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Suppose it were known, by someone else, what you are going to
choose to do tomorrow. Wouldn't that entail that tomorrow you
must do what it was known in advance that you would do? In spite
of your deliberating and planning, in the end, all is futile: you
must choose exactly as it was earlier known that you would. The
supposed exercise of your free will is ultimately an illusion.
Historically, the tension between foreknowledge and the exercise
of free will was addressed in a religious context. According to
orthodox views in the West, God was claimed to be omniscient (and
hence in possession of perfect foreknowledge) and yet God was
supposed to have given humankind free will. Attempts to solve
the apparent contradiction often involved attributing to God
special properties, for example, being "outside" of time. However, the
trouble with such solutions is that they are generally
unsatisfactory on their own terms. Even more serious is the fact
that they leave untouched the problem posed not by God's
foreknowledge but that of any human being. Do human beings have
foreknowledge? Certainly, of at least some events and behaviors.
Thus we have a secular counterpart of the original problem. A
human being's foreknowledge, exactly as would God's, of another's
choices would seem to preclude the exercise of human free will.
Various ways of trying to solve the problem – for example, by
putting constraints on the truth-conditions for statements, or by
"tightening" the conditions necessary for knowledge – are
examined and shown not to work. Ultimately the alleged
incompatibility of foreknowledge and free will is shown to rest
on a subtle logical error. When the error, a modal fallacy, is
recognized, and remedied, the problem evaporates.
Table of Contents
(Clicking on the links below will take you to that part of
this article)
1. Introduction: The Problem of
Foreknowledge and Free Will
Moses Maimonides (1135-1204) has set out the problem in the
traditional manner:
… "Does God know or does He not know that a certain
individual will be good or bad? If thou sayest 'He knows', then
it necessarily follows that [that] man is compelled to act as God
knew beforehand he would act, otherwise God's knowledge would be
imperfect. …" [1]
The argument can be extended. The thrust of the argument does
not apply only to doing good or ill, but indeed to every human
act, from the most mundane to the most significant. The argument
could just as well read:
"Does God know or does He not know that a certain individual
(let's say the Prime Minister of Canada), on Feb. 3, 2081, will
put on brown shoes when dressing in the morning? If thou sayest
'He knows', then it necessarily follows that the Prime Minister
is compelled to act (i.e. to put on brown shoes) as God knew
beforehand he/she would, otherwise God's knowledge would be
imperfect. …"
The argument for the seeming impossibility of both God's having
foreknowledge and our having free will has troubled religious
thinkers, philosophers, and jurists for centuries.
It is clear why theologians are troubled by the challenge of
foreknowledge and free will. For most religions insist that God
has given human beings free will and thus human beings can choose
right from wrong, and that (in some religions at least) wrongful
acts are sinful and worthy of divine punishment, while good acts
are righteous and worthy of divine reward. But many of these
same religions will also insist that God is omniscient, i.e. God
knows everything (and thus has perfect foreknowledge).[2] To deny either
of these claims – that human beings have free will or that
God is omniscient – amounts to heresy. Yet, on the face of
it, each of these two claims appears to contradict the other.
But why should secular philosophers and jurists also be concerned
with this conundrum? For two reasons.
First is that many, perhaps most, contemporary philosophers and
jurists are keen to preserve the viability of the concept of free
will. Our legal institutions, our very sense of what is
praiseworthy and what is blameworthy, turn on the notion of free
will. It is at the conceptual bedrock of our civilization that
persons are creatures having the capacity of deliberation, that
we have the ability to recognize right from wrong, that we have
the ability to choose (to a large extent) what we do (and what we
do not do), and – most especially – we are responsible
for what we choose to do (and responsible for what we choose not
to do).
Second is that the challenge to the existence of free will is
posed not just by God's foreknowledge but by any foreknowledge
whatsoever. The religious version of the puzzle arises because
God is said to have omniscience, i.e. knowledge of everything.
But the problem would arise if anyone at all (i.e. anyone
whatsoever) were to have knowledge of our future actions. This
generalized version of the problem has come to be known as the
problem of Epistemic Determinism. For example, if my wife
were to know today that I would choose tea (rather than coffee)
for my breakfast tomorrow, then one could argue (paralleling
Maimonides's argument) that it would be impossible for me not to
choose tea tomorrow at breakfast.
The two concepts – (i) foreknowledge and (ii) human freedom
– seem to be utterly incompatible. The challenge, then, i.e.
the problem posed by epistemic determinism, is to find a way to
show that
| |
either |
(1) | foreknowledge (of human beings'
future actions) does not exist; |
| |
or |
(2) | free will does not exist; |
| |
or |
(3) | the alleged logical relation
between foreknowledge and the exercise of free will is
mistaken (i.e. foreknowledge is not incompatible with
the exercise of free will). |
Historically, some theologians have tried to solve the puzzle by
invoking unique properties of God. For example, some have argued
that God is 'outside of time' (or that 'His knowledge is
timeless') and thus His knowledge is not
foreknowledge at all, i.e. God's knowledge does
not occur before (or during, or after, for that matter)
any events in the world. The trouble with such solutions is (a)
they leave non-theistic versions of the puzzle untouched (e.g.
my wife's knowing that I will drink tea tomorrow), and (b) we can
construct a revised version of the puzzle explicitly invoking
God's timelessness, e.g.
God is omniscient and His knowledge is timeless, i.e. God knows
timelessly all that has happened, is happening, and will
happen. Therefore, if He knows timelessly that a person will
perform such-and-such an action, then it is impossible for that
person not to perform that action.
Some other theologians have argued that God has a 'special
way' of knowing. Unlike human beings (and
other sentient creatures) who must causally interact with the
world (e.g. read a report, see an event, examine evidence [such
as ashes, skid marks, etc.]), God is said to 'know
directly', i.e. without the need
of sensory data or of physical interaction with the world.
Such a notion of 'direct knowledge' is problematic in itself; but
more importantly, it is hard to see how it solves the problem at
hand, indeed how it even addresses the problem. For, again, as
was the case with arguing that God's knowledge is outside of
time, the same two objections can be raised to this putative
solution: (a') this latter attempted solution leaves the
non-theistic version of the puzzle untouched; and (b') we can
construct a revised version of the puzzle explicitly invoking
God's 'direct knowledge', e.g.
God knows directly (i.e. without sensory data) all that
has happened, is happening, and will happen. Therefore, if He
knows directly that a person will perform such-and-such an
action, then it is impossible for that person not to perform that
action.
Contemporary philosophers, especially secular ones, seek a
solution elsewhere. We are disinclined to pursue solutions
that call upon special properties of God, especially since any
such solution leaves the 'secular' version of the problem
untouched.
The focus of attention has shifted dramatically. Secular
philosophers argue that the supposed incompatibility arises out
of a very subtle but seductive logical fallacy. So
unobvious is this fallacy that it escaped detection by Maimonides
and hundreds (perhaps even countless thousands) of other persons.
The error has come to bear the name "The Modal Fallacy".
However, before we examine the Modal Fallacy, we need to delve
deeper into the notions of determinism, truth, and
knowledge.
2. Three Kinds of
Determinism
There are three distinct versions of determinism: logical,
epistemic, and causal. Each has been alleged to pose a threat to
the exercise of free will, indeed it has been claimed of each
version that its existence is incompatible with the existence of
free will.
- Logical determinism is most frequently couched as the
problem of 'future contingents'. The threat to the exercise of
free will arises from the thesis that the truth-value (i.e. the
truth or falsity) of any proposition[3]
is timeless, i.e. those propositions that are true are always
true, and those propositions that are false are always false.
Thus:
If a proposition about some future action you undertake (let's
say tomorrow) is true, then it is true now. But if it is true
now, then tomorrow you must undertake that action, that action
must occur, you are powerless to prevent yourself from
undertaking that action.
(Note that "logical" in the phrase "logical determinism" is not
meant to contrast with "illogical", but instead refers to a
particular concept of logic, namely truth itself.)
