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Time has been studied by philosophers and scientists for 2,500
years, and thanks to this attention it is much better understood today.
Nevertheless, many issues remain to be resolved. Here is a short list of
the most important ones—what time actually is;
whether time exists when nothing is changing; what kinds of time travel are
possible; why time has an
arrow even though the dynamical laws of the microscopic
constituents of the universe appear to be incapable of distinguishing past and
future; whether the future and past are real; how to
analyze the metaphor of time's flow; whether the future will be
infinite; whether there was time before the
Big Bang; whether tensed or tenseless concepts are semantically basic; what is
the proper formalism or logic for capturing the special role that time plays in
reasoning; and what are the neural mechanisms that account for our experience
of time. Some of these issues will be resolved by scientific advances
alone, but others require philosophical analysis. Philosophers of time are deeply divided on the question on what sort of
ontological differences there are among the present, past and future.
There are three competing theories. Presentists argue that
necessarily only present objects and present experiences are real;
and we
conscious beings recognize this in the special "vividness" of our present
experience. According to the growing-universe theory, the past and present are both real, but the future is not. The
third and more popular theory is that there are no significant ontological
differences among present, past and future because the differences are merely
subjective. This view is called
"eternalism" or "the block universe theory."
This controversy raises the issue of tenseless versus
tensed theories of time.
Eternalism or the block universe theory implies a tenseless theory. The earliest
version of this theory implied that tensed
terminology can be removed and replaced with tenseless
terminology. For example, the future-tensed sentence, "The Lakers will win the
basketball game" might be analyzed as, "The Lakers do win at time t, and
time t happens after the time of this utterance." The future tense
has been removed, and the verb phrases "do win" and "happens
after" are tenseless logically, although they are grammatically in the present
tense. Advocates of a
tensed theory of time object to this strategy and say that tenseless terminology is not semantically basic but
should be analyzed in
tensed terms, and that tensed facts are needed to make the tensed statements be
true. For
example, a tensed theory might imply that no adequate account of the
present tensed fact that it's now midnight can be given without irreducible
tensed properties such as presentness or now-ness. So, the
philosophical debate is over whether tensed concepts have semantical priority
over untensed concepts, and whether tensed facts have ontological priority over untensed
facts.
This article
explores both what is now known about time and what is controversial and unresolved,
by addressing the following questions:
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. What Should a Philosophical Theory of Time Do?
Should it define "time"? Yes, but it is improper to demand that we
define our term "time" as a prelude to saying anything more about time,
in large part because as we've learned more about time our definition of time
has evolved.
What we really want is to build a comprehensive, philosophical theory of time
that helps us understand time, say, by helping us solve problems about time.
We don't want to start building this theory by adopting a definition of time
that prejudices the project from the beginning.
Although there are theories of how to solve a specific problem about time, it
is always better to knit together solutions to several problems. Ideally,
the goal is to produce a theory of time that will solve in a systematic way the
constellation of problems involving time. What are those problems?
One is to clarify the relationship between time
and the mind. Does time exist for beings that have no minds? It
is easy to confuse time itself with the perception of time.
Another problem is to decide which of our intuitions about time should be
retained. Some of these intuitions may reflect deep
insights into the nature of time, and others may be faulty ideas inherited from
our predecessors. It is not obvious which is which. For one
example, if we have the intuition that time flows, but our science implies
otherwise, then which view
should get priority? Philosophers of time must solve the problem of how to
treat our intuitions.
A third problem for a philosophical theory of time is to clarify what physical science presupposes
and implies about time. A later section of this article
examines this topic. Most all philosophers of time claim that philosophical
theories should be consistent with physical science, or, if not, then they must
accept the heavy burden of proof to justify the inconsistency.
A philosophical theory of time should describe the relationship
between instants and events. Does the instant that we label as "11:01
A.M." for a certain date exist independently of the events that occur
then? In other words, can time exist if no event is happening? This
question or problem raises the thorny metaphysical issue of absolute
vs. relational theories of time.
