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Any theistic view of the world includes some notion of how
God is related to the structures of the universe, including
space and time. The question of God's relation to
time has generated a great amount of theological and philosophical
reflection. The traditional view has been that God is timeless
in the sense of being outside time altogether; that is,
he exists but does not exist at any point in time and he
does not experience temporal succession. What may be the
dominant view of philosophers today is that he is temporal
but everlasting; that is, God never began to exist and he
never will go out of existence. He exists at each moment
in time.
Deciding how best to think of God's relation to time
will involve bringing to bear one's views about other
aspects of the divine nature. How a philosopher thinks about
God's knowledge and his interaction with his people
within the temporal world shapes how that philosopher will
think about God's relation to time and vice versa.
In addition, other metaphysical considerations also play
important roles in the discussion. For example, the nature
of time and the nature of the origin of the universe each
have a bearing on whether God is best thought of as timeless
or temporal.
This article traces the main contours of the contemporary
debate. Several versions of the view that God is timeless
are explained and the major arguments for timelessness are
developed and criticized. Divine temporality is also explored
and arguments in its favor are presented along with criticisms.
In addition, some views that attempt to occupy a middle
ground will be considered.
Table of Contents
(Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts
of this article)
1. God's Relation to Time -- Preliminaries
a.
What it Means to be Temporal: A First Pass
b.
What it Means to be Timeless: A First Pass
c.
Some In-between Views
2. Methodology
3. Divine Timelessness
a.
Stump and Kretzmann: Timelessness as Duration
b.
Leftow: Timelessness as Quasi-Temporal Eternity
c.
Rogers: Timelessness with No Duration
4. Arguments for Divine Timelessness
a.
God's Knowledge of the Future
b.
The Fullness of God's Being
c.
God and the Creation of the Universe
5. Divine Temporality
6. Arguments for Temporality
a.
Divine Action in the World
b.
Divine Knowledge of the Present
7. Some In-between Views
a.
Padgett and DeWeese: God as Relatively Timeless
b.
Craig: God as Timeless without Creation and Temporal with
Creation
8. Conclusion
9. References and Further Reading
1.
God's Relation to Time -- Preliminaries
Theism is the view that there exists a person who is, in
significant ways, unlike every other person. This person,
whom we will call "God," is the creator of the
entire universe. Any theistic world-view includes some notion
of how God is related to this universe. There must be some
account of how God relates to events, things, and people
within the universe and of how God is related to what we
could call the structure of the universe. That is, how God
is related to space and to
time. If God is the creator
of the universe, the question arises as to whether God created
space and time as well. The answers to these questions turn
on whether space and time are parts or aspects of the universe
or whether they are more fundamental. Not many theologians
or philosophers think that space is more fundamental than
the universe. They think that God brought space into being.
This view implies that God is in some sense spaceless or
"outside" space. God's relation to time,
however, is a topic about which there continues to be deep
disagreement. From Augustine
through Aquinas, the major
thinkers argued that God was not in time at all. They thought
of God as eternal, in the sense that he is timeless or atemporal.
Now, the dominant view among philosophers is that God is
temporal. His eternal nature is thought of as being everlasting
rather than timeless. He never came into existence and he
will never go out of existence but he exists within time.
Proponents of each of these positions attribute eternality
to God. As a result, the term, "eternal" has
come to be either ambiguous or a general term that covers
various positions. In this article, the term, "eternal"
will be used to refer to God's relation to time, whatever
it is. The term "temporal" will refer to God
as within time and "timeless" will designate
God as being outside time.
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a. What
it Means to be Temporal: A First Pass
The majority position today, at least among philosophers,
is that God is everlasting but temporal. That is, God never
began to exist, and he will never go out of existence. God
does, however, experience temporal succession. That is,
God experiences some events (for example, the first century)
before he experiences other events (for example, the twenty-first
century.) If God is temporal, his existence and his thoughts
and actions have temporal location. He exists at the present
moment (and he has existed at each past moment and he will
exist at each future moment.) In August, he was thinking
about the heat wave in the mid-west. In the thirteenth century,
he listened to and answered Aquinas' prayers for understanding.
His dealings, like those of the rest of us, occur at particular
times.
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b. What it Means
to be Timeless: A First Pass
The claim that God is timeless is a denial of the claim
that God is temporal. First, God exists, but does not exist
at any temporal location. Rather than holding that God is
everlastingly eternal, and, therefore, he exists at each
time, this position is that God exists but he does not exist
at any time at all. God is beyond time altogether. It could
be said that although God does not exist at any time God
exists at eternity. That is, eternity can be seen as a non-temporal
location as any point within time is a temporal location.
Second, it is thought that God does not experience temporal
succession. God's relation to each event in a temporal sequence
is the same as his relation to any other event. God does
not experience the first century before he experiences the
twenty-first. Both of these centuries are experienced by
God in one "timeless now." So, while it is true
that in the thirteenth century Aquinas prayed for understanding
and received it, God's response to his prayers is
not something that also occurred in that century. God, in
his timeless state of being, heard Aquinas' prayers
and answered them. He did not first hear them and then answer
them. He heard and answered in one timeless moment -- in
fact, he did so in the same timeless moment that he hears
and answers prayers offered in the twenty-first century.
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c.
Some In-between Views
Some philosophers think that God's relation
to time cannot be captured by either of the categories
of temporality or timelessness. Rather, God is in some
third kind of relation to time. One in-between position
is that God is not within our time, but he is within his
own time. In this view, God's inner life is sequential
and, therefore, temporal, but his relation to our temporal
sequence is "all at once." In a sense, God
has his own time line. He is not located at any point
in our time line. On this view, God's time does
not map onto our time at all. His time is completely distinct
from ours.
Another view is that God is "omnitemporal."
It is true on this view as well that God is not in our
time, but he experiences temporal succession in his being.
Our time is constituted by physical time. God's
time (metaphysical time) has no intrinsic metric and is
constituted purely by the divine life itself (Padgett
1992, 2001; DeWeese 2002, 2004). If God is omnitemporal,
his metaphysical time does map in some way onto our physical
time. So there is a literal sense in which God knows now
that I am typing this sentence now.