- Epistemic determinism has a strikingly similar
formulation. Instead of simply attributing truth (or falsity) to
propositions about the future, epistemic determinism concerns
such propositions' being known prior to the times of the
occurrences they refer to. We then get this argument, parallel
to the preceding one:
If a proposition about some future action you undertake is known
(in advance), then (when the time comes) you must undertake that
action, that action must occur, you are powerless to prevent
yourself from undertaking that action.
- Causal determinism is the thesis that all events
(occurrences, processes, etc.) are the result of Laws of Nature
and of antecedent conditions and of nothing else. Thus (to cite
an example made famous by Carl Hempel), when a car radiator
cracks overnight, it is the consequence of laws pertaining to the
tensile strength of iron, of laws pertaining to the expansion of
water upon freezing, to the structure of the radiator, to its
being filled with water without anti-freeze, and to the
temperature's falling well below freezing for several
hours.[4] In the case of
human beings' acting, the same scenario is said to obtain.
If whatever one does is the result of Laws of Nature and of one's
physical and genetic makeup and one's personal history, then
– since all these 'factors' are 'set' (or 'in place') at the
moment of one's acting – you must undertake the action you
perform, that action must occur, you are powerless to prevent
yourself from undertaking that action.
Three arguments all with the same conclusion, namely that your
actions are 'determined' (in one of three different ways) and
thus your actions are 'unfree'. Free will is an illusion.
Of the three deterministic arguments, the most difficult to
engage is the third, that of causal determinism. Indeed, so
knotted is that argument, and so contentious are the issues
surrounding its presuppositions, it is treated separately in this
Encyclopedia. (See e.g.
"Laws of
Nature".)
From this point on,
this article will examine only
Epistemic Determinism
and Logical Determinism.
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3. The Relationship Between Epistemic
and Logical Determinism
Since the ground-breaking work of Plato (427?-347? B.C.E.) most
philosophers have agreed that there are (at least) three
conditions that must be satisfied for a human being, let's say
"x", to have knowledge of matters of fact, let's say "P":
- P (is true)
- x has good evidence, e, that P (and has little, or no,
countervailing evidence)[5]
- x believes, on the basis of e, that P
In the case of God, one may want to drop the second condition,
the evidential requirement, allowing that God knows
directly without the need of evidence. The third
condition, the belief-condition, poses certain problems as well.
In the case of human beings, this condition captures the 'mental'
or 'cognitive' aspect of knowledge. But the beliefs of an
omniscient God are unlike those of human beings. The beliefs of
human beings are finite, shifting, fallible, and corrigible.
Those of an omniscient God are infinite, unchanging, infallible,
and incorrigible. Perhaps, then, "believes" is not quite the
right word to use when speaking of God's knowledge, but no other
is ready at hand.
Be this as it may, there remains one common element (at least) in
the case of a human being's having knowledge and God's having knowledge,
viz. what is known is true. Neither God nor any human being can
literally know anything that is in fact false. Put another way,
truth is a prerequisite of knowledge (or using the vocabulary of
logic, truth is a necessary condition for knowledge).[6]
Someone may believe strongly that some proposition is true,
indeed he may insist that he knows, he may insist that he has
incontrovertible evidence that that proposition is true, but if
that proposition is in fact false, then he does not know.
(This is not to say that he must have some way of finding out
that he is mistaken. We are here divorcing truth from belief.)
Every proposition that is genuinely known (i.e. to be true) is
true; but the converse – viz. that every proposition that
is true is known – certainly does not hold for
less-than-omniscient human beings.
The upshot is that the premises of the argument for Epistemic
Determinism (i.e. that there can be knowledge of some [at least]
of a person's future actions) presuppose the premises of
the argument for Logical Determinism. For, simply, if there is
knowledge now (i.e. prior to the occurrence) of some future
actions, then there are propositions about the future that are
true now. If one were able to reject the premises of the
argument for Logical Determinism, one would thereby render the
argument for Epistemic Determinism unsound.
4. Attacking the Premises of Deterministic
Arguments
As is the case with any argument, four responses are possible.
- One can accept the argument. In effect, this is to say that
one regards the argument as being sound, i.e. as having true
premises and as being valid.
- One can argue that although the argument is valid, its
premise-set is false (and thus its conclusion is unsupported).
- One can reject the validity of the argument, in particular by
arguing that although the premise-set is true, the conclusion
does not follow from that premise-set.
- Finally, one can adopt both of the immediately preceding two
strategies, i.e. argue that not only is the premise-set false,
the argument is invalid to boot.
Some religious groups, e.g. the early Calvinists, have adopted
the first option. They accept the soundness of the
deterministic arguments and – giving primacy to God's
knowledge over human beings' free will – argue that
free will does not exist.
Needless to say, very few others have been inclined to adopt
such a view, indeed most persons who are familiar with the
deterministic arguments are strongly motivated to rebut such a
view. Such persons will, therefore, examine the possibility of
adopting option 2 or 3. We turn, then, first, to see
whether one can cogently rebut the premises of the argument for
Logical Determinism.
4a. Can a Future Contingent be true prior to the
event it refers to?
Propositions about future events, or, if one prefers, about
future matters of fact, are known as future contingents.
The earliest discussion of future contingents, and the attendant
problem of logical determinism, occurs in Aristotle's De
Interpretatione 9.[7]
There, Aristotle discusses the case of 'Tomorrow's Sea Battle'.
His argument, reconstructed and embellished, is this:
Two warring admirals, A and B, are preparing their fleets for a
decisive sea battle tomorrow. The battle will be fought until one
side is victorious. But the 'logical laws (or principles)' of the
excluded middle (every proposition is either true or false) and
of noncontradiction (no proposition is both true and false),
require that one of the propositions, 'A wins' and 'it is false
that A wins', is true and the other is false. Suppose 'A wins' is
(today) true. Then whatever A does (or fails to do) today will
make no difference: A must win; similarly, whatever B does (or
fails to do) today will make no difference: the outcome is
already settled, i.e. A must win. Or again, suppose 'A wins' is
(today) false. Then no matter what A does today (or fails to do),
it will make no difference: A must lose; similarly, no matter
what B does (or fails to do), it will make no difference: the
outcome is already settled, i.e. A must win. Thus, if every
proposition is either true or false (and not both), then
planning, or as Aristotle put it 'taking trouble', is futile. The
future will be what it will be, irrespective of our planning,
intentions, etc.
How might one try to rebut the premises of Aristotle's argument?
Proposal One: One might argue that propositions
are not true in advance of the events described. Propositions
'become' true when the events described occur.
First objection to Proposal One: (i) Sirhan Sirhan
killed Robert F. Kennedy. But when did it 'become true' that
Sirhan Sirhan killed Kennedy? At the moment of his pulling the
trigger? But the bullet was not yet lodged in Kennedy's body. At
the time of the bullet's entering Kennedy's body? But Kennedy
did not die immediately. He was rushed to a hospital where he
died some hours later. At the moment of Kennedy's death? But at
that moment Sirhan Sirhan was in the custody of police in a
building remote from the hospital where Kennedy was. (This
conundrum is the handiwork of Judith Jarvis Thomson.[8] ) The point
is that although it is clearly true that Sirhan Sirhan killed
Kennedy, it is problematic to pin down an exact time (or even a
candidate for the exact time) when Sirhan killed Kennedy and, by
extension, when it 'became true' that Sirhan killed Kennedy.
(ii) When did Germany lose World War II? When the Allies'
invasion force landed on the beaches of Normandy? When British
scientists and engineers invented and were able to use radar
against the German Luftwaffe? When Alan Turing and his team broke
the German secret code? When …?
The issues in the preceding paragraph strongly suggest that it
will prove problematic in the extreme to try to put precise times
on the (supposed) occurrence of a proposition's 'becoming true'.
Moreover, propositions are supposed to be abstract entities,
entities which do not exist in space and time; but if they do not
exist in time, how can their properties change – from
being neither true nor false to being true (or to being false as
the case may be) – at some particular time?
