Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Introduction
The philosophical treatment of
love transcends a variety of sub-disciplines including epistemology,
metaphysics, religion, human nature, politics and ethics. Often
statements or arguments concerning love, its nature and role in human
life for example, connect to one or all the central theories of
philosophy, and is often compared with, or examined in the context of,
the philosophies of sex and gender. The task of a philosophy of love
is to present the appropriate issues in a cogent manner, drawing on
relevant theories of human nature, desire, ethics, and so on. This
brief introduction examines the nature of love and some of the ethical
and political ramifications.
2. The Nature of Love: Eros, Philia, and Agape
The philosophical discussion
regarding love logically begins with questions concerning its nature.
This implies that love has a 'nature', a proposition that some may
oppose arguing that love is conceptually irrational, in the sense that
it cannot be described in rational or meaningful propositions. For
such critics, who are presenting a metaphysical and epistemological
argument, love may be an ejection of emotions that defy rational
examination; on the other hand, some languages, such as Papuan do not
even admit the concept, which negates the possibility of a
philosophical examination. In English, the word 'love', which is
derived from Germanic forms of the Sanskrit lubh (desire), is
broadly defined and hence imprecise, which generates first order
problems of definition and meaning, which are resolved to some extent
by the reference to the Greek terms, eros, philia, and
agape.
a. Eros
The term eros (Greek
erasthai) is used to refer to that part of love constituting a
passionate, intense desire for something, it is often referred to as a
sexual desire, hence the modern notion of 'erotic' (Greek
erotikos). In Plato's writings however, eros is held to
be a common desire that seeks transcendental beauty-the particular
beauty of an individual reminds us of true beauty that exists in the
world of Forms or Ideas (Phaedrus 249E: "he who loves the
beautiful is called a lover because he partakes of it." Trans.
Jowett). The Platonic-Socratic position maintains that the love we
generate for beauty on this earth can never be truly satisfied until
we die; but in the meantime we should aspire beyond the particular
stimulating image in front of us to the contemplation of beauty in
itself. The implication of the Platonic theory of eros
is that ideal beauty, which is reflected in the particular images of
beauty we find, becomes interchangeable across people and things,
ideas, and art: to love is to love the Platonic form of beauty-not a
particular individual, but the element they posses of true (Ideal)
beauty. Reciprocity is not necessary to Plato's view of love, for the
desire is for the object (of Beauty), than for, say, the company of
another and shared values and pursuits. Many in the Platonic
vein of philosophy hold that love is an intrinsically higher value
than appetitive or physical desire. Physical desire, they note, is
held in common with the animal kingdom and hence of a lower order of
reaction and stimulus than a rationally induced love, i.e., a love
produced by rational discourse and exploration of ideas, which in turn
defines the pursuit of Ideal beauty. Accordingly, the physical love of
an object, an idea, or a person in itself is not be a proper form of
love, love being a reflection of that part of the object, idea, or
person, that partakes in Ideal beauty.
b. Philia
In
contrast to the desiring and passionate yearning of eros,
philia entails a fondness and appreciation of the other. For
the Greeks, the term philia incorporated not just friendship,
but also loyalties to family and polis-one's political
community, job, or discipline. Philia for another may be
motivated, as Aristotle explains in the Nicomachean Ethics,
Book VIII, for the agent's sake or for the other's own sake. The
motivational distinctions are derived from love for another because
the friendship is wholly useful as in the case of business contacts,
or because their character and values are pleasing (with the
implication that if those attractive habits change, so too does the
friendship), or for the other in who they are in themselves,
regardless of one's interests in the matter. The English concept of
friendship roughly captures Aristotle's notion of philia, as he
writes: "things that cause friendship are: doing kindnesses; doing
them unasked; and not proclaiming the fact when they are doneÖ"
(Rhetoric, II. 4, trans. Rhys Roberts). Aristotle
elaborates on the kinds of things we seek in proper friendship,
suggesting that the proper basis for philia is objective: those
who share our dispositions, who bear no grudges, who seek what we do,
who are temperate, and just, who admire us appropriately as we admire
them, and so on. Philia could not emanate from those who are
quarrelsome, gossips, aggressive in manner and personality, who are
unjust, and so on. The best characters, it follows, may produce the
best kind of friendship and hence love: indeed, how to be a good
character worthy of philia is the theme of the Nicomachaen
Ethics. The most rational man is he who would be the happiest, and
he, therefore, who is capable of the best form of friendship, which
between two "who are good, and alike in virtue" is rare (NE,
VIII.4 trans. Ross). We can surmise that love between such
equals-Aristotle's rational and happy men-would be perfect, with
circles of diminishing quality for those who are morally removed from
the best. He characterizes such love as "a sort of excess of feeling".
