|
The growing demand for education in 5th century BCE. Greece called into existence a class
of teachers known as sophists. They were a professional class rather than a school, and as such
they were scattered over Greece and exhibited professional rivalries. The educational demand
was partly for genuine knowledge, but mostly reflected a desire for spurious learning that would
lead to political success. They wandered about Greece from place to place, gave lectures, took
pupils, and entered into disputations. For these services they exacted large fees, and were, in fact,
the first in Greece to take fees for teaching wisdom. Though not disgraceful in itself, the wise
men of Greece had never accepted payment for their teaching. The sophists were not, technically
speaking, philosophers, but, instead taught any subject for which there was a popular demand.
Topics included rhetoric, politics, grammar, etymology, history, physics, and mathematics. Early
on they were seen as teachers of virtue in the sense that they taught people to perform their
function in the state. Protagoras of Abdera, who appeared about 445 BCE. is named as the first
Sophist; after him the most important is Gorgias of Leontini, Prodicus of Ceos and Hippias of
Elis. Wherever they appeared, especially in Athens, they were received with enthusiasm and
many flocked to hear them. Even such people as Pericles, Euripides, and Socrates sought their
company.
The most popular career of a Greek of ability at the time was politics; hence the sophists largely
concentrated on teaching rhetoric. The aims of the young politicians whom they trained were to
persuade the multitude of whatever they wished them to believed. The search for truth was not
top priority. Consequently the sophists undertook to provide a stock of arguments on any subject,
or to prove any position. They boasted of their ability to make the worse appear the better reason,
to prove that black is white. Some, like Gorgias, asserted that it was not necessary to have any
knowledge of a subject to give satisfactory replies as regards it. Thus, Gorgias ostentatiously
answered any question on any subject instantly and without consideration. To attain these ends
mere quibbling, and the scoring of verbal points were employed. In this way, the sophists tried to
entangle, entrap, and confuse their opponents, and even, if this were not possible, to beat them
down by mere violence and noise. They sought also to dazzle by means of strange or flowery
metaphors, by unusual figures of speech, by epigrams and paradoxes, and in general by being
clever and smart, rather than earnest and truthful. Hence our word "sophistry": the use of
fallacious arguments knowing them to be such. Early on Sophists were seen to be of merit as
people of superior skill or wisdom, as we find in Pindar and Herodotus. We learn from Plato,
though, that even in the 5th century there was a prejudice against the name "sophist". By
Aristotle's time, the name bore a contemptuous meaning, as he defines "sophist" as one who
reasons falsely for the sake of gain.
With the revival of Greek eloquence, from about the beginning of the second century CE., the
name "sophist" attained a new distinction. At that time the name was given to the professional
orators, who appeared in public with great pomp and delivered declamations either prepared
beforehand or improvised on the spot. Like the earlier sophists, they went generally from place
to place, and were overwhelmed with applause and with marks of distinction by their
contemporaries, including the Roman Emperors. Dion Chrysostom, Herodes Atticus, Aristides,
Lucian, and Philostratus the Elder belong to the flourishing period of this second school of
sophists, a period which extends over the entire second century. They appear afresh about the
middle of the fourth century, devoting their philosophic culture to the zealous but unavailing
defense of paganism. Among them was the emperor Julian and his contemporaries Libanius,
Himerius, and Themistius. Synesius may be considered the last sophist of importance.
|
