| Panpsychism is the view that all
things have a mind or a mind-like quality. The word itself was
coined by the Italian philosopher Francesco Patrizi in the
sixteenth century, and derives from the two Greek words
pan (all) and psyche (soul or mind). This
definition is quite general, and raises two immediate questions:
(1) What does one mean by “all things”? (2) What does one mean
by “mind”? On the first question, some philosophers have argued
that literally every object in the universe, every part of every
object, and every system of objects possesses some mind-like
quality. Other philosophers have been more restrictive, arguing
that only certain broad classes of things possess mind (in which
case one is perhaps not a true panpsychist), or that, at least,
the smallest parts of things—such as atoms—possess mind. The
second question—what is mind?—is more difficult and contentious.
Here panpsychism is on neither better nor worse footing than any
other approach to mind; it argues only that one's notion of
mind, however conceived, must apply in some degree to all
things.
The panpsychist conception of mind must be sufficiently
broad to plausibly encompass humans and non-human objects as
well. Panpsychists typically see the human mind as a unique,
highly-refined instance of some more universal concept. They
argue that mind in, say, lower animals, plants, or rocks is
neither as sophisticated nor as complex as that of human
beings. But this in turn raises new questions: What common
mental quality or qualities are shared by these things? And
why should we even call such qualities "mental” in the first
place?
Panpsychism, then, is not a formal theory of mind. Rather, it
is a conjecture about how widespread the phenomenon of mind is
in the universe. Panpsychism does not necessarily attempt to
define “mind” (although many panpsychists do this), nor does it
necessarily explain how mind relates to the objects that possess
it. As a result, panpsychism is more of an overarching concept,
a kind of meta-theory of mind. More details are required to
incorporate it into a fully-developed theory of mind.
A view such as panpsychism seems perhaps unlikely at first
glance. And in fact many contemporary philosophers have argued
that panpsychism is simply too fantastic or improbable to be
true. However, there is actually a very long and distinguished
history of panpsychist thinking in Western philosophy, from
its beginnings in ancient Greece through the present day.
Some of the greatest names in philosophy have argued
for some form of panpsychism, or expressed a strong sympathy
toward the idea. Notably, as we progress into the 21st
century, we find the beginnings of a philosophical
renaissance for the subject. Once again panpsychism is finding
a place in the larger philosophical discourse, and is being
explored in a number of different ways.
Table of Contents
(Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of
this article)
1. The Concept of
Panpsychism
In a general sense, panpsychism may be defined as the view
that all things possess mind, or some mind-like quality. The
specific meanings of “all things” and “mind” vary widely among
particular thinkers, but there is a broad consensus on three
points. First, the mind in all things is something internal
to, or inherent in, things themselves (as opposed to being
injected or sustained by some outside entity). Second, such
mind has a sort of focus or unity to it, in that it is
typically assumed to be of a singular nature. Third, "things"
usually (but not always) include systems or collections of
lower-order entities; thus, a forest may be considered as a
thing, though it is composed of a variety of individual
trees, plants, animals, and so forth.
Panpsychist theories generally attempt to encompass both
the material realm and the mental realm in a single
comprehensive framework, in a way that fundamentally connects
the two. These realms are central to many
aspects of philosophy, but panpsychism lies at a unique
intersection of the two, wherein mind is seen as fundamental
to the nature of existence and being. It is at once an
ontology and a theory of mind.
This latter point requires elaboration. Panpsychism, in
itself, is not a theory of mind per se, because it does not in
general give an account of the precise nature of mind, nor of
how it relates to material things. Rather, it is a
meta-theory; it is a theory about theories, a framework
which says: However mind is to be conceived, it applies, in
some sense, to all things.
Thus panpsychism can apply, in principle, to virtually any
conventional theory of mind. There could exist, for example, a
panpsychist substance dualism in
which some Supreme Being grants a soul/mind to all things.
There could be a panpsychist functionalism that interprets
the functional role of every object as mind, even if such a
role is only “to gravitate,” “to resist pressure,” and so
forth. One could argue for a panpsychist identism in
which mind is identical to matter; or a panpsychist reductive
materialism in which the mind of each thing is reducible to
its physical states. The only theories not amenable to
panpsychism are those that (a) explicitly argue that only a
certain restricted class of beings can possess mind (such as
living things or Homo sapiens), or (b) deny the existence
of mind altogether (that is, eliminativism). The fact that
such restricted conceptions of mind are on shaky theoretical
ground suggests that one should not rule out the panpsychist
extension of other theories. Rather, the opposite view is
perhaps the more reasonable: that one should hold panpsychism
as a natural and logical extension of any given theory of
mind, until demonstrated otherwise.
A few further points should be made clear at the outset of
any discussion of panpsychism. First, philosophers typically
do not take panpsychism in the literal sense, meaning all
things have a soul; this interpretation of psyche is
primarily a remnant of the theological philosophy of the
Renaissance. Psyche is today most often interpreted as
synonymous with mind or, in a secular sense, spirit.
Second, panpsychism needs to be distinguished from some
closely related concepts: animism, hylozoism, pantheism,
panentheism, and panexperientialism:
-
Animism, as commonly understood, is the view that all
things possess a fully-developed, intelligent, and complex
conscious-like spirit. It is a concept arising more from
mythology than philosophy, and few panpsychists actually
attribute human-like (or god-like) consciousness to all
objects.
-
Hylozoism is the theory that everything is alive. This
concept originated in ancient philosophy when the notion of
life was less well-understood, and hence easily conflated
with ideas of spirit and mind. Thus when past writers
argue that “everything is alive” we are justified in
interpreting this in a panpsychist light. The term has been
used sporadically even through the early twentieth century,
but based on our current understanding of living organisms,
it is less useful or appropriate today.
-
Pantheism identifies everything, collectively, with God,
as a single unified being. For the pantheist, the universe
itself is God. In general this says nothing about individual
things, nor about the nature of mind, and hence has no
direct bearing on panpsychism (though some panpsychists do
equate God with the cosmos, and hence are pantheists as
well—Spinoza
being the prime example).
-
Panentheism is the view that God penetrates, or is in,
everything. Again, this typically assumes a single unified
God, whose omnipresence is taken as the spirit in all
things. Such a view is actually close to the standard
Christian position, where the Holy Spirit dwells everywhere.
But because it offers a notion of spirit as a part of a
unified God, and not as spirit of the thing itself, it is
not a true form of panpsychism.
Of the above terms, only panexperientialism deserves to be
considered as true panpsychism; the others are either archaic
or largely irrelevant. And due to the prominence of process
philosophy over the past few decades, panexperientialism is
perhaps the most widely discussed form of panpsychism
today.
The process view of panpsychism raises a third issue. When
process philosophers argue that all things have a mind or
that all things experience, they refer to all “true” or
“genuine” individuals. A human being is a genuine individual,
as are all animals. One-celled microbes are included, as well
as cells in the animal body. Plant cells count as individuals,
but, interestingly, whole plants do not—based on a particular
reading of some rather cryptic statements by Whitehead. On the
process view, rocks and tables are not individuals, but the
atoms and molecules that compose them are. Since atoms are
seen as possessing mind, all material things are thereby
enminded: either as individuals in themselves, or as a
collection of sentient atoms. It should be emphasized,
however, that the process view is a minority position; most
panpsychists throughout history have held to the stronger view
that all things possess mind.
Finally, it is clearly debatable what one means by “mind.”
Panpsychists have employed a variety of descriptive terms to
articulate the mental quality that all things share:
sentience, experience, feeling, inner life, subjectivity,
qualia, will, perception. In the vast majority of cases such
terms are used in a very broad sense, and are not defined in a
specifically human sense. In fact, panpsychists deliberately
avoid terms that are too closely identified with uniquely
human mental characteristics, such as consciousness
(or self-consciousness), cognition, thought, belief, and the
like. The usual intention is that only mind in the broadest
sense is applicable to all things.
