| The term "miracle" is used
very broadly in ordinary language. A quick review of news stories may
turn up reports such as that of a "Christmas Miracle," by which the
Texas gulf coast came to be blanketed with snow by a rare storm. We
speak of miracle drugs, or of miracle babies, and some household
products purport to be miraculous as well. Philosophical discussion of
the miraculous, however, is confined to the use to which religion--and
in particular, theistic religion--puts that conception. These
philosophical discussions center around two overlapping issues.
The first of these issues is a conceptual one:
What is a miracle? Controversy over the conception of a miracle focuses
primarily on whether a miracle must be, in some sense, contrary to
natural law. Must it, in particular, be a violation of natural
law? Supposing that it must be, a second question arises, namely,
whether the conception of such a violation is a coherent one.
Philosophers have also been concerned about what
sort of observable criteria would allow us to identify an event as a
miracle, particularly insofar as that means identifying it as a
violation of natural law. How, for example, can we tell the difference
between a case in which an event is a genuine violation--assuming that some sense can be made of this notion--and one that
conforms to some natural law that is unknown to us? And given the
occurrence of a genuine violation, how are we to determine whether it
is due to divine agency, or whether it is nothing more than a
spontaneous lapse in the natural order?
The second main issue is epistemological: Once we
settle on what a miracle is, can we ever have good reason to believe
that one has taken place? This question is generally connected with the
problem of whether testimony, such as that provided by scriptural
sources, can ever give us adequate reason to believe that a miracle has
occurred.
Table of Contents
(Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this
article)
1. The Definition of "Miracle"
In sketching out a brief philosophical discussion
of miracles, it would be desirable to begin with a definition of
"miracle;" unfortunately, part of the controversy in regard to miracles
is over just what is involved in a proper conception of the miraculous.
As a rough beginning, however, we might observe that the term is from
the Latin miraculum, which is derived from mirari, to
wonder; thus the most general characterization of a miracle is as an
event that provokes wonder. As such, it must be in some way
extraordinary, unusual, or contrary to our expectations. Disagreement
arises, however, as to what makes a miracle something worth wondering
about. In what sense must a miracle be extraordinary? One of the
earliest accounts is given by St. Augustine, who held (City of God,
XXI.8.2) that a miracle is not contrary to nature, but only to our
knowledge of nature; miracles are made possible by hidden
potentialities in nature that are placed there by God. In Summa
Contra Gentiles III:101, St. Thomas Aquinas, expanding
upon Augustine's conception, said that a miracle must go beyond the
order usually observed in nature, though he insisted that a miracle is
not contrary to nature in any absolute sense, since it is in the nature
of all created things to be responsive to God's will.
In his Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding,
David Hume offered two definitions of "miracle;" first, as a violation
of natural law (Enquiries p. 114); shortly afterward he offers
a more complex definition when he says that a miracle is "a
transgression of a law of nature by a particular volition of the Deity,
or by the interposition of some invisible agent" (Enquiries, p.
115n). This second definition offers two important criteria that an
event must satisfy in order to qualify as a miracle: It must be a
violation of natural law, but this by itself is not enough; a miracle
must also be an expression of the divine will. This means that a
miracle must express divine agency; if we have no reason to think that
an event is something done by God, we will have no reason to call it a
miracle.
More recently, the idea that a miracle must be
defined in terms of natural law has come under attack. R.F. Holland
(1965) has argued that a miracle may be consistent with natural law,
since a religiously significant coincidence may qualify as miraculous,
even though we fully understand the causes that brought it about.
Accounts of the miraculous that distance themselves from the
requirement that a miracle be in some way contrary to the order of
nature, in favor of a focus on their significance to human life, might
be said to emphasize their nature as signs; indeed the term semeion,
"sign," is one of the terms used in the New Testament to describe
miraculous events.
2. Miracles and Worldview
The outcome of any discussion of miracles seems to
depend greatly on our worldview. The usual theistic view of the world
is one that presumes the existence of an omnipotent God who, while
transcending nature, is nevertheless able to act, or to express his
will, within the natural world. Clearly belief in miracles is already
plausible if our enquiry may presume this view of things.
The usual way
of making this out might be described as supernaturalistic. Those who would defend supernaturalism sometimes do this through a commitment to an ontology of entities that exist in some sense outside of nature, where by "nature" is meant the totality of things that can be known by means of observation and experiment, or more generally, through the methods proper to the natural sciences.
Defenses of supernaturalism may also take a methodological turn by insisting that the natural sciences are
incapable of revealing the totality of all that there is. While
supernaturalists typically hold that God reveals his nature in part
through observable phenomena (as for example in miracles, or more
generally, in the order of nature), as we shall understand it here, methodological supernaturalism is committed as well to the view that
our knowledge of God must be supplemented by revelation. Revelatory
sources for our knowledge of God might, for example, include some form
of a priori knowledge, supersensory religious experience, or a
direct communication by God of information that would not otherwise be
available to us. Knowledge of God that is passed down in scripture,
such as the Bible or the Qur'an, is generally conceived by theists to
have a revelatory character.
Supernaturalistic accounts of the miraculous very commonly make reference to supernatural causes,
which are thought to play a useful role in the construction of
supernatural explanations. However, as we will see in sections 10 and 11, belief in miracles does not obviously commit one to belief in supernatural causes or the efficacy of supernatural explanations.
In contrast to supernaturalism, ontological naturalism denies
the existence of anything beyond nature; methodological naturalism holds
that observation and experiment-- or generally speaking, the methods of
the empirical sciences-- are sufficient to provide us with all of the
knowledge that it is possible for us to have. Naturalism is sometimes further characterized as holding that
nature is uniform, which is to say that all events in nature conform to
generalizations (e.g. laws) which can be verified by means of observation. Naturalists do
commonly hold this view-- confidence in the uniformity of nature is an
important part of the scientific enterprise-- but strictly speaking this
represents an additional metaphysical commitment regarding the nature
of the universe and its susceptibility to human understanding. If
nature turns out not to be fully lawlike, this would not require the
rejection of naturalism. A failure of uniformity, or what a believer in
miracles might
refer to as a violation of natural law, would imply only that there are
limits to our ability to understand and
predict natural phenomena. However, the naturalist is committed
to denying the legitimacy of any attempt to explain a natural
phenomenon by appeal to the supernatural. Naturalism denies the
existence of supernatural entities and denies as well the claim that
revelation is capable of providing us with genuine knowledge. Where the
supernaturalistic worldview is quite open to the possibility of
miracles, naturalism is much less sympathetic, and one might argue that
the tenets of naturalism rule out the possibility of miracles
altogether; see Lewis (1947:Ch. 1), Martin (1992:192) and Davis
(1999:131).
Much, of course, depends on how we conceive of
miracles, and on what we take their significance to be. One concern we
might have with the miraculous would be an apologetic one. By
"apologetic" here is meant a defense of the rationality of
belief in God. Historically, apologists have pointed to the occurrence
of miracles as evidence for theism, which is to say that they have held
that scriptural reports of miracles, such as those given in the Bible,
provide grounds for belief in God. While this argument is not as
popular now as it was in the 18th century, the modern conception of the
miraculous has been strongly influenced by this apologetic interest.
Such an interest puts important constraints on an account of miracles.
If we wish to point to a miracle as supporting belief in a supernatural
deity, obviously we cannot begin by assuming the supernaturalistic
worldview; this would beg the question. If we are trying to persuade a
skeptic of God's existence, we are trying to demonstrate
to him that there is something beyond or transcending nature, and he
will demand to be persuaded on his own terms; we must make use of no
assumptions beyond those that are already acknowledged by the
naturalistic worldview.
Because the history of modern thought regarding
miracles has been strongly influenced by apologetic interests, the
emphasis of this entry will be on the apologetic conception of the
miraculous-- that is, on the concept of miracle as it has been invoked
by those who would point to the reports of miracles in scripture as
establishing the existence of a supernatural God. It is important to
bear in mind, however, that any difficulty associated with this
apologetic appeal to miracles does not automatically militate against
the reasonableness of belief in miracles generally. A successful
criticism of the apologetic appeal will show at most that a warranted
belief in miracles depends on our having independent reasons for
rejecting naturalism; again, see Lewis (1947:11).