Another view (Craig, 2001a, 2001b) is that
God became temporal when time was created. God's
existence without creation is a timeless existence but
once temporal reality comes into existence, God himself
must change. If he changes, then he is, at least in some
sense, temporal. Just as it is not quite accurate to talk
about what happens before time comes into existence,
we should not describe this view as one in which God used
to be timeless, but he became temporal.
This language would imply that there was a time when God
was timeless and then, later, there is another time when
he is temporal. On this view, there was not a time when
he was timeless. God's timelessness without creation
is precisely due to the fact that time came into existence
with creation.
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2.
Methodology
Many philosophers of religion think that
the Scriptures do not teach definitively any one view
concerning God and time (Craig 2001a, 2001b; for a differing
view, see Padgett, 1992). The Scriptures do provide some
parameters for acceptable theories of God's relation
to time, however. For example, they teach that God never
began to exist and he will never go out of existence.
They also teach that God interacts with the world. He
knows what is going on, he reveals himself to people,
he acts in such a way that things happen in time. They
also teach that God is the Lord of all creation. Everything
is subject to him. Philosophers generally take claims
such as these as parameters for their thinking because
of their concern either to remain within historical, biblical
orthodoxy themselves or, at least, to articulate a position
about God and time that is consistent with orthodoxy.
Any departure from the broad outlines of orthodoxy, at
least for many Christian philosophers of religion, is
made as a last resort.
These parameters, as has been noted, allow
for a plurality of positions about how God is related
to time. Determining which position is most adequate involves
trying to fit what we think about other aspects of God's
nature together with our thinking about God's relation
to time. What we want to say about God's power or
knowledge or omnipresence will have some bearing on our
understanding of how it is that God is eternal. In addition,
we will try to fit our theories together with other issues
besides what God himself is like. Some of the most obvious
issues include the nature of time, the nature of change
and the creation of the universe.
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3.
Divine Timelessness
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a.
Stump and Kretzmann: Timelessness as Duration
Much of the contemporary discussion of timelessness
begins with the article "Eternity" by Eleonore
Stump and Norman Kretzmann (Stump and Kretzmann, 1981).
Stump and Kretzmann take their cue from Boethius who articulated
what became a standard understanding of divine timelessness:
"Eternity, then, is the whole, simultaneous and perfect
possession of boundless life" (Boethius, 1973). Stump
and Kretzmann identify four ingredients that they claim
are essential to an eternal (timeless) being. (Although
they cast their discussion in terms of an "eternal
being," this article will continue to use the term
"timeless".) First, any being that is timeless
has life. Second, the life of a timeless thing is not
able to be limited. Third, this life involves a special
sort of duration. Anything that has life must have duration
but the duration of a timeless being is not a temporal
duration. Last, a timeless being possesses its entire
life all at once. It is this last element that implies
that the timeless being is outside time because a temporal
living thing only possesses one moment of its life at
a time.
The two aspects of divine timelessness that
Stump and Kretzmann emphasize are that a timeless being
has life and that this life has a duration, though not
a temporal duration. The duration of the life of a timeless
being puts the nature of such a being in stark contrast
with the nature of abstract objects such as numbers or
properties. The picture of God that this view leaves us
with is of a being whose life is too full to exist only
at one moment at a time.
The challenge for a defender of a timeless
conception of God is to explain how such a God is related
to temporal events. For example, God is directly conscious
of each moment of time. The relation of his timeless cognition
and the temporal objects of his cognition cannot be captured
by using strictly temporal relations such as simultaneity
because temporal simultaneity is a transitive relation.
God is timelessly aware of the fall of Rome and, in the
same timeless now, he is aware of my spilling my coffee.
The fall of Rome is not, however, occurring at the same
time that my coffee spills. What is needed is some non-transitive
notion of God's relation to the temporal world.
To this end, Stump and Kretzmann introduce the notion
of "ET (eternal-temporal)-simultaneity:"
(ET) for every x and every y, x and
y are ET-simultaneous if and only if:
(i) either x is eternal and y is temporal, or vice
versa; and
(ii) for some observer, A, in the unique eternal
reference frame, x and y are both present -- that
is, either x is eternally present and y is observed
as temporally present, or vice versa; and
(iii) for some observer, B, in one of the infinitely
many temporal reference frames, x and y are both present
-- that is, either x is observed as eternally present
and y is temporally present, or vice versa. (Stump
and Kretzmann, 1981: pp 230-231.)
If x and y are ET-simultaneous, one is timeless
and the other temporal. This fact preserves the non-symmetrical
and non-transitive nature of the relation. If ET-simultaneity
captures the truth about God's relation to a temporal
world, then we do not have to worry about the fall of
Rome occurring at the same time that I spill my coffee.
Unfortunately, there are numerous difficulties
with ET-simultaneity. Philosophers have complained about
obscurity of the use of "reference frame"
terminology (for example, Padgett 1992). There is clearly
an analogy with relativity theory at work here. To put
an analogy at the core of a technical definition is pedagogically
suspect, at the least. It may be that it masks a deeper
philosophical problem. Furthermore, Delmas Lewis (1984)
has argued that a temporal being can observe something
only if that thing is itself temporal and a timeless being
can observe only what is timeless. Observation cannot
cross the temporal/timeless divide. Therefore, the observation
talk, as well as the reference frame talk, must be only
analogous or metaphorical.
It has also been argued that the notion
of atemporal duration, that Stump and Kretzmann hold to
be required by the timeless view, is at bottom incoherent.
Paul Fitzgerald (1985) has argued that for there to be
duration in the life of God, it must be the case that
two or more of God's thoughts, for example, will
have either the same or different amounts of duration.
Different thoughts in God's mind can be individuated
by their respective lengths of duration or at least by
their locations within the duration. Fitzgerald argues
that if a timeless duration does not have these analogues
with temporal or spatial duration, it is hard to think
of it as a case of bona fide duration. On the other hand,
if the duration in God's life has this sort of duration,
it is difficult to see that it is not simply one more
case of temporal duration.
Stump and Kretzmann attempt to respond to
such objections and have revised their analysis of ET-simultaneity
accordingly. In their first response to Fitzgerald (Stump
and Kretzmann, 1987), they make much of his analyzing
timeless duration in a way that makes it incompatible
with the traditional doctrine of divine simplicity. They
will not accept any notion of God's life that requires
them to give up on the simplicity of the divine nature.
