Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. General Description
The term "Stoicism" derives from the Greek word "stoa," referring
to a colonnade,
such as those built outside or inside
temples, around dwelling-houses, gymnasia, and market-places. They were
also set up separately as ornaments of the streets and open places. The
simplest form is that of a roofed colonnade, with a wall on one side,
which was often decorated with paintings. Thus in the market-place at
Athens the stoa
poikile (Painted Colonnade) was decorated with
Polygnotus's representations of the destruction of Troy, the fight of the
Athenians with the Amazons, and the battles of Marathon and Oenoe.
Zeno of Citium taught in
the stoa
poikile in Athens, and his adherents accordingly obtained the
name of
Stoics. Zeno was followed by Cleanthes, and then by Chrysippus, as
leaders of the school.
The school attracted many adherents, and flourished for centuries,
not only in Greece, but later in
Rome, where the most thoughtful writers, such as Marcus Aurelius,
Seneca, and Epictetus,
counted themselves among its followers.
We know little for certain as to what share particular Stoics, Zeno,
Cleanthes, or Chrysippus, had
in the formation of the doctrines of the school, But after Chryssipus
the main lines of the doctrine
were complete. The stoic doctrine is divided into three parts: logic,
physics, and ethics. Stoicism
is essentially a system of ethics which, however, is guided by a
logic as theory of method, and
rests upon physics as foundation. Briefly, their notion of morality
is stern, involving a life in
accordance with nature and controlled by virtue. It is an ascetic
system, teaching perfect indifference (apathea) to everything
external, for nothing external could be either good or evil. Hence to
the Stoics both pain and pleasure, poverty and riches, sickness and
health, were supposed to be equally unimportant.
2. Stoic Logic
Stoic logic is, in all essentials, the logic of Aristotle. To this,
however, they added a theory,
peculiar to themselves, of the origin of knowledge and the criterion
of truth. All knowledge, they
said, enters the mind through the senses. The mind is a blank slate,
upon which sense-
impressions are inscribed. It may have a certain activity of its own,
but this activity is confined
exclusively to materials supplied by the physical organs of sense.
This theory stands, of course,
in sheer opposition to the idealism of Plato, for whom the mind alone
was the source of
knowledge, the senses being
the sources of all illusion
and error. The Stoics denied the metaphysical reality of concepts.
Concepts are merely ideas in
the mind, abstracted from particulars, and have no reality outside
consciousness.
Since all knowledge is a knowledge of sense-objects, truth is simply
the correspondence of our
impressions to things. How are we to know whether our ideas are
correct copies of things? How
do we distinguish between reality and imagination, dreams, or
illusions? What is the criterion of
truth? It cannot lie in concepts, since they are of our own making.
Nothing is true save sense
impressions, and therefore the criterion of truth must lie in
sensation itself. It cannot be in
thought, but must be in feeling. Real objects, said the Stoics,
produce in us an intense feeling, or
conviction, of their reality. The strength and vividness of the image
distinguish these real
perceptions from a dream or fancy. Hence the sole criterion of truth
is this striking conviction,
whereby the real forces itself upon our consciousness, and will not
be denied. There is, thus, no
universally grounded criterion of truth. It is based, not on reason,
but on feeling.
3. Stoic Physics
The fundamental proposition of the Stoic physics is that "nothing
incorporeal exists." This
materialism coheres with the sense-impression orientation of their
doctrine of knowledge. Plato
placed knowledge in thought, and reality, therefore, in the ideal
form. The Stoics, however, place
knowledge in physical sensation, and reality -- what is known by the
senses -- is matter. All
things, they said, even the soul, even God himself, are material and
nothing more than material.
This belief they based upon two main considerations. Firstly, the
unity of the world demands it.
The world is one, and must issue from one principle. We must have a
monism. The idealism of
Plato resolved itself into a futile struggle involving a dualism
between matter and thought. Since
the gulf cannot be bridged from the side of ideal realm of the forms,
we must take our stand on
matter, and reduce mind to it. Secondly, body and soul, God and the
world, are pairs which act
and react upon one another. The body, for example, produces thoughts
(sense impressions) in the
soul, the soul produces movements in the body. This would be
impossible if both were not of the
same substance. The corporeal cannot act on the incorporeal, nor the
incorporeal on the
corporeal. There is no point of contact. Hence all must be equally corporeal.