3. The Credibility of Witnesses
A major concern with the rationality of belief in
miracles is with whether we can be justified in believing that a
miracle has occurred on the basis of testimony. To determine whether
the report of a miracle is credible, we
need to consider the reliability of the source. Suppose subject S
reports some state of affairs (or event) E. Are S's reports
generally true? Clearly if she is known to lie, or to utter falsehoods
as jokes, we should be reluctant to believe her. Also, if she has any
special interest in getting us to believe that E has occurred--
if, for example, she stands to benefit financially-- this would give us
reason for skepticism. It is also possible that S may be reporting a
falsehood without intending to do so; she may sincerely believe that E
occurred even though it did not, or her report may be subject to
unconscious exaggeration or distortion. Aside from the possibility that
she may be influenced by some tangible self-interest, such as a
financial one, her report may also be influenced by emotional factors--
by her fears, perhaps, or by wishful thinking. We should also consider
whether other reliable and independent witnesses are available to
corroborate her report.
We must also ask whether S is herself a witness to
E, or is passing on information that was reported to her. If she
witnessed the event personally, we may ask a number of questions about
her observational powers and the physical circumstances of her
observation. There are quite a few things that can go wrong here; for
example, S may sincerely report an event as she believed it to occur,
but in fact her report is based on a misperception. Thus she may report
having seen a man walk across the surface of a lake; this may be her
understanding of what happened, when in fact he was walking alongside
the lake or on a sand bar. If it was dark, and the weather was bad,
this would have made it difficult for S to have a good view of what was
happening. And of course we should not neglect the influence of S's own
attitudes on how she interprets what she sees; if she is already
inclined to think of the man she reports as walking on water as being
someone who is capable of performing such an extraordinary feat, this
may color how she understands what she has seen. By the same token, if
we are already inclined to agree with her about this person's
remarkable abilities, we will be all the more likely to believe her
report.
If S is merely passing on the testimony of someone
else to the occurrence of E, we may question whether she has properly
understood what she was told. She may not be repeating the testimony
exactly as it was given to her. And here, too, her own biases may color
her understanding of the report. The possibility of distortions
entering into testimony grows with each re-telling of the story.
It will be fruitful to consider these elements in
evaluating the strength of scriptural testimony to the miracles
ascribed to Jesus. The reports of these miracles come from the four
gospel accounts, which may not have been written by those who are
supposed to have personally witnessed Jesus' miracles. Some of these
accounts seem to have borrowed from the others, or to have been
influenced by a common source; even if this were not the case, they
still cannot be claimed to be independent. Assuming they originate with
the firsthand testimony of the apostles Mark, Matthew, Luke and John,
these men were closely associated and had time to discuss among
themselves what they had seen before their reports were recorded for
posterity. They were all members of the same religious community, and
shared a common perspective as well as common interests. Unfortunately,
there are no independent reports from uninterested witnesses; while the
gospel accounts tell us that there were miracles that took place in
front of hostile witnesses, this will not help us when it is the
accuracy of these very gospel reports that is at issue. (Later
acknowledgements of Jesus' miracles by hostile parties is, the skeptic
will argue, evidence only for the gullibility of these writers.)
It is sometimes suggested that these men undertook
grave risk by reporting what they did, and they would not have risked
their lives for a lie. But this establishes, at best, only that their
reports are sincere; unfortunately, their conviction is not conclusive
evidence for the truth of their testimony. We could expect the same
conviction from someone who was delusional.
Let us consider a particular report of Jesus'
resurrection in applying these considerations. Popular apologetic
sometimes points to the fact that according to Paul in 1 Corinthians
(15:6), the resurrected Jesus was seen by five hundred people at once,
and that it is highly improbable that so many people would have the
experience of seeing Jesus if Jesus were not actually there. After all,
it may be argued, they could not have shared a mass hallucination,
since hallucinations are typically private; there is no precedent for
shared hallucination, and it may seem particularly far-fetched to
suppose that a hallucination would be shared among so many people.
Accordingly it may be thought much more likely that Jesus really was
there and, assuming there is sufficient evidence that he had died
previously to that time, it becomes reasonable to say that he was
resurrected from the dead.
While this report is sometimes taken as evidence
of Jesus' physical resurrection, Paul says only that he appeared
to the five hundred without saying explicitly that it was a physically
reconstituted Jesus that these people saw. But let us suppose that Paul
means to report that the five hundred saw Jesus in the flesh.
Unfortunately we do not have the reports of the five hundred to Jesus'
resurrection; we have only Paul's hearsay testimony that Jesus was seen
by five hundred. Furthermore Paul does not tell us how this information
came to him. It is possible that he spoke personally to some or all of
these five hundred witnesses, but it is also possible that he is
repeating testimony that he received from someone else. This opens up
the possibility that the report was distorted before it reached Paul;
for example, the number of witnesses may have been exaggerated, or the
original witnesses may have merely reported feeling Jesus' presence in
some way without actually seeing him. For the sake of argument,
however, let us suppose that there was at one time a group of five
hundred people who were all prepared to testify that they had seen a
physically resurrected Jesus. This need not be the result of any
supposed mass hallucination; the five hundred might have all seen
someone who they came to believe, after discussing it amongst
themselves, was Jesus. In such a case, the testimony of the five
hundred would be to an experience together with a shared interpretation
of it.
It is also possible that the text of Paul's letter
to the Corinthians has not been accurately preserved. Thus, no matter
how reliable Paul himself might be, his own report may have been
modified through one, or several, redactions.
There are, therefore, quite a few points at which
error or distortion might have entered into the report in 1
Corinthians: (1) The original witnesses may have been wrong, for one
reason or another, about whether they saw Jesus; (2) the testimony of
these witnesses may have been distorted before reaching Paul; (3) Paul
may have incorrectly reported what he heard about the event, and (4)
Paul's own report, as given in his original letter to the Christian
community in Corinth, may have been distorted. The apologist may argue
that it would be very surprising if errors should creep into the report
at any of these four points. The question we must ask now, however, is
which of these alternatives would be more surprising: That some
error should arise in regard to 1-4 above, or that Jesus really was
resurrected from the dead.
4. Hume's Argument
In Section X of his Enquiry Concerning Human
Understanding, Hume tells us that it is not reasonable to subscribe
to any "system of religion" unless that system is validated by the
occurrence of miracles; he then argues that we cannot be justified in
believing that a miracle has occurred, at least when our belief is
based on testimony-- as when, for example, it is based on the reports of
miracles that are given in scripture. (Hume did not explicitly address
the question of whether actually witnessing an apparent miracle would
give us good reason to think that a miracle had actually occurred,
though it is possible that the principles he invokes in regard to
testimony for the miraculous can be applied to the case of a witnessed
miracle.) His stated aim is to show that belief in miracle reports is
not rational, but that "our most holy religion is founded on Faith, not
on reason" (Enquiries, p. 130). Hume surely intends some irony
here, however, since he concludes by saying that anyone who embraces a
belief in miracles based on faith is conscious of "a continued miracle
in his own person, which subverts all the principles of his
understanding" (Enquiries, p. 131); this seems very far from an
endorsement of a faith-based belief in miracles.
There is some dispute as to the nature of Hume's
argument against miracles, and the Enquiry seems to contain
more than one such argument. The most compelling of these is the one I
will call the Balance of Probabilities Argument. (For a brief
discussion of some of the other arguments, see the entry "David Hume:
Writings on Religion.") Hume tells us that we ought to proportion our
certainty regarding any matter of fact to the strength of the evidence.
We have already examined some of the considerations that go into
assessing the strength of testimony; there is no denying that testimony
may be very strong indeed when, for example, it may be given by
numerous highly reliable and independent witnesses.