Second objection to Proposal One: We do, in a
great many cases, routinely ascribe truth to propositions about
future events. (iii) Each year the Children's Hospital in
Vancouver has a lottery in which the grand prize is a new
'prestige home'. Persons buy tickets on the firm belief that some
winning ticket will be drawn. If the Hospital deliberately
failed to draw a ticket, on the scheduled date, from the pool of
purchased tickets, all those who had purchased a ticket could
rightly claim that the hospital had been lying, i.e. had been
asserting false propositions. The ticket-holders had all assumed
that the proposition "Some winning ticket will be drawn on the
scheduled date" was true, weeks before the scheduled date. (iv)
It is true today that there will a US presidential election in
2048. And (v) it is demonstrably true now that there will be a
total solar eclipse, over parts of Libya and Turkey, on 30
April 2060.[9]
Third objection to Proposal One: To argue that
propositions about the future acquire a truth-value only when the
described event occurs (i.e. in the future) will entail
abandoning the logical law (/principle) of the excluded middle:
propositions about the future will not, then, have truth-values
now, i.e. prior to the occurrence of the predicted event.
Adopting Proposal One would require our creating a far more
complicated logic. This is not to say that this proposed solution
is completely without merit; but it is to say that we ought to
try to find some other solution before resorting to such a major
revision of logic. [For more discussion of these objections, see
Time: Is the future real?.]
What other way might one, then, propose to avoid the conclusion
of the argument about tomorrow's sea battle?
Proposal Two: Disjunctions (i.e. propositions of
the form "P or Q" [in this particular case "A wins or
it is false that A wins"]) are true, but not the individual
disjuncts (components, i.e. "A wins" and "it is false that A
wins").
Objection to Proposal Two: The proposal is
terribly peculiar. We are inclined to say that a disjunction is
true just because (at least) one of its disjuncts is true. If
neither P is true nor Q is true, how can
"P or Q" be true? And, further, just as in the previous
proposal, this one, too, entails abandoning the law of the
excluded middle: while "A wins or it is false that A wins" has a
truth-value now, neither of the two propositions "A wins" and "it
is false that A wins" has a truth-value now. So, once again, we
would prefer a less radical solution.
Interim Conclusion #1:
It emerges, then, that challenging the premises of the argument
for logical determinism – viz. that a proposition about an
event can be true prior to the occurrence of that event –
is not a promising approach to solving the problem of the threat
posed to the existence of free will. (We will return to a further
examination of Logical Determinism in due course.) Since truth
is a necessary condition for knowledge, if we had been able to
reject the premises of the argument for logical determinism, we
would, thereby, at a stroke have undercut the argument for
epistemic determinism. But, at this point in our discussions, we
are allowing that future contingents can be true (or false) now,
prior to the events referred to. Thus we must next examine
whether the premises of the argument for epistemic determinism
can be true.
4b. Can a Future Contingent be known prior to the
event it refers to?
How might one try to rebut the premises of the argument for
epistemic determinism?
Proposal One: One might argue that factual
propositions are knowable only through a causal chain linking the
event to the would-be knower. One can know, for
example, that Mount St. Helens erupted within the last one hundred
years: by
hearing the reports of eyewitnesses, by seeing the event on
television, by reading newspaper accounts, and by viewing the
very considerable damage to the environs of the mountain. In
short, we know of events by their causal remnants and
since there apparently are no cases of 'backwards causation',
knowledge of future contingents is impossible.
Objection to Proposal One:
Even if it is granted that there are no causal remnants of future
events, the conclusion that there can be no knowledge of future
events is false. Examining their remnants is not the only way to
have knowledge of future events. In the case of Mount St.
Helens, for example, ample warning was given (a month earlier) by
the US Forestry Service of the imminent cataclysm. Some of those
who choose to ignore the danger signals did not live long to
regret their folly.
And it is not only of impending large-scale disasters that we
often have foreknowledge. Throughout our normal, even humdrum,
days we depend on our knowledge of future contingents in
order to maintain our lives and to avert death. When we see a
bus traveling at a high speed along a highway on whose curb we
are standing, we know full well that that bus is going to pass in
front of us and that it would kill us if we were to be foolhardy
enough to step in front of it just as it approached. None of
us expects the bus suddenly, as it approaches, to turn into a
slow-moving marshmallow. We know that the bus will retain
its 'integrity' as a bus. Even such a simple, commonplace,
act as unceremoniously opening and drinking a bottle of cola
requires our knowing that it will not poison us, that it is, and
will remain, potable.
Simply put, our knowledge of how the world has behaved up till
now provides powerful evidence of how it will behave. That is
why we teach our children not to play in the street, why we teach
our children not to put their fingers into electrical outlets,
why we (try to) teach our children not to drive while
intoxicated, etc. Our daily behavior provides abundant and
powerful evidence that we do, to a very great extent, know
perfectly well what the future will be.
Proposal Two: The examples offered in the objection
(immediately above) are not bona fide cases of foreknowledge;
they are cases merely of strong beliefs. We may
believe we know, but something 'could go wrong' between
now and the predicted event. We cannot rule out our making a
mistake. There is always the ineliminable possibility of error.
For example, the person who opens and drinks a bottle of cola
doesn't really know that it is safe to drink, that someone hasn't
in fact tampered with the drink and poisoned it. Because of the
possibility of unforeseen circumstances, even if they are very
improbable, one cannot have genuine knowledge of the future.
First Objection to Proposal Two: Knowing a future
contingent does not require that there be no possibility of our
making a error. Yes, we could make a mistake, yes,
something might happen that will make our prediction turn out
false, but that is no reason to claim that we cannot know the
future. What is required is that we have good grounds to make
our prediction and that they be true, not that there be no
possibility of error.
At the dawn of the 'modern' era in philosophy, René
Descartes (1595-1649) began his Meditations by asking what
could be known for certain. He sets as his program the
elimination from his belief-system all that is not, or cannot be,
known for certain.
My reason tells me that as well as withholding assent from
propositions that are obviously false, I should also withhold it
from ones that are not completely certain and
indubitable.[10]
Given the tenor of his time, with the extraordinary success of
the 'new' science, the headiness of such a claim is perhaps
understandable (and forgivable). But it was, in the end, a
colossal error. It was the pursuit of an impossible goal, the
philosophical equivalent of placing the goalposts in an
unreachable place.
The two phrases "x knows" and "x knows for certain" are no more
equivalent than "x sees the distant mountain" and "x sees the
distant mountain perfectly (e.g. from miles away x can see the
veins in the leaves on the trees)". Persons who do not have
perfect pitch may, nonetheless, know when a pianist has hit a
wrong note. One doesn't have to hear perfectly to hear. Two
mathematicians may prove the same theorem; one of these proofs
may be 'elegant', the other 'circuitous'; but both are proofs. A
proof need not be elegant in order to be proof.
Similarly with knowledge. What one knows need not be
certain; some, probably most, things that we know fall
short of certainty, but it is arbitrary and stultifying to refuse
to acknowledge these cases as genuine cases of knowledge. By
setting the standards too high, as did Descartes and as do many
of his intellectual heirs even today, is to rob the concept of
"knowledge" of its utility.
To know the future, it is not required that we be
infallible (i.e. incapable of making a mistake). The
person who sees a bus fast approaching knows that it will not
(miraculously) turn into a marshmallow. And she is right: it
does not. Realistically, few of us (unless corrupted by a bad
introductory philosophy course), would be tempted to say, "She
didn't know. After all, the bus could have turned
into a marshmallow." True enough, there is one sense in
which the bus could have turned into a marshmallow, and
that sense is that such an eventuality is a logical
possibility, i.e. is not logically self-contradictory. Indeed it
is a matter of the very definition of "matter of fact" or
"contingency" that such propositions are both possibly true and
possibly false. Every true contingency is (as a matter of the
very definition of "contingency") possibly false; and likewise
every false contingency is (as a matter of the very definition of
"contingency") possibly true. [More on this in section 5
below.] But nothing of particular significance follows from
these latter facts.