For example, there cannot be any sort of sequence among
distinct events or "moments" within the duration
of God's life. There are no distinct events or moments
at all within the life of a God who is metaphysically
simple. Although the two positions are linked throughout
medieval thought, there is a cost to holding that a timeless
God must be metaphysically simple as well. Any independent
argument against divine simplicity (such as in Wolterstorff,
1991) will count against such a view of timelessness.
In a later response, Stump and Kretzmann
put forward a new version of ET-simultaneity (called ET'):
(ET'): For every x and every
y, x and y are ET-simultaneous if and only if:
(i) either x is eternal and y is temporal or vice
versa (assume x is eternal and y temporal)
(ii) with respect to some A in the unique eternal
reference frame, x and y are both present -- that
is: (a) x is in the eternal present with respect to
A, (b) y is in the temporal present, and (c) both
x and y are situated with respect to A in such a way
that A can enter into direct and immediate causal
relations with each of them and (if capable of awareness)
can be directly aware of each of them; and
(iii) with respect to some B in one of the infinitely
many temporal reference frames, x and y are both present
-- that is: (a) x is in the eternal present, (b) y
is at the same time as B, and (c) both x and y are
situated with respect to B in such a way that B can
enter into direct and immediate causal relations with
each of them and (if capable of awareness) can be
directly aware of each of them. (Stump and Kretzmann,
1992)
This version of the principle eliminates
the observation difficulties but continues to use the
notion of reference frames to describe the timeless and
the temporal states. Alan Padgett (1992) has argued that
Stump and Kretzmann cannot be defending anything more
than a loose analogy with relativity theory here. He points
out that they admit that the use of relativity theory
is a heuristic device and nothing more. Yet their analysis
of the relation between a timeless being and events in
time requires more than a loose analogy. As far as the
Special Theory of Relativity is concerned, there is an
absolute temporal simultaneity or an absolute temporal
ordering between any two events within each other's
light cones. The problems with holding that simultaneity
is absolute only arise when two events each of which is
outside the other's light cone are considered. If
two events are outside each other's light cones
in this way, they cannot causally interact. This feature
of Special Relativity makes the analogy of the relations
between a timeless being and a temporal event on the one
hand and the relations between events in different reference
frames quite weak.
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b.
Leftow: Timelessness as Quasi-Temporal Eternity
Brian Leftow has defended timeless duration
in the life of God in another way. He holds that there
are distinct moments within God's life. These moments
stand in the successive relations of earlier and later
to one another, although they are not temporally
earlier or later than one another. Leftow calls this view
Quasi-Temporal Eternality (QTE) (Leftow 1991).
A QTE being is timeless in that it lives all of its life
at once. No moment of its life passes away and there is
no moment at which some other moment has not yet been
lived. Because the life of a QTE being has sequential
moments, its duration is significantly like the duration
or extension of the life of a temporal being. Because
it experiences all of these moments "at once,"
or in the same timeless now, it is a timeless being.
One advantage Leftow thinks his view affords
is that it can meet Fitzgerald's challenges while
holding to the doctrine of divine simplicity. There can
be the sort of duration that allows discrete moments to
be individuated by location in the life of a metaphysically
simple, timeless God. Leftow argues that there is a significant
difference between a being that has spatial or material
parts and a being that has a duration consisting of different
moments or positions or points. If the duration of God's
life was made up of discrete parts, God could not be a
metaphysically simple being. Points are not parts, however.
A finite line segment is not made up of some finite number
of points such that the addition or subtraction of a (finite)
number of points will change its length. If the points
or moments or positions in the duration of the life of
God are not to count as parts of that life, they must
be of zero finite length.
Fitzgerald had criticized Stump and Kretzmann's
notion of timeless duration by insisting that any duration
must be made up of distinct positions. This charge will
not affect Leftow's position. Leftow allows that
in the life of a timeless God (and a metaphysically simple
God) there are distinct points. He insists that these
points are not parts in the life of God. Therefore God
is not a being whose life contains distinct parts. He
is metaphysically simple. His life does contain points
that are ordered sequentially, however. So the QTE God
with its sequential points allows God to have the sort
of duration that Fitzgerald wanted, yet be timeless. In
this way, the QTE concept of timeless duration is more
satisfactory than the one put forward by Stump and Kretzmann.
Timeless duration, in Leftow's understanding,
shares features with temporal duration. In a recent essay,
he defends the idea that such features can be shared without
rendering God temporal (Leftow 2002). He distinguishes
between those properties that make something
temporal and those that are typically temporal.
A typically temporal property (TTP) is a property that
is typical of temporal events and which helps
make them temporal. Having some TTP is not sufficient
to make an event a temporal event, however. What will
make an event temporal is having the right TTPs.
Leftow notes that nearly everyone who argues that God
is timeless also holds that God's life has at least
some TTPs. Similarly, no one who holds that God is temporal
thinks that God has every TTP. For example, being wholly
future relative to some temporal event is a TTP; but God,
even if he is temporal, does not have that property. God
has no beginning. As a result his life is not wholly future
to any temporal event.
God's life, like any life, is an event,
but it is one in which time does not pass and in which
no change takes place. This description captures what
is meant by a timeless duration. While having a duration
and being an event are each cases of TTPs, Leftow has
well-argued that they are not the sort of TTP that only
temporal beings can have. God's life, then, can
be a timeless duration.
Which other TTPs does God have if he is
timeless? God's life also has a present, Leftow
argues. Having a present is a TTP, but God's present
is a non-temporal present. God's "now"
is not a temporal now. "Now" is the answer
to the question asked of some event, "When does
it occur?" The term, "now," according
to Leftow, picks out when the speaker tokens it. Not all
whens are times, however. Eternity, in the sense of being
a timeless location, can also be a when (see also Leftow
1991). "At eternity" can be the answer to
the question, "When does God act?"
Leftow's analysis of these typically
temporal properties shows that some of the objections
to timeless duration and a timeless God's relation
to a temporal world are not decisive. A timeless God can
be present, though not temporally present, to the world.
He can have a life which is an event having duration,
though not temporal duration. So the critics of Stump
and Kretzmann are correct in so far as they argue that
these properties are the sort of things that make their
bearers temporal. It may be that though things that have
these properties are typically temporal, they are not
necessarily so.