Nevertheless, Hume tells us that no
testimony can be adequate to establish the occurrence of a miracle. The
problem that arises is not so much with the reliability of the
witnesses as with the nature of what is being reported. A miracle is,
according to Hume, a violation of natural law. We suppose that a law of
nature obtains only when we have an extensive, and exceptionless,
experience of a certain kind of phenomenon. For example, we suppose
that it is a matter of natural law that a human being cannot walk on
the surface of water while it is in its liquid state; this supposition
is based on the weight of an enormous body of experience gained from
our familiarity with what happens in seas, lakes, kitchen sinks, and
bathtubs. Given that experience, we always have the best possible
evidence that in any particular case, an object with a sufficiently
great average density, having been placed onto the surface of a body of
water, will sink. According to Hume, the evidence in favor of a
miracle, even when that is provided by the strongest possible
testimony, will always be outweighed by the evidence for the law of
nature which is supposed to have been violated.
Considerable controversy surrounds the notion of a
violation of natural law. However, it would appear that all Hume needs
in order to make his argument is that a miracle be an exception to the
course of nature as we have previously observed it; that is, where we
have had a substantial experience of a certain sort of phenomenon-- call
it A-- and have an exceptionless experience of all As
being B, we have very strong reason to believe that any given A
will be a B. Thus given that we have a very great amount of experience
regarding dense objects being placed onto water, and given that in
every one of these cases that object has sunk, we have the strongest
possible evidence that any object that is placed onto water is one that
will sink. Accordingly we have the best possible reasons for thinking
that any report of someone walking on water is false-- and this no
matter how reliable the witness.
While objections are frequently made against
Hume's conception of natural law, in fact no particularly sophisticated
account of natural law seems to be necessary here, and Hume's examples
are quite commonsensical: All human beings must die, lead cannot remain
suspended in the air, fire consumes wood and is extinguished by water (Enquiries
p. 114). This may be a naive conception of
natural law; nevertheless it is true that, all things being equal, we
can assign a minimal probability to the occurrence of a counterinstance
to any of these generalizations.
At times Hume sounds as though he thinks the
probability of such an event is zero, given its unprecedented nature,
and some commentators have objected that the fact that we have never
known such an event to occur does not imply that it cannot
occur. Past regularities do not establish that it is impossible that a
natural law should ever be suspended (Purtill 1978). However,
regardless of Hume's original intent, this is a more extravagant claim
than his argument requires. He is free to admit that some small
probability may be attached to the prospect that a dense object might
remain on the surface of a lake; it is sufficient for his purposes that
it will always be more likely that any witness who reports such
an event is attempting to deceive us, or is himself deceived. After
all, there is no precedent for any human being walking on water,
setting this one controversial case aside, but there is ample precedent
for the falsehood of testimony even under the best of circumstances.
Accordingly Hume says (Enquiries p. 115ff)
that "no testimony is sufficient to establish a miracle, unless the
testimony be of such a kind, that its falsehood would be more
miraculous, than the fact, which it endeavors to establish." We must
always decide in favor of the lesser miracle. We must ask ourselves,
which would be more of a miracle: That Jesus walked on water, or that
the scriptural reports of this event are false? While we may
occasionally encounter testimony that is so strong that its falsehood
would be very surprising indeed, we never come across any report, the
falsehood of which would be downright miraculous. Accordingly, the
reasonable conclusion will always be that the testimony is false.
Thus to return to Paul's report of Jesus'
resurrection in 1 Corinthians: It may be highly unlikely that the original
witnesses were wrong, for one reason or another, about whether they saw
Jesus; it may be highly unlikely that the testimony of these witnesses
may have been distorted before reaching Paul; it may be highly unlikely
that Paul incorrectly reported what he heard about the event, and it
may be highly unlikely that Paul's original letter to the Christian
community in Corinth has not been accurately preserved in our modern
translations of the New Testament. Suppose the apologist can argue that
a failure in the transmission of testimony at any of these points might
be entirely without precedent in human experience. But the physical
resurrection of a human being is also without precedent, so that the
very best the apologist can hope for is that both alternatives-- that
the report is incorrect, or that Jesus returned to life-- are equally
unlikely, which seems only to call for a suspension of judgment.
Apologetic appeals frequently focus on the strength of testimony such
as Paul's, and often appear to make a good case for its reliability.
Nevertheless such an appeal will only persuade those who are already
inclined to believe in the miracle-- perhaps because they are already
sympathetic to a supernaturalistic worldview-- and who therefore tend
to downplay the unlikelihood of a dead man returning to life.
Having said all this, it may strike us as odd that
Hume seems not to want to rule out the possibility, in principle, that
very strong testimony might establish the occurrence of an
unprecedented event. He tells us (Enquiries p. 127) that if the
sun had gone dark for eight days beginning on January 1, 1600, and that
testimony to this fact continued to be received from all over the world
and without any variation, we should believe it-- and then look for the
cause. Thus even if we were convinced that such an event really did
take place-- and the evidence in this case would be considerably
stronger than the evidence for any of the miracles of the Bible-- we
should suppose that the event in question really had a natural cause
after all. In this case the event would not be a violation of natural
law, and thus according to Hume's definition would not be a miracle.
Despite this possibility, Hume wants to say that
the quality of miracle reports is never high enough to clear this
hurdle, at least when they are given in the interest of establishing a
religion, as they typically are. People in such circumstances are
likely to be operating under any number of passional influences, such
as enthusiasm, wishful thinking, or a sense of mission driven by good
intentions; these influences may be expected to undermine their
critical faculties. Given the importance to religion of a sense of
mystery and wonder, that very quality which would otherwise tend to
make a report incredible-- that it is the report of something entirely
novel-- becomes one that recommends it to us. Thus in a religious
context we may believe the report not so much in spite of its
absurdity as because of it.
5. Problems with Hume's Argument
There is something clearly right about Hume's
argument. The principle he cites surely resembles the one that we
properly use when we discredit reports in tabloid newspapers about
alien visitors to the White House or tiny mermaids being found in
sardine cans. Nevertheless the argument has prompted a great many
criticisms.
Some of this discussion makes use of Bayesian
probabilistic analysis; John Earman, for example, argues that when the
principles of Hume's arguments "are made explicit and examined under
the lens of Bayesianism, they are found to be either vapid, specious,
or at variance with actual scientific practice" (Earman 2000). The
Bayesian literature will not be discussed here, though Earman's
discussion of the power of multiple witnessing deserves mention. Earman
argues that even if the prior probability of a miracle occurring is
very low, if there are enough independent witnesses, and each is
sufficiently reliable, its occurrence may be established as probable.
Thus if Hume's concern is to show that we cannot in principle
ever have good reason to believe testimony to a miracle, he would
appear to be wrong about this (Earman 2000: See particularly Ch. 18 and
following). Of course the number of witnesses required might be very
large, and it may be that none of the miracles reported in any
scripture will qualify. It is true that some of the miracles of the
Bible are reported to have occurred in the presence of a good number of
witnesses; the miracle of the loaves and fishes is a good example,
which according to Mark (Mark 6:30-44) was witnessed by 5,000 people.
But have already noticed that the testimony of one person, or even of
four, that some event was witnessed by a multitude is not nearly the
same as having the testimony of the multitude itself.
Another objection against Hume's argument is that
it makes use of a method that is unreliable; that is, it may have us
reject reports that are true or accept those that are false. Consider
the fact that a particular combination of lottery numbers will
generally be chosen against very great odds. If the odds of the
particular combination chosen in the California Lottery last week were
40 million to 1, the probability of that combination being chosen is
very low. Assuming that the likelihood of any given event being
misreported in the Los Angeles Times is greater than that, we would not
be able to trust the Times to determine which ticket is the winner.
The unreliability objection, made out in this
particular way, seems to have a fairly easy response. There is no
skeptical challenge to our being justified in believing the report of a
lottery drawing; that is, reports of lottery drawings are reports of
ordinary events, like reports of rainstorms and presidential press
conferences. They do not require particularly strong testimony to be
credible, and in fact we may be justified in believing the report of a
lottery drawing even if it came from an otherwise unreliable source,
such as a tabloid newspaper. This is surely because we know in advance
that when the lottery is drawn, whatever particular combination of
numbers may be chosen will be chosen against very great odds, so that
we are guaranteed to get one highly improbable combination or another.
