Each sinful human being is implicated in the sin of Adam and has inherited from him both guilt and a tendency to keep on sinning through concupiscentia (disordered desire out of the control of reason). This is why it is important to baptize infants to expunge that guilt, and to be constantly seeking God’s help in overcoming concupiscentia. The upshot is: Human beings certainly do not have the kind of free will which the Pelagians say they do. (See, for example, Augustine’s clarification in Retractiones 1.14 of the ideas considered in his earlier book De duabus animabus (On Two Souls).)

Augustine sparred with the teachings of Pelagius and, more importantly, with his followers Julian of Eclanum and Caelestius. Augustine was ultimately influential in having Pelagianism decreed a heresy. Various later writings, including the sermons, critiqued Pelagianism. In De gestis Pelagii (On the Proceedings of Pelagius), he responded to the records of a church council in Palestine. This council had acquitted Pelagius, who had denounced the doctrines attributed to him, and Augustine makes much of the fact that the doctrines themselves were condemned, also critiquing the details of Pelagius’ response. In De gratia Christi et de peccato originali (On the Grace of Christ and on Original Sin), Augustine argues that Pelagius contradicts Paul when, in his account of grace, he fails to recognize that human beings need God’s help to convert our very wills to the good, and argues also that Ambrose, praised by Pelagius, is not on Pelagius’ side. In De natura et gratia (On Nature and Grace), he responds to a book of Pelagius, arguing that human nature was created wholly good but was corrupted by the freely chosen sin of Adam in such a way that human beings are no longer able not to sin; if human beings could be saved by their own efforts, the Bible would not teach that faith is necessary for salvation. Only the freely given grace of God can restore the ruined human ability to love and obey God. Pelagius’ mistake was to deny that human nature has been corrupted by sin. In this critique of Pelagius, Augustine emphasizes the same teachings he had wielded against the Manicheans—that evil is not a nature in itself but corruption of a thing which is, in its created nature, good. (Pelagius did not deny that what God created is good, but Augustine did think that he failed to understand how human nature can be corrupted by evil.) Contra Iulianum (Against Julian) is a six-book work responding to four books of Julian. Augustine claims that earlier church fathers such as Cyprian and Ambrose are on his side and defends himself from accusations of resemblance to the Manicheans. He even argues that Julian gives unwitting support to the Manicheans, because Julian thinks that a human being is not born with a corrupted nature. If he was, then marriage would have to be condemned as an evil—for, as Jesus says, a good tree does not bear bad fruit—but marriage is good, so we should not think that babies are born sinners unable to do good. Augustine argues in response that the Pelagians, in denying that evil can come from something good, have supported the Manichean view that evil comes from an evil nature opposed to God. He explains that evil, while it cannot be caused by God, can be caused by lesser, changeable goods created by God—in particular, by rational finite beings with free will. There was also another six-book response to Julian, a later book which was not completed—Augustine’s Opus imperfectum contra Iulianum (Uncompleted Work Against Julian). The reader may consider Augustine’s polemical account of Pelagianism alongside modern scholarship.

Fifth, Augustine wrote De trinitate (On the Trinity). This work was many years in the making and could easily be many years in the studying. Before he was finished, someone stole some portions of the book from him. He was then compelled to finish the whole thing by requests from ecclesiastical brethren, especially from Aurelius, bishop of Carthage, Augustine’s superior in the church. Like the portions of the book itself when it was stolen, incomplete information about De trinitate has outspread a more complete understanding. It is widely known that Augustine is trying to make some sense of the Trinity, and that he develops certain psychological analogies for the Trinity. The number of analogies, the classification of them, and the subtlety of the analogies all call for careful study. (Memory, understanding, and will make one analogy; another analogy is the one loving, that which is loved, and the love itself.) However, an Augustinian analogy for the Trinity may not be quite what the contemporary reader thinks of when encountering a phrase like “analogy for the Trinity.” At some risk of oversimplification, De trinitate can be understood as no more (and no less) than an attempt to understand God in part. This involves an attempt to grow in understanding while recognizing that we can only ever hope to know in part. This partial understanding focuses on the traces of the Trinity that we can find in humanity—using the Latin vestigium (sign or trace) (11.1.1) or indicium (indication or evidence) (15.2.3). (For example, human memory, intellect, and will are together a trace of the Trinity.) We should not question the Trinitarian doctrine (15.6.9), but it is worthwhile to add understanding to faith, although we are still left seeing through a glass darky (15.8.14-15.9.16).

Sixth, Augustine addressed the decline of Roman civilization, particularly after Rome was sacked by Alaric. Although Christianity was at this time mainstream, classical paganism was still around, and these polytheists blamed the Christians for the disaster. Augustine spent years replying, and the result was his great work De civitate dei (On the City of God). In its twenty-two books Augustine refutes polytheistic paganism, explains that evils such as those recently experienced by Rome are normal in human affairs, and explains the Christian view of society. De civitate dei is vast in scope. It argues that the success of Rome had not been the result of its faithfulness to pagan gods. It offers Augustine’s own philosophy of history and his social and political philosophy—in fact, a statement of the entire Christian worldview. But what is the “City of God” and its antonym the “City of Man”? These concepts are discussed in due time.

Seventh, of course, Augustine wrote the Retractiones themselves, the detailed review and critique of most of his writings.

Eighth, throughout this long career Augustine wrote a great many letters and sermons, a vast number of which have been preserved. Scholars over the centuries have passed them down in an orderly form. In new English translations by New City Press, they occupy about forty-seven volumes as of the year 2026. Augustine’s sermons can be categorized by the time of their delivery (when available), by their themes (anti-Donatist or anti-Pelagian sermons, for example), or by biblical passages. There are sermons on liturgical occasions—sermons on the Passover, on the Ascension, and so on. There are sermons on books of the Old Testament. There are sermons on books of the New Testament, including a famous series on the writings of John.

The Enarrationes in Psalmos (Expositions on the Psalms) are an interesting case. In Latin, an enarratio/enarrationis is an exposition or an interpretation. The name fits but does not come directly from Augustine; Erasmus gave these writings their name much later. Augustine’s enarrationes can be categorized as sermons, and most are. But some are mere commentaries on a Psalm, or perhaps undelivered sermon outlines. There are more than 200 enarrationes. One important aspect of the enarrationes is their heavy reliance on the idea of the totus Christus (the whole Christ), both head and body, both Jesus the Messiah and his church (on which more below in 4f.).

Augustine spent his final days in Hippo as it lay under siege by the Vandals. Augustine and his comrades lamented and prayed. Possidius makes a point of relaying one of Augustine’s last letters, in which he advised Bishop Honoratus what pastors should do when an invading army is nigh. He gives guidance on circumstances when it is appropriate to flee—but emphasizes the importance of not abandoning the flock; when some must remain behind and risk destruction, bishops and priests should remain with them to tend to their spiritual needs.

Augustine continued to preach vigorously until his final illness, three months into the siege. At the end he devoted himself to constant prayer and repentance, focusing especially on penitential Psalms. After about ten days of this lifestyle, Augustine died in the presence of Possidius and other brethren.

In terms of Augustine’s theology, the influence of his ideas, and his writings, his time was only beginning.

2. Augustine and Platonism (and Other Philosophers)

Augustine studied, directly or indirectly, many philosophers. A major source for him was Cicero, who had largely been responsible for the establishment of philosophy as a Roman pursuit conducted in Latin, not merely a Greek pursuit conducted in Greek. In Cicero’s books, Augustine studied the history of philosophy, and Cicero’s interpretation of philosophy’s grand debates between the Epicureans, Stoics, Aristotelians, and the Academic skeptics. Augustine also read the Platonists Plotinus and Porphyry, as well as Varro. It is difficult to prove with certainty which books of the philosophers he read, but it is reasonable to suppose that other primary sources were among them such as the writings of Seneca and Lucretius. Many of Augustine’s writings address the philosophers, such as the Cassiciacum dialogues and Book XIX of De civitate dei. In Epistula 118 he explains that the Stoics did better than the Epicureans in recognizing that the summum bonum (highest good) is not pleasure but virtue, and is located not in the body but in the soul—however, the Platonists outdid the Stoics in recognizing a greater good above the soul, and even the Platonists fall short of the Gospel.

Philosophical influences on Augustine and his interactions with them is an enormous field of study. An essential topic for understanding Augustine’s life, his writings, and Augustinian scholarship is his relation to Neoplatonism. This section considers that relationship, its philosophical and theological importance, and questions it raises about Augustine’s thought.

The main idea of Plato’s philosophy was that non-physical reality exists and is superior to physical reality. The soul is a non-physical thing and finds its fulfillment in knowing and enjoying higher, non-physical reality. Plato’s ideas were developed by later philosophers, particularly the tradition known as Neoplatonism. Chief among them are Plotinus and his follower and biographer, Porphyry. In De civitate dei Book X, Porphyry comes in for some heavy criticism by Augustine for his support of the worship of the gods, whom Augustine identifies as demonic spirits (the rebellious angels). Plotinus is not above criticism either (chap. 30).