All things being material, what is the original kind of matter, or
stuff, out of which the world is
made? The Stoics turned to Heraclitus for an answer. Fire
logos) is the primordial kind of
being, and all things are composed of fire. With this materialism the
Stoics combined pantheism.
The primal fire is God. God is related to the world exactly as the
soul to the body. The human
soul is likewise fire, and comes from the divine fire. It permeates
and penetrates the entire body,
and, in order that its interpenetration might be regarded as
complete, the Stoics denied the
impenetrability of matter. Just as the soul-fire permeates the whole
body, so God, the primal fire,
pervades the entire world.
But in spite of this materialism, the Stoics declared that God is
absolute reason. This is not a
return to idealism, and does not imply the incorporeality of God. For
reason, like all else, is
material. It means simply that the divine fire is a rational element.
Since God is reason, it follows
that the world is governed by reason, and this means two things. It
means, firstly, that there is
purpose in the world, and therefore, order, harmony, beauty, and
design. Secondly, since reason
is law as opposed to the lawless, it means that universe is subject
to the absolute sway of law, is
governed by the rigorous necessity of cause and effect. Hence the
individual is not free. There
can be no true freedom of the will in a world governed by necessity.
We may, without harm, say
that we choose to do this or that, and that our acts are voluntary.
But such phrases merely mean
that we assent to what we do. What we do is none the less governed by
causes, and therefore by
necessity.
The world-process is circular. God changes the fiery substance of
himself first into air, then
water, then earth. So the world arises. But it will be ended by a
conflagration in which all things
will return into the primal fire. Thereafter, at a pre-ordained time,
God will again transmute
himself into a world. It follows from the law of necessity that the
course taken by this second,
and every subsequent, world, will be identical in every way with the
course taken by the first
world. The process goes on for ever, and nothing new ever happens.
The history of each
successive world is the same as that of all the others down to the
minutest details.
The human soul is part of the divine fire, and proceeds into humans
from God. Hence it is a
rational soul, and this is a point of cardinal importance in
connection with the Stoic ethics. But
the soul of each individual does not come direct from God. The divine
fire was breathed into the
first man, and thereafter passed from parent to child in the act of
procreation. After death, all
souls, according to some, but only the souls of the good, according
to others, continue in
individual existence until the general conflagration in which they,
and all else, return to God.
4. Stoic Ethics
The Stoic ethical teaching is based upon two principles already
developed in their physics;
first, that the universe is governed by absolute law, which admits of
no exceptions; and second,
that the essential nature of humans is reason. Both are summed up in
the famous Stoic maxim,
"Live according to nature." For this maxim has two aspects. It means,
in the first place, that men
should conform themselves to nature in the wider sense, that is, to
the laws of the universe, and
secondly, that they should conform their actions to nature in the
narrower sense, to their own
essential nature, reason. These two expressions mean, for the Stoics,
the same thing. For the
universe is governed not only by law, but by the law of reason, and
we, in following our own
rational nature, are ipso facto conforming ourselves to the
laws of the larger world. In a
sense, of course, there is no possibility of our disobeying the laws
of nature, for we, like all else
in the world, act of necessity. And it might be asked, what is the
use of exhorting a person to
obey the laws of the universe, when, as part of the great mechanism
of the world, we cannot by
any possibility do anything else? It is not to be supposed that a
genuine solution of this difficulty
is to be found in Stoic philosophy. They urged, however, that, though
we will in any case do as
the necessity of the world compels us, it is given to us alone, not
merely to obey the law, but to
assent to our own obedience, to follow the law consciously and
deliberately, as only a rational
being can.