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c.
Rogers: Timelessness with No Duration
Katherin Rogers (1994, 2000) has argued
that both Leftow and Stump and Kretzmann have not succeeded
in articulating a compelling, or even coherent, notion
of divine timeless duration. She challenges their claims
that the views of timelessness found in Boethius and other
medieval thinkers include duration. These texts, she argues,
are at best ambiguous. Given their background in Plotinus
and Augustine, Rogers argues that it is better not to
read these philosophers as attributing duration to the
life of God. Augustine and Anselm especially express the
notion of timelessness by the use of the notion of the
present.
Even if the medieval thinkers did think
of timelessness as involving duration, the more difficult
question is whether we ought to think about it in this
way. Rogers points out that both Stump and Kretzmann and
Leftow, in defending the notion of divine timelessness
against common objections do not make use of their distinctive
notions of timeless duration at all. Furthermore, the
explanations given of the coherence of timeless duration
are not compelling.
Stump and Kretzmann use the analogy of two
parallel lines (Stump and Kretzmann 1987: 219). The higher
one is completely illuminated (all at once) while the
lower has illuminated a point at a time moving with uniform
speed. The light on each line represents the indivisible
present. The entirety of the timeless line is one indivisible
present while each point on the temporal line is a present
(one at a time). In this way the life of God is stretched
out, so to speak, along side temporal reality.
This analogy breaks down at crucial points.
Rogers argues that the line representing timelessness
(call this line, "E") either is made of distinct
points or it is not. It if is not, then timelessness has
no duration. If it is, then these points must correspond
in some way to the points on the temporal line (called
"T"). The geometric aspect of the analogy
is strained considerably when it is seen that some point
on T (call it T1) is going to be much closer to a point
on E (E1) then the point T235 will be. Yet all of God's
life must stand in the same relation to each point in
time, if God is to be truly timeless. Rogers points out
that such an analogy is never found in the medieval writers.
Their favorite geometric analogy is the circle and the
point at the center. The circle represents all of time
and the dot, timelessness. Timelessness stands in the
same relation to each point along the temporal array.
The point itself has no extension or parts.
If God is a QTE being, then his timeless
life does have earlier and later points. These are not
experienced by God sequentially, however. They are experienced
all at once in the one timeless now. Rogers argues that
Leftow has two options. Either he must argue for a principled
distinction between there being moments in God's
life and his experiencing these moments (such
that the moments can exist sequentially but be experienced
all at once) or he must grant that earlier and later moments
of God's life can also be simultaneous. Neither
alternative increases the plausibility or the clarity
of the claim that God's life has timeless duration.
Rogers offers a non-geometric analogy, found
in Augustine (1993), that captures the relation between
a timeless God and temporal reality. God's relation
to the world is similar to human memory of the past. Just
as in one present mental exercise, a human being can call
to mind a whole series of events that are themselves sequential,
God in his timeless state can know the whole sequence
of temporal events non-sequentially.
Rogers's position, then, is that God's
timeless life does not involve duration. She does not
think that denying duration to God's life reduces
it to some kind of frozen or static existence. These terms
are temporal in nature. They each imply a motionless state
through a period of time. She writes, "With the
exception of lacking extension, God is nothing like a
geometric point" (Rogers, 1994, p 14). His life
does, however, lack extension.
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4.
Arguments for Divine Timelessness
Although there are many arguments for the
claim that God is timeless, this essay will look at three
of the most important. These are arguments concerning
God's knowledge of future free actions, the fullness
of God's life, and God's creation of the universe.
In addition, we will look at some responses to these arguments.
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a.
God's Knowledge of the Future
The most prominent argument for divine timelessness
is that this position offers a solution to the problem
of God's foreknowledge of free actions. The challenge
of reconciling human freedom and divine omniscience is
best seen if we presume that God is temporal. If God is
omniscient and infallible, he knows every truth, and he
is never mistaken. If human beings are free in a libertarian
sense, then some actions a person performs are up to her
in the sense that she can initiate or refrain from initiating
the action. The problem arises if it is supposed that
someone will (in the future) choose freely some particular
action. Suppose Jeanie will decide tomorrow to make a
cup of tea at 4:00 pm. If this is a free act on her part,
it must be within her power to make the cup of tea or
to refrain from making it. If God is in time and knows
everything, then hundreds of years ago, he already knew
that Jeanie would make the cup of tea. When tomorrow comes,
can Jeanie refrain from making the cup of tea? As Nelson
Pike has argued, (Pike 1965) she can do so only if it
is within her power to change what it was that God believed
from the beginning of time. So, although God has always
believed that she would make the tea, she must have the
power to change what it was that God believed. She has
to be able to make it the case that God always believed
that she would not make the cup of tea. Many
philosophers have argued that no one has this kind of
power over the past, so human freedom is not compatible
with divine foreknowledge.
If God is timeless, however, it seems that
this problem does not arise. God does not believe things
at points in time and Jeanie does not, therefore,
have to have power over God's past beliefs. She
does need power over his timeless beliefs. This power
is not seen to be problematic because God's timeless
knowledge of an event is thought to be strongly analogous
to our present knowledge of an event. It is the occurring
of the event that determines the content of our knowledge
of the event. So too, it is the occurring of the event
that determines the content of God's knowledge.
If Jeanie makes a cup of tea, God knows it timelessly.
If she refrains, he knows that she refrains. God's
knowledge is not past but it is timeless.
One might argue that even if God is temporal,
the content of his foreknowledge is determined by the
occurring of the event in the same way. This claim, of
course, is true. There are two items which allow for difficulty
here. First, it is only in the case of a temporal God
foreknowing Jeanie's making tea that she needs to
have counterfactual power over the past, Second, if God
knew a hundred years ago that she was going to make tea,
there is a sense in which she can "get in between"
God's knowledge and the event. In other words, the
fact that God knows what he knows is fixed before she
initiated the event. If it is a free choice on her part,
she can still refrain from making the tea. Her decision
to make tea or not stands temporally between the content
of God's beliefs and the occurring of the event.
The position that God is timeless is often
cited as the best solution to the problem of reconciling
God's knowledge of the future and human freedom.