Plotinus is the most important—the one read by Augustine in those crucial moments in Milan. In Plato’s writings, his ideas were often conveyed through images (such as the famous Allegory of the Cave in the Republic), and accounts of non-physical reality were not always exactly the same (such as the Good in Republic versus Beauty in the Symposium). In addition, everything was presented in dialogue form, not as a treatise explaining: “This is how it is.” Plotinus was a great interpreter of Plato. He put the ideas, accounts, and arguments together, and he gave a brilliant account of reality as a Platonist sees it. Plotinus posits three levels of divinity. The ultimate reality (corresponding to the Good of Republic) is the One. Next is Mind, or Intelligence, or Intellect. Then there is the universal Soul. The souls of individual beings—your soul, my soul, your dog’s soul (since animals have souls in premodern philosophy)—are all fallen from these higher realms.

Augustine has often been called a Neoplatonist philosopher, but he clearly thinks of himself as a Christian thinker. To what extent is his philosophy a function of Neoplatonic philosophy, and to what extent is it a matter of a Christian thinking through things Christianly? While Augustine is clearly trying to do the latter, he may be doing rather a lot of the former, and he can easily do both at the same time to some extent.

There are definitely positive and distinctively Christian appropriations of Platonic thought in Augustine. Above all, there is the Christian appropriation of the concept of non-physical reality. God and the soul are non-physical things; Augustine teaches (in the Prologue to De beata vita, throughout the Confessiones, and elsewhere) that our thinking will be muddled if we try to think of God and the soul in physical terms.

Almost as important is the idea of degrees of reality. In Platonic thought, non-physical reality is not only better in terms of being better or more beautiful. It is also more real. This is vital for responding to the POE, and informed Augustine’s critiques of Manicheanism and Pelagianism. Augustine explains in Book VII of Confessiones how the ideas he found in Plotinus were vital for understanding evil. He learned that God exists to the utmost: God vere est (truly is) (7.11.17). Everything else exists to a lesser degree: Augustine saw that which is below God nec omnino esse nec omnino non esse (neither altogether to be nor altogether not to be). This insight enabled Augustine to think of evil not as a substance competing with God, but as metaphysically unequal to God. God most is, and evil is a lack in what is; it is not a thing that exists in itself—but a corruption of what does. Evil is a breakdown in the good ordering of something God created. It is also metaphysically unequal to what it corrupts; evil is what happens when a thing created good by God, already less than God, becomes further less—becomes less than what it should be. All the same, what God created is still good, otherwise evil could not corrupt it.

Augustine also accepted Christian teachings which overrule Platonic ideas. He is a Trinitarian. Plotinus loved the idea of unity; Augustine could agree with that and even with the identification of God as the One. But there are not three gradations of divinity; rather, there are three equal persons who are the one God. The doctrine of the Incarnation is also crucial. Augustine explains in Confessiones VII how the Platonists had some idea that the good life for a human being involves the love of God—but the way there is Jesus Christ, the God who became man, which those philosophers never taught. Augustine also explicitly accepts the doctrine of a bodily resurrection. Plato’s and Plotinus’ writings had no notion of this, instead considering the idea of a cycle of transmigrations of the soul into a new body after each life (an idea which can be traced to Pythagoras) as well as the idea of an eternal disembodied state.

Are there, then, Platonic ideas less friendly to Christianity that Augustine accepted? This is an important question in Augustine scholarship. A good deal of work has focused on the Plotinian idea of the fall of the soul; Augustine pondered the question where the soul comes from. Robert O’Connell (1987) has controversially argued that Augustine held to the Plotinian view that our souls fell to our bodies after sinning in their pre-birth, disembodied state. Also see Rombs (2006.)

An important related question concerns how Augustine’s thought developed over the course of his career as a Christian theologian, particularly with respect to Neoplatonism. At some risk of overgeneralization, one can distinguish some traditions of Augustine scholarship by how they approach this topic.

Is it primarily a matter of Augustine changing his views as he moves from being a disciple of Plotinus to a disciple of Paul? This approach to Augustine goes back to von Harnack (1888) and Boissier (1888), runs through Alfaric (1918), and continues into the twenty-first century in works such as Dobell (2009). Harrison (2008) argues that a weaker version of this reading has been widespread due to its inclusion in the 1967 edition of Peter Brown’s biography of Augustine. In this reading, Augustine begins as “an optimistic devotee of a Christian philosophy which promises the attainment of perfection, moral purity and tranquility, and the contemplation of wisdom” (16) but ends as a more pessimistic Christian theologian. Harrison critiques this view, noting that Brown later reconsidered it (14–17).

Is it perhaps the case that Augustine is always more or less both a Christian and a Platonist philosopher? Besides O’Connell, a number of scholars have read Augustine this way. These include Courcelle (1963), Teske (2008), and Cary (2000).

Or was Augustine a Christian thinker from the beginning? Conybeare (2006) explores the idea that Augustine was never quite a Neoplatonist in the first place. Harrison (2008) has argued that Augustine is always as much a Christian as he knows how to be. She explains, for example, that those appeals to divine grace associated with the later writings—the ones that are allegedly less philosophical and more theological—are already present, or at least anticipated, in Augustine’s early writings. Development in Augustine’s thinking is “less a revolution” than a “natural evolution” (151), and Harrison cites Goulven Madec as an important scholar who tends to get this right. See Madec (1962). Others, including Clark (1994), Levering (2013), and Boone (2020), read Augustine as informed of and interested in Platonic philosophy—but aiming only at understanding Christian truth.

3. Love and Desire

Augustine’s most definitive teaching is on the ordo amoris (the order of love). Everything in his philosophy and theology can be traced back to the teaching on the love of God and neighbor. His work here is, of course, a submission to the authority of Christ, Scripture, and church, and often takes the form of biblical interpretations in letters, sermons, and treatises on theology. It is also a matter of philosophy, in which Neoplatonism plays a key role.

a. A Rich Vocabulary

A good place to begin is an overview of Augustine’s rich vocabulary on love and desire. In De civitate dei Augustine says “love [amor], then, yearning [from inhio/inhiare] to have what is loved, is desire [cupiditas/cupiditatis]; and having and enjoying it, is joy [laetitia]” (14.7). Love comes in two varieties: Desire, when we lack what we love—and delight, when we have and enjoy what we love. All of Augustine’s language on love, desire, and delight fits this pattern.

However, the vocabulary is flexible. In the same passage, Augustine explains that cupiditas/cupiditatis (desire/passion) and concupiscentia (introduced above in 1c.) have a good connotation when they are specified as being rightly directed to a good object. He supports this with quotations from the Bible in which the desire for the things of God is described using cupiditas or concupiscentia or their related verbs. However, when a good object of desire is not specified, these words are understood to refer to a bad desire. And here is another instance of rigidity: Augustine always treats the desire for God as good, and any desire that interferes with that desire as bad. The only thing better than desire for God is delight in God.

Concupiscentia and cupiditas normally have a negative connotation; acceptable English translations include concupiscence and cupidity respectively, as well as desire and lust for either. Libido/libidinis also has a negative connotation and can be translated as desire or lust. Desiderium can also mean desire, but does not have the same negative connotation. Some verbs for desiring include cupio, concupio, and desidero.

Amor is love, the noun; amo/amare is to love, the verb. Caritas/caritatis can be translated as love or charity. This word is used in Latin translations of the New Testament.

Words for delight or joy or pleasure include nouns such as laetitia, dilectio/dilectionis, delectatio/delectationis, and voluptas/voluptatis. Verbs for delighting or rejoicing include diligo/diligere, delecto/delectare, and gaudeo/gaudere.

The verb volo/velle means will, want, or wish. Its corresponding noun is voluntas/voluntatis. Since the soul’s wanting is also its desiring, these words are often used in describing love or desire. So is quaero/quaerere, which means seek, since we seek and pursue that which we desire.

Finally, consider Augustine’s vocabulary for the end-goal—for that state of completion, fulfillment, and unmitigated goodness which would be the satisfaction of these desires. One of his standard terms is beata vita (the good life, or the happy or blessed life), a term also used by Seneca, the Stoic philosopher. Another standard term is pax/pacis (peace). Other terms may also be used to refer to the same state or to describe one of its characteristics, such as aeterna vita (eternal life).

b. The Ordo Amoris in Augustine’s Writings

Platonism had a teaching on love before Augustine did: What is most valuable should be loved the most, and that means non-physical reality. In Plato’s Symposium, love (eros) is the drive that powers the soul’s ascent up to Beauty Itself, the ultimate reality. The Fifth Tractate of the Third Ennead in Plotinus’ Enneads is a later passage on the subject.