One must be careful not to 'slide' from "possible" to
"probable". Just because an event is possible does not
justify the inference that it is probable. The
proposition that the US Congress will adopt Swedish as the
country's sole national language certainly is a logical
possibility, i.e. is not self-contradictory. But that
proposition has a probability, for all intents and purposes, of
zero. Every contingent proposition is both possibly true and
possibly false. And some propositions that are possibly false
have a reasonably high probability of being actually true; while
some (other) possibly false propositions have a (nearly) zero
probability (/zero likelihood) of being true. The essential
point for our knowing a contingent proposition is (a) our
having a well-founded belief that it is true and (b) that it
is true. Its being possibly false is irrelevant. Its being
probably false is quite another matter, but whether it is
probably false or is not probably false is not entailed by its
being possibly false.
Every true contingency whatsoever, not just those about the
future, is possibly false. It is truth that counts,
not possible falsehood. Actual truth 'trumps' possible falsehood
in the matter of a proposition's being known.
Second Objection to Proposal Two: One must be
careful not to set the requirements, for knowing the future,
unrealistically high. For such standards can rebound and make it
impossible to know the past as well.
In the first decade of the Twentieth Century, the conductor and
musicologist, Friedrich Wilhelm Stein, discovered in Jena,
Germany, a copyist's version of a formerly unknown symphony. The
copyist had annotated it as having been written by Beethoven. It
was published in 1911 as Beethoven's "Jena Symphony". However,
in 1957, H.C. Robbins Landon uncovered the original manuscript
and established that the composition had in fact been written by
Friedrich Witt (1770-1837), a contemporary of Beethoven's.
Clearly those who believed, in the years 1911 through 1947, that
the "Jena Symphony" had been composed by Beethoven had a
well-grounded belief. But, as it was to turn out, their belief
was mistaken. And this little piece of history demonstrates how
what we take to be knowledge of past events can be mistaken. But
what moral should one draw from this story?
Although we can never eliminate entirely the possibility of our
having mistaken beliefs about past events, or misleading (or
incorrect) evidence for those beliefs, it does not follow that we
do not have knowledge of a great many past events. There is, to
cite just one instance, simply too much evidence, indeed
overwhelming evidence, that Mount St. Helens erupted on 18
May 1980 for anyone to have a rational belief that we do not
know that historical fact. To be sure, it is logically
possible that we should be mistaken. But the
probability that we are mistaken is effectively zero.
If we are to be skeptical about the possibility of knowing any
future events, we would have to be equally skeptical of our
knowledge of the past. And if we are not unduly skeptical about
our knowledge of the past, we ought not to be unduly skeptical
about the possibility of our knowing certain future events. (And
as for the claim that we know far more about the past than we do
of the future, one must bear in mind that we know only an
infinitesimal part of what has happened in the past. Do you
know, or indeed have any way of finding out, for example, the
names of Leif Ericson's shipmates?)
Understand that I am not being especially skeptical about the
past. All I am trying to do is to draw a parallel between
knowledge of the past and knowledge of the future. The parallels
are these: in both sorts of cases it is possible to have very
strong evidence; in both sorts of cases it is possible to be
mistaken. Possibly being mistaken is not a condition unique to
claims about knowing the future; it applies equally to claims
about knowing the past. But in neither case does the
possibility of error undermine truth.
Proposal Three: The examples that have been given
of foreknowledge, e.g. of a solar eclipse, of an imminent
volcanic eruption, of a US presidential election, etc., are cases
of naturally occurring phenomena or of legislatively mandated
events. Such events have an overwhelmingly high probability of
occurring. But when we turn to cases of human beings making
choices, the situation is vastly different.
Many, perhaps most, human choices and behaviors are the product
of free will. Some of these choices and behaviors are conscious
and deliberative considerations; others are subject to whim, to
irrational desires, to spur-of-the-moment decisions, etc. None
of us can know, in advance, what another person's free choice
will be.
Objections to Proposal Three: This latter way of
trying to undercut the premises of the argument for Epistemic
Determinism works, if at all, only for the secular version. It
does nothing to diminish the sting of the version capitalizing on
God's omniscience.
But even if this objection is confined to the secular version, it
hardly addresses the alleged conundrum. For the secular version
of the argument for Epistemic Determinism does not, in the
slightest, require that we human beings be able to foresee
all the actions and behavior of other persons. The
argument has its dreadful bite even if we are able to foresee
only some of the free choices of others. And being able
to do that is something that is familiar to everyone.
In the case of persons whom we know well, especially family
members, we are able to know, in certain circumstances, what they
are about to say or do. If my wife and I go to dinner at one
particular restaurant, I know beforehand, without her telling me,
what she will order for dessert (lemon pie). If I happen to
glance at her shopping list before she leaves home, I can know in
advance that she will return with some 60-watt light
bulbs. All of these are free choices on her part; none of
them is coerced or forced in any way. Yet, I do know them.
In the case of predicting the behavior of groups of persons,
entire industries have grown up in the last 100 years devoted to
such inquiries: professional pollsters, of course, but also
economists, psychologists, political commentators, planning
departments of large corporations, marketing advisers,
pension-fund managers, etc., operating under a number of
context-relevant constraints, e.g. to minimize losses, to
maximize gains, etc. Perhaps nowhere is such research of greater
consequence than in planning military maneuvers (as in World
War II). On that occasion, it became a matter of life and
death for countless numbers of troops that their commanders
correctly predicted the actions of their enemies.
Interim Conclusion #2:
Earlier we saw that there are no good reasons to
reject the claim that future contingents are true (or
false as the case may be) prior to the occurrence of the events
they refer to. And now we see that, similarly, there are no good
reasons to reject the claim that many future contingents (all
future contingents in the case of God) can be, and more
especially are, known prior to the events they
refer to.
Thus, if we are, finally, to remove the sting of the
deterministic arguments, we will have to do so by arguing that
these arguments, although having true premises, are –
appearances to the contrary – invalid. Each of
these
arguments harbors a logical slip between their premises and their
conclusions. The rest of this article is given over to revealing
the nature of the logical error.
5. Possibility, Necessity, and
Contingency
To expose the mistakes in the deterministic arguments, we will
need some tools of modern logic. Some elementary symbols will
help to illuminate the concepts at play in the deterministic
arguments. However, all the formulas that will be used, which
incorporate these symbols, will also be expressed in English
prose.
| Symbol |
Its meaning |
Explanation |
| P, Q, R, ... |
propositions |
See footnote 3 |
| ~P |
it is not the case that P |
Example: It is not the case that copper conducts
electricity. (Note: "P" and "~P" have opposite
truth-values – whichever is true, the other is
false.) |
P  Q |
if P, then Q |
Example: If she is late, (then) the meeting will be
delayed. |
| gKP |
God knows that P |
Example: God knows that the Mississippi River flows
north to south. |
Next we need three concepts at the heart of modern modal
logic. The symbols are:
| Symbol |
Its meaning |
Explanation |
 P |
it is (logically) possible that P |
Example: It is (logically) possible that the United
States was defeated in World War II. (Note: Whatever
is not self-contradictory is logically possible.) |
 P |
It is (logically) necessary that P |
Example: It is logically necessary that every number has
a double. (Note: If Q is not logically possible, then
~Q is logically necessary.) |
 P |
It is contingent that P |
Example: It is contingent that the United States
purchased Alaska from Russia. (Note: A proposition, Q, is
contingent if and only if
Q and
~Q.) |
These latter three concepts require further elaboration.
P is possible (symbolized "P").
A proposition,
P, is possible if and only if it is not self-contradictory. All
propositions that are true are possibly true. In addition, some
false propositions are also possibly true, namely those that are
false but are not self-contradictory. Some philosophers like to
explicate "P is possible" in this way: "There are some possible
circumstances in which P is true". And some philosophers,
adopting the terminology popularized by Leibniz (1646-1716), will
substitute "worlds" for "circumstances", yielding "P is true in
some possible worlds". Examples of possibly true propositions
include:
- Ottawa, Canada, is north of Washington, DC.
- The Great Salt Lake is saltier than the Dead Sea.
- The Dead Sea is saltier than the Great Salt Lake.