A theory of time should address the question of time's apparent
direction. If the projectionist in the movie theater (cinema) shows a film of
cream being added into black coffee but runs the film backwards, we
in the audience can immediately tell that events couldn't have
occurred this way. We recognize the arrow of
time because we know about the one-directional processes in
nature. This arrow becomes less and less apparent to us viewers
as the film subject gets smaller and smaller and the time interval
gets shorter and shorter until finally we are viewing processes that could just
as easily go the other way, at which point the arrow of time has disappeared. Philosophers disagree about the explanation
of the arrow. Could it be a consequence of the laws of science? The arrow appears to be very basic for understanding
nature, yet it is odd that asymmetries in time don't appear in the principal, basic dynamical laws of physics.
Could the arrow of time reverse some day? Philosophers wonder what
life would be like in some far off corner of the universe if the
arrow of time were reversed there. Would people there walk
backwards up steps while remembering the future?
Another philosophical problem about time concerns the two questions,
"What is the present, and why does it move into the past?" If we know what
the present is, then we ought to be able to answer the question, "How long does the present last?"
Regarding the "movement" of the present into the past, many philosophers are suspicious of this notion of the
flow of time, the march of time. They doubt whether it is a property of time as
opposed to being some feature of human perception. Assuming time does
flow, is the flow regular? With some theories of time, we can make sense of
Friday seconds lasting much longer than Thursday seconds, as the flow of Friday
time slows to a crawl.
Some philosophers doubt whether the future and past are as real as the present, the feature that is referred to by the word "now."
A famous philosophical argument says that, if the future were real, then it would be fixed now, and we
would not have the freedom to affect that future. Since we do have that
freedom, the future can't be real. Some philosophers consider this to be a
clever, but faulty argument.
For a last example of a philosophical issue regarding time, is time
a fundamental feature of nature, or does it emerge from more basic
features--in analogy to the way the smoothness of water flow emerges from the complicated behavior of the underlying atoms?
From what more basic feature does time emerge?
A full theory of time should address this constellation of
philosophical issues about time. Narrower theories of time will focus on
resolving a few members of this constellation, but the long-range goal is to
knit together these theories into a full, systematic, detailed theory of time.
2. How is Time Related to Mind?
Physical time is public time, the time that clocks are designed to measure. Psychological time is private time. It is
perhaps best understood as
awareness of physical time.
Psychological time passes swiftly for us while we are enjoying reading a book, but it slows
dramatically if we are waiting anxiously for the water to boil on the stove.
The slowness is probably due to focusing our attention on shorter intervals of
physical time. Some philosophers claim that psychological time is completely transcended in the
mental state called "nirvana." Meanwhile, the clock by the stove is measuring physical time
and is not affected by anybody's awareness. When a physicist defines speed to be the
rate of change of position with respect to time, the term "time"
refers to physical time. Physical time is more
basic for helping us understand our shared experiences in the world, and so it is more useful than psychological time for doing science.
But psychological time is vitally important for understanding many human thought processes.
We even have an awareness of the passage of physical time during our sleep, and
we awake knowing we've slept for one night, not for one month. But if we've
been under a general anesthetic and wake up, we have no sense of how long we've
been unconscious. Psychological time stopped.
Within the field of cognitive science, one
wants to know what are the neural mechanisms that account not only for our
experience of time's flow, but also for our ability to place events into the
proper time order. See (Damasio, 2006) for further discussion of the
progress in this area of cognitive science. The most surprising scientific discovery about psychological time
is Benjamin Libet's experiments in the 1970s showing that the brain events involved in
initiating free choices occur about a third of a second before we are aware of
the choice. Before Libet's work, it was universally agreed that a person
is aware of deciding to act freely, then later the body initiates the action.
Psychologists are interested in whether we can speed up our minds relative to
physical time. If so, we might become mentally more productive,
get more high quality decision making done per fixed amount of physical time,
learn more per minute. Several avenues have been explored: using drugs such
as cocaine and amphetamines, undergoing extreme experiences such as jumping
backwards off a tall tower with bungee cords attached to the legs, and trying
different forms of meditation. So far, none of these avenues have led to
success productivity-wise.
Any organism's sense
of time is subjective, but is the time that is sensed also subjective, a
mind-dependent phenomenon? If it were subjective in the way judgments of
good food or good music are subjective, then it would be miraculous that
everyone can so easily agree on the ordering of public events in time.