(NE, VIII.6) Friendships of a lesser quality may also be
based on the pleasure or utility that is derived from another's
company. A business friendship is based on utility--on mutual
reciprocity of similar business interests; once the business is at an
end, then the friendship dissolves. Similarly with those friendships
based on the pleasure that is derived from the other's company, which
is not a pleasure enjoyed for who the other person is in himself, but
in the flow of pleasure from his actions or humour. The first
condition for the highest form Aristotelian love is that a man loves
himself. Without an egoistic basis, he cannot extend sympathy and
affection to others (NE, IX.8). Such self-love is not
hedonistic, or glorified, depending on the pursuit of immediate
pleasures or the adulation of the crowd, it is instead a reflection of
his pursuit of the noble and virtuous, which culminate in the pursuit
of the reflective life. Friendship with others is required "since his
purpose is to contemplate worthy actionsÖto live pleasantlyÖsharing in
discussion and thought" as is appropriate for the virtuous man and his
friend (NE, IX.9). The morally virtuous man deserves in turn
the love of those below him; he is not obliged to give an equal love
in return, which implies that the Aristotelian concept of love is
elitist or perfectionist: "In all friendships implying inequality the
love also should be proportional, i.e. the better should be more loved
than he loves." (NE, VIII, 7,). Reciprocity, although not
necessarily equal, is a condition of Aristotelian love and friendship,
although parental love can involve a one-sided fondness.
c. Agape
Agape refers to the paternal love of God for
man and for man for God but is extended to include a brotherly love
for all humanity. (The Hebrew ahev has a slightly wider
semantic range than agape). Agape arguably draws on
elements from both eros and philia in that it seeks a
perfect kind of love that is at once a fondness, a transcending of the
particular, and a passion without the necessity of reciprocity. The
concept is expanded on in the Judaic-Christian tradition of loving
God: "You shall love the Lord your God with all your heart, and with
all your soul, and with all your might" (Deuteronomy 6:5) and loving
"thy neighbour as thyself" (Leviticus 19:18). The love of God requires
absolute devotion that is reminiscent of Plato's love of Beauty (and
Christian translators of Plato such as St Augustine employed the
connections), which involves an erotic passion, awe, and desire
that transcends earthly cares and obstacles. Aquinas, on the other
hand, picked up on the Aristotelian theories of friendship and love to
proclaim God as the most rational being and hence the most deserving
of one's love, respect, and considerations. The universalist
command to "love thy neighbor as thyself" refers the subject to those
surrounding him, whom he should love unilaterally if necessary. The
command employs the logic of mutual reciprocity, and hints at an
Aristotelian basis that the subject should love himself in some
appropriate manner: for awkward results would ensue if he loved
himself in a particularly inappropriate, perverted manner!
(Philosophers can debate the nature of 'self-love' implied in
this-from the Aristotelian notion that self-love is necessary for any
kind of inter-personal love, to the condemnation of egoism and the
impoverished examples that pride and self-glorification from which to
base one's love of another. St Augustine relinquishes the debate--he
claims that no command is needed for a man to love himself (De bono
viduitatis, xxi.) Analogous to the logic of "it is better to give
than to receive", the universalism of agape requires an initial
invocation from someone: in a reversal of the Aristotelian position,
the onus for the Christian is on the morally superior to extend love
to others. Nonetheless, the command also entails an egalitarian
love-hence the Christian code to "love thy enemies" (Matthew 5:44-45).