If God is timeless, after all, he does not foreknow
anything. Boethius, Anselm, Aquinas and many others have
appealed to God's atemporality to solve this problem.
While the proposal that God is timeless
seems to offer a good strategy, at least one significant
problem remains. This problem is that of prophecy. Suppose
God tells Moses, among other things, that Jeanie will
make a cup of tea tomorrow. Now we have a different situation
entirely. While God's knowledge that Jeanie will
make a cup of tea is not temporally located, Moses'
knowledge that Jeanie will make tea is temporally
located. Furthermore, since the information came from
God, Moses cannot be mistaken about the future event (Widerker
1991, Wierenga, 1991).
The prophet problem is a problem, some will
argue, only if God actually tells Moses what Jeanie will
do. God, it seems, does not tell much to Moses or any
other prophet. After all, why should God tell Moses? Moses
certainly does not care about Jeanie's cup of tea.
Since prophecy of this sort is pretty rare, we can be
confident that God's knowledge does not rule out
our freedom. Some have argued, however, that if it is
even possible for God to tell Moses (or anyone else for
that matter) what Jeanie will do, then we have a version
of the same compatibility problem we would have if we
held that God is in time and foreknows her tea making.
We could call this version, the "possible prophet"
problem. If the possible prophet problem is serious enough
to show that God's timeless knowledge of future
acts (future, that is, from our present vantage point)
is incompatible with those acts being free, then holding
God to be timeless does not solve the problem of foreknowledge.
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b.
The Fullness of God's Being
In thinking about God's nature, we
notice that whatever God is, he is to the greatest degree
possible. He knows everything that it is possible to know.
He can do anything that it is possible to do. He is maximally
merciful. This "maximal property idea" can
be applied as well to the nature of God's life.
God is a living being. He is not an abstract object like
a number. He is not inanimate like a magnetic force. He
is alive. If whatever is true of him is true of him to
the greatest degree possible, then his life is the fullest
life possible. Whatever God's life is like, he surely
has it to the fullest degree.
Some philosophers have argued that this
fact about God's life requires that he be timeless.
No being that experiences its life sequentially can have
the fullest life possible. Temporal beings experience
their lives one moment at a time. The past is gone and
the future is not yet. The past part of a person's
life is gone forever. He can remember it, but he cannot
experience it directly. The future part of his life is
not yet here. He can anticipate it and worry about it,
but he cannot yet experience it. He only experiences a
brief slice of his life at any one time. The life of a
temporal thing, then, is spread out and diffuse.
It is the transient nature of our experience
that gives rise to much of the wistfulness and regret
we may feel about our lives. This feeling of regret lends
credibility to the idea that a sequential life is a life
that is less than maximally full. Older people sometimes
wish for earlier days, while younger people long to mature.
We grieve for the people we love who are now gone. We
grieve also for the events and times that no longer persist.
When we think about the life of God, it
is strange to think of God longing for the past or for
the future. The idea that God might long for some earlier
time or regret the passing of some age seems like an attribution
of weakness or inadequacy to God. God in his self-sufficiency
cannot in any way be inadequate. If it is the experience
of the passage of time that grounds these longings, there
is good reason not to attribute any experience of time
to God. Therefore, it is better to think of God as timeless.
He experiences all of his life at once in the timeless
present. Nothing of his life is past and nothing of it
is future. Boethius' famous definition of eternity
captures this idea: "Eternity, then, is the whole,
simultaneous and perfect possession of boundless life"
(Boethius, 1973). Boethius contrasts this timeless mode
of being with a temporal mode: "Whatever lives in
time proceeds in the present and from the past into the
future, and there is nothing established in time which
can embrace the whole space of its life equally, but tomorrow
surely it does not yet grasp, while yesterday it has already
lost" (Boethius, 1973).
However, those who think that God is in
some way temporal do not want to attribute weakness or
inadequacy to God. Nor do they hold that God's life
is less than maximally full. They will deny, rather, that
God cannot experience a maximally full life if he is temporal.
These philosophers will point out that many of our regrets
about the passage of time are closely tied to our finitude.
It is our finitude that grounds our own inadequacy, not
our temporality. We regret the loss of the past both because
our lives are short and because our memories are dim and
inaccurate. God's life, temporal though it may be,
is not finite and his memory is perfectly vivid. He does
not lose anything with the passage of time. Nor does his
life draw closer to its end. If our regrets about the
passage of time are more a function of our finitude than
of our temporality, much of the force of these considerations
is removed.
One important issue that this argument concerning
the fullness of God's life ought to put to rest
is the idea that those who hold God to be timeless hold
that God is something inert like a number or a property.
Whether or not they are correct, the proponent of timelessness
holds that it is the fullness of God's
life (rather than its impoverishment) that determines
his relation to time.
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c.
God and the Creation of the Universe
Another argument for God's timelessness
begins with the idea that time itself is contingent. If
time is contingent and God is not, then it is at least
possible that God exist without time. This conclusion
is still far from the claim that God is, in fact, timeless
but perhaps we can say more. If time is contingent, then
it depends upon God for its existence. Either God brought
time into existence or he holds it in existence everlastingly.
(The claim that time is contingent, though, is not uncontroversial.
Arguments for the necessity of time will be considered
below.)
If God created time as part of his creation
of the universe, then it is important whether or not the
universe had a beginning at all. Although it might seem
strange to think that God could create the universe even
if the universe had no beginning, it would not be strange
to philosophers such as Thomas Aquinas. Working within
the Aristotelean framework, he considered an everlasting
universe to be a very real possibility. He argued (in
his third way) that even a universe with an infinite past
would need to depend upon God for its existence. In his
view, even if time had no beginning, it was contingent.
God sustains the universe, and time itself, in existence
at each moment that it exists.
The majority position today is that the
universe did have a beginning. What most people mean by
this claim is that the physical universe began. It is
an open question for many whether time had a beginning
or whether the past is infinite. If the past is infinite,
then it is metaphysical time and not physical time that
is everlasting. Arguments such as the Kalam Cosmological
Argument aim to show that it is not possible that the
past is infinite (Craig and Smith, 1993; Craig 2001b).
Suppose time came into existence with the universe so
that the universe has only a finite past. This means that
physical time was created by God. It may be the case that
metaphysical time is infinite or that God created "pure
duration" (metaphysical time) also. In the latter
case, God had to be timeless. God created both physical
and metaphysical time and God existed entirely without
time. God, then, had to be timeless. Unless God became
temporal at some point, God remains timeless.