For example, first, Einstein was born, then he went to school, then he died. Everybody
agrees that it happened in this order: birth, school, death. No other
order. The agreement on time order for so many phenomena is part of the
reason that many philosophers and scientists believe physical time is an objective
phenomenon not dependent on being consciously experienced. The other part
of the reason time is believed to be objective is that our universe has a large number of
different processes that bear consistent time relations, or frequency
of occurrence relations, to each other. For example, the frequency of
a fixed-length pendulum is a constant multiple of the half life of a
specific radioactive uranium isotope; the relationship doesn't change
as time goes by (at least not much and not for a long time). The
existence of these sorts of relationships makes our system of
physical laws much simpler than it otherwise would be, and it makes
us more confident that there is something objective we are referring to with
the time-variable in those laws.
If there were no minds, would physical time be absent, too? Aristotle raised this
metaphysical question when he said, "Whether, if soul (mind) did not exist, time would exist or not, is a
question that may fairly be asked; for if there cannot be someone to count
there cannot be anything that can be counted..." [Physics,
chapter 14]. He doesn't answer his own question
because, he says rather profoundly, it depends on whether time is the
conscious numbering of movement or instead is just the capability of
movement's being numbered were consciousness to exist. Aristotle's
distinction foreshadows the modern distinction between psychological
time and physical time.
St. Augustine, adopting a
subjective view of time,
said time is nothing in reality but exists only in the mind's
apprehension of that reality. Henry of Ghent and Giles of Rome both
said time exists in reality as a mind-independent continuum, but is
distinguished into earlier and later parts only by the mind. In the
11th century, the Persian philosopher Avicenna doubted the existence
of physical time, arguing that time exists only in the mind due to
memory and expectation. In the 13th century, Duns Scotus disagreed with all
these philosophers and recognized
both physical and psychological time.
At the end of the 18th century, Kant suggested
a subtle relationship between time and mind--that our mind actually structures
our perceptions so that we know a priori that time is like a
mathematical line. Time is, on this theory, a form of conscious
experience.
In the 20th century, the philosopher of science Bas van Fraassen described
physical time by saying, "There
would be no time were there no beings capable of reason" just as "there would be
no food were there no organisms, and no teacups if there were no tea drinkers,"
and no cultural objects without a culture.
The controversy in metaphysics between idealism and realism is
that, for the idealist, nothing exists independently of the mind. If
this controversy is settled in favor of idealism, then time, too,
would have that subjective feature--physical time as well as
psychological time.
It has been suggested by some philosophers that Einstein's theory of
relativity, when confirmed, showed us that time depends on the observer, and
thus that time is subjective, or dependent on the mind. This error is
probably caused by Einstein's use of the term "observer." Einstein's
theory does imply that the duration of an event isn't absolute but depends on
the observer's frame of reference or coordinate system. But what Einstein
means by "observer's frame of reference" is merely a perspective or framework
from which measurements could be made. The "observer" does not have to be a
conscious being or have a mind; it could be a clock on a rock. Einstein's
point is that a clock on this rock might measure a different duration than a
second clock in a rocket hurtling past the rock. Einstein isn't making a
point about mind-dependence.
3. What is Time?
One way to answer the question "What is time?" is to
declare that it is what accurate clocks measure. This is correct, but it
doesn't tell us enough. We want something "deeper."
The most popular "deep" answer to the question "What is physical time?" is that it
is a special system of relations among instantaneous events. It is what
underlies our temporal claims that Newton lived before Einstein and at
the same time as Leibniz yet a lot longer than anyone who died as a
teenager. (The relations are in italics although the events in this example are
not instantaneous; but longer events are considered to be composed of
instantaneous events.)
Actually this is time for a given frame of reference
because the relationships can change if we change the frame of reference. This is the
answer offered by Adolf Grünbaum who applies the contemporary mathematical theory of continuity to physical processes,
which implies that time is a linear continuum.
How do we tell whether this is the correct answer to our question? To be convinced, we need to be told what the
relevant terms mean, such as "certain system of relations." In
addition, we need to be presented with a theory of time
implying that time is this system of relations; and we need to be shown how that
theory adequately addresses the many
features that are required for a successful theory of time.
Finally, we need to compare this theory to its alternatives. This article won't carry out these tasks.