2. A Historical Overview
a. Ancient
Philosophy
Panpsychism is an ancient concept in Western philosophy,
predating even the earliest writings of the pre-Socratics. It
was in fact an essential part of the cosmology into which
philosophy was born. Thus we should not be too surprised to
find its influence recurring throughout our history.
We see evidence of this at the very beginning of
philosophy, in the few remaining fragments of Thales, the man
widely regarded as the first philosopher of ancient Greece.
Thales believed that the lodestone (magnet) possessed a psyche
or soul: “According to Thales…the lodestone has a soul because
it moves iron” (Aristotle, De Anima, 405a19).
Furthermore, the power of the lodestone was seen as a
particularly powerful manifestation of a divine animate
quality shared by all things: “Certain thinkers say that soul
is intermingled in the whole universe, and it is perhaps for
that reason that Thales came to the opinion that all things
are full of gods” (Ibid, 411a7).
Other pre-Socratics held similar views:
-
Anaximenes
put forth the pneuma (air) as the underlying arche,
or ruling principle, of the cosmos. Pneuma has a number of
related meanings, many of which correspond closely with psyche; in addition to “air” it can also mean breath, soul, spirit, or mind. Since pneuma penetrates and
underlies all things, this implies that all things are
endowed with a spiritual or soul-like quality.
-
Heraclitus’
arche was fire. Fire, like the pneuma, was associated
with life-energy; thus Heraclitus referred to this fire not
merely as pyr, but as pyr aeizoon – an
“ever-living fire.” Consequently, this life-energy was seen
as residing in all things: “All things are full of souls and
of divine spirits” (Smith, 1934: 13). In another fragment he
proclaimed: “The thinking faculty is common to all”
(Freeman, 1948: 32).
-
Anaxagoras
envisioned the world as composed of a myriad of substances,
but these were ordered and regulated by the single
over-arching principle of nous (mind). Nous
was a unifying, cosmic mental force that was interwoven with
the movement and actions of disparate elements. The mind
that is ubiquitous is not just some amorphous, abstract
mind, but essentially like that of animals, that is, an
animated soul or spirit: “[J]ust as in animals, so in
nature, mind is present and responsible for the world…”
(Aristotle, Metaphysics, 984b15).
Of special note is the thinking of Empedocles.
He invented the four-element view of the cosmos—fire, air,
water, and earth—that held for nearly two millennia. All
things, including psyche, were composed of these four
substances. Furthermore, the elements themselves were seen as
ensouled: “Empedocles [says that the soul] is composed of all
the elements and that each of them actually is a soul”
(Aristotle, De Anima, 404b11). These elements were
presided over by two animate forces, Love (attraction) and
Strife (repulsion). Hence panpsychism was central to
Empedocles’ worldview. Guthrie (1962-81: 233) stated that “it
was in fact fundamental to Empedocles’ whole system that there
is no distinction between animate and inanimate, and
everything has some degree of awareness and power of
discrimination.” Perhaps the clearest indication comes in
fragment 103: “all things have the power of thought” (Smith,
1934: 31).
Moving to the heart of Greek philosophy, Plato made a
number of intriguing comments in support of panpsychism.
Notably, passages suggesting such a view occur in four of his
last works – Sophist, Philebus, Timaeus,
and Laws. This implies that they represent his mature
thinking on the matter, and thus have some strong degree of
significance in his overall metaphysical system.
Sophist discusses Plato’s ideas about the Form of
Being. Since being, on Plato’s view, has the power of
self-generating motion (247e), he concludes that the Form of
Being must itself have an inherent psychic aspect:
O heavens, can we ever be made to believe that motion
[kinesi] and life [zoe] and soul [psyche]
and mind [phronesi] are not present with perfect being?
Can we imagine that, being is devoid of life and mind, and
exists in awful unmeaningness an everlasting fixture? -- That
would be a dreadful thing to admit (249a).
All real things participate in the Form of Being, as this
is how they acquire their actual existence. Thus, everything
may be said to participate in life, mind, and soul.
In the Philebus Plato introduced the concept of the
anima mundi—the world-soul (30a). He argued that the
universe, like the human body, is composed of the four
Empedoclean elements (fire, air, water, earth). Both the human
and the cosmos are well-ordered and exhibit clear signs of
logos, of rationality. The body, though nothing more
than a well-ordered combination of the elements, possesses a
soul; therefore a reasonable implication is that the universe
too, and everything in it, are ensouled. If this were not the
case, then there must be something fundamentally unique about
the structure of mankind and the cosmos that they alone are
ensouled. Plato gave no indication that this is true and, in
fact, argued later to the contrary.
Timaeus contains an account of how the creator of
the universe—the Demiurge—brought the cosmos into existence,
and endowed it with a world-soul. One learns that not only is
the cosmos as a whole ensouled, but so too are the
stars, individually; they are “divine living things”
(40b), for which “[the Demiurge] assigned each soul to a star”
(41e). As well the Earth, described as a “god” (40c),
“foremost” in the cosmos. Later (77b) Plato explains that even
plants possess the third kind of soul (appetitive), and thus
are animate.
Finally, in Laws Plato offers perhaps his final
statement on the matter:
Now consider all the stars and the moon and the years and
the months and all the seasons: what can we do except repeat
the same story? A soul or souls...have been shown to be the
cause of all these phenomena, and whether it is by their
living presence in matter...or by some other means, we shall
insist that these souls are gods. Can anybody admit all this
and still put up with people who deny that ‘everything is full
of gods’? (899b).
In a nod to the famous line by Thales, Plato seems to
resolve this issue for us: everything is full of gods.
Regarding Aristotle, we
know that he viewed the psyche or soul as the form (or
structure) of living things. Accordingly, non-living things
have no soul—hence, technically, Aristotle was no panpsychist.
But the question remains whether non-living things have
something soul-like in them.
First, we note that there is a kind of evolutionary
imperative in Aristotle’s thinking. He envisioned all of
nature as continually striving toward “the better” or “the
good” (see Physics 192a18; On Generation and
Corruption 336b28; Eudemian Ethics 1218a30). By
“better” Aristotle has in mind certain specific qualities; he
comments that being is better than non-being, life better than
non-life, and soul better than matter. Thus, as Rist (1989:
123) points out, there is a meaningful sense in which “the
whole of the cosmos is permeated by some kind of upward desire
and aspiration”—upward in the sense of toward form, life, and
soul.
This outlook is essential to Aristotle because he sought to
explain the puzzling phenomenon of spontaneous generation.
Plant and animal life seem to materialize out of inanimate
matter—such as the maggots and flies that quickly appear in
decaying animal waste. How is this possible? The upward
striving of matter is part of the explanation, but not the
whole story.
Aristotle argued that all natural (as opposed to manmade)
objects possess an inherent “principle of motion”
(Physics 192b9). This fact permits one to see such
motion as “an immortal never-failing property of things that
are, a sort of life as it were to all naturally constituted
things” (Physics, 250b12). The “sort of life” in matter
was no idle concept, but directly connected to the process of
spontaneous generation. This life-energy initiates the
generative process, thus bringing into being true life and
soul.
The life-energy in all things had to be grounded in some
kind of substance, in order to be manifest in the real world.
So Aristotle adopted, perhaps via Anaximenes, the notion of
the pneuma. The pneuma is not, strictly speaking, mind or
soul; rather, it is something soul-like. As he says in
Generation of Animals, it is the “faculty of all kinds
of soul,” the “vital heat” (thermoteta psychiken), the
“principle of soul” (736b29).