Augustine is, broadly speaking, in the same tradition. Everything he says about love is based on the importance of loving in proportion to the goodness of the thing loved. We will not understand these matters, he thinks, if we can only think of reality in physical terms, for the greater and the greatest objects of love are non-physical beings. The greatest is God, who is infinitely good and deserves unlimited love. Goods greater than anything except God are souls, or rational spirits. They should be loved above all lesser goods, and themselves loved less than God.

Scholars have sometimes questioned whether this account adequately integrates the love of self with the love of God, the love of self with the love of neighbor, or the love of neighbor with the love of God. Others, such as O’Donovan [1980] (2006), have responded with positive appraisals of Augustine on one or more of these points. Clearly, Augustine’s view is that the right love of oneself, one’s neighbor, and God harmonize; they work together towards the good of all human beings concerned.

A few samples from some of Augustine’s writings are in order.

Soliloquia 1.2.7 says, summarizing a prayer Augustine has just offered, “deum et animam scire cupio” (I yearn to know God and the soul). In 1.1.1 he makes a brief prayer: “deus semper idem, noverim me, noverim te” (O God, always the same, may I know myself, may I know you). In addition to setting the agenda for this and other early writings—to learn as much as possible about God and the soul—this is a statement of what is most valuable. God and the soul are the most valuable realities there are and should be our highest priorities.

De natura boni opens with the observation that “summum bonum, quo superius non est, deus est” (the highest good, than which there is not a higher, is God) (1). The rest of the book explains in detail how whatever has modus, species/speciei, and ordo/ordinis (limit or measure, form or type, and order) is to that extent good. Nor can anything exist without these qualities. Therefore, whatever exists depends on goodness. In chapter 22, Augustine explains that God is not limited but may be said to be modus in the highest degree—God is himself the upper limit. Goodness is part of the fabric of existence. Whatever exists is spirit or body. Some goods are better than others—spirit (spiritus/spiritus) is better than matter, and rational (rationabilis) spirit is greater than any other spirit. This is a complete cataloging of what is real and teaches us what to value: God above all, rational spirits after that.

De doctrina christiana explains that “magna res est homo” (the human being is a great thing), the image of God in our souls—not in our bodies (1.22.20). And we have been commanded to love (diligo) one another. But only eternal things are to be enjoyed (fruor/frui). Do we then love human beings on account of themselves (propter se) or on account of something else (propter aliud)? If the former, then it is to be enjoyed (frui). If the latter, it is to be used (utor/uti). Augustine answers that human beings are to be loved on account of something else, rather than themselves. He is not saying humans have no intrinsic value and are only there to be used for the sake of God. Augustine immediately defines the difference between what it means to love something on its own account—frui—and what it means to love something on account of something else—uti. He says “quod enim propter se diligendum est, in eo constituitur beata vita” (for that which is to be loved on account of itself, in the same thing is a happy/blessed life established). We cannot find happiness and fulfillment loving human beings alone. As great as these goods are, only God is a great enough good for the love of him to establish a happy life. Augustine goes on to explain the biblical command to love God and neighbor (1.22.21-1.26.27). The command does not neglect the love of self, including one’s soul (the greater part of what a human is) as well as one’s body (the lesser part); it presupposes that we do love ourselves, but we needed no command to love ourselves. We did need a command to love God and other people, and hence God gave us this command.

The first paragraph of Confessiones includes this memorable line: “Tu excitas, ut laudare te delectet, quia fecisti nos ad te et inquietum est cor nostrum, donec requiescat in te” (You stir [man] that he might delight to praise you, because you have made us to [or for] yourself, and our heart is restless until it should rest in you) (1.1.1). The next thirteen books explore every aspect of the idea that God created humanity with a heart designed for the love of God, a heart self-condemned to misery through turning to lesser goods, and restored to joy by turning back towards God. Commenting on the pear incident in Book II, Augustine defines sin as what happens when we exercise an immoderate or disorderly inclination (immoderata inclinatio) and abandon better and higher goods for lower goods; the highest goods are “tu, domine deus noster, et veritas tua et lex tua” (you, our Lord God, and your truth and your law) (2.5.10). Lesser goods may be loved, but only in proportion to their own goodness and in submission to God’s law. In Book XIII he comments on the Sabbath rest of God, looking backward to God’s rest after creating and forward to the eternal heavenly rest of the redeemed. This is not a euphemism for death; it means the satisfaction of desire in God. He says “requies nostra locus noster” (our rest is our place) (13.9.10). All things, when they function properly, move towards their proper place—a stone downwards, fire upwards. The soul moves towards God, powered by love: “pondus meum amor meus” (My weight is my love). He prays “domine deus, pacem da nobis . . . pacem quietis . . .” (Lord God, give to us peace . . . the peace of rest . . .) (13.35.50). Augustine’s wish is that all human beings may learn to love God and find rest there.

In Book XIX of De civitate dei Augustine goes through an exhaustive account of the positions a philosopher could take on the happy life, borrowing from the Roman writer Varro (19.1-19.3). The problem with the philosophers is that they were all seeking for the greatest good (summum bonum) in themselves and in this life—a life full of suffering, and in which even the best of human virtue is no more than a resistance against deeply ingrained sin (19.4-9). A worldly happiness based on humanity itself is just not possible. The greatest good is aeterna vita (eternal life); the life of the enjoyment of God. In the heavenly eschaton (a life including the bodily resurrection), the saints will enjoy a complete blessedness or happiness (beatitudo/beatitudinis), the perfect peace (pax/pacis) (19.10-19.11).

Book XV concludes De trinitate. The whole point is to seek (quaero) God, Augustine explains (15.2.2). The seeking of God means love. The Holy Spirit has kindled (accendo/accendere) man to the love (dilectio/dilectionis) of God and neighbor, “et ipse dilectio est” (and he himself is love) (15.17.31). Christ gave the Holy Spirit to the church once on earth (John 20:22) and then once again from Heaven (Acts 2) signifying (from significo/significare) the love of neighbor on earth and the love of God in Heaven (15.26.46). In the final paragraph of this enormous set of fifteen books, he prays “meminerim tui, intellegam te, diligam te” (may I remember you, may I understand you, may I love you) (15.28.51).

In one of the sermons on the Psalms of Ascent in the Enarrationes in Psalmos, Augustine explains that love is what keeps us far from God or helps us climb up to God. “Si amaveris terram, peregrinaris a deo; si amaveris deum, ascendis ad deum” (If you will love the earth, you are wandering from God; if you will love God, you are climbing up to God) (119, 8). These verbs are second-person plurals: Augustine is speaking to the church, exhorting them collectively to turn from the desire for lesser goods that leads them astray and climb in love towards the highest. How shall we have the right love? “In caritate dei et proximi exerceamur, ut redeamus ad caritatem” (If we should train in the love of God and neighbor, we would return to love). We can climb up to God by learning to love God and other people.

c. The Ordo Amoris: Creation, Fall, and Redemption

The overall picture here could be summarized along the following lines. We should love God. We should love all human beings. That includes ourselves—but we already knew that much—and only needed a divine command to love God and others.

We should love thus because it is commanded by God, but also because it is the proper function of the human being thus to love. We are designed for it. Another reason (or another way of stating the same reason) to love God is: Only God is good enough to satisfy all our desire. Human desire is naturally oriented towards goodness. One does not simply desire a cup of tea, but the goodness inherent in the tea. We do not simply love our spouse and children, but the goodness God built into them. For God created all things good; goodness is built into the structure of reality. What God created has (or is) a nature (natura), which means an ordered reality. Ordered reality is good. Human happiness is not just something that happens in our own minds; it is a state of being, and of relatedness. Happiness ensues when we enjoy the goodness of God, either directly by enjoying God, or indirectly by enjoying the good things he created and referring the love of them back, in gratitude, towards God.

That, however, is only a summary of how it should be—not of how it is. Love is corrupted by sin and healed by grace. One might read Augustine and think that his idea of sin means loving physical goods instead of spiritual, or a love of worldly goods rather than eternal. But this is not an accurate characterization of sin, although it aptly describes some common sins, such as sexual sins or theft. Keep in mind that it is not the love of physical or worldly goods as such that is a problem, but the love of them at the expense of higher goods—loving them inordinately—with the kind of love due to greater goods. Still, this understanding of sin does not get to the heart of the matter. A better characterization of sin would be prideful: Sin involves choosing ourselves as our own good, refusing to accept our status as created by God to be part of a community of people who love each other, who love God, and who are loved by God. Pride, he explains in De libero arbitrio voluntatis, is the first sin of both Satan and Adam. However, the most thorough characterization of sin is simply this: Sin is the love of lesser goods—whether physical, worldly, oneself, or anything else—with the love due to God. Sin is disordered love which fails to recognize God as the greatest good and the source of fulfillment, or which fails to recognize the value of all persons. (This definition extends to pride, of course—the love of oneself with the love due to God.)