- John Lennon was the first songwriter to travel in a space
capsule.
- There are three times as many species of insect as there are
species of mollusk.
- 2 + 2 = 4
- All aunts are female.
- Some pigs can levitate.
Understand that prefacing a proposition, P, with "" does not 'make' P possible. What it does is to
create a new, different, proposition, viz.
P,
which, in effect, says that P is possible. If P is
possible (e.g. suppose "P" stands for "Gold was first discovered
in California in 1990"), then (although P is false),
P is true. Or, suppose "Q" stands for "2 + 2
= 7". Then prefacing "Q" with "" does
not 'make' Q possible. It produces a new proposition, "Q", which is false. Q is, and remains, impossible
whether or not it is prefaced with "".
Everything that is actual (or actually true) is possible (i.e.
possibly true). But if a proposition is actually false, then it
is impossible only if it is self-contradictory; otherwise it is a
false contingency, and all contingencies, whether true or false,
are possible.
We may ask "What color did Sylvia paint the lawn chair?" We look
at the chair and see that she has painted it yellow. Thus it is
demonstrable that it is possible that she painted the chair
yellow. And its being yellow implies it is false that she
painted the chair blue. But the falsity of the proposition that
she painted the lawn chair blue in no way precludes that she
could have done so. Even though false, it still remains
possible that she painted the chair blue.
P is necessary (symbolized "P").
Necessarily true propositions are those that are true in all
possible circumstances (/worlds), i.e. are not false in
any. Necessary truth can be defined in terms of possibility,
viz. P is necessary if and only if its negation (i.e.
"~P") is impossible. In symbols (where "=df"
stands for "is by definition"):
P =df ~~P
Examples of necessarily true propositions:
- 2 + 2 = 4
- All aunts are female.
- Whatever is blue is colored.
- There are either fewer than 20 million stars or there
are more than 12 million. (This statement may be unobvious; but
if you think about it you may come to see that it cannot be
false.)
- It is false that some triangle has exactly four sides.
P is contingent (symbolized "P"). A proposition, P, is contingent if and only
if it is both possibly true and possibly false.
Contingent propositions are those that are true in some possible
circumstances (/worlds) and are false in some possible
circumstances (/worlds). Contingency can be defined in terms of
possibility, viz.
P =df
P &
~P
It is essential to understand that "P &
~P" does not mean "P is true and false
in some possible circumstances (worlds)". No proposition
whatsoever is both true and false in the same set of
circumstances (law of non-contradiction). To say that a
proposition is contingent is to say that it is true in some
possible circumstances and is false in some (other!)
circumstances.
Examples:
- The Boston Red Sox won the World Series in 2002.
- It is false that the Boston Red Sox won the World Series in
2002.
- Steel-clad ships can float in the ocean.
- It is false that steel-clad ships can float in the ocean.
Modal terms and modal status
Terms such as "must", "has to", "cannot", "is necessary", "is
impossible", "could not be otherwise", "has to be", "might",
"could be", "contingent", and the like, are known as "modal"
terms. All of these are definable in terms of "possibility".
Every proposition is either logically possible or logically
impossible. And no proposition is both.
Drawing the net a bit finer, and dividing the class of logically
possible propositions into those that are necessarily true and
those that are contingent, we have three exclusive categories.
Every proposition is exclusively either necessarily true,
necessarily false, or contingent. That is, every proposition
falls into one of these latter three categories, and no
proposition falls into more than one.
Just as the expression "truth-value" is a generic term
encompassing "truth" and "falsity", the expression "modal status"
is a generic term encompassing "contingent", "necessarily true",
and "necessarily false".
Finally, no proposition ever changes its modal status.
We will call this principle "The
Principle of the Fixity of Modal Status". And for the
purposes of assessing the deterministic arguments we note
especially: no contingent proposition ever 'becomes' necessary
or impossible.
6. The Modal Fallacy
From a mathematical point of view, if we arbitrarily pick any
two propositions, truth and falsity can be attributed to them in
four different combinations, specifically
the first is true, and the second is true
the first is true, and the second is false
the first is false, and the second is true
the first is false, and the second is false
However, it sometimes happens that two propositions will have
certain logical relationships between them such as to make one or
more of these four combinations impossible. For example,
consider the two propositions
 and
 .
: Diane planted only six rosebushes.
: Diane planted fewer than eight
rosebushes.
While each of these propositions, by itself, could be true and
could be false, there are – as it turns out – only
three, not four, possible combinations of truth and
falsity that can be attributed to this particular pair of
propositions. On careful thought, we can see that the second
combination – that is, the one which attributes truth to
and falsity to
–
is impossible. For if is true (i.e. if it
is true that Diane has planted only six rosebushes) then
is also true. Put another way: the truth of
guarantees the truth of
.
This is to say
(1) It is impossible (for
to be true
and for to be false).
Unfortunately, ordinary English does not lend itself easily to
express the quasi-symbolic sentence (1). In symbols we can
express the sentence this way:
(1a) ~(
& ~)
About the best we can do in English is to create the following
unidiomatic, extremely clumsy sentence:
(1b) The compound sentence,
and
not-, is impossible (i.e. is
necessarily false).
English prose is a poor tool for expressing fine logical
distinctions (just as it is an unsuitable tool for expressing
fine mathematical distinctions[11] ). But, as it turns
out, the situation is worse than just having to make do with
awkward sentences. For it is a curious fact about most natural
languages – English, French, Hebrew, etc. – that when
we use modal terms in ordinary speech, we often do so in
logically misleading ways. Just see how natural it is to try to
formulate the preceding point [viz. proposition (1)] in this
fashion:
(2) If is true, then it is impossible
for to be false.
Or, in symbols:
(2a)
~~
In ordinary speech, the latter sentence, (2), is natural and
idiomatic; the former sentence (1b) is unnatural and unidiomatic.
But – and this is the crucial point – the
propositions
expressed by (1)-(1b) are not equivalent to the
propositions expressed by sentences (2)-(2a). The
former set, that is (1)-(1b), are all true. The
latter, (2)-(2a) are false and commit the modal
fallacy. The fallacy occurs in its assigning the modality of
impossibility, not to the relationship between the truth of
and falsity of
as is done
in (1)-(1b), but to the falsity of
alone. Ordinary grammar beguiles us and misleads
us. It makes us believe that if
is true,
then it is impossible for
to be false. But
it is possible for
to be
false. is a contingent proposition.
Recall the principle of the fixity of modal status. Even if the
falsity of is guaranteed by the truth of
some other proposition [in this case
],
does not 'become' impossible: it
'remains' contingent, and thereby possible.
Whatever impossibility there is lies in jointly asserting
and denying
. (See (1b)
above.) The proposition "it is false that " does not 'become' impossible if one
asserts .[12]
6a. The Modal Fallacy in Logical Determinism
Some persons have been deceived by the following (fallacious)
argument to the effect that there are no contingent propositions:
"(By the Law of Non-contradiction), if a proposition is true
(/false), then it cannot be false (/true). If a proposition
cannot be false (/true), then it is necessarily true (/false).
Therefore if a proposition is true (/false), it is necessarily
true (/false). That is, there are no contingent propositions.
Every proposition is either necessarily true or necessarily
false. (If we could see the world from God's viewpoint, we would
see the necessity of everything. Contingency is simply an
artifact of ignorance. Contingency disappears with
complete knowledge.)"
The fallacy arises in the ambiguity of the first premise. If we
interpret it close to the English, we get:
P ~~P
~~P
P
 P
P
However, if we regard the English as misleading, as assigning a
necessity to what is simply nothing more than a necessary
condition, then we get instead as our premises:
~(P & ~P) [equivalently:
(P
P)]
~~P
P
From these latter two premises, one cannot validly
infer the conclusion:
P
P.
In short, the argument to the effect that there are no contingent
propositions is unsound. Its very first premise commits the
modal fallacy.