The soul-like pneuma is ubiquitous in the natural world,
penetrating and informing all things. It not only brings soul
to the embryo and to the spontaneously-generated creatures,
but it accounts for the general desire of matter for form, and
for the good. Aristotle is explicit and unambiguous that all
things are inspirited by the pneuma. With rather stunning
clarity he informs us:
Animals and plants come into being in earth and in liquid
because there is water in earth, and pneuma in water, and in
all pneuma is vital heat, so that in a sense all things are
full of soul (Generation of Animals 762a18-20).
Echoing panpsychist thinking from Thales to Plato,
Aristotle apparently came to the conclusion that something
soul-like, of varying degrees, inhered in all objects of the
natural world.
Post-Aristotelian (Hellenistic) Greek philosophy continued
to incorporate panpsychist themes. The two dominant schools of
that era were those of Epicurus and
the Stoics.
Epicurean physical theory relied heavily on the atomism of
Democritus,
and followed his central thesis of material objects as
composed of atoms moving through the void. The early atomists
held to a strict determinism, but this was problematic for
Epicurus, as his ethical system required the existence of free
will. He therefore discarded the determinism by introducing a
new factor that he called “swerve” (parenklisis; in
Latin, declinare, a deflection or turning-aside). The
swerve was due to a tiny amount of free will exhibited by
all atoms.
The willful swerving of the atoms is the basis for our own
free will. As Lucretius
describes it, “[Out of the swerve] rises, I say, that
will torn free from fate, through which we follow
wherever pleasure leads, and likewise swerve aside at times
and places” (pp. 255-60). Human free will cannot arise ex
nihilo (“since nothing, we see, could be produced from
nothing”; p. 287), and hence must be present in the atoms
themselves: “Thus to the atoms we must allow…one more cause of
movement [namely, that of free will]—the one whence comes this
power we own” (pp. 284-6). The necessary conclusion, then, is
that since all things are composed of willful atoms, all
things can be said to be animate.
The early Stoic philosophers— Zeno, Cleanthes,
and Chrysippus—adopted
many of their predecessors’ fundamental assumptions about the
nature of being and mind, most importantly the
Aristotelian/Anaximean conception of the pneuma. Composed of
fire and air, the Stoic pneuma was put forth as the creative
life energy of the universe. This was most evident in human
bodies, in which both warmth (fire) and breath (air) were seen
as the essential defining characteristics of life and soul.
Pneuma was the active principle made tangible, and as such it
accounted for all form that was seen in worldly objects.
Pneuma was the “creative fire” of the cosmos, a pyr
technikon. It had the status of divinity, and was equated
with both god and cosmic reason.
A. A. Long (1974) notes that in the Stoic system “mind and
matter are two constituents or attributes of one thing, body,
and this analysis applies to human beings as it does to
everything else” (p. 171). All material objects are “bodies,”
and they are in fact “compounds of ‘matter’ and ‘mind’ (God or
logos). Mind is not something other than body but a necessary
constituent of it, the ‘reason’ in matter” (p. 174).
b. Renaissance Thinking
The end of Hellenism and the Stoic philosophy coincided
with the beginnings of the monotheistic religious worldview.
Monotheism and the Christian worldview were fundamentally
opposed to panpsychism, and thus it is perhaps not surprising
that we find relatively little articulation of panpsychist
ideas for several centuries.
The next major advance did not occur until the Italian
Renaissance. Five of the most important philosophers of that
era—Cardano, Telesio, Patrizi, Bruno, and Campanella—were
panpsychists.
Cardano was the first notable philosopher in over a
millennium to put forth an unambiguous panpsychist philosophy.
His ontological system consisted of a nested hierarchy in
which each individual thing was seen as (1) a part (of the
larger whole, or One), (2) a unity in itself, and (3) a
composition of sub-parts. The fundamental principle
maintaining the unity of each part was anima (soul);
the particularly human form of this principle he
recognized as mind. As the unifying principle, soul was
present in all unities large and small.
Like Empedocles, Telesio saw two fundamental and opposing
forces in the universe: an expanding and motive principle that
he called heat, and a contracting principle,
cold. These forces acted on and shaped the so-called
third principle, passive matter, which was associated with the
Earth. Every object was a composition of passive matter and
the heat/cold principles. Heat and cold also had the notable
property of perception. Heat sought to stay warm, and
cold to stay cool, and this tendency Telesio
interpreted as a kind of sensation or knowledge. As he says,
“It is quite evident that nature is propelled by
self-interest” (1586/1967: 304). And since heat and cold
inhered in all things, all things shared in this ability to
sense. Thus his position is sometimes referred to as
pansensism, a particular form of panpsychism.
Patrizi’s chief work, New Philosophy of the Universe
(1591), laid out a complete cosmological system, and
introduced into the Western vocabulary the term “panpsychism.”
Following the model of Ficino, Patrizi created a nine-level
hierarchical system of being, with soul (anima) in the
center. As such it permeated all levels, existing
simultaneously at the level of the world-soul, the human soul,
and the soul of inanimate things. “Patrizi does not treat
the individual souls as [mere] parts of the world soul, but
believes, rather, that their relation to their bodies is
analogous to that of the world soul to the universe as a
whole” (Kristeller, 1964: 122). Soul is “both [unity and
plurality], with the many contained in the one” (Brickman,
1941: 41).
Bruno was very frank about his panpsychist view, and even
acknowledged its unconventionality. In his 1584 dialogue,
Cause, Principle and Unity, one character exclaims,
“Common sense tells us that not everything is alive. ... [W]ho
will agree with you?” Another replies, “But who could
reasonably refute it?” (1998: 42). Bruno believed that the
same principles must apply throughout the cosmos; the Earth
held no privileged position in the universe (such as being at
the center), and humans held no privilege with respect to
possessing a soul. He took the world-soul and the human soul
as given, and concluded that all things, all parts of the
whole, must be animated: “[N]ot only the form of the universe,
but also all the forms of natural things are souls.” He adds,
“there is nothing that does not possess a soul and that has no
vital principle” (p. 43). The skeptic retorts: “Then a dead
body has a soul? So, my clogs, my slippers, my boots...are
supposedly animated?” Bruno clarifies his position by
explaining that such “dead” things are not to be considered
animate in themselves, but rather as containing elements that
either are themselves animate or have the innate power of
animation:
I say, then, that the table is not animated as a table, nor
are the clothes as clothes...but that, as natural things and
composites, they have within them matter and form [that is,
soul]. All things, no matter how small and miniscule, have in
them part of that spiritual substance... [F]or in all things
there is spirit, and there is not the least corpuscle that
does not contain within itself some portion that may animate
it (p. 44).
Campanella’s system centered on his doctrine of the “three
primalities”: power, wisdom, and love. These are three
qualities that Campanella saw as residing in all things, from
the lowliest rock to the human being, to God himself. He
argued that all things possess wisdom and sensation, and
therefore can be said to possess the power of knowing. First and foremost, things
know themselves: “All things have the sensation of their own
being and of their conservation. They exist, are conserved,
operate, and act because they know” (in Bonansea, 1969: 156).
Cassirer (1963: 148) noted “Panpsychism emerges as a simple
corollary to his theory of knowledge.” We see this, very
explicitly, in the subtitle of Campanella’s work De sensu
rerum:
A remarkable tract of occult philosophy in which the world
is shown to be a living and truly conscious image of God, and
all its parts and particles thereof to be endowed with sense
perception, some more clearly, some more obscurely, to the
extent required for the preservation of themselves and of the
whole in which they share sensation.