Virtue, then, is the life according to reason. Morality is simply
rational action. It is the universal
reason which is to govern our lives, not the caprice and self-will of
the individual. The wise man
consciously subordinates his life to the life of the whole universe,
and recognizes himself as a
cog in the great machine. Now the definition of morality as the life
according to reason is not a
principle peculiar to the Stoics. Both Plato and Aristotle taught the
same. In fact, it is the basis of
every ethic to found morality upon reason, and not upon the
particular foibles, feelings, or
intuitions, of the individual self. But what was peculiar to the
Stoics was the narrow and one-
sided interpretation which they gave to this principle. Aristotle had
taught that the essential
nature of humans is reason, and that morality consists in following
this, his essential nature. But
he recognized that the passions and appetites have their place in the
human organism. He did not
demand their suppression, but merely their control by reason. But the
Stoics looked upon the
passions as essentially irrational, and demanded their complete
extirpation. They envisaged life
as a battle against the passions, in which the latter had to be
completely annihilated. Hence their
ethical views end in a rigorous and unbalanced asceticism.
Aristotle, in his broad and moderate way, though he believed virtue
alone to possess intrinsic
value, yet allowed to external goods and circumstances a place in the
scheme of life. The Stoics
asserted that virtue alone is good, vice alone evil, and that all
else is absolutely indifferent.
Poverty, sickness, pain, and death, are not evils. Riches, health,
pleasure, and life, are not goods.
A person may commit suicide, for in destroying his life he destroys
nothing of value. Above all,
pleasure is not a good. One ought not to seek pleasure. Virtue is the
only happiness. And people
must be virtuous, not for the sake of pleasure, but for the sake of
duty. And since virtue alone is
good, vice alone evil, there followed the further paradox that all
virtues are equally good, and all
vices equally evil. There are no degrees.
Virtue is founded upon reason, and so upon knowledge. Hence the
importance of science,
physics, logic, which are valued not for themselves, but because they
are the foundations of
morality. The prime virtues, and the root of all other virtues, is
therefore wisdom. The wise man
is synonymous with the good man. From the root-virtue, wisdom, spring
the four cardinal
virtues: insight, bravery, self-control, and justice. But since all
virtues have one root, those who
possess wisdom possess all virtue, and those who lack it lack all. A
person is either wholly
virtuous, or wholly vicious. The world is divided into wise and
foolish people, the former
perfectly good, the latter absolutely evil. There is nothing between
the two. There is no such
thing as a gradual transition from one to the other. Conversion must
be instantaneous. the wise
person is perfect, has all happiness, freedom, riches, beauty. They
alone are the perfect kings,
politicians, poets, prophets, orators, critics, and physicians. The
fool has all vice, all misery, all
ugliness, all poverty. And every person is one or the other. Asked
where such a wise person was
to be found, the Stoics pointed doubtfully at Socrates and Diogenes
the Cynic. The number of the
wise, they thought, is small, and is continually growing smaller. The
world, which they painted
in the blackest colors as a sea of vice and misery, grows steadily worse.
The similarities between Cynicism and Stoic ethics are apparent.
However, the Stoics modified
and softened the harsh outlines of Cynicism. To do this meant
inconsistency, though. It meant
that they first laid down harsh principles, and then proceeded to
tone them down, to explain them
away, to admit exceptions. Such inconsistency the stoics accepted
with their habitual
cheerfulness. This process of toning down their first harsh
utterances took place mainly in three
ways. First, the modified their principle of the complete suppression
of the passions. Since this is
impossible, and, if possible, could only lead to immovable
inactivity, they admitted that the wise
person might exhibit certain mild and rational emotions. Thus, the
roots of the passions might be
found in the wise person, though they would never be allowed to grow.
In the second place, they
modified their principle that all else, save virtue and vice, is
indifferent. Such a view is unreal,
and out of accord with life. Hence the stoics, with a masterly
disregard of consistency, stuck to
the principle, and yet declared that among things indifferent some
are preferable to others. If the
wise person has the choice between health and sickness, health is
preferable. Indifferent things
were thus divided into three classes: those to be preferred, those to
be avoided, and those which
are absolutely indifferent.
In the third place, the stoics toned down the principle that people
are either wholly good, or
wholly evil. The famous heroes and politicians of history, though
fools, are yet polluted with the
common vices of humankind less than others. Moreover, what were the
Stoics to say about
themselves? Were they wise men or fools? They hesitated to claim
perfection, to put themselves
on a level with Socrates and Diogenes. Yet they could not bring
themselves to admit that there
was no difference between themselves and the common herd. They were
"proficients," and, if not
absolutely wise, approximated to wisdom.
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