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5.
Divine Temporality
The position that God is temporal sometimes
strikes the general reader as a position that limits the
nature of God. Philosophers who defend divine temporality
are committed to a similar methodology to that held by
those who are defenders of timelessness. They aim to work
within the parameters of historical, biblical orthodoxy
and to hold to the maximal property idea that whatever
God is, he is to the greatest possible degree. Thus, proponents
of divine temporality will hold that God is omniscient
and omnipotent. God's temporality is not seen as
a limit to his power or his knowledge or his being. Those
who hold to a temporal God often work on generating solutions
to the challenge of divine foreknowledge and human freedom.
They work within the notion that God knows whatever can
be known and is thus omniscient. Even those philosophers
who argue that God cannot know future free actions defend
divine omniscience. They either think that there are no
truths about future free actions or that none of those
truths can be known, even by God (Hasker, 1989 and Pinnock
et al., 1994). God is omniscient because he knows everything
that can be known. Divine temporality is not a departure
from orthodox concepts of God.
In fact, it is often the commitment to biblical
orthodoxy itself that generates the arguments that God
is best thought of as temporal. After all, the Pslamist
affirms that God is ‘from everlasting to everlasting.'
(Psalm 90:2) It looks like what is affirmed is God's
everlasting temporality. Two of these arguments will be
discussed: the argument that divine action in the world
requires temporality and the argument that God's
knowledge of tensed facts requires that he be temporal.
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6.
Arguments for Temporality
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a.
Divine Action in the World
God acts in the world. He created the universe
and he sustains it in existence. God's sustaining
the universe in its existence at each moment is what keeps
the universe existing from moment to moment. If, at any
instant, it were not sustained, it would cease to exist.
If God sustains the universe by performing different actions
at different moments of time, then he changes from moment
to moment. If God changes, then he is temporal.
God's interventions in the world are
often interactions with human beings. He redeems his people,
answers their prayer, and forgives their sin. He also
comes to their aid and comforts and strengthens them.
Can a proponent of divine timelessness make sense of God
interacting in these ways? It all depends, of course,
on what the necessary conditions for interaction turn
out to be. If it is not possible to answer a request (a
prayer) unless the action is performed after
the request, then the fact that God answers prayer will
guarantee that he is temporal. Some thinkers have thought
that an answer can be initiated only after a request.
Others have argued that, although answers to requests
normally come after the request, it is not necessary that
they do so. In order to count as an answer, the action
must occur because of the request. Not any because
of relation will do, however. An answer is not normally
thought of as being caused by the request, yet a cause-effect
relation is a kind of because of relation. Answers
are contingent whereas effects of causes are in some sense
necessary. The because of relation that is relevant
to answering a request has to do with intention or purpose.
In some cases, it seems that it is not necessary
for the request to come before the answer. If a father
knows that his daughter will come home and ask for a peanut
butter sandwich, he can make the sandwich ahead of time.
There is some sense in which he is responding to her request,
even if he has not yet been asked. If the relation between
a request and an answer is not necessarily a temporal
one, then a timeless God can answer prayer. He hears all
our prayers in his one timeless conscious act and in that
same conscious act, he wills the answers to our various
requests.
Perhaps the effects of God's actions
are located successively in time but his acting is not.
In one eternal act he wills the speaking to Moses at one
time and the parting of the sea at another. So Moses hears
God speaking from the bush at one time and much later
Moses sees God part the sea. But in God's life and
consciousness, these actions are not sequential. He wills
timelessly both the speaking and the parting. The sequence
of the effects of God's timeless will does not imply
that God's acts themselves are temporal.
b.
Divine Knowledge of the Present
Although God's knowledge of the future
is thought by many to be a strong support for divine timelessness,
many philosophers think that God's knowledge of the
present strongly supports his temporality. If God knows
everything, he must know what day it is today. If God is
timeless, so the argument goes, he cannot know what day
it is today. Therefore, he must be temporal. (This argument
is put forward in various ways by Craig, 2001a, 2001b; DeWeese,
2004; Hasker, 2002; Kretzmann, 1966; Padgett, 1992, 2001
and Wolterstorff, 1975.)
To get at the claim that a timeless God cannot
know what day it is, we can start with the facts that a
timeless God cannot change and that God knows everything
it is possible to know. But if God knows that today is December
13, 2006, tomorrow he will know something else. He will
know that yesterday it was December 13, 2006 and
that today is December 14, 2006. So God must know
different things at different times. If the contents of
God's knowledge changes, he changes. If he changes, he is
temporal and not timeless.
The quick answer to this concern is to deny
that God knows something different at different times. First,
it is obvious that someone who holds that God is timeless
does not think that God knows things at times at
all. God's knowings are not temporally located even if what
he knows is temporally located. It is not true, it will
be insisted, that God knows something today. He
knows things about today but he knows these things
timelessly.
God knows that today is December 13 in that
he knows that the day I refer to when I use the word "today"
in writing this introduction is December 13. When we raise
the question again tomorrow ("Can a timeless God know
what day it is today?"), God knows that this
second use of "today" refers to December 14. Temporal
indexical terms such as "today," "tomorrow,"
and "now" refer to different temporal locations
with different uses. In this way they are similar to terms
such as "here," "you," and "me."
The point is that the meaning of any sentence involving
an indexical term depends upon the context of its use. Since
indexical terms may refer to different items with different
uses, we can make such sentences more clear by replacing
the indexical term with a term whose reference is fixed.
The sentence, "I am now typing this sentence"
can be clarified by replacing the indexical terms with other
terms that make the indexicals explicit. For example, "I
type this sentence at 11:58 AM (EST) on December 13, 2006."
Even better is "Ganssle types this sentence at 11:58
AM (EST) on December 13, 2006." These sentences, it
can be claimed, express the same proposition. In the same
way, "I am now writing here" can be clarified
as "Ganssle writes on December 13, 2006 at11:58 AM
(EST) in Panera Bread in Hamden, CT." God,
of course, knows all of the propositions expressed by these
non-indexical sentences. Furthermore, the content of his
knowledge does not need to change day to day. The proposition
expressed by a non-indexical sentence is true timelessly
(or everlastingly) if it is true at all. The proposition
expressed by the sentence, "Ganssle types this sentence
at 11:58 AM (EST) on December 13, 2006" will be true
tomorrow and the next day and so on. God can know these
things and be changeless. He can, therefore, be timeless.