Campanella offered a number of arguments in support of his
panpsychism. For example, following Epicurus and Telesio he
argued that “like comes from like,” that is, that emergence is
impossible:
Now, if the animals are sentient...and sense does not come
from nothing, the elements whereby they and everything else
are brought into being must be said to be sentient, because
what the result has the cause must have. Therefore the heavens
are sentient, and so [too] the earth... (cited in Dooley,
1995: 39).
Campanella was an important thinker, but the two great
panpsychists of the seventeenth century were certainly Spinoza and Leibniz.
Spinoza created a radical monism in which the single
underlying substance of all reality was what he identified as
“God, or Nature.” God/Nature possessed two knowable
attributes: mind (thought) and matter (extension).
In Spinoza’s psycho-physical parallelism, every object has
both its own unique mode of extension and its corresponding
mode of thought (also called the “idea” of the object): “In
God [/Nature] there is necessarily the idea…of all things…”
(Ethics, II Prop 3). Moreover, the idea of an object
has a very specific interpretation: it is the mind of that
object. Since every object has a corresponding idea, every
object can be said to have a mind. This is most apparent to us
in our own case, wherein the human mind is simply the idea of
the human body. But it is a general ontological principle, and
thus applies to all things:
From these [propositions] we understand not only that the
human mind is united to the body, but also what should be
understood by the union of mind and body. [...] For the things
we have shown so far are completely general and do not pertain
more to man than to other individuals, all of which, though in
different degrees, are nevertheless animate. ... [W]hatever we
have asserted of the idea [that is, mind] of the human body
must necessarily also be asserted of the idea of everything
else (ibid: II Prop. 13, Scholium).
There is some considerable disagreement as to the proper
interpretation of Spinoza’s psycho-physical parallelism, and
the meaning of the crucial Proposition 13 (above). Yet there
seems to be a consensus in recent years that any proper
reading will entail some form of panpsychism.
Leibniz’s panpsychism was based on his Monadology,
or science of monads. Monads are the point-like constituents
of reality, and they possess a number of characteristics that
are related to mental qualities. The structure of the monad is
to be understood as consisting of two primary qualities,
“perception” and “appetite.” Perceptions are the changing
internal states of the monads, and these changes are brought
about (in a rather vague way) by the monad’s appetite; the
appetite was a kind of seeking or desiring, a compelling need
to reflect the universe.
The strongly animistic tone of the terms perception and
appetite is not coincidental; each monad is identified with
a soul:
I found that [the monad’s] nature consists in force, and
that from this there follows something analogous to sensation
[that is, perception] and appetite, so that we must conceive
of them on the model of the notion we have of souls
(1989: 139).
Monads themselves are unities, but so too, in a different
way, are collections of monads. Any material object is
such a collection, and is integrated by the action of a
“dominant monad” which represents the integrated unity of the
object. Leibniz, following Bruno, made a critical distinction
between objects with a truly organic sense of unity and
objects that are mere sets, collections, or aggregations of
distinct things. Aggregates such as “an army or a flock,” or
“a heap of stones” do not possess a dominant monad and thus no
unified mind. Interestingly, Leibniz never gave a formal
definition as to what qualifies as a group and what defines
a true individual. Nonetheless, all things—even mere
aggregates—possess mind, if only in their parts. Of this
Leibniz was clear: “[W]e see that there is a world of
creatures, of living beings, of animals, of entelechies, of
souls in the least part of matter” (Monadology, sec.
66).
c. Eighteenth and Nineteenth
Centuries
French thinkers Julien LaMettrie and Denis Diderot
discarded the concept of the supernatural soul, and concluded
that mind, or a mind-like nature, must be present in all
matter. This was the view that came to be known as vitalistic
materialism. Diderot’s work D'Alembert's Dream (1769)
put forth a very explicit panpsychist view: “this faculty of
sensation…is a general and essential quality of matter”
(1769/1937: 49). Throughout the dialogue one finds repeated
references to the “general sensitivity of matter.” At one
point he observes that “[f]rom the elephant to the flea, from
the flea to the sensitive living atom, the origin of all,
there is no point in nature but suffers and enjoys” (ibid:
80).
In the century following the French Enlightenment,
panpsychist thought developed most rapidly in Germany. Among
its more prominent advocates: Herder, Schopenhauer, Goethe,
Fechner, Lotze, Hartmann,
Mach, and Haeckel.
Herder was a dynamist philosopher who argued that
Kraft (force or energy) was the single underlying
substance of reality. As such it reflected both mental and
physical properties. Herder sought to unify the diversity of
forces (gravity, electricity, magnetism, and light) under the
single framework of Kraft, of which the various
Kraefte were different manifestations. The Kraft
was at once material-energy, life-energy, spirit, and mind.
“[Herder] represents the Kraefte of plants and stones
as analogous to the soul. [...] [E]ach endowed with a
different degree of consciousness...” (Nisbet, 1970: 11). In
1784 he wrote: “All active forces of Nature are,
each in its own way, alive; in their interior there must be
Something that corresponds to their effects without—as Leibniz
himself assumed....”
Schopenhauer’s masterwork, The World as Will and
Idea (1819), describes a two-fold system of reality. From
one perspective, the world is to be taken according to
classical idealism—it exists only as our minds grasp and
perceive it, hence as pure idea. On the other hand, the
things of the world must also possess an inner reality. When
we humans look inside ourselves, we find, ultimately, only
forms of wanting, desiring, urging—in short, will. Yet we are
material objects, not essentially unlike other material
objects; hence all things, not just humans, are, on the
inside, will:
We shall accordingly make further use of [the knowledge of
the world as will and idea] as a key to the nature of
every phenomenon in nature, and shall judge of all
objects which are not our own bodies…according to the
analogy of our own bodies, and shall therefore assume
that as in one aspect they are idea, …so in another aspect,
what remains of objects when we set aside their existence as
idea of the subject, must in its inner nature be the same as
that in us which we call will (1819/1995: 37).
Not just objects, but all the forces of nature are to be
seen as forms of will: “[G]enerally every original force
manifesting itself in physical and chemical appearances, in
fact gravity itself—all these in themselves...are absolutely
identical with what we find in ourselves as will”
(1836/1993: 20).
Schopenhauer’s theory thus brings an effective unity to the
notions of mind and matter:
Now if you suppose the existence of a mind in the
human head, [...] you are bound to concede a mind to every
stone. [...] [A]ll ostensible mind can be attributed to
matter, but all matter can likewise be attributed to mind;
from which it follows that the antithesis [between mind and
matter] is a false one (1851/1974: 212-213).
Goethe developed a poetic form of panpsychism that
displayed itself chiefly in his writings that personified
nature. His most explicit statement came from a short essay of
1828: “Since, however, matter can never exist and act without
spirit [Seele], nor spirit without matter, matter is
also capable of undergoing intensification, and spirit cannot
be denied its attraction and repulsion” (1988: 6). Here we
find a beautifully concise articulation of panpsychism: no
matter without mind, no mind without matter. This is not
to say that mind is identical with matter, nor that one can be
reduced to the other. It simply claims (like Spinoza and
Schopenhauer) that neither
mind nor matter exist without the other.
Fechner’s panpsychism was focused primarily on plant life.
The fact that plants have a Seele is of critical
importance to him because it serves as the basis for a
completely panpsychic universe, and a corresponding new
worldview. Fechner’s concept of the plant-soul was based, like
Aristotle’s, on a comparison and analogy with other living
beings:
[I]s not the plant quite as well organized as the animal,
though on a different plan, a plan entirely of its own,
perfectly consonant with its idea? If one will not venture to
deny that the plant has a life, why deny it a soul? For it is
much simpler to think that a different plan of bodily
organization built upon the common basis of life indicates
only a different plan of psychic organization (1848/1946:
168-9).