Despite the fact that the odds against any particular combination are
very great, all of the other particular outcomes are equally unlikely,
so we have no prejudice against any particular combination. We
know that people are going to win the lottery from time to time; we
have no comparable assurance that anyone will ever be raised from the
dead.
Nevertheless if we are to be able to make progress
in science, we must be prepared to revise our understanding of natural
law, and there ought to be circumstances in which testimony to an
unprecedented event would be credible. For example, human beings
collectively have seen countless squid, few of which have ever exceeded
a length of two feet. For this reason reports of giant squid have, in
the past, been sometimes dismissed as fanciful; the method employed by
Hume in his Balance of Probabilities Argument would seem to rule out
the possibility of our coming to the conclusion, on the basis of
testimony, that such creatures exist-- yet they have been found in the
deep water near Antarctica. Similarly, someone living beyond the reach
of modern technology might well reject reports of electric lighting and
airplanes. Surely we should be skeptical when encountering a report of
something so novel. But science depends for its progress on an ability
to revise even its most confident assertions about the natural world.
Discussion of this particular problem in Hume
tends to revolve around his example of the Indian and the ice. Someone
from a very hot climate such as that of India, living during Hume's
time, might refuse to believe that water was capable of taking solid
form as ice or frost, since he has an exceptionless experience against
this. Yet in this case he would come to the wrong conclusion. Hume
argues that such a person would reason correctly, and that very strong
testimony would properly be required to persuade him otherwise. Yet
Hume refers to this not as a miracle but as a marvel; the difference
would appear to lie in the fact that while water turning to ice does
not conform to the experience of the Indian, since he has experienced
no precedent for this, it is also not contrary to his
experience, because he has never had a chance to see what will happen
to water when the temperature is sufficiently low (Enquiries, p.
113). By the same token, we ought to be cautious when it comes to
deciding how large squid may grow in the Antarctic deeps, when our only
experience of them has been in warm and relatively shallow water. The
circumstances of an Antarctic habitat are not analogous to those in
which we normally observe squid.
On the other hand, when someone reports to us that
they have witnessed a miracle, such as a human being walking on water,
our experience of ordinary water is analogous to this case, and
therefore counts against the likelihood that the report is true. And of
course our usual experience must be analogous to this case, for
if the water that someone walks upon is somehow unlike ordinary water,
or there is something else in the physical circumstances that can
account for how it was possible in this one instance for someone to
walk on water when this is impossible in the ordinary case, then it is
not a violation of natural law after all, and therefore, by Hume's
definition, not a miracle. Jesus' walking on water will only qualify as
a miracle on the assumption that this case is analogous in all relevant
respects to those cases in which dense objects have sunk.
The distinction between a miracle and a marvel is
an important one for Hume; as he constructs an epistemology that he
hopes will rule out belief in miracles in principle, he must be careful
that it does not also hinder progress in science. Whether Hume is
successful in making this distinction is a matter of some controversy.
a. Does Hume's Argument Beg the
Question?
Many commentators have suggested that Hume's
argument begs the question against miracles. (See for example Lewis
1947:103, Houston 1994:133) Suppose I am considering whether it is
possible for a human being to walk on water. I consider my past
experience with dense objects, such as human bodies, and their behavior
in water; I may even conduct a series of experiments to see what will
happen when a human body is placed without support on the surface of a
body of water, and I always observe these bodies to sink. I now
consider what is likely to occur, or likely to have occurred, in some
unknown case. Perhaps I am wondering what will happen the next time I
step out into the waters of Silver Lake. Obviously I will expect,
without seriously considering the matter, that I will sink rather than
walk on its surface. My past experience with water gives me very good
reason to think that this is what will happen. But of course in this
case, I am not asking whether nature will be following its usual
course. Indeed, I am assuming that it will be, since otherwise I would
not refer to my past experience to judge what was likely in this
particular case; my past experience of what happens with dense bodies
in water is relevant only in those cases in which the uniformity of
nature is not in question. But this means that to assume that our past
experience is relevant in deciding what has happened in an unknown
case, as Hume would have us do, is to assume that nature was following
its usual course-- it is to assume that there has been no break in the
uniformity of nature. It is, in short, to assume that no miracle has
occurred. In order to take seriously the possibility that a miracle has
occurred, we must take seriously the possibility that there has been a
breach in the uniformity of nature, which means that we cannot assume,
without begging the question, that our ordinary observations are
relevant.
It would be a mistake, however, to suppose that
this criticism represents a victory for apologetic. While the apologist
may wish to proceed by asking the skeptic to abandon his assumption
that ordinary experience is relevant to assessing the truth of miracle
reports, this seems to beg the question in the opposite direction.
Ordinary experience will only fail to be relevant in those cases in
which there was in fact a break in the uniformity of nature, i.e. in
those cases in which a miracle has occurred, and this is precisely what
the skeptic requires to be shown. It is tempting to suppose that there
is a middle ground; perhaps the skeptic need only admit that it is possible
that ordinary experience is not relevant in this case. However, it is
difficult to determine just what sort of possibility this would be. The
mere logical possibility that an exceptional event may have
occurred is not something that the skeptic has ever questioned; when I
infer that I will sink in the waters of Silver Lake, I do so in full
recognition of the fact that it is logically possible that I will not.
If the apologist is asking for any greater
concession than this, the skeptic may be forgiven for demanding that he
be given some justification for granting it. He may be forgiven, too,
for demanding that he be persuaded of the occurrence of a miracle on
his own terms-- i.e. on purely naturalistic grounds, without requiring
him to adopt any of the assumptions of supernaturalism. Of course the
most natural place to look for evidence that there may occasionally be
breaks in the natural order would be to testimony, but for reasons that
are now obvious, this will not do.
It would appear that the question of whether
miracle reports are credible turns on a larger question, namely,
whether we ought to hold the supernaturalistic worldview, or the
naturalistic one. One thing seems certain, however, and that is that
the apologist cannot depend on miracle reports to establish the
supernaturalistic worldview if the credibility of such reports depends
on our presumption that the supernaturalistic worldview is correct.
6. Conceptual Difficulties: The
Logical Impossibility of a Violation
Recent criticisms of belief in miracles have
focused on the concept of a miracle. In particular, it has been held
that the notion of a violation of natural law is self-contradictory. No
one, of course, thinks that the report of an event that might be taken
as a miracle-- such as a resurrection or a walking on water-- is
logically self-contradictory. Nevertheless some philosophers have
argued that it is paradoxical to suggest both that such an event has
occurred, and that it is a violation of natural law. This
argument dates back at least as far as T.H. Huxley, who tells us that
the definition of a miracle as contravening the order of nature is
self-contradictory, because all we know of the order of nature is
derived from our observation of the course of events of which the
so-called miracle is a part (1984:157). Should an apparent miracle take
place, such as a suspension in the air of a piece of lead, scientific
methodology forbids us from supposing that any law of nature has been
violated; on the contrary, Huxley tells us (in a thoroughly Humean
vein) that "the scientist would simply set to work to investigate the
conditions under which so highly unexpected an occurrence took place;
and modify his, hitherto, unduly narrow conception of the laws of
nature" (1894:156). More recently this view has been defended by Antony
Flew (1966, 1967, 1997) and Alastair McKinnon (1967). McKinnon has
argued that in formulating the laws of nature, the scientist is merely
trying to codify what actually happens; thus to claim that some event
is a miracle, where this is taken to imply that it is a violation of
natural law, is to claim at once that it actually occurred, but also,
paradoxically, that it is contrary to the actual course of events.
Let us say that a statement of natural law is a
generalization of the form "All As are Bs;" for example, all objects
made of lead (A) are objects that will fall when we let go of them (B).
A violation would be represented by the occurrence of an A that is not
a B, or in this case, an object made of lead that does not fall when we
let go of it. Thus to assert that a violation of natural law has
occurred is to say at once that all As are Bs, but to say at the same
time that there exists some A that is not a B; it is to say,
paradoxically, that all objects made of lead will fall when left
unsupported, but that this object made of lead did not fall when left
unsupported. Clearly we cannot have it both ways; should we encounter a
piece of lead that does not fall, we will be forced to admit that it is
not true that all objects made of lead will fall. On McKinnon’s view, a
counterinstance to some statement of natural law negates that
statement; it shows that our understanding of natural law is incorrect
and must be modified-- which implies that no violation has occurred
after all.