Such love transcends any perfectionist or aristocratic notions that
some are (or should be) more loveable than others. Agape finds
echoes in the ethics of Kant and Kierkegaard, who assert the moral
importance of giving impartial respect or love to another person
qua human being in the abstract. However, loving one's
neighbor impartially (James 2:9) invokes serious ethical concerns,
especially if the neighbor ostensibly does not warrant love. Debate
thus begins on what elements of a neighbor's conduct should be
included in agape, and which should be excluded. Early
Christians asked whether the principle applied only to disciples of
Christ or to all. The impartialists won the debate asserting that the
neighbor's humanity provides the primary condition of being loved;
nonetheless his actions may require a second order of criticisms, for
the logic of brotherly love implies that it is a moral improvement on
brotherly hate. For metaphysical dualists, loving the soul rather than
the neighbor's body or deeds provides a useful escape clause-or in
turn the justification for penalizing the other's body for sin and
moral transgressions, while releasing the proper object of love-the
soul-from its secular torments. For Christian pacifists, "turning the
other cheek" to aggression and violence implies a hope that the
aggressor will eventually learn to comprehend the higher values of
peace, forgiveness, and a love for humanity. The universalism
of agape runs counter to the partialism of Aristotle and poses
a variety of ethical implications. Aquinas admits a partialism in love
towards those we are related while maintaining that we should be
charitable to all, whereas others such as Kierkegaard insist on
impartiality. Recently, LaFallotte has noted that to love those one is
partial towards is not necessarily a negation of the impartiality
principle, for impartialism could admit loving those closer to one as
an impartial principle, and, employing Aristotle's conception of
self-love, iterates that loving others requires an intimacy that can
only be gained from being partially intimate ("Personal Relations",
Blackwell Companion to Ethics). Others would claim that the
concept of universal love, of loving all equally, is not only
impracticable, but logically empty-Aristotle, for example, argues:
"One cannot be a friend to many people in the sense of having
friendship of the perfect type with them, just as one cannot be in
love with many people at once (for love is a sort of excess of
feeling, and it is the nature of such only to be felt towards one
person)" (NE, VIII.6).
3. The Nature of Love: further conceptual considerations
Presuming love
has a nature, it should be, to some extent at least, describable
within the concepts of language. But what is meant by an appropriate
language of description may be as philosophically beguiling as love
itself. Such considerations invoke the philosophy of language, of the
relevance and appropriateness of meanings, but they also provide the
analysis of 'love' with its first principles. Does it exist and if so,
is it knowable, comprehensible, and describable? Love may be knowable
and comprehensible to others, as understood in the phrases, "I am in
love", "I love you", but what 'love' means in these sentences may not
be analyzed further: that is, the concept 'love' is irreducible-an
axiomatic, or self-evident, state of affairs that warrants no further
intellectual intrusion, an apodictic category perhaps, that a Kantian
may recognize. The epistemology of love asks how we may know
love, how we may understand it, whether it is possible or plausible to
make statements about others or ourselves being in love (which touches
on the philosophical issue of private knowledge versus public
behavior). Again, the epistemology of love is intimately connected to
the philosophy of language and theories of the emotions. If love is
purely an emotional condition, it is plausible to argue that it
remains a private phenomenon incapable of being accessed by others,
except through an expression of language, and language may be a poor
indicator of an emotional state both for the listener and the subject.
Emotivists would hold that a statement such as "I am in love" is
irreducible to other statements because it is a nonpropositional
utterance, hence its veracity is beyond examination. Phenomenologists
may similarly present love as a non-cognitive phenomenon. Scheler, for
example, toys with Plato's Ideal love, which is cognitive, claiming:
"love itselfÖbringing about the continuous emergence of ever-higher
value in the object--just as if it were streaming out from the object
of its own accord, without any exertion (even of wishing) on the part
of the lover. (The Nature of Sympathy, trans. Heath). The lover
is passive before the beloved. The claim that 'love' cannot be
examined is different from that claiming 'love' should not be
subject to examination-that it should be put or left beyond the mind's
reach, out of a dutiful respect for its mysteriousness, its awesome,
divine, or romantic nature. But if it is agreed that there is such a
thing as 'love' conceptually speaking, when people present statements
concerning love, or admonitions such as "she should show more love",
then a philosophical examination seems appropriate: is it synonymous
with certain patterns of behavior, of inflections in the voice or
manner, or by the apparent pursuit and protection of a particular
value ("Look at how he dotes upon his flowers-he must love them")?