The Earth itself is “animated,” and is furthermore “an
angel, so rich and fresh and blooming, ... turning wholly
towards heaven its animated face” (1861/1946: 150, 153). The
animate Earth further implies “belief in the animate character
of all other stars.”
Lotze’s central work, Microcosmos (1856-64/1885),
described a comprehensive philosophical viewpoint based on a
rejection of mechanistic thinking. He advocated the notion
that all material objects have “a double life, appearing
outwardly as matter, and as such manifesting...mechanical
[properties, while] internally, on the other hand, moved
mentally...” (p. 150). He concluded that “no part of being is
any longer devoid of life and animation” (p. 360). Lotze
acknowledged the prima facie improbability of his
panpsychist view: “Who could endure the thought that in the
dust trodden by our feet, in the...cloth that forms our
clothing, in the materials shaped into all sorts of
utensils..., there is everywhere present the fullness of
animated life...?” (p. 361). Ultimately it is the “beauty of
the living form [that] is made to us more intelligible by this
hypothesis” (p. 366).
Eduard von Hartmann further developed Schopenhauer’s system
of the world as will and idea, combining elements of Leibniz,
Schelling, and Hegel into a
doctrine of spiritual monism. He articulated a worldview in
which the unconscious will is the cause of all things. The
fact that matter is resolvable into will and idea led Hartmann
to accept “the essential likeness of Mind and Matter”
(1869/1950, vol. 2: 81): “The identity of mind and matter
[becomes] elevated to a scientific cognition, and that, too,
not by killing the spirit but by vivifying matter” (ibid:
180).
Mach’s philosophical writings emerged in the early 1880's.
A strong empiricist, he developed a neutral monistic
philosophy in which the primary substance of existence was
something that he called “sensations.” This realization led
him rather suddenly to a panpsychist conception of reality:
“Properly speaking the world is not composed of ‘things’...but
of colors, tones, pressures, spaces, times, in short what we
ordinarily call individual sensations” (1883/1974: 579).
Recalling Schopenhauer’s tone, Mach wrote:
We shall then discover that our hunger is not so
essentially different from the tendency of sulphuric acid for
zinc, and our will not so greatly different from the pressure
of a stone, as now appears. We shall again feel ourselves
nearer nature, without its being necessary that we should
resolve ourselves into a nebulous and mystical mass of
molecules, or make nature a haunt of hobgoblins (ibid:
560).
Haeckel developed a monistic philosophy in which both
evolution and the unity of all natural phenomena played a
major part. The unity and relation of all living things
convinced him that all dualities were false, especially the
Cartesian dualism of body and mind. Haeckel
was explicitly panpsychist by 1892: “One highly important
principle of my monism seems to me to be, that I regard
all matter as ensouled, that is to say as
endowed with feeling (pleasure and pain) and
motion…” (p. 486). He offered one argument for
panpsychism, namely that “all natural bodies possess
determinate chemical properties,” the most important being
that of “chemical affinity.” This affinity, Haeckel argued,
can only be explained “on the supposition that the molecules…
mutually feel each other” (p. 483). Three years later
he observed, “Our conception of Monism…is clear and
unambiguous; …an immaterial living spirit is just as
unthinkable as a dead, spiritless material; the two are
inseparably combined in every atom” (1895: 58).
By the latter part of the nineteenth century, panpsychist
thought began to develop in England and America. The first
major British panpsychist of that time was William Kingdon
Clifford. He believed in a form of Spinozist parallelism—that
some process of mind exists concurrently with all forms of
matter. Clifford cited evolutionary continuity in arguing that
there is no point in the chain of material organization at
which mind can be conceived to suddenly appear. Fellow Briton
Herbert Spencer
wrote an article in 1884 explaining that modern physics
has revealed the “incredible power” of matter. The scientist
is forced to conclude that:
every point in space thrills with an infinity of vibrations
passing through it in all directions; the conception to which
[the enlightened scientist] tends is much less that of a
Universe of dead matter than that of a Universe everywhere
alive: alive if not in the restricted sense, still in a
general sense (1884: 10).
Royce’s 1892 book, Spirit of Modern Philosophy,
introduced a form of panpsychism based on absolute idealism:
“The theory of the ‘double aspect’, applied to the facts of
the inorganic world, suggests at once that they, too, in so
far as they are real, must possess their own inner and
appreciable aspect” (1892: 419-20). A few years later he added
this observation:
[W]e have no sort of right to speak in any way as if the
inner experience behind any fact of nature were of a grade
lower than ours, or less conscious, or less rational, or more
atomic. [...] [T]his reality is, like that of our own
experience, conscious, organic, full of clear contrasts,
rational, definite. We ought not to speak of dead nature
(1898/1915: 230).
Charles
Peirce’s article, “Man's Glassy Essence” (1892), begins by
noting “[T]here is fair analogical inference that all
protoplasm feels. It not only feels but exercises all the
functions of mind” (1892/1992: 343). And yet protoplasm is
simply complex chemistry, a particular arrangement of
molecules. We are therefore compelled “[to] admit that
physical events are but degraded or undeveloped forms of
psychical events” (ibid: 348). Peirce then laid out his own
dual-aspect theory of mind:
[A]ll mind is directly or indirectly connected with all
matter, and acts in a more or less regular way; so that all
mind more or less partakes of the nature of matter. [...]
Viewing a thing from the outside, [...] it appears as matter.
Viewing it from the inside, [...] it appears as consciousness
(ibid: 349).
d. Twentieth Century to the Present
William James first addressed the subject of panpsychism in
his Principles of Psychology. He devoted a full chapter
to Clifford’s mind-stuff theory, and displayed notable
sympathy to the view. James’ first personal endorsement of
panpsychism came in his Harvard lecture notes of 1902-3, in
which he noted, “pragmatism would be [my] method and
‘pluralistic panpsychism’ [my] doctrine” (Perry, 1935: 373).
In his 1905-6 lecture notes he observed: “Our only
intelligible notion of an object in itself is that it
should be an object for itself, and this lands us in
panpsychism and a belief that our physical perceptions are
effects on us of ‘psychical’ realities...” (ibid: 446).
James arrived at a clear and unambiguous position in his
1909 book, A Pluralistic Universe. He explained that
his theory of radical empiricism is a form of pluralist monism
in which all things are both pure experience and “for
themselves,” that is, are objects with their own independent
psychical perspectives. In the end he endorsed “a general view
of the world almost identical with Fechner’s” (ibid: 309-10).
He saw in this new worldview “a great empirical movement
towards a pluralistic panpsychic view of the universe” (ibid:
313).
In the early part of the twentieth century, panpsychist
philosophy continued to develop rapidly in England and the
USA. The dominant philosophical system, the one most connected
with panpsychism, was Process Philosophy. Its earliest
advocates were Bergson and Whitehead.
Bergson wrote Creative Evolution in 1907. His
thesis—that matter is “the lowest degree of mind”—echoes
Peirce. He added, following Schopenhauer, that “pure willing
[is the] current that runs through matter, communicating life
to it” (1907/1911: 206). But Bergson’s clearest elaboration
came in Duration and Simultaneity (1922). Here he
achieved a true process philosophy wherein all physical events
contain a memory of the past. Given his earlier insistence
that memory is essential to mind, one can see the conclusion
that mind, or consciousness, is in all things:
What we wish to establish is that we cannot speak of a
reality that endures without inserting consciousness into it.