A different, but popular answer to the question "What is time?" is that time is the form
of becoming. To assess this answer, which is from Alfred North Whitehead,
we need to be told what the term "form of becoming" means; we need to be
presented with a detailed theory of time implying that time is the form of
becoming; and we need to investigate how it addresses those many features
required for a successful theory of time. A third theory of time is
Michael Dummett's constructive model of time; he argues that time is a
composition of intervals rather than of durationless instants. The model
is constructive in the sense that
there do not exist any times
which aren't detectable in principle by a physical process.
The metaphysical attitude being used here in assessing whether Grünbaum's,
Dummett's and
Whitehead's answers are correct is the attitude that fruitful problem solving is
a guide to what exists. It is the same attitude that declares zero to
exist because zero is so useful for solving the numerical equation x + b = c in
the special case when the two numbers b and c happen to be equal, and because
having solutions to these sorts of equations is indispensable to the best
scientific theories.
If physical time and psychological time are two different kinds of time, then two answers are required to the
question "What is time?" and
some commentary is required regarding their relationships, such as whether one is
more
fundamental. Many philosophers of science argue that physical time is more fundamental even though psychological time is discovered first by each of us as
we
grow out of our childhood, and even though psychological time was discovered first as
we human beings
evolved from our animal ancestors. The remainder of this article focuses more on
physical time than psychological time.
Another answer to our question, "What is time?" is that
time is whatever the time variable t is denoting in the
best-confirmed and most fundamental theories of current science. "Time" is
given an implicit definition this way. Nearly all philosophers
would agree that we do learn something about physical time by looking at the
behavior of the time variable in these theories; but they complain that
the nature of
physical time can be revealed only with a philosophical theory of time that
addresses the many philosophical issues that scientists don't
concern themselves with.
Some philosophers, notably
Zeno and
McTaggart, answer the question, "What is time?" by replying that it is nothing
because it doesn't exist. In a similar vein, the early 20th century
English philosopher F. H. Bradley argues, "Time, like space, has most evidently
proved not to be real, but a contradictory appearance....The problem of change
defies solution." However, most philosophers agree that time does exist.
They just can't agree on what it is.
Whatever time is, it is not "time." One has four letters; the other
does not. Nevertheless, it might help us understand time if we improved
our understanding of the sense and reference of the word "time." Should the proper answer to the
question "What is time?" produce a definition of the word as a means
of capturing its sense? Definitely not--if the definition must be some analysis that provides a simple paraphrase in all
its occurrences. There are just too many varied occurrences of the word:
time out, behind the times, in the nick of time, and so forth.
But how about a definition that is more realistic? Might it
be helpful to explore the grammar of the term "time" in either ordinary
language or the physics literature?
Most philosophers today would agree with A. N. Prior who remarked
that, "there are genuine
metaphysical problems, but I think you have to talk about grammar at least a
little bit in order to solve most of them." However, do we learn
enough
about what time is when we learn about the grammatical intricacies of the word?
Ordinary-language philosophers are especially interested in time talk, in what
Wittgenstein called the "language game" of discourse about time.
Wittgenstein's expectation is that by drawing attention to ordinary ways of
speaking about time we will dissolve rather than answer our philosophical
question. But most philosophers of time are unsatisfied with this approach
and have the goal of uncovering important features about time
itself.
That was Aristotle's goal
when he provided an early, careful answer to our question, "What is time?" by
declaring that "time is the measure of change" [Physics,
chapter 12], but he emphasizes "that time is not change
[itself]"
because a change "may be faster or slower, but not time..." [Physics,
chapter 10]. For example, a specific change such as the descent of a leaf can
be faster or slower, but time itself can't be faster or slower. Aristotle
advocates what is now referred to as the
relational theory of time because he believed that "there is no time apart from
change...." [Physics, chapter 11]. Aristotle was clear that
time is not discrete but "is continuous.... In respect of size there is
no minimum; for every line is divided ad infinitum. Hence it
is so with time" [Physics, chapter 11].
René Descartes had a very different answer to "What is time?" He argued that a material body has the
property of spatial extension but no inherent capacity for temporal endurance,
and that God by his continual action sustains (or re-creates) the body at each
successive instant.
In the 17th century, the English physicist Isaac Barrow rejected Aristotle's
linkage between time and change. Barrow said time is something which exists
independently of motion or change and which existed even before God created the
matter in the universe. Barrow's
student, Isaac Newton, agreed that the relational theory of time is incorrect. Newton argued very specifically that
time and space are an infinitely large container for all events, and
that the container exists with or without the events. He added that space and time are
not material substances, but are like substances in not being
dependent on matter or motions or anything else except God.