Of course this does not mean that no one has ever
parted the Red Sea, walked on water, or been raised from the dead; it
only means that such events, if they occurred, cannot be violations of
natural law. Thus arguably, this criticism does not undermine the
Christian belief that these events really did occur (Mavrodes
1985:337). But if Antony Flew is correct (1967:148), for the apologist
to point to any of these events as providing evidence for the existence
of a transcendent God or the truth of a particular religious doctrine,
we must not only have good reason to believe that they occurred, but
also that they represent an overriding of natural law, an overriding
that originates from outside of nature. To have any apologetic value,
then, a miracle must be a violation of natural law, which means that we
must (per impossibile) have both the law and the exception.
a. Violations as Nonrepeatable
Counterinstances to Natural Law
The conception of a violation may, however, be
defended as logically coherent. Suppose we take it to be a law of
nature that a human being cannot walk on water; subsequently, however,
we become convinced that on one particular occasion (O)-- say for
example, April 18th, 1910--someone was actually able to do this. Yet
suppose that after the occurrence of O water goes back to
behaving exactly as it normally does. In such a case our formulation of
natural law would continue to have its usual predictive value, and
surely we would neither abandon it nor revise it. The only revision
possible in this case would be to say "Human beings cannot walk on
water, except on occasion O." Yet the amendment in this case is
entirely ad hoc; in its reference to a particular event, the
revision fails to take the generalized form that statements of natural
law normally possess, and it adds no explanatory power to the original
formulation of the law. It gives us no better explanation of what has
happened in the past, it does nothing to account for the exceptional
event O, and it fares no better than the original formulation
when it comes to predicting what will happen in the future. In this
case O is what might be called a nonrepeatable
counterinstance to natural law. Faced with such an event we would
retain our old formulation of the law, which is to say that the
exceptional event O does not negate that formulation. This
means that there is no contradiction implied by affirming the law
together with its exception.
Things would be different if we can identify some
feature (F) of the circumstances in which O occurred
which will explain why O occurred in this one case when
normally it would not. F might be some force operating to
counteract the usual tendency of a dense object, such as a human body,
to sink in water. In this case, on discovery of F we are in a
position to reformulate the law in a fruitful way, saying that human
beings cannot walk on water except when F is present. Since the
exception in this case now has a generalized form (i.e. it expresses
the proposition that human beings can walk on water whenever F
is present), our reformulation has the kind of generality that a
statement of natural law ought to have. It explains the past
interaction of dense bodies with water as well as the original
formulation did, and it explains why someone was able to walk on water
on occasion O. Finally, it will serve to predict what will
happen in the future, both when F is absent and when it is
present.
We may now, following Ninian Smart (1964:37) and
Richard Swinburne (1970:26), understand a violation as a nonrepeatable
counterinstance to natural law. We encounter a nonrepeatable
counterinstance when someone walks on water, as in case O, and
having identified all of the causally relevant factors at work in O,
and reproducing these, no one is able to walk on water. Since a
statement of natural law is falsified only by the occurrence of a
repeatable counterinstance, it is paradoxical to assert a particular
statement of law and at the same time insist that a repeatable
counterinstance to it has occurred. However there is no paradox in
asserting the existence of the law together with the occurrence of a
counterinstance that is not repeatable.
b. Miracles as Outside the Scope
of Natural Laws
The force of this line of reasoning to deny that
natural laws must describe the actual course of events. Natural laws do
not describe absolutely the limits of what can and cannot happen in
nature. They only describe nature to the extent that it operates
according to laws. To put the matter differently, we might say that
natural laws only describe what can happen as a result of natural
causes; they do not tell us what can happen when a supernatural cause
is present. As Michael Levine (1989:67) has put the point:
Suppose the laws of nature are regarded
as nonuniversal or incomplete in the sense that while they cover
natural events, they do not cover, and are not intended to cover,
non-natural events such as supernaturally caused events if there are or
could be any. A physically impossible occurrence would not violate a
law of nature because it would not be covered by (i.e. would not fall
within the scope of) such a law.
On this understanding, a physically impossible
event would be one that could not occur given only physical, or
natural, causes. But what is physically impossible is not absolutely
impossible, since such an event might occur as the result of a
supernatural cause. One way to make this out is to say that all laws
must ultimately be understood as disjunctions, of the form "All As are
Bs unless some supernatural cause is operating." (Let us refer to this
as a supernaturalistic formulation of law, where of course it is causal supernaturalism that is at work here, as opposed to a naturalistic
formulation, which simply asserts that all As are Bs, without taking
account the possibility of any supernatural cause.) If this is correct,
then it turns out that strictly speaking, a miracle is not a violation
of natural law after all, since it is something that occurs by means of
a supernatural intervention. Furthermore, since statements of natural
law are only intended to describe what happens in the absence of
supernatural intrusions, the occurrence of a miracle does not negate
any formulation of natural law.
The supernaturalistic conception of natural law
appears to offer a response to Hume's Balance of Probabilities
argument; the evidence for natural laws, gathered when supernatural
causes are absent, does not weigh against the possibility that a
miracle should occur, since a miracle is the result of a supernatural
intervention into the natural order. Thus there is a failure of analogy
between those cases that form the basis for our statements of natural
law, and the circumstances of a miracle. Probabilistic considerations,
based on our ordinary experience, are only useful in determining what
will happen in the ordinary case, when there are no supernatural causes
at work.
7. Conceptual Difficulties II:
Identifying Miracles
We have seen two ways in which the concept of a
miracle, described as an event that nature cannot produce on its own,
may be defended as coherent. We may say that a miracle is a violation
of natural law and appeal to the conception of a violation as a
nonrepeatable counterinstance, or we may deny that miracles are
violations of natural law since, having supernatural causes, they fall
outside the scope of these laws. Nevertheless, conceptual difficulties
remain. Antony Flew (1966, 1967, 1997) has argued that if a miracle is
to serve any apologetic purpose, as evidence for the truth of some
revelation, then it must be possible to identify it as a miracle
without appealing to criteria given by that revelation; in particular,
there must be natural, or observable, criteria by which an event can be
determined to be one which nature cannot produce on its own. Flew
refers to this as the Problem of Identifying Miracles.
Let us see how this problem arises in connection
with these two conceptions of the miraculous. Are there natural
criteria by which we can distinguish a repeatable from a nonrepeatable
counterinstance to some natural law? Suppose some formulation of
natural law (All As are Bs) and some event that is a counterinstance to
that formulation (an A that is not a B). The counterinstance will be
repeatable just in case there is some natural force F present
in the circumstances that is causally responsible for the
counterinstance, such that every time F is present, a similar
counterinstance will occur. But suppose we do our best to reproduce the
circumstances of the event and are unable to do so. We cannot assume
that the event is nonrepeatable, for we have no way to eliminate the
possibility that we have failed to identify all of the natural forces
that were operating to produce the original counterinstance. The
exceptional event may have been produced by a natural force that is
unknown to us. No observable distinction can be made between a case in
which an exception is repeatable, having been produced by some as--yet
undiscovered natural force, and one that is not. Worse yet, the
naturalist will argue that the very occurrence of the exception is
evidence that there is in fact some previously unknown natural force at
work; where there is a difference in effects, there must be a
difference in causes-- which for the naturalist means, of course, natural
causes.
Nor does the difficulty go away if we adopt the
supernaturalistic view of natural law. On this view, natural laws only
describe what happens when supernatural forces are absent; a genuine
miracle does not violate natural law because it is the effect of a
supernatural cause. Suppose an extraordinary event occurs, which the
apologist would like to attribute to a supernatural cause. The
following two states of affairs appear to be empirically
indistinguishable:
1. The event is the result of a natural cause that
we are as yet unable to identify.
2.
The event is the result of a supernatural
cause.