... [I]t is impossible to imagine or conceive a connecting
link between the before and after without an element of memory
and, consequently, of consciousness. ... We may perhaps feel
averse to the use of the word “consciousness” if an
anthropomorphic sense is attached to it. [But] there is no
need to take one’s own memory and transport it, even
attenuated, into the interior of the thing. ... It is the
opposite course we must follow. ... [D]uration is essentially
a continuation of what no longer exists into what does exist.
This is real time, perceived and lived. ... Duration therefore
implies consciousness; and we place consciousness at the heart
of things for the very reason that we credit them with a time
that endures (1922/1965: 48-49).
Whitehead’s panpsychism is relatively well known. It is
based in his view of an “occasion of experience” as the
ultimate particle of reality, and as possessing both a
physical pole and a mental pole. If things are nothing but
occasions, and occasions are in part mental, then all things
have a mental dimension. In
Modes of Thought (1938), in the chapter titled “Nature
Alive,” he observed, “this [traditional] sharp division between
mentality and nature has no ground in our fundamental
observation. [...] I conclude that we should conceive mental
operations as among the factors which make up the constitution
of nature” (p. 156).
Bertrand Russell ultimately came to a neutral monist view
in which events were the primary reality, and mind and matter
were both constructed from them. After some early, suggestive
comments, he became increasingly supportive of panpsychism in the late 1920's. Russell’s book An Outline of Philosophy
(1927) directly addressed this. He wrote: “My own
feeling is that there is not a sharp line, but a difference of
degree [between mind and matter]; an oyster is less mental
than a man, but not wholly un-mental” (p. 209). Part of the
reason why we cannot draw a line, he says, is that an
essential aspect of mind is memory, and a memory of sorts is
displayed even by inanimate objects: “we cannot, on this
ground [of memory], erect an absolute barrier between mind and
matter. ... [I]nanimate matter, to some slight extent, shows
analogous behavior” (p. 306). In the summary he adds,
The events that happen in our minds are part of the course
of nature, and we do not know that the events which happen
elsewhere are of a totally different kind. The physical
world…is perhaps less rigidly determined by causal laws than
it was thought to be; one might, more or less fancifully,
attribute even to the atom a kind of limited free will (p.
311).
Perhaps Russell’s clearest statement came in his
Portraits from Memory (1956). Memory is “the most
essential characteristic of mind, ... using this word [memory]
in its broadest sense to include every influence of past
experience on present reactions” (pp. 153-4). As before,
memory applies to all physical objects and systems:
This [memory] also can be illustrated in a lesser degree by
the behavior of inorganic matter. A watercourse which at most
times is dry gradually wears a channel down a gully at the
times when it flows, and subsequent rains follow [a similar]
course... You may say, if you like, that the river bed
'remembers' previous occasions when it experienced cooling
streams. ... You would say [this] was a flight of fancy
because you are of the opinion that rivers and river beds do
not 'think'. But if thinking consists of certain modifications
of behavior owing to former occurrences, then we shall have to
say that the river bed thinks, though its thinking is somewhat
rudimentary (p. 155).
In contrast to Whitehead, Charles Hartshorne articulated a
clear and explicit form of process panpsychism. Beginning with
his Beyond Humanism (1937), he laid out the unambiguous
position that all true individuals possess a kind of psyche:
“Molecules, atoms, and electrons all show more analogy of
behavior to animals than do sticks and stones. The
constitutions of inorganic masses may then after all belong on
the scale of organic being…” (pp. 111-112). Elaborating on
this notion over four decades, through such articles as
“Panpsychism” (1950), “Physics and Psychics” (1977), and “The
Rights of the Subhuman World” (1979), his panpsychism (or,
“psychicalism”) is a clear and consistent theme. He combined
the insights of Leibniz with Whitehead’s process view into a
system which, he claimed, resolved many long-standing
philosophical problems: most notably that it serves as a
third way between dualism and materialism. Ultimately,
panpsychism/psychicalism is, he says, the most viable ontology
available to us—certainly preferable to an utterly
unintelligible materialism: “the concept of ‘mere dead
insentient matter’ is an appeal to invincible ignorance. At no
time will this expression ever constitute knowledge” (1977:
95).
Many other great thinkers of the twentieth century promoted
panpsychist ideas, including:
-
F. S. C. Schiller: “A stone, no doubt, does not apprehend
us as spiritual beings… But does this amount to saying that
it does not apprehend us at all, and takes no note whatever
of our existence? Not at all; it is aware of us and affected
by us on the plane on which its own existence is passed… It
faithfully exercises all the physical functions, and
influences us by so doing. It gravitates and resists
pressure, and obstructs…vibrations, and so forth, and makes
itself respected as such a body. And it treats us as if of a
like nature with itself, on the level of its understanding…”
(1907: 442).
-
John
Dewey : “[T]here is nothing which marks off the plant
from the physico-chemical activity of inanimate bodies. The
latter also are subject to conditions of disturbed inner
equilibrium, which lead to activity in relation to
surrounding things, and which terminate after a cycle of
changes…” (1925: 253).
-
J. B. S. Haldane: “We do not find obvious evidence of
life or mind in so-called inert matter…; but if the
scientific point of view is correct, we shall ultimately
find them, at least in rudimentary form, all through the
universe” (1932: 13).
-
Teilhard de Chardin: “there is necessarily a double
aspect to [matter’s] structure... [C]o-extensive with
their Without, there is a Within to things.” “[W]e are
logically forced to assume the existence in rudimentary
form...of some sort of psyche in every corpuscle, even in
those (the mega-molecules and below) whose complexity is of
such a low or modest order as to render it (the psyche)
imperceptible...” (1959: 56, 301).
-
Gregory Bateson: “The elementary cybernetic system with
its messages in circuit is, in fact, the simplest unit of
mind; ... More complicated systems are perhaps more worthy
to be called mental systems, but essentially this is what we
are talking about. ... We get a picture, then, of mind as
synonymous with cybernetic system... [W]e know that within
Mind in the widest sense there will be a hierarchy of
subsystems, any one of which we can call an individual mind”
(1972: 459-60).
-
Freeman Dyson: “The laws [of physics] leave a place for
mind in the description of every molecule… In other words,
mind is already inherent in every electron, and the
processes of human consciousness differ only in degree and
not in kind…” (1979: 249).
-
David Bohm: “That which we experience as mind…will in a
natural way ultimately reach the level of the wavefunction
and of the ‘dance’ of the particles. There is no
unbridgeable gap or barrier between any of these levels. ...
It is implied that, in some sense, a rudimentary
consciousness is present even at the level of particle
physics” (1986: 131).
Panpsychism enters the 21st century with vigor
and diversity of thought. A number of recent works have
focused attention on it. If we look back to the year 1996 we
find two books that contributed to a resurrection of sorts.
First, Chalmers’ The Conscious Mind lays out a
naturalistic dualism theory of mind in which he suggests (with
an apparent diffidence) that mind can be associated with
ubiquitous information states—following Bateson and Bohm,
though without citing their panpsychist views. His relatively
detailed discussion of panpsychism sparked a resurgence of
discussion on the matter, and contributed to a wider interest.
Also, Abram’s Spell of the Sensuous argued from a
phenomenological basis for a return to an animistic worldview,
though his work was more poetic essay than detailed
philosophical inquiry. In 1998 process philosopher David Ray
Griffin published Unsnarling the World-Knot, a major
milestone in panpsychist philosophy. Griffin supplies a
detailed and scholarly assessment of the subject, though with
a strong focus on the process view, and with only a cursory
historical study.
