A garden near the city of Athens, owned and used by the philosopher
Epicurus
and his followers. It became a symbol of Epicurean philosophy.
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1. Location and Use
In 307/306 BCE the Athenian philosopher Epicurus
bought a house with a garden just outside Athens along the road from
the Dipylon gate to the Academy (Cicero, De
Finibus 5.1.3). Other great founders of philosophical schools
had chosen public areas for their teaching: Plato established his
school near the Academy,
Isocrates and Aristotle
taught in the Lyceum, Zeno
often met his students in the Stoa Poecile.
In contrast, Epicurus'
hedonistic and materialistic philosophy flourished and grew amidst
the privately owned groves of his Garden. The Garden itself - apart
from the city, a private space, and pleasurable - became a symbol for
the detachment and hedonism of the Epicurean school. Nothing of the
Garden's layout is known, but its closeness to the canalized Eridanus
River must have provided plentiful water for irrigation of its trees
and plants. After Epicurus'
death the Garden was passed down to his followers (Diogenes
Laertius, 10.10 and 10.17). We may imagine that Epicureans
seeking relief from the disturbances of the city gathered in the
Garden's groves for many centuries.
2. Select Bibliography
Furley, David John. "Epicurus" in
the Oxford Classical Dictionary. Third Edition. Oxford
1996.
Wycherley, R.E. The Stones of Athens. Princeton 1978.
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