Gottfried Leibniz
objected. He argued that time is not an entity existing independently
of actual events. He insisted that Newton had
underemphasized the fact that time necessarily involves an ordering of
any pair of
non-simultaneous events. This is why time "needs" events, so to
speak. Leibniz added that this overall order is time.
In the 18th century, Immanuel Kant
said time and space are forms that the mind projects upon the
external things-in-themselves. He spoke of our mind structuring our
perceptions so that space always has a Euclidean geometry, and time
has the structure of the mathematical line. Kant's idea that
time is a form of apprehending phenomena is probably best
taken as suggesting that we have no direct perception of time but
only the ability to experience things and events in time. Some
historians distinguish perceptual space from physical space and say
that Kant was right about perceptual space. It's difficult, though,
to get a clear concept of perceptual space. If physical space and
perceptual space are the same thing, then Kant is claiming we know a
priori that physical space is Euclidean. With the discovery of
non-Euclidean geometries in the 1820s, and with increased doubt about
the reliability of Kant's method of transcendental proof, the view
that truths about space and time are apriori truths began to lose
favor.
In 1924, Hans Reichenbach
defined time order in terms of possible cause. Event A happens before
event B if A could have caused B but B couldn't have caused A. This
was the first causal theory of time, that was originally suggested by Leibniz
who said, "If of two elements which are not simultaneous one comprehends the
cause of the other, then the former is considered as preceding, the
latter as succeeding." The usefulness of the causal theory depends
on a clarification of the notorious notions of causality and possibility without
producing a circular explanation that presupposes an understanding of time
order. Reichenbach's idea was that causal order can be explained in terms of the
"fork asymmetry". The asymmetry is due to the fact that outgoing processes from
a common center tend to be correlated with one another, but incoming processes
to a common center are uncorrelated. [Do you remember ever tossing a rock into a still pond?
There’s a correlation among all sorts of later events
such as the rock’s disappearing under the water, the water surface getting
wavy, your hearing a splash sound, and a little later the water surging
slightly up the bank at the edge of the pond, and even of the pond being
warmer. Imagine what the initial conditions at the edge of a pond must be like
to produce correlated, incoming, concentric water waves that would expel the
rock, leave the water surface smooth, have the sound waves rush out of your
ear, and cool the pond to the temperature it was before the rock hit.] Some philosophers argue that
temporal asymmetry, but not temporal priority, can be analyzed in terms of
causation. But even if Reichenbach were
correct that temporal priority can be analyzed in terms of causation, the
question remains whether time itself can be analyzed in those terms.
The usefulness of the
causal theory also depends on a refutation of David Hume's view that
causation is simply a matter of constant conjunction [that is, always being
together]. For Hume, there is nothing metaphysically deep
about causes preceding their effects; it's just a matter of
convention that we use the terms "cause" and "effect" to distinguish
the earlier and later members of a pair of events which are related
by constant conjunction.
During history, a variety of answers have been given to the question of
whether time is like a line or, instead, like a circle. The concept of linear
time first appeared in the writings of the Hebrews and the Zoroastrian Iranians.
The Roman writer Seneca also advocated linear time. Plato and most other
Greeks and Romans believed time to be motion and believed cosmic motion was
cyclical, but
this wasn't envisioned as
requiring any detailed endless repetition such as the multiple rebirths
of Socrates. However, the Pythagoreans and some Stoic philosophers did adopt this drastic
position.
With circular time, you can be assured that after your death you will be
reborn. The future will become the past. If time is like this, then
the question arises as to whether there would be an endless number of times when
each state of the world reoccurred, or whether, accepting Leibniz's Principle of
the Identity of Indiscernibles, each supposedly repeating state of the world
would occur just once because each state would be not be discernible from the
repeated state.
Islamic and Christian theologians
adopted the Greek common sense idea that time is linear and the Jewish-Zoroastrian
idea that the universe was created at a definite moment in the past. Augustine
emphasized that human experience is a one-way journey from Genesis to
Judgment, regardless of any recurring patterns or cycles in nature.