The identical error occurs in the argument for logical
determinism. Recall (the expanded version of) Aristotle's sea
battle:
Two warring admirals, A and B, are preparing their fleets for a
decisive sea battle tomorrow. The battle will be fought until one
side is victorious. But the 'logical laws (or principles)' of the
excluded middle (every proposition is either true or false) and
of noncontradiction (no proposition is both true and false),
require that one of the propositions, 'A wins' and 'it is false
that A wins', is true and the other is false. Suppose 'A wins' is
(today) true. Then whatever A does (or fails to do) today will
make no difference: A must win; similarly, whatever B does (or
fails to do) today will make no difference: the outcome is
already settled, i.e. A must win. Or again, suppose 'A wins' is
(today) false. Then no matter what A does today (or fails to do),
it will make no difference: A must lose; similarly, no matter
what B does (or fails to do), it will make no difference: the
outcome is already settled, i.e. A must win. Thus, if every
proposition is either true or false (and not both), then
planning, or as Aristotle put it 'taking trouble', is futile. The
future will be what it will be, irrespective of our planning,
intentions, etc.
If we let "A" stand for "Admiral A wins" and let "B" stand for
"Admiral B wins", the core of this argument can be stated in
symbols this way:
 |
|
|
|
| A or B |
[one or the other of these two propositions is
true] |
| ~(A & B) |
[it is not possible that both A and B are
true] |
|
|
A
A
A ~~A |
} |
If A is true, then A must be true.
If A is true, then A cannot be false.
|
| |
A
~B
A ~B |
} |
If A is true, then B must be
false.
If A is true, then B cannot be true.
|
| |
B
B
B ~~B |
} |
If B is true, then B must be true.
If B is true, then B cannot be false.
|
| |
B
~A
B ~A |
} |
If B is true, then A must be
false.
If B is true, then A cannot be true.
|
In this argument, by hypothesis, either A is true or
B is true, and since they cannot both be true, the
second premise may be accepted as true. But none of the
conclusions is true. A is contingent, and B is
contingent. Yet the conclusions state that from the assumed
truth of either of (the two contingencies) A or B, it
follows that A and B are each either necessarily true
or necessarily false. Each of these eight conclusions violates
the principle of the fixity of modal status. What, then,
are the conclusions one may draw validly from the
premises? These:
| (A
~B) |
or, equivalently, |
~(A & B) |
| (B
~A) |
or, equivalently, |
~(B & A) |
So long as we remain mindful of the fact that "~(P & Q)" is logically equivalent to
"(P
~Q)" but is not equivalent to "P
~Q", the
argument for logical determinism will be seen to be
invalid.[13] Our ordinary language treats
"it is impossible for both P and Q to be true" as if it
were logically equivalent to "if P is true, then Q is
necessarily false". But the profound difference between these
two assertions is that the former preserves the principle of the
fixity of modal status, the latter violates that principle. The
proposition, "Admiral A wins", is contingent, and if true, then
it 'remains' true. Indeed this is a trivial logical truth:
(i) (P
P)
alternatively,
~(P &
~P)
The argument for logical determinism illicitly treats this
logical truth as if it were equivalent to the false proposition
(ii) P
P
alternatively, P
~~P
If you do not let yourself be beguiled by the invalid 'move'
(inference) from (i) to (ii), the argument for logical
determinism collapses. The truth of a proposition concerning
your future behavior does not make that future behavior
necessary. What you choose to do in the future was, is, and will
remain contingent, even if a proposition describing that choice
is timelessly true.
6b. The Modal Fallacy in Epistemic Determinism
Let's recall Maimonides's argument:
… "Does God know or does He not know that a certain
individual will be good or bad? If thou sayest 'He knows', then
it necessarily follows that [that] man is compelled to act as God
knew beforehand he would act, otherwise God's knowledge would be
imperfect."
We can symbolize the core of this argument, using "" for "it necessarily follows"; and "" for "compelled"; and "D" for the proposition
describing what some particular person does tomorrow.
gKD
D
There seems to be (at least) one missing premise. [In the
terminology of logicians, the argument is enthymematic.]
One tacit assumption of this argument is the necessary truth, "it
is not possible both for God to know that D and for D to be
false", or, in symbols, "~(gKD
& ~D)". So the argument becomes:
gKD
~(gKD & ~D)
D
But even with this repair, the argument remains invalid. The
conclusion does not follow from the two premises. To
derive the conclusion, a third premise is needed, and it is easy
to see what it is. Most persons, with hardly a moment's thought,
virtually as a reflex action, will tacitly assume that the second
premise is logically equivalent to:
gKD
D
and will tacitly (/unconsciously) add this further premise, so as
to yield, finally:
gKD
~(gKD & ~D)
gKD
D
D
But this third premise, we have seen above, is false; it commits
the modal fallacy. Without this premise, Maimonides' argument is
invalid; with it, the argument becomes valid but
unsound (i.e. has a false and essential premise [viz. the
third one]). Either way, the argument is a logical botch.
Once the logical error is detected, and removed, the argument for
epistemic determinism simply collapses. If some future
action/choice is known prior to its occurrence, that event does
not thereby become "necessary", "compelled", "forced", or what
have you. Inasmuch as its description was, is, and will remain
forever contingent, both it and its negation remain
possible. Of course only one of the two was, is, and will
remain true; while the other was, is, and will remain false. But
truth and falsity, per se, do not determine a proposition's
modality. Whether true or false, each of these propositions was,
is, and will remain possible. Knowing – whether
by God or a human being – some future event no more forces
that event to occur than our learning that dinosaurs lived in
(what is now) South Dakota forced those reptiles to take up
residence there.
7. Residual concerns – Changing the
past; Changing the future
It will sometimes happen that persons will painstakingly follow
each of the steps of the preceding arguments that expose the
modal fallacy in logical and epistemic determinism and still
harbor lingering worries that the truth or knowledge of future
contingents precludes the very possibility of free will
"Look", they might say, "if it is already true today (Monday)
that I will do Z tomorrow (Tuesday), then surely tomorrow, try as
I might, I will end up doing Z. Were I do something else
instead, in effect not do Z on Tuesday, then I would change, from
true to false, the truth-value that a proposition had on Monday.
But that is impossible. Thus, tomorrow, my considering the
alternatives – my deliberating over my course of action, my
trying to make up my mind what I will choose, my trying to
exercise free will – is really just an illusion. Since I
can't change the past, and since it is already true before
I act that I will do Z, it clearly follows that I cannot exercise
free will."
To tackle this last deterministic argument, we need to discuss
two matters: (1) what might be meant by the expressions "change
the past" and "change the future", and (2) whether changing the
future involves retroactively changing the truth-value of a
proposition.
Changing the past, present, or future: The past is
fixed. One cannot undo what has happened (although one can, of
course, try to mitigate the consequences of wrongful acts –
by apologizing, making amends, etc.)
Not even an omnipotent God can 'undo' or 'redo' the past, for to
do so would
per impossible
actualize a self-contradiction (e.g. "x occurred at
such-and-such a time and x did not occur at
such and such a time").
Jewish sages warn against 'prayer in vain' (where "in vain" does
not mean "futile" but "contemptuously" or "profanely" [as in
the Third Commandment, "Thou shalt not take the Lord's name in
vain"]):
... to cry over the past is to utter a vain prayer. If a man's
wife is [already] pregnant and he says, "[God] grant that my wife
bear a male child", this is a vain prayer. If he is coming home
from a journey and he hears cries of distress in the town and
says, "[God] grant that this is not in my house", this is a vain
prayer.[14]
Such prayers were regarded as blasphemous since they were taken
to be supplications to God that He change the past from the way
it was. But not even an omnipotent God can violate the logical
principle of the (law of) non-contradiction.
And yet, God-fearing persons frequently do utter such prayers.
How natural it is, for example, for Believers, when knowing that
their child was on board a particular ship, and learning that the
ship has met a terrible calamity and sunk – with some
passengers being lost and some others being rescued – to
pray to God that their child is among the survivors. Is there
any way to rationalize such behavior and render it
non-blasphemous?