And how is desire healed? How is it redeemed? Some parts of the answer are already in place. Desire is healed by God’s mercy and by all the things through which God’s mercy works. That includes our recognition of these insights, our decisions to do better, and our efforts to be virtuous. Even these, however, may be worthless to heal our souls without some help from God. More than this, the healing of desire includes prayer, faith, hope, charity, the hearing of the biblical commands, and immersion in the life of the church. (On the healing of desire, see the introductory chapter of Boone (2020).)

4. Augustine’s Enduring Ideas

What follows is an introduction to some of Augustine’s most famous and enduring ideas in philosophy and theology.

a. Religious Epistemology

Augustine’s religious epistemology is an immense topic, but the distinction between two topics that are part of religious epistemology makes a brief survey possible. First, there are reasons offered why we should believe in Christianity. Second, there is an explanation of how religious knowledge works—how we know God. These reasons and explanations are, as is usual with Augustine, interconnected.

Why believe? Augustine gives more than one answer. De utilitate credendi is a very useful text on this topic.

One answer is that faith is reasonable and rational. This is one of the old tensions between orthodox Christianity and Manicheanism. Manicheanism in Augustine’s experience taught that faith is not reasonable; people should believe only what they know for themselves. By contrast, orthodoxy openly recommended trust in reliable authority: Christ, church, and Scripture. This is the same church that can trace its origins back to Christ himself. And this is how we know most of what we do know—by trusting people who have the firsthand knowledge we lack. History, geography, and even who our parents are—these are all things known by trust. In De vera religione, Augustine presents important explanations of why Christianity satisfies the highest standards of rationality.

Another answer is simply that Christianity is true. Arguments for the existence of God and the immortality of the soul in books such as Soliloquies are relevant here. There are also arguments from fulfilled prophecies, see De fide rerum quae non videntur (On Faith in Things Which Are Not Seen). Augustine explains that the multitudes who have come over to Christ are an indicator of his authority. His miracles also testify to this.

This barely begins to explain Augustine’s idea that faith just makes sense. If we do not know something which is not easy to know for ourselves, the best move is to trust someone who does know it. We just need to figure out who that is. Based on reasoning considered in the previous two paragraphs, that means trusting Christ, Scripture, and church.

This faith is reasonable but is not the same thing as reason. Faith (fides/fidei) means trust. Reason (ratio/rationis) and understanding (intellectus/intellectus) involve comprehension. The Augustinian way of thinking is that we can add reason to faith and ideally should. We must have faith, but for those who can, it is good to understand what is taught by faith. But we will not get very far without faith. Augustine loved a line from the early Latin translations of Isaiah 7:9: “nisi credideritis, non intellegetis” (Unless you should believe, you will not understand).

But how do we know? What epistemic faculty or process is involved when we know anything, and especially when we know God? This question brings us back to Augustine’s famous teaching on illumination. Knowledge comes from God’s work in the soul. Following up on investigations into God and the soul in Soliloquia, De magistro raises something like an argument for skepticism: We can only learn through signs, but we cannot understand any sign unless we already know what it signifies, and knowing what it signifies requires learning—therefore, learning is impossible. Augustine’s solution is that knowledge does not come from any form of learning that relies on signs but comes from God working in our souls. Christ is the only true teacher, and he is in the soul teaching—and that is where knowledge comes from.

Thus, De magistro is the classical source of the Augustinian theory of illumination, although there would be some development of his epistemology over time. This theory has some correspondences to the Platonic idea of knowledge by recollection (most famously in Plato’s Meno). Knowledge is not a matter of sensory experience but is an activity of the non-physical soul. But illumination is not quite the same as Platonic recollection. Instead of a doctrine of reincarnation, there is an explicit appeal to the Trinity acting in our souls. (See De trinitate 12.15.24 for Augustine’s direct disagreement with Platonic recollection.)

b. The Problem of Evil

The POE is the perennial question: How are God and evil compatible? Three aspects of Augustine’s work on the POE are particularly notable. One is that he gives an early presentation of the free will explanation for the origins of evil: Evil happens because of humanity’s free will and cannot accurately be blamed on God. (See section 4g.)

Another is the sheer number of interrelated things Augustine says about evil. Free will is one response, but there is a good deal more—Augustine is giving a Christian response to the POE as part of a detailed articulation of a Christian worldview, and he is not going to stop at just one answer. These different responses to the POE have been discussed and developed by later medieval thinkers such as Boethius and Aquinas and on into contemporary philosophy and theology. This section is a brief overview of several pieces of Augustine’s response to the POE. See Evans (1982) for a more complete study of the topic.

The free will explanation for the origins of evil is a first piece of Augustine’s response to evil. The necessary action in response to evil is a very important second piece. This is to love God as we ought. Since pride is the primal evil, the humility of Jesus Christ is the cure. We should imitate that humility. A third piece is Augustine’s use of the aesthetic response to the POE: God can bring good out of evil and order out of disorder. Like a brilliant artist, God can use a thing ugly in itself—like a single ugly square in a large mosaic—to make a good, ordered, and beautiful whole (De ordine 1.1.2). A fourth piece is the classification of some sufferings as just punishment for sin (De libero arbitrio voluntatis 1.1.1). A fifth piece is an early version of the idea that suffering purifies our souls—anticipating modern accounts of what is called a “soul-making theodicy.” Augustine explains how sufferings in life can turn us to God (De beata vita 1.2). God may take away a thing loved in a disorderly way or use an illness to help that person to do better—for example, when Augustine’s weakness in his lungs helped him to give up his corrupt profession as a rhetoric teacher (Confessiones IX). A sixth is the principle that God is justified in making many lesser goods: A universe full of many different kinds of good things, including lesser ones and those whose limited degree of goodness makes evil possible, is a universe more beautiful, orderly, and filled with the glory of God. A seventh is the extension of some of these other answers to what are often, these days, called “natural evils”— such as diseases, natural disasters, and dangerous wild animals. These might seem to be things to which a free will explanation of evil does not apply, but Augustine explains that free will does apply to the category of natural evils, if that is even an acceptable name for them: Our frail bodies are only vulnerable to these things as a result of the just punishment for our sins (De civitate dei 11.22). This connects to contemporary discussions on the evidential POE. In addition, returning to the aesthetic response, things that may seem evil in themselves contribute to a well-ordered whole, and serve good ends if they are used rightly. They are also things good in and of themselves, as all reality is. That brings us to an eighth, the metaphysical explanation of evil: Evil is not a thing in itself, but a corruption of things. It is no more than a lack of goodness.

A further notable aspect of Augustine’s work on the POE is the metaphysics of this last point. This theme connects directly other themes in Augustine’s life and work including his Christian incorporation of some ideas from Neoplatonism, his account of his commitment to Christ, his critique of Manicheanism, his critique of Pelagianism, and his account of rightly ordered loves. What is is good; everything that exists has a nature, every nature is good, and all goodness is to be attributed to the creator. Evil is parasitic on a good nature: The good nature can exist without the evil, but not vice versa. Illness is a good example of this teaching, used by Augustine in De natura boni 6: Illness is an absence of health in the body, it can only be present when there is still some health, and if all health were removed then so would be the illness.

This is a teaching about God in himself as well as about his creation: God is unlimited good, absolute perfection, and unchangeable. Lesser goods are changeable, which is what gives them the possibility of becoming less good. This contrasts with the Manichean view. God is invulnerable and unchanging, not a God vulnerable to evil and affected by his struggle with it.

There is an important series of distinctions here. First, there is the distinction between God and his creation—the distinction between infinite, unchangeable goodness, and limited goodness vulnerable to change and corruption. Second, there is the distinction between created goodness and fallenness. A thing created by God has some degree of goodness, and when it is corrupted it has less than that. Third, there is the distinction between good and evil—one is a positive existence, and one is a lack. A fourth clarification might be in order: A great good which is corrupted (such as a sinful human) may still have more goodness in it than an uncorrupted lesser good that never fell from where it should have been.

c. Political Philosophy

The basics of Augustine’s political philosophy (or theology) are developed in De civitate dei . A number of his views are of interest, such as his just war theory (19.7). (See Augustine: Political and Social Philosophy.)

A community is defined by what it loves. Discarding the definition of a people (populus) as a coming together of human beings to share in what is useful (utilitas/utilitatis) (De civitate dei 19.21), Augustine defines a people as a coming together of many rational beings (rationales res) joined in like-minded communion (concors communio) around what it loves (diligo) (19.24).