In the Medieval period, Thomas
Aquinas agreed. Nevertheless, it was not until 1602 that the concept of linear
time was more clearly formulated--by the English
philosopher Francis Bacon. In 1687, Newton advocated linear time when he represented time mathematically by using a line
rather than a circle. The concept of linear time was promoted by Barrow, Leibniz,
Locke and Kant. In 19th century Europe, the idea of linear time
became dominant in both science and philosophy.
However, in the twentieth century,
Gödel and others
discovered solutions to the equations of Einstein's general theory of relativity that allowed closed loops of
proper
time. These causal loops or closed curves
in spacetime allow
you to go
forward continuously in time until you arrive back into your past. You
might even meet your younger self. If so, some definitions
of "person" will need to be revised to allow for this. The logic of the term
"time" that is embedded in our time talk does not rule out a nonlinear
structure for time, but there is no reason to believe (physical) time is actually like this or that anything
has gone back in time.
Is time a basic concept, or does it depend on
something more basic? We might put this question as whether facts about time
supervene on more basic facts. Sound in the air depends on changes in the molecules of
the air, so those changes are more basic than sound.
Thanks to Minkowski in 1908 we believe spacetime is more basic than time, but is
spacetime itself basic? One camp says that both space and time are the product of some micro-substrate, although there is no agreed upon theory of what the
substrate is. Another camp says that space is not basic but time is.
In 2004, after winning the Nobel Prize
in physics, David Gross expressed the views of this second camp:
Everyone in string theory is convinced...that spacetime is doomed. But we don't know what it's replaced by. We have
an enormous amount of evidence that space is doomed. We even have examples, mathematically well-defined examples, where space is an emergent concept.... But in my opinion the tough problem that has not yet been faced up to at all is, "How do we imagine a dynamical theory of physics in which time is emergent?"
...All the examples we have do not have an emergent time. They have emergent space but not time. It is very hard for me to imagine a formulation of physics without time as a primary concept because physics is typically thought of as predicting the future given the past. We have unitary time evolution. How could we have a theory of physics where we start with something in which time is never mentioned?
4. What does Science Require of Time?
a. Relativity and Quantum Mechanics
The general theory of relativity
and quantum mechanics
are the two most fundamental theories of physics, and the Big Bang theory is the
leading theory of cosmology. According to relativity and quantum mechanics, spacetime is,
loosely speaking, a collection of
points called "spacetime locations" where the universe's physical events occur.
Spacetime is four-dimensional and
a continuum,
and time is a distinguished, one-dimensional sub-space
of this continuum. Any interval of time--any duration--must be a linear continuum of instants
in which one event follows another from past to present to future. So, a
duration has a point-like structure similar to the structure of an interval of real numbers;
between any two instants there is another instant, and there are no gaps in the
sequence of instants.
This first response to the question "What does science require of time?" is
too simple. There are complications. There is an important
difference between the universe's cosmic time and a clock's
proper
time; and there is an
important difference between proper time
and a reference frame's coordinate
time. Most spacetimes can not have coordinate systems. Also, all
physicists believe that relativity and quantum mechanics are logically
inconsistent and need to be replaced by a theory of quantum gravity. A
theory of quantum gravity is likely to have radical implications for our
understanding of time, such as time and space losing their discreteness and even
their separate identities on the very smallest scale. Aristotle, Leibniz, Newton, and everyone else before Einstein, believed there was a frame-independent duration between two events.
For example, if the time interval between two
lightning flashes is 100 seconds on someone's accurate clock, then the
interval also is 100 seconds on your accurate clock, even if you are flying by
at an incredible speed. Einstein rejected this piece of common
sense in his 1905 special theory of relativity when he declared that
the time interval between two events depends on
the observer's reference frame. As Einstein expressed it, "Every
reference-body has its own particular time;
unless we are told the reference-body to which the statement of time
refers, there is no meaning in a statement of the time of an event."
Each reference frame, or reference-body, divides spacetime differently into its
time part and its space part.
In 1908, the mathematician Hermann Minkowski
had an original idea in metaphysics regarding space and time. He was
the first person to realize that spacetime is more
fundamental than time or space alone. As he put it, "Henceforth space by
itself, and time by itself, are doomed to fade away into mere
shadows, and only a kind of union of the two will preserve an
independent reality." The metaphysical assumption behind Minkowski's
remark is that what is "independently real" is what does not vary
from one reference frame to another. It's their
"union," what we now call "spacetime," that doesn't vary. It follows
that the division of events into the past ones, the present ones, and
the future ones is also not "independently real". However, space and time
are not completely equivalent even in relativity because time is a
"distinguished" sub-space of the 4-d spacetime continuum. Being
distinguished implies that time isn't just another 4th dimension of physical
space; it's a special dimension unlike the space dimensions, even when we
confine our attention to a single reference frame.