This, of course, is due to the fact that we do not observe the cause of
the event in either of these cases-- in the first, it is because the
cause is unknown to us, and in the second, because supernatural causes
are unobservable ex hypothesi. Thus the issue here is whether
we should suppose that our failure to observe any cause for the event
is due to our (perhaps temporary) inability to fully identify all of
the natural forces that were operating to produce it, or whether it is
because the cause, being supernatural, is in principle unobservable. If
Flew is right, then in order to identify the event as a miracle, we
must find some way to rule out the possibility of ever finding a
natural cause for it; furthermore, if the identification of this event
as a miracle is to serve any apologetic purpose, we must find some
empirical grounds for doing this.
To complicate matters even further, there is yet a
third possibility, which is that:
3. The event has no cause at all.
That is, it is possible that the event is simply
uncaused or spontaneous. It is clear that there can be no
observable difference between an event that has a supernatural cause,
since such a cause is in principle unobservable, and one that
fails to have a cause. The challenge for an account of miracles as
supernaturally caused is to show what the difference is between
conceiving an event as having a supernatural cause, and conceiving of
it as simply lacking any cause at all.
The implications of this are quite significant:
Even if the naturalist were forced to admit that an event had no
natural cause, and that nature is, therefore, not fully lawlike, this
does not commit him to supernaturalism. It is possible that nature
undergoes spontaneous lapses in its uniformity. Such events would be
nonrepeatable counterinstances to natural law, but they would not be
miracles. They would fall within the unaided potentialities of nature;
the naturalist need not admit the necessity of supernatural
intervention to produce such events, because their occurrence requires
no appeal to any transcendent reality. Indeed, should we become
persuaded that an event has occurred that has no natural cause, the
naturalist may argue that simplicity dictates that we forgo any appeal
to the supernatural, since this would involve the introduction of an
additional entity (God) without any corresponding benefit in
explanatory power.
8. Supernatural Causes and
Supernatural Explanation
The apologist, however, will insist that this is
precisely the point. Describing an extraordinary event as the effect of
a supernatural cause, and attributing it to divine intervention, is
justified by the fact that it offers us a chance to explain it where no
natural explanation is available. Assuming (as the naturalist typically
does) that nature operates according to physical laws, the occurrence
of an apparent exception points to some difference in the
circumstances. If no difference in the physical circumstances can be
found, then the only explanation available is that there is some
supernatural force at work. It is unreasonable to reject such a
supernatural explanation in the purely speculative hope that one day a
natural explanation may become available.
The notion of a supernatural explanation deserves
careful attention. The naturalist will surely argue that the conception
of a supernatural explanation-- together with its cognate, the notion of
a supernatural cause-- is confused. This position is motivated by the
conviction that the notions of an explanation and of a cause are
fundamentally empirical conceptions.
First, as regards the conception of a cause:
Paradigmatically, causation is a relation between two entities, a cause
(or some set of causal circumstances) and an effect. Now there are many
cases in which we witness the effect of a cause that is not seen; I
might for example hear the sound of a gunshot, and not see the gun that
produced it. Furthermore I will be able to infer that there is a gun
somewhere nearby that produced that sound. This is an inference from
effect to cause, and is similar to what the apologist would like to do
with a miracle, inferring the existence of God (as cause) from the
occurrence of the miracle (as effect). But what makes my inference
possible in this case is, as Hume would point out, the fact that I have
observed a regular conjunction of similar causes with similar effects.
This is precisely what is lacking when it comes to supernatural causes.
I cannot ever experience the conjunction of a supernatural cause with
its effect, since supernatural causes are (by hypothesis) unobservable--
nor can I make an inference from any phenomenon in nature to its
supernatural cause without such an experience. Indeed given the
very uniqueness of God's miraculous interventions into nature, it is
difficult to see how the notion of divine causation could draw on any
kind of regularity at all, as empirical causes do.
It is true that science often appeals to invisible
entities such as electrons, magnetic fields, and black holes; perhaps
the apologist conceives her own appeal as having a similar character
(Geivett 1997:183). These things, one may argue, are known only through
their observable effects. But the causal properties of such natural
entities as electrons and magnetic fields are analogous to those of
entities that are observable; this is what entitles us to refer
to them as natural entities. Furthermore, these properties may
be described in terms of observable regularities, which means that
entities like electrons and magnetic fields may play a role in theories
that have predictive power. Thus for example, an appeal to electrons
can help us predict what will happen when we turn on a light switch.
God is not a theoretical entity of this kind. Far from being able to
play a role in any empirical regularities, God's miraculous
interventions into nature, as these are conceived by the
supernaturalist, are remarkable for their uniqueness.
Another reason for doubting that God can possess
causal powers analogous to those enjoyed by natural objects arises from
the fact that God is typically conceived as lacking any location in
space-- and on the view of some philosophers, as being outside of time
as well. Causal relationships among natural entities play out against a
spatio-temporal background. Indeed it would seem that to speak of God
as the cause of event in nature encounters something similar to the
Problem of Mind-Body Interaction. (This should not be surprising given
the usual conception of God as a nonmaterial entity, i.e. as mind or
spirit.) All of the cases of causal interaction of which we are aware
occur between physical entities that are fundamentally similar to one
another in terms of possessing physical properties such as mass,
electrical charge, location in space etc. Thus we know for example how
one billiard ball may move another by virtue of the transfer of
momentum. But God possesses none of these qualities, and cannot
therefore interact with physical objects in any way that we can
understand. God cannot, for example, transfer momentum to a physical
object if God does not possess mass.
It may be argued that the conception of an
explanation is inextricably intertwined with that of causation, so that
if the conception of a supernatural cause is an empty one, the notion
of a supernatural explanation can hardly be expected to get off the
ground. The apologist may respond by distinguishing the sort of
explanation she intends to give, when she attributes a miracle to
divine agency, from the sort of explanation that is common to the
natural sciences. In particular, she might characterize them as personal
explanations, which work to explain a phenomenon by reference to the
intentions of an agent-- in this case God. (See for example Swinburne
1979: Ch. 2) Now, it is true that personal explanations do not have
quite the same empirical basis as do scientific ones; nevertheless,
like scientific explanations, they do typically have empirical
consequences. For example, if I explain Bertrand's running a red light
by saying that he wanted to be on time to his meeting, I have given a
personal explanation for Bertrand's behavior, and it is one that is
testable. It will be supported by any observations that tend to confirm
the hypothesis that Bertrand is due for a meeting and that being on
time is something that he desires, and it will be undermined by any
that are contrary to it, such as discovering that Bertrand does not
believe that any meeting is imminent. Furthermore this explanation also
serves as a basis for rough predictions about other actions that
Bertrand might be expected to perform, e.g. he will likely take other
steps (possibly involving additional traffic violations) in order to
make it to his meeting on time.
The most obvious way in which appeals to divine
agency fail to be analogous to the usual sort of personal explanation
is in their failure to yield even the vaguest of predictions. (See
Nowell-Smith 1955) Suppose, for example, that we attribute a walking on
water to divine intervention; from this description, nothing follows
about what we can expect to happen in the future. Unless we can
introduce additional information provided by revelation, we have no
grounds for inferring that God will bring it about that additional
miracles will occur; he may, or he may not. Indeed, as far as this kind
of predictive expansion is concerned, we seem no better off saying that
some event came about because God willed to occur than we would be if
we said of it simply that it had no cause, or that it occurred
spontaneously. (Indeed, often
when someone says "It was God's will," they are calling attention to
the inscrutability of events.) In light of this fact, there is no
reason why the naturalist should find such a supernatural explanation
compelling; on the contrary, faced with a putative miracle, if his
concern was to explain the event, he would be justified in following
Hume's advice and continuing to hold out for a natural cause and a
natural explanation-- one that possesses predictive power-- or in the
worst case, to simply shrug off the incident as inexplicable, while
denying that this inexplicability warrants any appeal to the divine.
An objection here may be that all of this makes
use of an unnecessarily narrow conception of causation-- one which
arbitrarily seeks to restrict their use to the natural sciences.