Everyone loves God above all—or does not. Those who do not are united in their love of self above all, seeking happiness defined by themselves, independent of God. The community of those who love God above all is the City of God. The other is the City of Man. Everyone is in one—and only one—of these two communities.

And everyone includes the angels. The rebellious, fallen angels (the demons) are part of the City of Man. The good angels are part of the City of God. The founding of the two Cities goes back to the division of the good from the rebellious angels (Book XI). Among human beings, we can trace the history of the two Cities from Cain, of the City of Man, and Abel, of the City of God (Book XV).

Everyone desires peace, including those making up the City of Man (19.12). Their problem is that they are looking for it in the wrong place. True peace is a heavenly good, fully experienced by the angels and departed saints—or later, when we die or in the eschaton. For now, the City of God has a semblance of peace, and is blessed with the hope of a perfect peace later (19.20).

It would be a mistake to equate the City of Man with politics, or with the idea of a political community—the Roman Empire, the city of Athens, the state of Texas, the country of Zimbabwe, and so on. Nor should we equate the City of God with the church. Christians who are part of the City of God are also part of a political community—they are members of the church, of a political community, and of the City of God. And there are hypocrites in the church—members of the church, of the political community, and of the City of Man.

Despite their disagreement with the City of Man over ultimate ends, the City of God can agree with the City of Man on many things. When the City of Man interferes with the worship of God, for example when the government forbids Christian worship or requires idolatry, the City of God cannot cooperate with it. But they can work together on much else, and so lovers of God can cooperate with people who do not love God, working together for as much of a semblance of peace as is possible on earth. Unlike members of the City of Man with whom they are working, they understand that this peace is neither final nor complete. But they can seek the good of their own earthly kingdoms, as Jeremiah advised the Jews in Babylon (19.26). In this way, Augustine presents a vision for Christians living in the world—working in and with the world—yet still not of the world. His readers would have a framework for thinking through the decline of Roman civilization. They could avoid idolizing Rome and keep a sense of communal identity—not only in their own cities or nations, but also with the church that outlasts even Rome and is a part of the eternal City of God. Roman Christians could recognize some limited goodness in their Roman heritage and recognize Roman decline as a bad thing in and of itself. They could also seek the good of any earthly kingdom in which they found themselves.

d. Divine Timelessness

Augustine’s writings are among the classical sources of the idea that God is outside of time. This idea has continued over the centuries, touted by people like Boethius, Anselm, Thomas Aquinas, and C. S. Lewis. Contemporary philosophers of religion who advocate a version of the timelessness theory include Eleonore Stump, Norman Kretzmann, and Brian Leftow. There are notable contemporary detractors from the theory of divine timelessness; for further discussion, see God and Time.

Augustine’s perspective from his famous analysis in Book XI of the Confessiones is a slow meditation on time. The main idea is that God is outside of time (11.11.13). All times are equally present to God, who knows them all at once from his changeless eternity.

Time itself is part of God’s creation. Accordingly, there is no time when God has not yet created (11.13.15). God creates time and the rest of creation from an eternal state, and he remains outside of his creation although he acts within it.

Augustine considers whether the temporal present has any extension—any length or duration (11.15.18-20). We can talk of the present year, but it has months past and months future; the present day has hours past and hours future. The present hour has minutes past and minutes future. If there is a smallest unit of time—so small that it cannot be divided—this only can be called a genuine present moment of time.

All times tend towards non-being (11.14.17). Yet the past and the future are real, for there is a presence of past and future (11.17.22-20.26). We can even say that they exist in the soul—a past of memory and a present of expectation.

However, we still do not understand how God sees the future from his position outside of time (11.19.25). The human soul is not God, but it is an image of God, and a thing having some ability to know God. It is not outside of time like God is, but it does imitate or resemble God’s timelessness in a very small way. We experience durations of time much longer than the present moment (11.28.38). Whether a human experience is long enough to hear one word, a whole sentence, a Psalm of many sentences, or more, it contains within itself a vast number of smaller times. Even if there is such a thing as the smallest unit of time, it is so small that a very large number of moments is still contained in the smallest lengths of human experience. A presence of many times is unified in one mind; the same holds for a human life and indeed for human history altogether. The human being is called upward, away from smaller units of times towards the eternity of God (11.29.39). In the knowledge of God there is a full presence of all times, and this exalted divinity deserves our humble worship (11.31.41).

e. Trinitarianism

Augustine’s De trinitate is an effort to grow in understanding of God by means of finding signs of the Trinity in creation, and especially in human nature. One such analogy is memory, understanding, and will. Another is the one loving, that which is loved, and the love itself. Augustine does not think that such traces of the Trinity can close the infinite gap between our minds and God. They are meant to add to an orthodox faith in the Trinitarian dogma—one God and three divine persons who are Father, Son, and Holy Spirit—some measure of understanding (intellegentia) (15.6.9).

There is much more to Augustine’s Trinitarianism than his own brilliant and lengthy study of the traces of the Trinity. He describes God the Son and Word of God—standard biblical language for Jesus—as the Word which God is eternally speaking. And the love between the two of them is the Holy Spirit, who eternally proceeds from the Father and the Son (15.6.9). This understanding of the Holy Spirit has been more influential in Western Christianity (Catholicism and Protestantism) than in Eastern Christianity (Eastern Orthodoxy). Indeed, while honoring Augustine as a great church father, Eastern Christians can be critical of Augustine—his influence contributed to the famous dispute between the East and the West over the addition of the phrase filioque (and the Son) to the statement about the Holy Spirit in the Nicene Creed.

In philosophy, the distinction between Augustine’s Trinitarianism and Neoplatonism is important. Plotinus had spoken of three divinities—One, Mind, and Soul—which were not on the same level. Departing from Neoplatonism (and critiquing the Arian heresy), Augustine is emphatic that God the Father, Son, and Holy Spirit are all equal and all the same divine substance. See for example (De ordine 1.10.29) and (De trinitate 1.6.9). Ayres (2010) examines Augustine’s Trinitarianism with attention to its relation to Platonism.

f. Christ and Church

Christology is a key topic in Augustine’s ecclesiology as well as his Trinitarianism. The critique of the Donatists is central here, expressing Augustine’s emphasis on the unity of the church. One important related idea is that of the totus Christus. This means “the whole Christ,” an idea drawn from several passages in the Bible, but especially from Paul’s teaching on the church as the bride of Christ and on Paul’s “one flesh” teaching about marriage. The idea is that Christ and church have permanently connected identities—in their holy union, we should not think of one without thinking of the other. This idea has an enormous influence on Augustine’s hermeneutics. It allows him to look for the voices of Christ and of church speaking in unison—speaking together, or better yet, speaking as one. As he asks his congregation “Si duo in carne una, cur non duo in voce una” (If two in one flesh, why not two in one voice) (Enarrationes in Psalmos 30 2, 4).

This idea greatly informed Augustine’s interpretation of the Old Testament. He could read the Psalms and find Jesus speaking there, or the church, or both. He could also argue (for example, against the Donatists) that the Psalms were instructing the church concerning their oneness with Christ and with one another. Fiedrowicz (1997), Cameron (2012), and Meconi (2013) are important scholarly studies of this topic.

g. Free Will and Predestination

Augustine uses the idea of free will to respond to the POE and to defend an orthodox Christian worldview as superior to Manicheanism. In De libero arbitrio voluntatis, he develops and defends this idea of free will. He explains that free will is a good thing, a worthy gift of God to humanity. He explains how free will is compatible with God’s foreknowledge of our decisions. He explains how the free choice to turn towards lesser goods and away from God is not caused by God or anything else. Although free choice depends on the faculty of free will, which depends on God who created it, the choice is something like a first cause—not the result of prior events. Free will should be understood in what contemporary analytic philosophers call the libertarian sense: The ability to do otherwise than we do—in this case, the ability to sin or not to sin.

This defense of free will was a mantle to be taken up by later Christian philosophers of the medieval era such as Boethius and Aquinas, and by contemporary Christian philosophers and analytic theologians in our own era.

However, Augustine’s response to Pelagianism explained that we do not have free will. In De libero arbitrio voluntatis 2.20.54, Augustine explains that once fallen into sin, human beings cannot get back up again by themselves. They need grace. In 3.18.52, he clarifies that he is talking about the free will human nature possessed before Adam’s sin corrupted it. In De civitate dei, Augustine writes of Adam’s free will again (12.21)—a will whose misuse corrupted humanity (13.14). In the Enchiridion (The Handbook) he describes Adam as free (25-30). However, the human race lost its free will through the sin of Adam. In a direct response to Pelagius in De natura et gratia, he explains that Adam had free will, which corrupted human nature afterward (3).