If love does possesses 'a nature' which is identifiable by
some means-a personal expression, a discernible pattern of behavior,
or other activity, it can still be asked whether that nature can be
properly understood by humanity. Love may have a nature, yet we
may not possess the proper intellectual capacity to understand
it-accordingly, we may gain glimpses perhaps of its essence-as
Socrates argues in The Symposium, but its true nature being
forever beyond humanity's intellectual grasp. Accordingly, love may be
partially described, or hinted at, in a dialectic or analytical
exposition of the concept but never understood in itself. Love may
therefore become an epiphenomenal entity, generated by human action in
loving, but never grasped by the mind or language. Love may be so
described as a Platonic Form, belonging to the higher realm of
transcendental concepts that mortals can barely conceive of in their
purity, catching only glimpses of the Forms' conceptual shadows that
logic and reason unveil or disclose. Another view, again
derived from Platonic philosophy, may permit love to be understood by
certain people and not others. This invokes a hierarchical
epistemology, that only the initiated, the experienced, the
philosophical, or the poetical or musical, may gain insights into its
nature. On one level this admits that only the experienced can know
its nature, which is putatively true of any experience, but it also
may imply a social division of understanding-that only philosopher
kings may know true love. On the first implication, those who do not
feel or experience love are incapable (unless initiated through rite,
dialectical philosophy, artistic processes, and so on) of
comprehending its nature, whereas the second implication suggests
(though this is not a logically necessary inference) that the
non-initiated, or those incapable of understanding, feel only physical
desire and not 'love'. Accordingly, 'love' belongs either to the
higher faculties of all, understanding of which requires being
educated in some manner or form, or it belongs to the higher echelons
of society-to a priestly, philosophical, or artistic, poetic class.
The uninitiated, the incapable, or the young and inexperienced-those
who are not romantic troubadours-are doomed only to feel physical
desire. This separating of love from physical desire has further
implications concerning the nature of romantic love.
4. The Nature of Love: Romantic Love
Romantic love is deemed to be of a higher metaphysical and
ethical status than sexual or physical attractiveness alone. The idea
of romantic love initially stems from the Platonic tradition that love
is a desire for beauty-a value that transcends the particularities of
the physical body. For Plato, the love of beauty culminates in the
love of philosophy, the subject that pursues the highest capacity of
men's thinking. The romantic love of knights and damsels emerged in
the early medieval ages (11th Century France, fine
amour) a philosophical echo of both Platonic and Aristotelian love
and literally a derivative of the Roman poet, Ovid and his Ars
Amatoria. Romantic love theoretically was not to be consummated,
for such love was transcendental motivated by a deep respect for the
lady; however, it was to be actively pursued in chivalric deeds rather
than contemplated-which is in contrast to Ovid's persistent sensual
pursuit of conquests! Modern romantic love returns to
Aristotle's version of the special love two people find in each
other's virtues-one soul and two bodies, as he poetically puts it. It
is deemed to be of a higher status, ethically, aesthetically, and even
metaphysically than the love that behaviourists or physicalists
describe.