There are many philosophers who reject this
quick answer on the grounds that God can know all of the
non-indexical propositions and still not know what is happening
now. This kind of objection raises the second approach
to the question of a timeless God's knowledge of the
present. This approach is not through change but through
omniscience. I can know that you type a sentence at some
date (call the date, t1) without knowing whether
or not you are typing the sentence now. I might
fail to know that t1 is now. A timeless God can
know all propositions expressed by sentences of the form
"event e occurs at tn."
Sentences of the form, "event e occurs now,"
so the objection goes, express different propositions.
In order for God to be omniscient, he must know all propositions.
If some sentences are essentially indexical (if they do
not express the same propositions as sentences of the form
"event e occurs at tn"), he cannot
know them. If a timeless God cannot know this kind of proposition,
he is not omniscient.
There have been two basic kinds of responses
to this line of argument. The first is to deny that there
are propositions that are irreducibly indexical in this
way. In knowing every proposition of the form "event
e occurs at tn," God knows every
proposition about events. This response is, in effect, a
defense of the quick answer given above. While this position
has its adherents, it involves a commitment to the B-theory
of time. The B-theory of time (also known as the tenseless
theory or the stasis theory) entails the claim
that the most fundamental features of time are the relations
of "before," "after," and "simultaneous
with." Talk of tenses (past, present and future) can
be reduced to talk about these relations. The temporal now
is not an objective feature of reality but is a feature
of our experience of reality. If the B-theory of time is
true, this objection to divine timelessness is undermined.
Those who think that there are propositions
about events that cannot be reduced to propositions of the
form "event e occurs at tn,"
hold the A-theory of time (or tensed or process
theory.) The A-theory claims that there is an objective
temporal now. This now is not a feature only of our subjective
experience of reality but it is a piece of the furniture
of the universe. Another way to explain this is that even
if there were no temporal minds, the property of occurring
now would be exemplified by some events and not others.
There would be facts about what is happening now. The fundamental
temporal properties are the tensed properties. So events
objectively are past, present or future. They are not past,
present or future only in virtue of their relation to other
events. (The distinction between the A-theory and the B-theory
of time was first articulated by J. M. E. McTaggart; see
McTaggart, 1993.)
There are different versions of the A-theory
and different versions of the B-theory. It is not for this
essay to canvass all of these versions or to weigh the evidence
for or against any of them. (For more information, see Le
Poidevin and MacBeath, 1993; Oaklander and Smith, 1994;
and the section "Are there
Essentially Tensed Facts?" of the article on Time
in this encyclopedia.) Suffice it to say that the A-theory
is held more commonly than the B-theory. If the claim that
all propositions about events can be reduced to propositions
of the form "event e occurs at tn" entails a
controversial theory of time, it will not be as successful
a defense as many would like. This consideration, to be
sure, does not mean that it might not be the correct response,
but the burden of defending it is greater accordingly.
Another sort of response to the claim that
divine omniscience requires that God is temporal is to embrace
the conclusion of the argument and to hold that God is not
propositionally omniscient even if he is factually omniscient.
In other words, God knows every fact but there are some
propositions that can be known only by minds that are located
indexically. God is not lacking any fact. His access to
each fact, though, is not indexical (Wierenga, 1989, 2002).
He knows the same fact I know when I think "I am writing
here today." The proposition through which he knows
this fact, however, is different than the proposition through
which I know it. God knows the fact through the non-indexical
proposition "Ganssle writes in Panera on
December 13, 2006." Embracing this solution is not
without its costs. First of all we have to adjust how we
describe God's omniscience. We cannot describe it
in terms of God's knowing every proposition. It is
not true, on this view, that God knows every proposition.
God knows every fact.
One way to object to this view is to deny
that propositions expressed by indexical and non- indexical
sentences refer to or assert the same fact. To take this
road is to hold that some facts are essentially
indexical rather than just that some sentences or propositions
are. This objection does not seem too plausible because
of stories like the following. Suppose you assert to me
(truly) "You are in the kitchen," and I assert
to you (also truly), "I am in the kitchen."
These sentences are not identical and, according to the
view we are considering, they express different propositions.
What makes both of these assertions true is one and the
same fact; the fact consisting in a particular person (Ganssle)
being in a particular place (the kitchen). My knowledge
of this fact is mediated through a proposition that is expressed
by sentences using the indexical "I" and your
knowledge is mediated through propositions expressed by
sentences using "you." If there is one fact
that makes these different indexical sentences true, it
seems that there can be one fact that makes the following
two indexical sentences true: "Ganssle is now typing"
and "Ganssle types on December 13, 2006." If
these sentences are made true by the same fact, God can
know all facts even if he does not know some facts in the
same we know them. Our knowledge of facts is conditioned
by our indexical location. That is, we know them the way
we do in virtue of our personal, spatial and temporal coordinates.
A third response is possible. This response
can be combined with the second and that is to deny that
God's knowledge is mediated by propositions at all.
William Alston has argued that God knows what he knows without
having any beliefs. God's knowledge is constituted
instead by direct awareness of the facts involved. This
view entails that God's omniscience is not to be cashed
out in terms of propositions. Furthermore, if God's
knowledge of a fact consists in the presence of that fact
to God's consciousness, it may be that this presence
does not affect God intrinsically. If this is the case,
God can be aware of different facts in their different temporal
locations without himself changing. Whether a strategy such
as this one will succeed is an open question (Alston 1989;
Ganssle 1993, 1995, 2002c).
Many philosophers who argue for divine temporality
structure their arguments as follows: If God is timeless,
the B-theory of time must be true. But the B-theory of time
is false. Therefore, God is not timeless. Philosophers who
defend divine timelessness, then, take one of two tacks.
Either they embrace the first premise and hold to the B-theory
of time (Helm 1988, 2001; Rogers 2000) or they argue against
the second premise. God can be timeless even if the A-theory
of time is true. In this case, they try to show that a timeless
God can know tensed facts without changing himself. Some
advocates of timelessness will try to reconcile their view
with the A-theory whether or not it is the theory of time
they hold. Since the A-theory is the more widely held, showing
God's timelessness to be compatible with it helps
strengthen the overall case for timelessness.