All things considered, Augustine’s view on free will and sin appears to be straightforward. He believed that free will was given by God to humanity—but not on an individual basis. Rather, God gave free will to be exercised corporately by Adam, the head of the human race. Adam’s free decision corrupted humanity, so that human beings no longer have this freedom. In this way, Augustine’s critique of Manicheanism and his free will response to the POE would be able to stand. However, just where free will applied—whether human evil comes originally from many different free decisions or originally from just one—needed clarification. (Scholars disagree over whether Augustine in his later writings really believes that Adam had free will as such.)

It also needed to be clarified that the escape from sin, the healing of the soul, and the soul’s return to God are not things that can be attributed to free will—they are all of grace. Only God’s sheer mercy on sinners unable to do any good can help us. And who gets that mercy? Those to whom God chose to give it for no reason we can ever hope to know. This is Augustine’s (in)famous teaching of predestination, part of the critique of Pelagianism. (For an introduction, see Enchiridion 98.) Here Augustine has been an influence on later predestinationist theologies. In terms of Reformation theologies, Augustine corresponds to infralapsarian—not to supralapsarian Calvinism: God did not ordain the fall. Human beings lack the free will Adam had—but Adam had it.

Other things needed to be clarified, and perhaps they still do after all this time. This seems to be Augustine’s eventual view. But was it his view in the beginning, or did he change his view, and if so, in what way?

Augustine scholars discuss this a good deal. There is discussion as to whether De libero arbitrio voluntatis is fully coherent, whether Augustine changed it later in his career after a shift towards less Plato and more Paul was well underway. This conversation connects to the conversation over the roles of Platonism and Christianity in his thought, as well as to the study of Augustine versus the Pelagians. Analysis is ongoing and likely to continue into the future. For pathways into the conversation, see Harrison (2008).

At least one thing is clear: There is some development in Augustine’s views on the subject. In Retractiones 2.1, Augustine describes his letter Ad Simplicianum or (To Simplicianus), bishop of Milan and successor to Ambrose. In his letter he tried to defend free will—in this case the ability of the human will to place its faith in Christ but failed—“vicit dei gratia” (the grace of God conquered) he says. This is about the free will of the human race—not of Adam. If Augustine did not believe in free will for humanity and then change his mind, he wanted to believe in it, but eventually could not.

But this is freedom either to do or not do a thing—libertarian freedom, as philosophers routinely call it. In De civitate dei 22.30, Augustine clarifies that Adam originally had the freedom either to sin or not to sin, and this freedom was a good thing; however, a different kind of freedom of the will, and a better one, would be its inability to sin. This is the freedom the saints shall experience in heaven.

Augustine challenges readers to reconsider their understanding of free will. (See Free Will for a contemporary discussion.) The ability to do or not do (libertarian freedom) is not the only definition. There is the well-known compatibilist view of free will—the ability merely to do what you want to do. But there is a third option—the classical teleological account of freedom in terms of the orientation of the will to the good—a free will is one able to pursue the good, and the freest will would be one unable to do otherwise. Notice that this last option, while not defining free will in the libertarian way, nevertheless recognizes freedom in the libertarian sense as one type of freedom.

An additional reconsideration is appropriate for a Christian theologian: When we speak of the ability to do or not do a thing, whose ability to do something are we talking about? The Augustinian denial of free will focuses on the lack of human ability, after the sin of Adam and prior to God’s graciously healing our corrupted wills, to be without sin. It is possible to deny this ability, while affirming that human beings in the same state have the ability to place their faith in Jesus Christ. Apparently, Augustine eventually denied this ability as well, and this is why he is important in the history of predestinationist theologies, for he thinks that only by God’s completely unmerited kindness in healing our corrupted wills are any of us ever able to have faith. There is also the question whether those who have this ability, those who have received God’s gracious help, retain the ability to not have faith. Augustine seems to think they do.

Augustine uses the idea of free will to respond to the POE and to defend an orthodox Christian worldview as superior to Manicheanism. In De libero arbitrio voluntatis, he develops and defends this idea of free will. He explains that free will is a good thing, a worthy gift of God to humanity. He explains how free will is compatible with God’s foreknowledge of our decisions. He explains how the free choice to turn towards lesser goods and away from God is not caused by God or anything else. Although free choice depends on the faculty of free will, which depends on God who created it, the choice is something like a first cause—not the result of prior events. Free will should be understood in what contemporary analytic philosophers call the libertarian sense: The ability to do otherwise than we do—in this case, the ability to sin or not to sin.

This defense of free will was a mantle to be taken up by later Christian philosophers of the medieval era such as Boethius and Aquinas, and by contemporary Christian philosophers and analytic theologians in our own era.

However, Augustine’s response to Pelagianism explained that we do not have free will. In De libero arbitrio voluntatis 2.20.54, Augustine explains that once fallen into sin, human beings cannot get back up again by themselves. They need grace. In 3.18.52, he clarifies that he is talking about the free will human nature possessed before Adam’s sin corrupted it. In De civitate dei, Augustine writes of Adam’s free will again (12.21)—a will whose misuse corrupted humanity (13.14). In the Enchiridion (The Handbook) he describes Adam as free (25-30). However, the human race lost its free will through the sin of Adam. In a direct response to Pelagius in De natura et gratia, he explains that Adam had free will, which corrupted human nature afterward (3).

All things considered, Augustine’s view on free will and sin appears to be straightforward. He believed that free will was given by God to humanity—but not on an individual basis. Rather, God gave free will to be exercised corporately by Adam, the head of the human race. Adam’s free decision corrupted humanity, so that human beings no longer have this freedom. In this way, Augustine’s critique of Manicheanism and his free will response to the POE would be able to stand. However, just where free will applied—whether human evil comes originally from many different free decisions or originally from just one—needed clarification. (Scholars disagree over whether Augustine in his later writings really believes that Adam had free will as such.)

It also needed to be clarified that the escape from sin, the healing of the soul, and the soul’s return to God are not things that can be attributed to free will—they are all of grace. Only God’s sheer mercy on sinners unable to do any good can help us. And who gets that mercy? Those to whom God chose to give it for no reason we can ever hope to know. This is Augustine’s (in)famous teaching of predestination, part of the critique of Pelagianism. (For an introduction, see Enchiridion 98.) Here Augustine has been an influence on later predestinationist theologies. In terms of Reformation theologies, Augustine corresponds to infralapsarian—not to supralapsarian Calvinism: God did not ordain the fall. Human beings lack the free will Adam had—but Adam had it.

Other things needed to be clarified, and perhaps they still do after all this time. This seems to be Augustine’s eventual view. But was it his view in the beginning, or did he change his view, and if so, in what way?

Augustine scholars discuss this a good deal. There is discussion as to whether De libero arbitrio voluntatis is fully coherent, whether Augustine changed it later in his career after a shift towards less Plato and more Paul was well underway. This conversation connects to the conversation over the roles of Platonism and Christianity in his thought, as well as to the study of Augustine versus the Pelagians. Analysis is ongoing and likely to continue into the future. For pathways into the conversation, see Harrison (2008).

At least one thing is clear: There is some development in Augustine’s views on the subject. In Retractiones 2.1, Augustine describes his letter Ad Simplicianum or (To Simplicianus), bishop of Milan and successor to Ambrose. In his letter he tried to defend free will—in this case the ability of the human will to place its faith in Christ but failed—“vicit dei gratia” (the grace of God conquered) he says. This is about the free will of the human race—not of Adam. If Augustine did not believe in free will for humanity and then change his mind, he wanted to believe in it, but eventually could not.

But this is freedom either to do or not do a thing—libertarian freedom, as philosophers routinely call it. In De civitate dei 22.30, Augustine clarifies that Adam originally had the freedom either to sin or not to sin, and this freedom was a good thing; however, a different kind of freedom of the will, and a better one, would be its inability to sin. This is the freedom the saints shall experience in heaven.

Augustine challenges readers to reconsider their understanding of free will. (See Free Will for a contemporary discussion.) The ability to do or not do (libertarian freedom) is not the only definition. There is the well-known compatibilist view of free will—the ability merely to do what you want to do. But there is a third option—the classical teleological account of freedom in terms of the orientation of the will to the good—a free will is one able to pursue the good, and the freest will would be one unable to do otherwise. Notice that this last option, while not defining free will in the libertarian way, nevertheless recognizes freedom in the libertarian sense as one type of freedom.