Undoubtedly the word "cause" is used in a very diverse number of ways,
and it is surely wrong to say that no sense can ever be attached to a
statement of the form "God caused x to occur." The same may be
said regarding the notion of an explanation. But it is the apologist
who tries to understand supernatural causes as analogous to the sort of
causes that are of interest to natural science. If supernatural causes
are not sufficiently similar to natural ones, they cannot be expected
to fill the gap when natural causes are found to be lacking.
The most fundamental challenge to someone who
wishes to appeal to the existence of supernatural causes is to make it
clear just what the difference is between saying that an event has a
supernatural cause, and saying that it has no cause at all. Similarly
when it comes to the prospect of giving a supernatural explanation:
Supposing that someone walks on water and we are unable to find any
natural explanation for this, what warrants our saying that such an
event has a supernatural explanation, as opposed to saying that it is
inexplicable and being done with it?
9. Coincidence Miracles
Given the difficulties that arise in connection
with the suggestion that God causes a miracle to occur, a non-causal
account deserves consideration. R.F. Holland (1965) has suggested that
a religiously significant coincidence may qualify as a miracle. Suppose
a child who is riding a toy motor-car gets stuck on the track at a
train crossing. A train is approaching from around a curve, and the
engineer who is driving it will not be able to see the child until it
is too late to stop. By coincidence, the engineer faints at just the
right moment, releasing his hand on the control lever, which causes the
train to stop automatically. The child, against all expectations, is
saved, and his mother thanks God for his providence; she continues to
insist that a miracle has occurred even after hearing the explanation
of how the train came to stop when it did. Interestingly, when the
mother attributes the stopping of the train to God she is not
identifying God as its cause; the cause of the train's stopping is the
engineer's fainting. Nor is she, in any obvious way, offering an
explanation for the event-- at least none that is intended to compete
with the naturalistic explanation made possible by reference to the
engineer's medical condition. What makes this event a miracle, if it
is, is its significance, which is given at least in part by its being
an apparent response to a human need.
Like a violation miracle, such a coincidence
occurs contrary to our expectations, yet it does this without standing
in opposition to our understanding of natural law. To conceive of such
an event as a miracle does seem to satisfy the notion of a miracle as
an event that elicits wonder, though the object of our wonder seems not
so much to be how the train came to stop as the simple fact that
it should stop when it did, when we had every reason to think it would
not.
A similar account of the miraculous comes from
John Hick's conception of religious faith as a form of
"experiencing-as." Inspired by Wittgenstein's discussion of seeing-as
in the Philosophical Investigations (194e), Hick has argued
that while the theist and the atheist live in the same physical
environment, they experience it differently; the theist sees a
significance in the events of her life that prompts her to describe her
experience as a continuing interaction with God (1973:Ch. 2). A theist,
for example, might benefit from an unexpected job opportunity and
experience this as an expression of divine providence; the same event
might not move an atheist in this way. Regarding miracles in
particular, Hick (1973:51) writes:
A miracle, whatever else it may be, is an
event through which we become vividly and immediately conscious of God
as acting towards us. A startling happening, even if it should involve
a suspension of natural law, does not constitute for us a miracle in
the religious sense of the word if it fails to make us intensely aware
of God's presence. In order to be miraculous, an event must be
experienced as religiously significant.
Holland gives no indication that he wants to describe the miracle of
the train in terms of experiencing-as. Nevertheless it seems reasonable to say, with Hick, that in
Holland's example, while the child's mother has seen the same thing
that the skeptic has-- the stopping of the train-- she understands it
differently, experiencing it as a miracle, and as an
expression of divine providence.
But now a new problem emerges: If the question of whether an event is a miracle
lies in its significance, and if its significance is a matter of how we
understand it, then it is hard to see how the determination that some
event is a miracle can avoid being an entirely subjective matter. In
this case, whether or not a miracle has occurred depends on how the
witnesses see it, and so (arguably) is more a fact about the
witnesses, and their response to the event, than it is to the event
itself. (See Smart 1964:35) But we do not typically analyze human
agency in this way; whether or not Caesar crossed the Rubicon is not a
matter of how anyone experiences things. The question of whether Caesar
crossed the Rubicon is an objective one. Surely the theist wishes to
say that the question of whether God has acted in the world, in the
occurrence of a miracle, is objective as well. And surely this fact
accounts for the attractiveness of a causal account of miracles; any
dispute over the cause of a putative miracle is a dispute over the
facts, not a dispute about how people view the facts.
10. Miracle as Basic Action
This is a serious criticism, but it overlooks
something very important about the character of actions generally. To
ask whether a human being has acted is surely to ask an objective
question, but it is not always to ask a question about causes. Arthur
Danto (1965) has argued for a distinction between two types of action:
Those that are mediated, and those that are basic. (See also Davidson
1982, who refers to basic actions as primitive.) I act in a
mediated way when I perform action x by doing y; for example, if I turn on the light in my study by flicking a switch, my turning on the light is a mediated action. My flicking the switch is also a mediated action if I flick the switch by moving my fingers. Notice that, when we say that I turned on the light in a mediated sort of way, this may carry causal implications: In this case, the light's coming on was caused by the
switch's being flicked, and the switch's being flicked was caused by my
fingers' moving. But not all of our actions are
like this. When I move my fingers in order to flip the switch, I do not
bring about their movement by doing anything else; I just move them. Thus to say I have acted in moving my fingers does not imply that I caused anything
to happen. Yet clearly it is, in some sense of "fact," a fact that I moved my fingers.
It is possible, of course, that my fingers' moving has a cause, such as the firing of
various neurons. But my neural firings are not actions of mine; they are not things that I do. It is not as though I set about to fire my neurons as part of a procedure aimed
ultimately at bringing it about that my muscles contract and my fingers
move. And even if I did, there would have to be something that I
did immediately in order to set the chain of causes going, or there
would be an infinite series of actions I would have to perform in order
to turn on the light— I could never so much as start to act . Thus the possibility of being able to describe
my fingers' moving in terms of physical causes, and of thereby
being able to give a natural explanation for this in terms of neural
firings and the like, does not rule out the possibility of saying that in moving my fingers, I have acted.
Some philosophers believe that the truth of a
libertarian account of free will implies that the free actions of human
beings have no natural cause. This parallels the way that the
traditional view of miracles has understood the manner of God's action
in a miracle. (J.P. Moreland has discussed the analogy between free
human actions and miracles in this regard; see Moreland 1997.) Such a
libertarian view of human action may be correct. It is important to
recognize, however, that we do not have to settle the matter; we do not
have to show that someone's moving of their fingers has no natural
cause in order to attribute this movement to their agency. Thus analogously, a
believer in miracles may insist that there is no natural explanation
for various miracles such as the creation of the universe, Moses'
parting of the Red Sea, or Jesus' resurrection. But if miracles are
basic actions on the part of God, then our attribution of divine agency
to such events does not require us to show that these things
cannot be explained by reference to natural causes. Whatever we must do
to identify an event as a miracle, if a miracle is conceived as a basic
action on the part of God, it cannot involve a requirement to show that
it has no natural cause.
To ascribe a basic action to its agent is not to
make any claim about its cause; thus if miracles are properly conceived
as basic actions on the part of God, it is not the case that "any assertion that a miracle
has occurred is implicitly a causal assertion" (Levine 1994:39), though
this view is widely held. On the contrary, the ascription of a miracle
to God will be logically independent of any causal analysis. (For a detailed discussion of this point see Corner 2007, and particularly Ch. 4.)
11. Wittgenstein: Miracle as
Gesture
This leaves open the question of how we are
to identify an event as a miracle, if this does not involve a causal
analysis. One approach is to think of a miracle as a gesture
on the part of God. In Culture and Value (1980:45e), Ludwig
Wittgenstein writes:
A miracle is, as it were, a gesture that
God makes. As a man sits quietly and then makes an impressive gesture,
God lets the world run on smoothly and then accompanies the words of a
saint by a symbolic occurrence, a gesture of nature. It would be an
instance if, when a saint has spoken, the trees around him bowed, as if
in reverence.