Into the present century, Christian DeQuincey’s Radical
Nature (2002) offers another process perspective, and a
more satisfying review of the historical aspect. In 2003 there
were two more books dedicated to panpsychism: David Clarke’s
Panpsychism and the Religious Attitude, and Freya
Mathews’ For Love of Matter. Clarke again takes the
process view, underscoring the dominance of this philosophical
perspective on the discussion. Mathews moves into new
territory; drawing inspiration from Schopenhauer, she crafts a
truly metaphysical philosophy in which humans are sensitive
participants in an animate cosmos. Gregg Rosenberg released a
nominally panpsychist approach to mind in 2004, with his book
A Place for Consciousness. In 2005, Skrbina published
the first-ever comprehensive study of the subject,
Panpsychism in the West. Most recently, Galen Strawson
has presented a forceful argument for panpsychism based on the
inexplicability of emergence of mind (see Section 4).
Thus, at present we can discern at least six active lines
of inquiry into panpsychism:
-
the Process Philosophy view, as conceived by Bergson and
Whitehead, and developed by Hartshorne, Griffin, DeQuincey,
and Clarke;
-
the Quantum Physics approach, as developed by Bohm,
Hameroff, and others;
-
the Information Theory approach, arising from the work of
Bateson, Wheeler (1994), Bohm, and Chalmers;
-
the Part-Whole Hierarchy, as envisioned by Cardano and
elaborated by Koestler (1967) and Wilber (1995);
-
the Nonlinear Dynamics approach, as inspired by Peirce
(1892) and further articulated by Skrbina (1994, 2001);
and
-
Strawson’s (2006) “real physicalism” (see Section
4).
These areas all offer significant opportunity for
development and articulation. They hold out the hope of
resolving otherwise intractable problems of emergentism and
mechanism, especially when so many conventional approaches
have reached a dead end. As Nagel, Searle, and others have
noted, the problems of mind and consciousness are so difficult that “drastic actions” are
warranted—perhaps even as drastic as panpsychism.
Panpsychism, with its long list of advocates and
sympathizers, is a robust and respectable approach to mind. It
offers a naturalistic escape from Cartesian dualism and
Christian theology. And, by undermining the mechanistic
worldview, it promises to resolve not only long-standing
philosophical problems but persistent social and ecological
problems as well. Many great thinkers, from Empedocles and
Epicurus to Campanella and LaMettrie, Fechner and James to
Gregory Bateson, have recognized the potential for the
panpsychist view to fundamentally alter, for the better, our
outlook on the world. An animated worldview is not only
philosophically rigorous, but it can have far-reaching and
unanticipated effects.
3. Arguments: Pro and Con
An analysis of historical views, and recent discussions by
such individuals as Griffin (1998), Popper (1977), McGinn
(1997), and Seager (1995), demonstrate a number of distinct
arguments for, and against, panpsychism. Skrbina (2005)
identifies a total of six objections and twelve supporting
arguments, though with some overlap between them. Below is a
summary of the more compelling arguments and objections.
The first major argument for panpsychism is also one of the
oldest: the Argument from Continuity. This argument, which is
expressed in a variety of forms, claims that there is some
critical thread of continuity among all things—a thread
intimately related to the processes of mind. The particular
entity that is continuous varies, but is typically expressed
as either a substance or as a common form, structure,
or function. We humans possess mind-like qualities
that are a direct consequence of some substance, form, or
structure; hence all things, to the degree that they share
this common nature, have a corresponding share in
mentality.
This is best illustrated through examples. The earliest
such argument was presented by Anaximenes, with his
arche of pneuma. As a kind of airy spirit, the pneuma
accounted for our own minds but also permeated and sustained
the entire cosmos and all things in it. Anaxagoras’ nous, and
Heraclitus’ pyr, or fire, served a similar purpose, and
thus were also arguments by continuity. Empedocles and Plato
argued for pluralist, rather than monist, continuity. They saw
all things as composed of the four elements (fire, air, water,
and earth), and these elements were either souls in themselves
(Empedocles), or the basis for human, cosmic, and other soul
(Plato).
Among the German philosophers, Herder’s Kraft (force
or power) played a similar role. For Schopenhauer, the will
was our essential inner nature; since we are simply an “object
among objects,” all things must possess an inner will. Fechner
(1848/1946) emphasized the functional similarity between
humans and, for example, plants. Though obviously different in
many ways, living plants share essential functional qualities
with humans, both representing a kind of living dynamism that
suggests an inner striving and desire, a joy in being alive.
Later, the American philosopher Dewey made a related case,
stressing the continuity between living and nonliving
systems.
At the heart of these arguments is an attempt to draw a
fundamental analogy between humans and nonhumans. Some
philosophers prefer to call such arguments “analogical,” and
for good reason. But this is not sufficiently precise. Nearly
every conceivable argument for panpsychism must start from the
fact of our own human mind, and draw some analogy from that.
It is the nature of the analogy that distinguishes the
arguments. The continuity arguments are one particular form of
analogical thinking, and hence deserve special
designation.
In order to oppose an argument by continuity, one must
either refute the existence of the substance or structure, or
deny that it relates to mind in any fundamental way—the latter
being the more common approach. The critic may argue that the
continuity analogy simply fails to hold; hence we have the
Inconclusive Analogy objection. Such a critic typically would take
the extreme cases of a human versus a rock or an atom, and
argue that no relevant analogy can be made. But of course,
what seems obvious in the extreme cases is less so when one
examines the intermediate points; it is there that the critic
has to make his case.
A second general argument for panpsychism, also dating back
to ancient Greece, relates to the notion of emergence of mind.
The Greeks developed the idea that ex nihilo, nihil
fit: out of nothing comes nothing. We thus get the
argument that mind cannot arise from no-mind, and hence that
mind must have been present at the very origin of things. This
is the Argument from Non-Emergence. An extended treatment
follows in Section 4.
The Non-Emergence Argument is countered by claiming,
naturally, that emergence of mind is in fact intelligible and
explicable (this is the majority view, but no
philosopher to date has succeeded in giving a widely-accepted explanation for it). Popper (1977) was perhaps the
first to use emergence as an objection to panpsychism, but
recently an entire volume was dedicated to this topic; see
Strawson, et al (2006).
With the advent of Darwin’s theory of evolution in
the mid-1800’s there came new support for both continuity and
non-emergence arguments. If humans evolved from lower animals,
they from single-celled creatures, and they in turn from
nonliving matter, then the continuity of beings suggests a
continuity of the fundamental qualities of experience,
awareness, and mind. Evolutionary continuity over time makes difficult
any attempt to define the supposed point in history at which
mind suddenly appeared. Haeckel (1892) was the first to offer
an evolutionary argument, but Paulsen, Royce, Waddington, and
Rensch made essentially the same claim.
Others expressed it differently. There is, they said, no
place within the hierarchy of organism complexity—the
so-called phylogenetic chain—where one can “draw a line” to
distinguish those with mind from those without. Clifford
(1874) was perhaps the first to put it this way:
[I]t is impossible for anybody to point out the
particular place...where [absence of consciousness] can be
supposed to have taken place. [...] [E]ven in the very
lowest organisms, even in the Amoeba...there is something or
other, inconceivably simple to us, which is of the same
nature with our own consciousness... [Furthermore] we cannot
stop at organic matter, [but] we are obliged to
assume...that along with every motion of matter, whether
organic or inorganic, there is some fact which corresponds
to the mental fact in ourselves (pp. 60-61).
Others, including Globus, Chalmers (1996), and Rensch, have
argued in similar terms.
To counter this argument one must identify a plausible point at
which to break the hierarchical chain. Where, and why, does
the continuity suddenly fail to hold? All agree that it holds,
to some degree, for higher mammals, such as chimpanzees and
dolphins. If the critic believes it to fail with rocks and
atoms, he must explain this discrepancy—otherwise the
objection is invalid. To date few have attempted this. Tye
(2000: 171) is one exception; he draws the line at fish and
honey bees, which, he says, are the simplest beings that experience a kind of “phenomenal
consciousness.” Whether his rationale for this line is
acceptable is an open question.