An additional reconsideration is appropriate for a Christian theologian: When we speak of the ability to do or not do a thing, whose ability to do something are we talking about? The Augustinian denial of free will focuses on the lack of human ability, after the sin of Adam and prior to God’s graciously healing our corrupted wills, to be without sin. It is possible to deny this ability, while affirming that human beings in the same state have the ability to place their faith in Jesus Christ. Apparently, Augustine eventually denied this ability as well, and this is why he is important in the history of predestinationist theologies, for he thinks that only by God’s completely unmerited kindness in healing our corrupted wills are any of us ever able to have faith. There is also the question whether those who have this ability, those who have received God’s gracious help, retain the ability to not have faith. Augustine seems to think they do.

h. How to Read the Bible

Book XII of Confessiones and the whole of De doctrina christiana are recommended reading for an overview of the principles of Augustine’s hermeneutics. First, the Bible is the Word of God and does not err. Second, its richness exceeds our understanding, and it often includes more depths of meaning than one reader alone can understand—perhaps more than even its human author can understand (even as the human author’s intentions in the Bible are always correct). Third, the Bible is to be interpreted by its clear meanings: A meaning clearly taught in one passage disambiguates a murky passage elsewhere. Moreover, the teaching conveyed by any proposed figurative reading should be taught in a non-figurative way elsewhere in the Bible. Among the clearer teachings are the basics of Christianity: the Trinity, the Incarnation, the Gospel, and the love of God and neighbor.

Augustine’s influence in biblical hermeneutics has been immense and is sometimes misunderstood. It is well-known that in Book XIII of Confessiones, he advocates non-literal readings of the Bible—for example, the first chapter of Genesis. It has been said that Augustine does not approve of literal meanings—but he does—he wrote De Genesi ad litteram (On Genesis According to the Letter, or The Literal Meaning of Genesis). One of the points of Book XII of Confessiones is that a passage of Scripture can have multiple meanings, and it is typical of Augustine to recognize a literal and a non-literal meaning. For example, he accepts a six-day creation (12.10-12.12). In De civitate dei, Augustine explains that we must recognize the historical and the symbolic meanings of the story of Noah and the Ark (15.27).

Even this language of “literal” and “non-literal” can be misleading. Literal is not the opposite of allegorical or metaphorical; it is best to speak of figurative and non-figurative readings when discussing Augustine’s hermeneutics. See Cameron (2012, 17-18). The main idea behind the use of figurative readings is to find the great teachings of Christianity shimmering throughout the Scriptures—to find Christ, Gospel, and church taught anywhere in the Bible that a reader looks. See Teske (2009) and Cameron (2012).

5. The Future of Augustine

Augustine’s ideas are worth exploring on other matters including the philosophy of memory, marriage, the refutation of Arianism, and other heresies.

Augustine’s most famous books—Confessions, The City of God, On Christian Doctrine, and On the Trinity—have been read, reread, misread, and read again. Along the way various of his other books have been read a good bit, from On True Religion to the Enchiridion, but the vast corpus of his sermons and letters have not. As James J. O’Donnell says, an Augustine we hardly know may perhaps just be coming into view. This is the Augustine who revealed himself at vast length in his letters and sermons, texts which constitute over 45% of his surviving works. These texts have been mined for facts that fit the pre-determined structure of biographical narrative, but have received far too little attention for their literary and philosophical content (2001, 23). Since O’Donnell pointed this out, more scholarship has emerged in this area including Ployd (2015), Claire (2016), and commentators on Augustine’s idea of the totus Christus.

As this work continues, scholars will no doubt engage in reconsiderations of Augustine’s ideas. There is a slogan associated with the Reformation: “Ecclesia semper reformanda est” (The Church must always be reformed). We may modify this for our purposes: “Augustinus semper retractandus est” (Augustine must always be reconsidered). Twenty-first century scholars are reconsidering his moral theories, his views on interpreting the Bible, his perspective on memory, and more. (See for example, Claire (2016).) Ideas Augustine scholars thought they understood may need to be reconsidered from a new angle; older scholarly debates may need to be reopened, resettled, or at least reframed (Harrison 2008); and scholars may consider ideas such as the totus Christus (Cameron 2012).

6. Conclusion

Alfred North Whitehead famously characterized all Western philosophy as a set of footnotes to Plato—an insightful oversimplification. Similar things might be said of the philosophical or theological influence of Augustine. The back cover of one book states, “For many, all theology subsequent to Augustine is a footnote” (TeSelle 2006). Ellingsen explains that all the Western theological traditions have deep roots in Augustine (2005). Gerald McDermott identifies Augustine as “the most influential theologian ever” (2010, chap. 4). In Western philosophy, it would be difficult to avoid being at least a little Augustinian without intentionally becoming a thoroughgoing materialist, naturalist, and atheist. (Nietzsche is a good example of this option.) Even philosophers who do not seem particularly Augustinian can look Augustinian at times, such as William James when, in Lectures IX and X of his Varieties of Religious Experience, he explains that the result of religious conversion is reordered love. More direct influences on philosophy and religion can be traced through the likes of Boethius, Anselm, Bonaventure, Thomas Aquinas, Martin Luther, John Calvin, René Descartes, Gottfried Leibniz, Jonathan Edwards, Martin Heidegger, Ludwig Wittgenstein, and C. S. Lewis. The scholarship on these influences is vast and interesting. How different philosophers interacted with Augustine’s ideas is a topic of perennial interest. There is, for example, a long scholarly discussion on the connections between Augustine and Descartes, including differing views of Augustine’s influence on Descartes, and analysis of to what extent Descartes’ philosophy modifies Augustine’s.

The reader now has some of the basics in hand. Most importantly, the reader should understand how different ideas in Augustine connect to the theme of reordering our love for God and for other people. Where should an interested reader go next?

First, go to the primary sources: There is no substitute for reading Augustine’s books. Shorter readings, such as the Cassiciacum dialogues, are a good place to start—but it is important to read books such as the Confessions and Teaching Christianity in their entirety. Translations are adequate for most purposes; there is an abundance of translations in English for many of Augustine’s writings, ranging from public-domain translations to the massive project of New City Press to produce top-of-the-line translations of everything written by Augustine. Other languages may be less fortunate, but the European languages (particularly German, French, Italian, Spanish, and Portuguese) are home to translations of Augustine. Translations and scholarship also exist in non-Western contexts, such as Chinese. Hopefully the future will see a flourishing of translations into Chinese, Hindi, Urdu, Arabic, Swahili, and other tongues.

Second, read scholarly work as a guide to interpreting the original readings; secondary sources make good introductions, including Chadwick (1986), Clark (1994), Harrison (2000), Ellingsen (2005), TeSelle (2006), and Boone (2020). Some works introduce significant portions of the scholarship, such as the contributions in Kelley (2014). The multi-lingual Augustinus-Lexikon is a multivolume series published by Schwabe Verlag in Switzerland and is a helpful resource on specific topics. The first three volumes are Mayer (1986-1994), Mayer (1996-2002), and Mayer (2004-2010). Augustine Through the Ages: An Encyclopedia Fitzgerald (2009) is another.

In addition, there is a steady stream of new Augustine scholarship adding to the immeasurable trove of past scholarship. The Oxford Patristics Conference, regularly held in Oxford every four years, reliably covers a good deal of Augustine. Many of the proceedings are printed in the Studia Patristica series published by Peeters Publishers. Various scholarly journals are devoted largely or exclusively to Augustine, including the English Augustinian Studies, the French Recherches Augustiniennes, and the multilingual Augustiniana.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

• Augustine. 2026. The City of God, translated by William Babcock. New City Press.
• Augustine. 1997. Confessions, translated by Mariah Boulding. New City Press.
• Augustine.1996. Teaching Christianity, translated by Edmund Hill. New City Press.
• Augustine. 1991. The Trinity, translated by John E. Rotelle. New City Press.
  • New City Press is working to provide quality translations of all of Augustine’s works. Above are the four most important writings.
• Augustine. 1992. Confessions, translated by Henry Chadwick. Oxford University Press.
• Augustine. 1960. Confessions, translated by John Ryan. Doubleday.
• Augustine. 2006. Confessions, translated by F. J. Sheed. Hackett.
  • The Confessions has been translated often. Listed above are three of the high-quality alternatives to New City Press.
• S. Aurelii Augustini Opera Omnia: Editio Latina. Sant’Agostino.
  • Online access to Latin texts of Augustine’s work. Suitable for lower levels of scholarship; modern critical editions are better for advanced levels.