Modern modal logic again comes to the rescue. Remember, on
traditional accounts, God is (along with being all-good)
omniscient and omnipotent. God, being omniscient, will have
known, since the beginning of time, that the parents would pray
(at such and such a time) for the survival of their child. In
particular, God would have known at the time of the ship's
sinking that the parents would pray sometime later, and God could
have chosen to answer those prayers in advance of their
being uttered. On this view, God is not changing the past at
all; God is making the past one particular way among the infinite
number of different ways it could have been. One must
attend to the modalities. Under this view, God does not
change the past from the way it was (which activity would be a
violation of the principle of non-contradiction), but rather God
makes one possibility (the child's surviving) actual, and makes
another possibility (the child's perishing) nonactual. There is
no violation of the principle of non-contradiction, and the
parents' prayers are not blasphemous.
And it bears emphasizing that it is not God's knowing beforehand
that the parents would pray in a certain manner that 'brings it
about' ('necessitates', 'forces') their praying that way. It is,
quite the contrary: it is the parents praying of their own free
will that God have saved their child from death that moves God to
do (have done) as he did.
Similar freedoms and constraints apply to the present. On pain
of inconsistency, one cannot change what is happening at this
very moment. In some circumstances, and in a certain sense, one
can change what is about to happen next (i.e. in the immediate
future). But one cannot change what is happening now,
i.e. at this very moment.
What about the future? Most of us believe that we can, to a
certain extent, change (or affect) the future. But then we
recall the proverb, "Que sera, sera" ("What will be, will be"),
and we begin to have doubts. If the future will be what it is
going to be, how can we change it?
Not surprisingly, the response is: "It all depends on what you
mean by 'change'".
"I cannot change the future – by anything I have
done, am doing, or will do – from what it is going to
be. But I can change the future from what it might
have been. I may carefully consider the appearance of my
garden, and after a bit of thought, mulling over a few
alternatives, I decide to cut down the apple tree. By so doing, I
change the future from what it might have been. But I do not
change it from what it will be. Indeed, by my doing what I do, I
contribute – in a small measure – to making the
future the very way it will be.
"Similarly, I cannot change the present from the way it is. I can
only change the present from the way it might have been, from the
way it would have been were I not doing what I am doing right
now. And finally, I cannot change the past from the way it was.
In the past, I changed it from what it might have been, from what
it would have been had I not done what I did.
"We can change the world from what it might have been; but in
doing that we contribute to making the world the way it
was, is, and will be. We cannot – on
pain of logical contradiction – change the world from the
way it was, is, or will be."[15]
Suppose that tomorrow, by the exercise of my free will, I wash
the family car. In doing so, I make the future just what it was
to be. But it was to be (that way rather than some other) just
because I will exercise my free will tomorrow. It is tomorrow's
exercise of my free will that makes it the way it will be.
In exercising my free will tomorrow (to wash the family car) have
I retroactively changed the past? Have I changed the truth-value
of some proposition from true to false and of some other
proposition from false to true?
Semantic relations are not causal relations: Again,
the English language confuses us. We say that what we will
choose to do tomorrow 'makes' some proposition
true. And we might add, what I choose to do tomorrow (viz. wash
the family car) 'makes' the car clean.
But these are two radically different senses of "makes". The
first use of "makes" refers to the semantic relation of
"truth-conferring". My washing the car tomorrow 'confers' truth
on the proposition that on such-and-such a day, I wash the family
car. But an event's 'conferring truth' on a proposition is not a
causal relation. Causal relations occur between two
events (or occurrences, or states). The event of my
washing the car brings about the state (or the event that lasts
several days) of my car being clean.
The event of my washing the car tomorrow doesn't
retroactively cause the proposition that I wash the car
tomorrow to become true, nor does it change the
truth-value of that proposition. The proposition that I wash the
car tomorrow (i.e. on such-and-such a date) simply describes what
happens tomorrow. If I do wash the car tomorrow, then that
proposition was, is, and forever will be, true. If I do not wash
the car tomorrow, then that same proposition was, is, and always
will be false.
Some persons find it easier to understand the concept of the
semantic relation of 'truth-making' if the example concerns a
past event rather than a future one. Consider the proposition
(which is still being debated by scientists) that the dinosaurs
on earth perished as a result of an impact of a huge meteor at
Chicxulub, on the Yucatan Peninsula in Mexico, about 65 million
years ago. If there was such an impact, and if it caused the
demise of the dinosaurs, then the proposition is true (or, more
specifically, always was, is, and always will be true). If,
however, there was no such impact, or if there was an impact but
it didn't cause the death of the dinosaurs, then the proposition
always was, is, and forever will be false.
Every actual event has a timelessly true description. It is what
happens, i.e. what events occur – including those that are
the free choices of human beings – that 'accounts
for' the
truth of their descriptions. The truth (today) of the
proposition that John Wilkes Booth assassinated Abraham Lincoln
neither 'accounts for' nor 'caused' that criminal act.
In the next few hours I will make any number of free choices.
Tomorrow there will be true propositions describing those
choices. But none of my choices today is 'forced' or 'caused by'
my actual choices having true descriptions tomorrow. And we can
generalize:
In the next few hours you will exercise your free will and make
any number of free choices. Yesterday there were, today there
are, and tomorrow there will be, true propositions describing
those choices. But none of your choices today (whatever they
are) is 'forced' or 'caused by' your actual choices having had a
true description yesterday, having a true description today, or
continuing to have a true description tomorrow.
8. Concluding Remarks
The argument (Logical Determinism) that a proposition's being
true prior to the occurrence of the event it describes logically
precludes free will ultimately rests on a modal fallacy. And the
ancillary argument that a proposition's being true prior to the
occurrence of the event it describes causes the future
event to occur turns on a confusion (i) of the truth-making
(semantic) relation between an event and its description with
(ii) the causal relation between two events.
The argument (Epistemic Determinism) that a proposition's being
known prior to the occurrence of the event it describes
logically precludes free will, as in the case of logical
determinism, ultimately rests on a modal fallacy. And the
arguments that it is impossible to know the future are refuted by
two facts. One is that we do in fact know a very great deal
about the future, indeed our managing to keep ourselves alive
from hour to hour, from day to day, depends to a very
great extent on such knowledge. Two is that the objection that
we cannot have knowledge of the future – because our
beliefs
about the future 'might' (turn out to) be false – turns on
a
mistaken account of the role of 'the possibility of error' in a
viable account of knowledge. Beliefs about future actions,
insofar as they are contingent, and – by the very
definition
of "contingency" – are possibly false. But "possibly
false"
does not mean "probably false", and possibly false beliefs, so
long as they are also actually true, can constitute bona
fide knowledge of the future.
Further
Reading
- Complementary
- William Lane Craig, The Only Wise God: The Compatibility
of
Divine Foreknowledge and Human Freedom, (Grand Rapids,
MI: Baker Book House), 1987. 157 pp.
- William L. Rowe, Philosophy of Religion: An
Introduction, 2nd edition (Belmont, CA: Wadsworth Publishing
Co.), 1993, esp. Chapter 11, "Predestination, Divine
Foreknowledge, and Human Freedom", pp. 141-154.
- Dissenting
Nelson Pike has argued that if one adopts a particular notion of
omniscience [different from the one presupposed in this
article], God's omniscience does preclude the existence of human
free will. Alvin Plantinga responds to Pike, arguing that God's
omniscience is compatible with human free will. Finally, Pike
tries to defend his position against Plantinga. The three papers
(listed in chronological sequence) are:
- Nelson Pike, "Divine Omniscience and Voluntary Action", in
The Philosophical Review, 74 (Jan. 1965) pp.
27-46. Reprinted as "God's Foreknowledge and Human Free
Will Are Incompatible", in Philosophy of Religion: An
Anthology, 2nd edition, edited by Louis P. Pojman, (Belmont,
CA: Wadsworth Publishing Co.), 1994, pp. 250-60.
- Alvin Plantinga, "God's Foreknowledge and Human Free Will are
Compatible", in God, Freedom, and Evil, (New York: Harper
& Row), 1974, pp. 66-72. Reprinted in Philosophy
of Religion: An Anthology, 2nd edition, edited by Louis P.