A coordinate system is a way of representing space and
time using numbers to represent spacetime points. Science confidently assigns numbers to times because, in any
reference frame, the happens-before order-relation on events is
faithfully reflected in the less-than order-relation on the time
numbers (dates) that we assign to events. In the fundamental theories
such as relativity and quantum mechanics, the values of the time
variable t are real numbers, not merely rational numbers. Each number
designates an instant of time, and time is a linear continuum of these instants
order by the happens-before relation, similar
to the mathematician's line segment that is ordered by the less-than relation. Therefore, if these fundamental theories
are correct, physical time is one-dimensional rather than two-dimensional, and
continuous rather than discrete. These features don't require time to be linear,
however, because a segment of a circle is also a linear continuum,
but there is no evidence for circular time, for causal loops or
worldlines that are closed curves in spacetime.
What about instants? A duration is an ordered set of instants, not a whole or sum of instants. That
is, instants are members of durations, not parts of them. Any duration is
infinitely divisible, and it endlessly divides into more intervals;
it never divides into instants. The parts of durations
are just more durations. The instant is
not part of the duration; instead, the singleton set of an instant is a subset
of the duration. Instants are like real numbers in that they are
boundaries of durations. They are locations in time, but they are "in" time as members are in sets, not
as parts are in wholes.
The ordering of instants by the happens-before relation, by temporal
precedence, is complete; and there are no gaps in the sequence of instants. Regarding the number of instants in any
(non-zero) duration, time's being a linear continuum implies
the ordered instants are
so densely packed that between any two there is a third, so that no
instant has a next instant. In fact, time's being a linear continuum implies
that there is a nondenumerable infinity of instants between any two instants. There is little doubt that the actual
temporal structure of events can be embedded in the real numbers, but
how about the converse? That is, to what extent is it known that the
real numbers can be adequately embedded into the structure of the
instants? The problem is that, although time is not quantized in
quantum theory, for times shorter than about 10-43
seconds, the so-called Planck time, science has no experimental
grounds for the claim that between any two events there is a third.
Instead, the justification is that the assumption of continuity is
convenient and useful, and that there are no better theories
available.
Because of quantum mechanical considerations, physicists agree
that the general theory of relativity must fail for durations shorter
than the Planck time, but they don't know just how it fails. Most importantly here,
there is no agreement among physicists as to whether the continuum
feature of time will be adopted in the future theory of quantum
gravity that will be created to take account of both gravitational
and quantum phenomena. The string theory of quantum gravity predicts
that time is continuous, but an alternative to string theory,
loop quantum gravity, does not. (See "Atoms of time.") Relativity theory challenges a great many of our
intuitive beliefs about time. The theory is inconsistent with the
common belief that the temporal order in which two events occur is independent
of the observer's point of reference. For events occurring at the same
place, relativity theory implies the order is absolute (independent
of the frame), but for distant events occurring close enough in time
to be in each other's absolute
elsewhere, event A can occur before event B in one reference
frame, but after B in another frame, and simultaneously with B in yet
another frame.
Science impacts our understanding of time in many other
fundamental ways. Relativity theory implies there is
time
dilation between one frame and another. For example, the faster a
clock moves, the slower it runs, relative to stationary clocks. Time
dilation shows itself when a speeding twin returns to find that his
(or her) Earth-bound twin has aged more rapidly. This surprising
dilation result has caused some philosophers to question the
consistency of relativity theory, arguing that, if motion is
relative, then from the perspective of the speeding twin, the speeding twin
should, instead, be the one who aged more rapidly. This argument is called the
twins paradox. Experts now are agreed that the
mistake is within the argument for the paradox, not within relativity
theory. As is shown in more detail in the Supplement of Frequently Asked
Questions, the argument fails to notice the radically different
relationships that each twin has to the rest of the universe as a
whole. In Einstein's relativity theory, the focus is often on proper time rather than
on a
global, coordinate time.