5. The Nature of Love: Physical, emotional, spiritual
Some may hold that love is physical, i.e.,
that love is nothing but a physical response to another whom the agent
feels physically attracted to. Accordingly, the action of loving
encompasses a broad range of behaviour including caring, listening,
attending to, preferring to others, and so on. (This would be proposed
by behaviourists). Others (physicalists, geneticists) reduce all
examinations of love to the physical motivation of the sexual
impulse-the simple sexual instinct that is shared with all complex
living entities, which may, in humans, be directed consciously,
sub-consciously or pre-rationally toward a potential mate or object of
sexual gratification. Physical determinists, those who believe
the world to entirely physical and that every event has a prior
(physical cause), consider love to be an extension of the
chemical-biological constituents of the human creature and be
explicable according to such processes. In this vein, geneticists may
invoke the theory that the genes (an individual's DNA) form the
determining criteria in any sexual or putative romantic choice,
especially in choosing a mate. However, a problem for those who claim
that love is reducible to the physical attractiveness of a potential
mate, or to the blood ties of family and kin which forge bonds of
filial love, is that it does not capture the affections between those
who cannot or wish not to reproduce-that is, physicalism or
determinism ignores the possibility of romantic, ideational love-it
may explain eros, but not philia or agape.
Behaviourism, which stems from the theory of the mind and asserts a
rejection of Cartesian dualism between mind and body, entails that
love is a series of actions and preferences which is thereby
observable to oneself and others. The behaviourist theory that love is
observable (according to the recognisable behavioural constraints
corresponding to acts of love) suggests also that it is theoretically
quantifiable: that A acts in a certain way (actions X,Y,Z) around B,
more so than he does around C, suggests that he 'loves' B more than C.
The problem with the behaviourist vision of love is that it is
susceptible to the poignant criticism that a person's actions need not
express their inner state or emotions-A may be a very good actor.
Radical behaviourists, such as B F Skinner, claim that observable and
unobservable behaviour such as mental states can be examined from the
behaviourist framework, in terms of the laws of conditioning. On this
view, that one falls in love may go unrecognised by the casual
observer, but the act of being in love can be examined by what events
or conditions led to the agent's believing she was in love: this may
include the theory that being in love is an overtly strong reaction to
a set of highly positive conditions in the behaviour or presence of
another. Expressionist love is similar to behaviourism in that
love is considered an expression of a state of affairs towards a
beloved, which may be communicated through language (words, poetry,
music) or behaviour (bringing flowers, giving up a kidney, diving into
the proverbial burning building), but which is a reflection of an
internal, emotional state, rather than an exhibition of physical
responses to stimuli. Others in this vein may claim love to be a
spiritual response, the recognition of a soul that completes one's own
soul, or complements or augments it. The spiritualist vision of love
incorporates mystical as well as traditional romantic notions of love,
but rejects the behaviorist or physicalist explanations. Those
who consider love to be an aesthetic response would hold that love is
knowable through the emotional and conscious feeling it provokes yet
which cannot perhaps be captured in rational or descriptive language:
it is instead to be captured, as far as that is possible, by metaphor
or by music.
6. Love: Ethics and Politics
The ethical aspects in love involve the moral appropriateness
of loving, and the forms it should or should not take. The subject
area raises such questions as: is it ethically acceptable to love an
object, or to love oneself? Is love to oneself or to another a duty?
Should the ethically minded person aim to love all people equally? Is
partial love morally acceptable or permissible (i.e., not right, but
excusable)? Should love only involve those with whom the agent can
have a meaningful relationship? Should love aim to transcend sexual
desire or physical appearances? May notions of romantic, sexual love
apply to same sex couples? Some of the subject area naturally spills
into the ethics of sex, which deals with the appropriateness of sexual
activity, reproduction, hetero and homosexual activity, and so on.
In the area of political philosophy, love can be studied from a
variety of perspectives. For example, some may see love as an
instantiation of social dominance by one group (males) over another
(females), in which the socially constructed language and etiquette of
love is designed to empower men and disempower women. On this theory,
love is a product of patriarchy, and acts analogously to Marx's view
of religion (the opiate of the people) that love is the opiate of
women. The implication is that were they to shrug off the language and
notions of 'love', 'being in love', 'loving someone', and so on, they
would be empowered. The theory is often attractive to feminists and
marxists, who view social relations (and the entire panoply of
culture, language, politics, institutions) as reflecting deeper social
structures that divide people into classes, sexes, and races.
This article has touched on some of the main elements of the
philosophy of love. It reaches into many philosophical fields, notably
theories of human nature, the self, and of the mind. The language of
love, as it is found in other languages as well as in English, is
similarly broad and deserves more attention.
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