Two final objections bear mentioning. First is the Not
Testable, or No Signs, objection: there is no empirical
evidence, nor any conceivable test, that could point to the
presence of mind in lesser beings. McGinn (1997) and Seager
(1995) have raised this point, among others. Yet it is hard to
see what might actually count as valid evidence of mind. As
Royce and Peirce have observed, simpler minds may appear to us
as law-like phenomena. Analogy and rational thinking about
metaphysical continuity are all we have to go on. Given the
conceptual difficulty in determining, with certainty, the
existence of minds in other human beings, one should not be
surprised that definitive evidence of lesser minds is lacking.
Certainly there is, we may say, an epistemological gap here,
in that our knowledge is deficient; but this does not imply an
ontological gap, that is, an absence of mind in other
things.
Lastly we have the Combination Problem: If mind is supposed
to exist in atoms or cells, then higher-order minds, such as
humans have, must be some kind of combination or sum of these
lesser minds. But it is inconceivable how such a summing would
work and how it might account for the richness of experience
that we all feel. Because panpsychism cannot account for
higher mind, the objector says, it must be false.
We should first note that this is not an objection to
panpsychism per se, but only to the particular theory that
says that higher-order mind must be composed of lower-order
mental elements. Granting this, there remains the general
question of the relation between higher- and lower-order minds
within the same being. As such, the Combination Problem may be
better seen as a call for details.
The problem was first addressed by Leibniz in the late
1600’s. His panpsychist theory of monads allowed for a single
dominant monad to unify the collective, and serve as the mind
of the body. Kant, in an
early work Dreams of a Spirit-Seer, criticized
Leibniz’s theory and thus became the first to employ the
Combination Problem against panpsychism. In 1890 William James
raised the issue, in objection to Clifford’s “mind-stuff” form
of panpsychism—though by 1909 he had changed his mind, and
stopped viewing combination as an insurmountable hurdle. More
recently Seager (1995) highlights the combination problem as
one of particular importance, as do a number of contributors
to Strawson, et al (2006).
4. Panpsychism vs. Emergentism
The issue of emergence of mind is important because it is
the mutually exclusive counterpart to panpsychism: either you
are a panpsychist, or you are an emergentist. Either mind was
present in things from the very beginning or it appeared
(emerged) at some point in the history of evolution. If,
however, emergence is inexplicable, or is less viable, then
one is left with the panpsychist alternative. This line of
reasoning, as mentioned above, is the argument from
Non-Emergence.
To briefly recap the historical forms of this argument: it
was first formulated by Epicurus circa 300 B.C.E. As we have
seen, he argued that the mental quality called will could
not arise from non-will, and therefore that the atoms from
which everything was made had to possess a kind of will
themselves. Will cannot emerge ex nihilo, and thus is
present in the very constituents of matter.
Others were likewise convinced by this approach. Telesio
held that “nothing can give what it does not possess,” and
thus it is inconceivable that mind arises from no-mind.
Patrizi believed, similarly, that nothing can be in the effect
that is not in the cause; hence, the elements themselves must
have life and soul, which they in turn grant to all things. In
1620 Campanella wrote: “If the animals are sentient…and
sentience does not come from nothing, the elements whereby
they and everything else are brought into being must be said
to be sentient, because what the result has the cause must
have” (in Dooley, 1995: 39).
The German panpsychists also found this argument
compelling. Fechner argued that “animate beings cannot arise
from inanimate.” Paulsen examined the question, “Whence did
psychical life arise?” His answer: it did not arise, but was
present at the origin of things. The sudden appearance of a
mental realm “would be an absolute world-riddle; it would mean
a creation out of nothing” (1892: 100).
The Non-Emergence argument resurfaced in the late twentieth
century with the work of zoologist Sewall Wright. In his 1977
article “Panpsychism and Science” he argued that brute
emergence of mind would be a kind of inexplicable miracle in
the natural order of things: “Emergence of mind from no mind
at all is sheer magic” (p. 82). Thomas Nagel flirted with this
argument in his “Panpsychism” essay (1979), but opted not to
follow through on all the implications.
The basic problem is this: emergence seems, at first
glance, to be a reasonable enough idea, but when pressed for details
it comes up sorely lacking. In fact, emergence of mind is very
difficult to sensibly explain. Mind is not like
five-fingered-ness, or warm-bloodedness. These things,
which clearly did emerge, are ontologically unlike mind. They
are simply reconfigurations of existing physical matter,
whereas mind is of a different ontological order. It is too
fundamental an aspect of existence to be comparable to
ordinary biological structural features.
Furthermore, emergence of mind is not just some fact of the
distant evolutionary past; it must recur every day, in, for
example, the development of a human embryo. That is, if a
human egg is utterly without mind, and a newborn infant has
one, when in the ontogenetic process does mind emerge? Why
just there? So in addition to the phylogenetic (historical)
emergence problem, we have the related ontogenetic problem as
well.
Given that there are very few panpsychists in the world,
most everyone is an emergentist. But, as Galen Strawson (2006)
has recently emphasized, emergentism is not a forgone
conclusion. In fact, it is highly dubious. His piece
“Realistic Monism: Why Physicalism Entails Panpsychism”
presses this point with notable urgency, and offers the most
detailed and complete version of the Non-Emergence argument to
date. If one is not a panpsychist, then one necessarily
believes that only some subset of creatures is privileged to
possess mind. The vast remainder of nature, then, is utterly
non-mental. This, Strawson observes, is pure presumption:
“there is absolutely no evidence whatsoever” (p. 20) for a
non-mental component of reality. We simply assume it to be
so.
Strawson’s argument, in a nutshell, is this:
-
There is one ultimate reality to the universe (“realistic
physicalism,” as he calls it).
-
Mental (that is, experiential) phenomena are a part of
this monistic reality. Therefore, experiential phenomena are
physical phenomena, rightly understood.
-
Radical-kind, or brute, emergence is impossible; mental
phenomena cannot arise from any purely non-mental stuff.
-
Therefore, the one reality and all things in it are
necessarily experiential.
If we are to be physicalists, Strawson says, then let us be
real physicalists and take the implications seriously. When we
do so, we find that “something akin to panpsychism is not
merely one possible form of realistic physicalism, but the
only possible form, and hence, the only possible form of
physicalism tout court” (p. 9).
Strawson tackles head-on those who implicitly endorse
emergence. He asks, “Does this conception of emergence make
sense? I think that it is very, very hard to understand what
it is supposed to involve. I think that it is incoherent, in
fact, and that this general way of talking of emergence has
acquired an air of plausibility…for some simply because it has
been appealed to many times in the face of a seeming mystery”
(p. 12). He gives a number of examples of putative emergence,
showing that each is really unintelligible. His slogan:
“emergence can’t be brute,” that is, higher-order mind can
emerge from lower-order, but mind cannot possibly emerge from
no-mind. “Brute emergence is by definition a miracle every
time it occurs,” which is rationally inconceivable.
Panpsychism thus offers a kind of resolution to the problem
of emergence, and is supported by several other arguments as
well. The viability of panpsychism is no longer really in
question. At issue is the specific form it might take, and
what its implications are. Panpsychism suggests a radically
different worldview, one that is fundamentally at odds with the
dominant mechanistic conception of the universe. Arguably, it
is precisely this mechanistic view—which sees the universe and
everything in it as a kind of giant machine—that lies at the
root of many of our philosophical, sociological, and
environmental problems. Panpsychism, by challenging this
worldview at its root, potentially offers new solutions to
some very old problems.
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