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7.
Some In-between Views
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a.
Padgett and DeWeese: God as Relatively Timeless
Alan Padgett and Gary DeWeese (Padgett 1992,
2001; DeWeese 2002, 2004) have each argued that God is not
in physical time although he is everlastingly temporal.
God's time is metaphysical time. Padgett and DeWeese,
as is to be expected, emphasize different things in the
details. For example, Padgett allows for the coherence of
a timeless God while DeWeese would endorse the view that
any timeless entity is causally inert. No person, then,
can be timeless. Only abstract objects such as numbers and
properties can exist outside time. Nevertheless, their positions
are similar enough to treat them together. The claim that
God is "relatively timeless" or "omnitemporal"
allows its proponents to endorse some of the criticisms
of divine timelessness and, at the same time, affirm some
of the arguments for timelessness. Each affirms
the argument that God can be timeless only if the B-theory
of time is true and that the B-theory is false. They also
can hold that God's life cannot be contained in the
measured moments of physical time. They each also affirm
that God created time (physical time) as he created the
physical universe.
It is with these latter claims that they make
the distinction between physical and metaphysical time.
Physical time is metric time. In other words, it is time
that has an intrinsic metric due to regularities in the
physical universe. Events such as the earth revolving around
the sun are regular enough to mark off units of time. Metaphysical
time involves no metric or measured temporal intervals.
God, in himself, is immune from temporal measure. These
temporal items depend upon the physical measure of time.
This measure is a function of the regular processes that
follow physical laws. Since God is not subject to the laws
of nature, he is not subject to measured time. He does experience
a temporal now, somewhat as we do, but his intrinsic experience
is not measured by regular, law-like intervals. He experiences
temporal succession, but this succession is that of the
progression of his own consciousness and actions rather
than that of any external constraints. Now that God has
created a universe that unfolds according to regular laws,
there is a metric within created time. So while God's
now coincides with the now of physical time, the measured
intervals do not belong to his divine life.
These positions combine some of the strengths
both of the temporalist with strengths of the timelessness
position. The challenge might consist in finding a stable
middle ground between timelessness and temporality. When
metaphysical time is described as being without metric and
without law-like intervals, and perhaps even that God does
not change before physical time is created, it becomes more
difficult to see the difference between this position and
timelessness. The main difference is that on this view,
God remains temporal and capable of change even when no
change happens in the divine life (for example, before creation).
On the other hand, when the co-location of God's experience
of his now and the now of physical time is emphasized, the
distinction between the two becomes more difficult to see.
William Lane Craig, who holds a similar position, identifies
God's time with the absolute time that was posited
by Newton (Craig 2001a, 2001b, 2002). With this notion in
place, one can see that physical time is that to which the
Special Theory of Relativity applies. Craig and others insist
that if relativity theory is interpreted along neo-Lorentzian
lines rather than along the lines recommended by Einstein,
there is room for a privileged reference frame and, therefore,
a cosmic time (Craig 2002). But this cosmic or "absolute"
time may still apply only to this universe and not to God.
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b.
Craig: God as Timeless without Creation and Temporal with
Creation
William Lane Craig's own position includes
another variation. He holds that God is temporal in that
he is within metaphysical time. This feature of God's
life is due to the creation of time. Once God created the
universe, he became temporal. Prior to creation, God was
timeless. Of course, it is not right to say "prior
to creation" in any literal sense. The way Craig describes
his view is that God without creation is timeless; God with
creation is temporal.
If God has shifted his eternal position in
this way, then some of the arguments against timelessness
or against temporality will have to be rejected. For example,
God in his timeless state is omniscient. He is not lacking
any knowledge at all. God must know, in his timeless state,
that I am typing now. If God (without creation) can know
that I am typing now, then it seems that a timeless God
with creation can know that I am typing now. Therefore,
God's timelessness is not incompatible with the A-theory
of time (Hasker 2003). Craig's response is that until
the universe is created, there is no time and so all tensed
propositions are false. What God, in his timeless state
without creation knows is the tenseless proposition "Ganssle
types on December 14, 2006." Once the universe is
created, time is real and these tenseless sentences do not
capture all the facts there are. In order to be omniscient
once time exists, God must also know that I type now.
The challenge with this response is that it
appears to endorse some of the strategies to make the B-theory
work. Remember the A-theory of time is the view that the
most fundamental things about time are the locations of
past, present and future. The B-theory holds that the most
fundamental aspects of time are the relations before, after,
and simultaneous with. On Craig's view, it is hard
to argue that the A-locations are more fundamental than
the B-relations when there can be facts of the B-sort that
have no A-locations. Without creation, it is a fact that
I type this sentence on December 14, 2006. Once time is
created, there are further facts such as whether I type
it now, or have already done so. The fact that I type it
on December 14 seems to be more fundamental than the facts
that come into existence when time is created.
Craig's position raises another interesting
question. Is it possible for a timeless being to become
temporal or for a temporal being to become timeless? The
philosophers whose views have been discussed will disagree
about the answer to this question. Stump and Kretzmann,
for example, would not think such a change possible. Their
view of divine timelessness is deeply connected with divine
simplicity which, in turn, is seen to be part of God's
essential nature. DeWeese also would not allow for this
sort of change since no timeless being can be a person or
stand in any causal relations on his view. Craig thinks
that it is possible.
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8.
Conclusion
Questions about God's relation to time
involve many of the most perplexing topics in metaphysics.
These include the nature of the fundamental structures of
the universe as well as the nature of God's own life.
It is not surprising that the questions are still open even
after over two millennia of careful inquiry. While philosophers
often come to conclusions that are reasonably settled in
their mind, they are wise to hold such conclusions with
an open hand.
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9.
References and Further Reading
Alston, William P. (1989). "Does God
Have Beliefs?" in Divine Nature and Human Language.
Ithaca: Cornell University Press: 178-193.
Aquinas. (1945). Introduction to St. Thomas
Aquinas. ed., Anton C. Pegis New York: Modern
Library.
Augustine. (1960). The Confessions of
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