b. General Books and Introductions

• Boone, Mark. J. 2020. Reason, Authority, and the Healing of Desire in the Writings of Augustine. Lexington Books.
  • A study of Augustine’s theology of desire in a cross-section of his writings.
• Brown, Peter. (1967) 2000. Augustine of Hippo: A Biography. Faber and Faber, Limited. New edition with an Epilogue, University of California Press.
  • The classic modern biography of Augustine. This work played a role in the debate over Augustine’s relationship to Neoplatonism. The 2000 edition includes an “Epilogue” in two parts: “New Evidence” and “New Directions.”
• Chadwick, Henry. 1986. Augustine: A Very Short Introduction. Oxford University Press.
• Clark, Mary T. 1994. Augustine. Continuum.
  • Above are two succinct introductions to Augustine’s life and thought.
• Ellingsen, Mark. 2005. The Richness of Augustine: His Contextual and Pastoral Theology. Westminster John Knox.
  • Introduction to the remarkable scope of Augustine’s theology and its enduring influence on all branches of Western Christianity.
• Fitzgerald, Allan, Ed. 2009. Augustine Through the Ages: An Encyclopedia. Eerdmans.
  • A reference work on all aspects of the study of Augustine and his influence.
• Harrison, Carol. 2000. Augustine: Christian Truth and Fractured Humanity. Oxford University Press.
  • A study of Augustine in context of classical culture and late antique society.
• Kelley, Joseph T. 2014. What Are They Saying about Augustine? Paulist Press.
  • An introduction to scholarship on Augustine.
• Kevane, Eugene. 1954. Augustine the Educator: A Study in the Fundamentals of Christian Formation. Newman.
  • Study on how Augustine, beginning with classical non-Christian resources, developed a Christian philosophy (or theology) and practice of education.
• Kolbet, Paul R. 2010. Augustine and the Cure of Souls: Revising a Classical Ideal. University of Notre Dame Press.
  • Study on how Augustine, beginning with classical non-Christian resources, developed a Christian approach to rhetoric.
• Levering, Matthew. 2013. The Theology of Augustine: An Introductory Guide to His Most Important Works. Baker.
  • Introduction to seven major works of Augustine.
• Mayer, Cornelius, Ed. 1986-1994. Augustinus-Lexikon, vol. 1. Schwage.
• Mayer, Cornelius, Ed. 1996-2002. Augustinus-Lexikon, vol. 2. Schwage.
• Mayer, Cornelius, Ed. 2004-2010. Augustinus-Lexikon, vol. 3. Schwage.
  • Augustinus-Lexikon is an encyclopedia on all aspects of Augustinian studies. Its contents are written in German, French, and English.
• McDermott, Gerald. 2010. The Great Theologians: A Brief Guide. InterVarsity Press.
  • An introduction to eleven major Christian theologians. The chapter on Augustine is a good introduction and is memorable for labeling Augustine as “the most influential theologian ever.”
• O’Donnell, James J. 2001. “Augustine: His Time and Lives.” In The Cambridge Companion to Augustine, edited by Eleonore Stump and Norman Kretzmann. Cambridge University Press.
  • Introduction to the context in which Augustine worked and the different aspects of his life and work.
• O’Donovan, Oliver. (1980) 2006. The Problem of Self-Love in St. Augustine. Yale University Press. Reprint, Wipf and Stock Publishers.
  • A reading on Augustine’s view of love of God, self, and neighbor, and the source of an optimistic account of Augustine’s efforts to integrate the three.
• Possidius. The Life of Saint Augustine.
  • The classic ancient biography of Augustine.
• TeSelle, Eugene. 2006. Augustine. Abingdon Press.
  • Study of Augustine’s theology divided into major periods of his life; in this way, TeSelle explains Augustine’s theology on his own terms and not according to the priorities of modern systematic theology.

c. The Modern Debate on Augustine’s Relation to Neoplatonism

• Alfaric, Prosper. 1918. L’évolution intellectuelle de saint Augustin. Émile Nourry.
• Boissier, Gaston. 1888. “La Conversion de Saint Augustin.” Revue des Deux Mondes. 85 (3): 43–69.
  • Above are two of the classic sources of the tradition reading Augustine’s thought as progressing from Neoplatonism in his early writings to Christianity.
• Cary, Phillip. 2000. Augustine’s Invention of the Inner Self: The Legacy of a Christian Platonist. Oxford University Press.
  • The first of a trilogy by the author, developing an account of the idea of Augustine as a Christian Platonist who grew in Platonism at the same time as he was growing in Christianity.
• Conybeare, Catherine. 2006. The Irrational Augustine. Oxford University Press.
  • A rethinking of how to read Augustine. Conybeare suggests Augustine was never quite a Neoplatonist in the first place, making her book an alternative to the idea of Augustine as initially a Neoplatonist and later a Christian—and to the idea of him as consistently both.
• Courcelle, Pierre. 1963. Les Confessions de Saint Augustin dans la tradition littéraire. Études Augustiennes.
  • One of the classic sources of the account of Augustine as a Christian Neoplatonist, drawing connections to other Christian Neoplatonists such as Theodorus.
• Dobell, Brian. 2009. Augustine’s Intellectual Conversion: The Journey from Platonism to Christianity. Cambridge University Press.
  • An early twenty-first century book written in the tradition of those who see Augustine’s mind as developing from Neoplatonism towards Christianity.
• Harrison, Carol. 2008. Rethinking Augustine’s Early Theology: An Argument for Continuity. Oxford University Press.
  • A critique of modern versions of the idea of Augustine as growing from a Neoplatonist thinker into a Christian one, describing Augustine’s intellectual development as more of a “natural evolution” within Christianity than a shift from Neoplatonism. An important study of Augustine as a Platonically informed Christian, but not a Neoplatonist.
• O’Connell, Robert J. 1987. The Origin of the Soul in St. Augustine’s Later Works. Fordham University Press.
  • An important work arguing that Augustine held to a version of the Neoplatonic idea of the fall of the soul. O’Connell’s thesis has been influential and controversial.
• Madec, Goulven. 1962. “Connaissance de Dieu et action de graces: Essai sur les citations de l’Ép. aux Romains I, 18–25.” Revue des Études Augustiniennes. 2 (1): 273–309.
  • A classic source of the reading of Augustine as a Platonically informed Christian but not a Neoplatonist.
• Rombs, Ronnie. 2006. Saint Augustine and the Fall of the Soul: Beyond O’Connell and His Critics. Catholic University of America.
  • A study of O’Connell’s thesis about Augustine and the fall of the soul.
• Teske, Roland. 2008. To Know God and the Soul: Essays on the Thought of Saint Augustine. Catholic University of America Press.
  • Essays in the interpretive tradition that sees Augustine as a Christian Neoplatonist.
• von Harnack, Adolph. 1888. Augustins Konfessionen. Geissen.
  • One of the classic sources of the tradition of reading Augustine’s thought as progressing from Neoplatonism in the early writings to Christianity.

d. Studies on Augustine’s Theology

• Ayres, Lewis. 2010. Augustine and the Trinity. Cambridge University Press.
• Clarifies Augustine’s Trinitarian theology and its differences from Neoplatonism.
• Cameron, Michael. 2012. Christ Meets Me Everywhere: Augustine’s Early Figurative Exegesis. Oxford University Press.
  • An important work on Augustine’s hermeneutics, clarifying, for example, what is meant by figurative exegesis, and the distinction between figure and allegory. This book is also helpful in explaining Augustine’s idea of the totus Christus (the whole Christ) who speaks in the Bible: Jesus and his church united.
• Clair, Joseph. 2016. Discerning the Good in the Letters and Sermons of Augustine. Oxford University Press.
  • Representative of scholarship exploring the letters and sermons of Augustine. Clair’s book considers Augustine’s nuanced position on the good in light of the already highly nuanced discussion of the good in Greco-Roman philosophy.
• Evans, G. R. 1982. Augustine on Evil. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • A thorough study of Augustine’s response to evil. Essential reading for those interested in Augustine’s take on the POE.
• Fiedrowicz, Michael. 1997. Psalmus Vox Totius Christi: Studien zu Augustinus Enarrationes in Psalmos. Herder.
  • A study of Augustine’s Enarrationes in Psalmos. Important for elaborating on the idea of the totus Christus.
• Meconi, David Vincent. 2013. The One Christ: St. Augustine’s Theology of Deification. Catholic University of America Press.
  • This book argues that Augustine had a robust theology of deification, reconsidering the idea of Augustine as a Western theologian in some tension with Eastern Christianity, in which the theology of deification is a salient characteristic.
• Ployd, Adam. 2015. Augustine, the Trinity, and the Church: A Reading of the Anti-Donatist Sermons. Oxford University Press.
  • Considers Augustine’s Trinitarianism and ecclesiology together; representative of the newer scholarship exploring Augustine’s sermons.
• Spurgeon, C. H. 1886. All of Grace. An Earnest Word with Those Who Are Seeking Salvation with the Lord Jesus Christ. Robert Carter & Brothers.
• Teske, Roland. 2009. Augustine of Hippo: Philosopher, Exegete, and Theologian: A Second Collection of Essays. Marquette University Press.
  • A modern introduction to Augustine’s hermeneutics.
• Topping, Ryan S. 2012. Happiness and Wisdom: Augustine’s Early Theology of Education. Catholic University of America Press, 2012.
  • A study of Augustine’s approach to education in his earlier writings, particularly how he reconsidered the classical liberal arts to create a distinctively Christian view of a liberal arts education.

Author Information

Mark J. Boone
Email: platoandaugustine@gmail.com
Founders Classical Academy
U. S. A.