Pojman, (Belmont, CA: Wadsworth Publishing Co.), 1994, pp.
261-4.
- Nelson Pike, "Divine Foreknowledge, Human Freedom and
Possible Worlds", in The Philosophical Review, 86
(April 1977), pp. 209-216.
- Supplementary: Causal Determinism
Throughout this paper we have examined two alleged threats to
the claim that human beings have free will, viz., the threat
posed by Logical Determinism and that posed by Epistemic
Determinism. Early I hived off the discussion of Causal
Determinism. For many thinkers, causal determinism poses a far
greater threat to the existence of free will than does either
logical or epistemic determinism. Again, I suggest as a starting
point, the article, "Laws of
Nature" in this Encyclopedia.
- Advanced
All three deterministic arguments are challenges to the
thesis that human beings have free will. And enormous efforts
have been expended over the last millennium, by countless
philosophers and theologians, to rebut these arguments. All
these efforts have been, as it were, defensive moves. And thus
the question naturally arises: Is there, or can there even be,
arguments to the effect that free will does exist? Is there any
empirical evidence that human beings have the capacity to
exercise free choice? Is the claim demonstrable that we can, at
least on occasion, make free choices?
In his article, "An Essential Unpredictability in Human
Behavior", in Scientific Psychology: Principles and
Approaches, edited by Ernest Nagel and Benjamin Wolman, (New
York: Basic Books), 1965, pp. 411-25, Michael
Scriven describes a thought-experiment which strongly supports
the claim that we have free will. (See esp. Section I.,
pp. 419-20.) Most persons will need to read this
paper several times, and without a dismissive attitude, to plumb
its cogency and depth. The paper is undeniably tough going, but,
in the end, worth the effort needed to grasp its insights.
Notes
-
The Eight Chapters of Maimonides on Ethics (Semonah
Perak.im), edited,
annotated, and translated with an Introduction by Joseph I.
Gorfinkle, pp. 99-100. (New York: AMS Press), 1966.
[ Return ]
-
Although contemporary (twentieth- and twenty-first-century)
secular philosophers continue the historical tradition of talking
about God as a (/the) omniscient being, one should not thereby
infer that these philosophers are assuming that God exists. For
contemporary secular philosophers, "God" may be regarded as
shorthand for "omniscient being". Their interest is in the
consequences of positing an omniscient being, not in promoting a
belief that such a being exists. The latter is a quite different
matter, not touched upon in this article.
[ Return ]
-
The term "proposition" is being used in a technical sense. It
refers, not to sentences, but to the non-linguistic statements
that can be expressed by indicative (or declarative) sentences.
For example, if an English-speaking person were to utter the
sentence, "Saturn is the sixth planet from the Sun", and a
French-speaking person were to utter the sentence, "Saturne est
la sixième planète la plus éloignée
du soleil", both would have expressed the same proposition
– two different sentences, one proposition. However, were
one person, let's say Efrem, to utter the sentence, "I can see
Saturn", and someone else, let's say Diane, were to utter the
sentence, "I can see Saturn", this would be a case of these
persons uttering the same sentence, but expressing two
different propositions, one about Efrem, the other about
Diane. For more on the distinction between sentences and
propositions see "What
sorts of things are true (or false)?" in this
Encyclopedia. [ Return ]
-
Carl Hempel, "The Function of General Laws in History", in The
Journal of Philosophy, 39, pp. 35-48
(1942). Reprinted in Aspects of Scientific
Explanation, (NY: The Free Press), 1965, pp.
231-243. [ Return ]
-
This second condition is stated loosely. Indeed ever since 1963,
when Edmund L. Gettier published his paper, "Is Knowledge
Justified True Belief?", in Analysis 23, pp.
121-123, a number of philosophers have tried their
hands at 'tightening' the conditions that are necessary for
knowledge. However, for our purposes, we need not settle on
whether these conditions are sufficient for knowledge. For the
present discussion, we need only insist upon the first condition
(viz. P is true), a condition that has been little
challenged in late-twentieth- and early
twenty-first-century theory of knowledge. [ Return ]
- In the case of God, truth is not only a
necessary condition for His knowledge, it is also sufficient. If
we let "g" stand for "God", "K" for "knows", then gKP
implies P, and P implies gKP.
[ Return ]
-
Aristotle's Categories and De
Interpretatione, translated with notes by J.L. Ackrill
(Oxford: Clarendon Press), 1963, Chapter 9 (pp.
50-53). [ Return ]
-
Judith Jarvis Thomson, "The time of a killing", Journal of
Philosophy, 68 (1971), pp. 115-32.
[ Return ]
- Glorious Eclipses: Their Past, Present and Future, by
Serge
Brunier and Jean-Pierre Luminet, translated by Storm Dunlop
(Cambridge: Cambridge
University Press), 2000, pp.154-5.
ISBN 0 521 79148 0.
See also NASA's "Eclipse
Home Page". [ Return ]
- René Descartes, Meditations
on First Philosophy (1641), p. 1.
Re-written (2004) by Jonathan
Bennett, for readability by students in the 21st century, from
the translation by John Cottingham (Cambridge University Press),
1996. [ Return ]
- Just as an exercise, try to state the following formula
solely in English prose:
x = [ (y2 +
zw)] / [2.7w (a3 + log(y -
0.5z))]
For further illustrations of the difficulty on occasion of
expressing fine logical points in ordinary prose, see Ernest
Nagel's celebrated "Symbolic Notation, Haddocks' Eyes and the
Dog-Walking Ordinance" (esp. the latter section), in The World
of Mathematics, vol. 3, edited by James R. Newman
(NY: Simon and Schuster), 1956, pp. 1878-1900.
(Reissued by Dover Publications. ISBN: 0486432688)
[ Return ]
- The modal fallacy is hardly the only case of human beings'
susceptibility to logical error. Another logical error, this one
drawn from mathematics, which – like the modal fallacy
– took centuries to be corrected, has to do with the
number of numbers. If one were to ask most persons, "Are
there more even and odd positive integers (1, 2, 3, 4, …)
than there are even positive integers (2, 4, 6, 8, …)
alone?", one would likely get as an answer, "Yes, of course.
There are twice as many even and odd positive integers together
as there are even positive integers alone." But contrary to our
untutored intuitions, this is the wrong answer. It turns out, as
was discovered and proved in the 19th century (by Georg Cantor
[1845-1918]), there are exactly as many even positive integers as
there are even and odd together. The two classes, that of all
the positive integers and that of the even positive integers are
said to be "equinumerous", that is, both classes contain the
same number (cardinality) of members, viz. an infinite
number. That there are as many even positive integers as there
are positive integers can be demonstrated by the fact that the
members of the two classes can be uniquely 'paired off', or putting the point in more technical
jargon, the members of the two classes can be put into a
"one-to-one correspondence":
| 1 |
2 |
3 |
4 |
. |
. |
. |
. |
| | |
| |
| |
| |
| |
| |
etc. |
| 2 |
4 |
6 |
8 |
. |
. |
. |
. |
Every positive integer has a unique double; and every even
positive integer has a unique half which is also an
integer. Clearly, there are instances when some of our
untutored, deeply ingrained, logical (and mathematical)
'intuitions' need to be reformed.[ Return ]
- The non-equivalence of "~(P & Q)" and
"(P ~Q)" has been explained and
illustrated in this article. For techniques, within modal logic,
to prove that these two expressions are not equivalent,
see, for example, Possible Worlds, by Raymond Bradley and
Norman Swartz (Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Co.), 1979, esp.
pp. 350-65. [ Return ]
- The Babylonian Talmud, Tractate Berakoth,
Chapter IX. Translated by Isidore Epstein, 1948 (reprinted
1978), (London: The Soncino Press [Oxford]).
pp. 327-8. [ Return ]
- Norman Swartz, Beyond Experience, 2nd edition (2001)
pp. 226-227. Available online at http://www.sfu.ca/philosophy/beyond_experience/
[ Return ]
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