It is interesting that Wittgenstein should speak of a gesture as a
symbolic occurrence. A human bodily movement becomes a gesture when it
takes on a particular kind of significance. The significance of a bow,
for example, lies in the fact that it is an expression of reverence or
respect. Being able to identify a bending at the waist as a bow
requires us to be familiar with the culture in which this particular
bodily movement has the significance that it does. Nevertheless, the
question of whether someone has bowed is an objective one-- it is, we
might say, a question about the facts. Thus the analogy of a miracle to
a gesture may give us a way to view miracles at once as signs, allowing
us to say that the character of a miracle lies, at least in part, in
its significance within what Wittgenstein would call a "form of life,"
and at the same time insist that the question of its significance is an
objective matter.
If a miracle is like a gesture in the way
Wittgenstein thinks it is, then supposing that a miraculous event
should occur, part of what makes it possible to identify that event as
a miracle is an appreciation of its significance. But a miracle does
not take on its significance in a vacuum; the significance of a
miracle, like the significance of a gesture, is dependent on a certain
sort of context. This context is established, at least to some degree,
by one's view of the world; whether one is able to identify an event as
a miracle will depend on one's ability to integrate it with a worldview
in which the possibility of God's acting in nature is already
acknowledged. Such a limitation poses no problem for theology
generally, which might legitimately regard such a view of things as its
starting point. It will, however, be fatal to any apologetic appeal
that seeks to establish the credentials of theistic religion by
pointing to the occurrence of a putative miracle and attempting to
establish, on grounds that are consistent with naturalism, that this
event gives compelling evidence for the existence of God.
Peter Winch has recently taken up Wittgenstein's
comparison of a miracle to a gesture:
A certain disposition, or movement, of a
human body can be called a 'gesture' only within a context where it is
possible for it to be recognised and/or reacted to as a gesture... Such
a possibility depends, at least in large part, on the reigning
culture within which the action occurs. (1995:211, emphasis in the
original)
Winch observes that our recognition of a gesture is typically immediate
rather than inferred. Thus for example, if we are introduced to someone
and they bow, we would not normally arrive at the conclusion that they
are bowing by means of an inference, after first eliminating the
possibility that their movement has a natural explanation; on the
contrary, if we are sufficiently familiar with bowing as a cultural
institution we will immediately recognize the character of their act.
Furthermore, our recognition of the fact that they have bowed will
typically be shown in our reaction to their gesture, e.g. in our bowing
in return. Analogously, we express our recognition of a miracle not by
looking to see if it has any natural cause, but by responding in the
manner characteristic of theistic religion; with awe, perhaps, or with
gratitude for God's beneficence. (This is the response of the mother in
Holland's miracle of the train.) But, just as our ability to recognize,
and to react appropriately to, a bow depends on our being immersed in a
particular culture, so might our ability to recognize a miracle and
react to it in the characteristically religious way. If Winch is
correct, then the skeptic, who seeks to show that a putative miracle
has a natural cause, is proceeding in the wrong direction-- but then so
is the theist who tries to show that the event cannot be explained
scientifically. Such a theist commits the same error as one would who
thinks that in order to show that a particular gesture is a bow, we
must show that no physiological explanation can be given for it.
The mainstream theistic approach to miracles is,
at the moment, one that would prefer to employ a method similar to that
used in the natural sciences. Philosophers taking this approach are
unlikely to be satisfied with the conception of a miracle as a gesture.
But if Winch is right, this is an indication of how deeply embedded
science has become in modern western culture, and an indication as well
of a drift away from the kind of religious culture in which the
conception of a miracle originally found its home.
12. References and Further
Reading
Aquinas, Thomas, Summa Contra Gentiles, III:100-103
Augustine, The City of God, XXI:8
Beardsmore, R.W, "Hume and the Miraculous," Religions
and Hume's Legacy, ed. Phillips, D.Z. and Tessin, Timothy,
Claremont Studies in the Philosophy of Religion, New York: St. Martin's
Press
Corner, David (2007), The Philosophy of
Miracles, London: Continuum
Danto, Arthur C. (1965), "Basic Actions," American
Philosophical Quarterly, 2:141-8
Davidson, Donald (1982), Essays on Action and
Events, New York: Oxford University Press
Davis, Stephen T (1999), "Beardsmore on Hume on
Miracles," Religions and Hume's Legacy, ed. Phillips, D.Z. and
Tessin, Timothy, Claremont Studies in the Philosophy of Religion, New
York: St. Martin's Press
Earman, John (2000), Hume's Abject Failure:
The Argument Against Miracles, New York: Oxford University Press
Hume, David (1975), Enquiries Concerning Human
Understanding, Ed. L.A. Selby-Bigge 3rd ed. Oxford: Oxford
University Press
Flew, Anthony (1966), God and Philosophy,
New York: Harcourt, Brace and World
Flew, Anthony (1967), "Miracles," Encyclopedia of
Philosophy. New York: Macmillan and Free Press, 1967, vol. 5, pp.
346-353
Flew, Anthony (1997), Hume's Philosophy of Belief,
Bristol: Thoemmes Press
Fogelin, Robert J. (2003), A Defense of Hume on
Miracles, Princeton: Princeton University Press
Geivett, R. Douglas (1997), "The Evidential Value
of Miracles," in Geivett, R. Douglas and Habermas, Gary R. eds (1997), In
Defense of Miracles: A Comprehensive Case for God's Action in History,
Downers Grove: Intervarsity Press
Hick, John (1973), God and the Universe of
Faiths, Oxford: Oneworld Publications Ltd.
Holland, R.F. (1965), "The Miraculous," American
Philosophical Quarterly 2:43-51
Houston, J. (1994), Reported Miracles,
Cambridge: Cambridge University Press
Huxley, T.H., (1894) Collected Essays, Vol.
VI, Hume:, With Helps to the Study of Berkeley, New York: D.
Appleton and Company
Lewis, C.S. (1947), Miracles, New York:
Macmillan
Levine, Michael, P. (1989), Hume and the
Problem of Miracles: A Solution, Dordrecht: Kluwer Publishers
Locke, John (2000), A Discourse of Miracles,
in Earman, John, Hume's Abject Failure: The Argument Against
Miracles, New York: Oxford University Press
Mackie. J.L. (1982), The Miracle of Theism:
Arguments for and against the Existence of God New York: Oxford
University Press
Martin, Michael (1992), Atheism: A
Philosophical Justification, Philadelphia: Temple University Press
Mavrodes, George I. (1985), "Miracles and the Laws
of Nature," Faith and Philosophy, Vol. 2 No. 4, October 1985
McKinnon, Alastair (1967), " 'Miracle' and
'Paradox,' " American Philosophical Quarterly, 4:308-314
Moore, Gareth (1996), Believing in God,
Edinburgh: T & T Clark
Nowell-Smith, Patrick (1955), "Miracles," in New
Essays in Philosophical Theology, ed. Antony Flew and Alastair
MacIntyre, New York: Macmillan
Melden, A.I. (1961), Free Action, London:
Routledge & Kegan Paul
Moreland, J.P (1997), "Science, Miracles, Agency
Theory & the God-of-the-Gaps," in Geivett, R. Douglas and Habermas,
Gary R. eds (1997), In Defense of Miracles: A Comprehensive case
for God's Action in History, Downers Grove: Intervarsity Press
Purtill, Richard (1978), "Thinking about
Religion: A Philosophical Introduction to Religion," Prentice-Hall
Smart, Ninian (1964), Philosophers and
Religious Truth, New York: Macmillan
Swinburne, Richard (1970), The Concept of
Miracle, London: Macmillan
Swinburne, Richard (1979), The Existence of
God, Oxford: Clarendon Press
Swinburne, Richard ed. (1989), Miracles,
from the series Philosophical Topics ed. Paul Edwards, New
York: Macmillan
Winch, Peter (1995), "Asking Too Many Questions,"
in Tessin, Timothy and von der Ruhr, Mario eds, Philosophy and the
Grammar of Religious Belief, Claremont Studies in the Philosophy of
Religion, New York: St. Martin's Press
Wittgenstein, Ludwig (1958), Philosophical
Investigations, 3rd edition, tr. G.E.M. Anscombe, Basil Blackwell
& Mott, Ltd.
Wittgenstein, Ludwig (1980), Culture and Value,
tr. Peter Winch, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
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