Proper time along a worldline in 4-d spacetime is the time elapsed by an
object having that worldline, as shown on an ideal clock having the same
worldline. In the twins paradox of special relativity, one twin's proper
time is very different than the other's.
There are two kinds of time dilation. Special relativity's time
dilation involves speed; general relativity's involves acceleration
and gravitational fields. Two ideally synchronized clocks need not
stay in synchrony if they undergo different accelerations or
different gravitational forces. We've already mentioned the clock that is taken
to the wine cellar. This gravitational time dilation would be especially
apparent if one of the two clocks were to fall into a
black
hole. A black hole can form when a star exhausts its nuclear fuel
and contracts so compactly that the gravitational force prevents
anything from escaping the hole, even light itself. The envelope of
no return surrounding the black hole is its event horizon. As a clock
falls toward a black hole, time slows on approach to the event
horizon, and it completely stops at the horizon (not just at the
center of the hole)--relative to time on a clock that remains safely
back on Earth. Every black hole brings an end to time inside itself.
If the microstructure of spacetime (near the Planck length which is much smaller
than the diameter of a proton) is a quantum foam of changing curvature of
spacetime with black holes forming and dissolving, then time loses its meaning
at this small scale. The philosophical implication is that time exists
only when we are speaking of regions large compared to the Planck length.
General Relativity theory may have even more profound implications for time.
In 1948, the logician Kurt
Gödel discovered radical solutions to Einstein's
equations, solutions in which there are closed timelike
curves, so that as one progresses forward in time along one of these curves one
arrives back at one's starting point. Gödel drew the conclusion that if matter is distributed so that there is Gödelian spacetime
(that is, with a preponderance of galaxies rotating in one direction rather than
another), then the universe
has no linear time. Reinforcing this conclusion, Stephen Hawking showed in
1969 that only if a general relativistic spacetime fails to have closed timelike
curves can it admit of a partition into spacelike 3-d slices.
b. The Big Bang
In 1922, the Russian physicist Alexander Friedmann predicted from
general relativity that the universe should be expanding. In 1927, the Belgian
physicist Georges Lemaitre suggested that galaxy movement could best be
accounted for by this expansion. And in 1929, the American astronomer
Edwin Hubble made careful observations of clusters of galaxies and confirmed
that the universe is undergoing a universal expansion. Atoms are not expanding;
our solar system is not expanding; even the cluster of galaxies to which the
Milky Way belongs is not expanding. But most every galaxy cluster is
moving away from the others. It's as if the clusters are exploding away from
each other, and in the future they will be very much farther away from each
other. Now, consider the past instead of the future. At any earlier
moment the universe was more compact. Projecting to earlier and earlier times,
and assuming that gravitation is the main force at work, the astronomers now
conclude that 13.7 billion years ago (plus or minus 1%) the universe was in a
state of nearly zero size and infinite density. Because all substances cool when
they expand, physicists believe the universe itself must have been cooling down
over the last 13.7 billion years, and so it begin expanding when it was
extremely hot. The Big Bang theory is a theory of how our universe evolved, how
it expanded and cooled from this beginning. This beginning process is
called the "Big Bang." As far as we knew back in the 20th century, the entire
universe was created in the Big Bang, and time itself came into existence "at
that time." So, asking what happened before the Big Bang was like asking
what on Earth is north of the North Pole. At least that's the best
response to this question assuming the classical theory of the Big Bang of the
20th century. With the appearance of the new theories of quantum gravity
and the cosmic landscape in the 21st century, the question has been resurrected as
legitimate.
In the literature in both physics and philosophy, descriptions of
the Big Bang often assume that a first event is also a first instant
of time and that spacetime did not exist outside the Big Bang. This
intimate linking of a first event with a first time is a
philosophical move, not something demanded by the science. It is not
even clear that it's correct to call the Big Bang an event. The Big Bang "event" is a singularity without space coordinates, but events
normally must have space coordinates. One response to this problem is
to alter the definition of "event" to allow the Big Bang to be an
event. Another response, from James Hartle and Stephen Hawking, is to
consider the past cosmic time-interval to be open rather than closed at t = 0. Looking back to the Big Bang is
then like following the positive real numbers back to ever smaller
positive numbers without ever reaching a smallest positive one. If Hartle and
Hawking are correct that time is actually like this, then the
universe had no beginning event, but it has a finite amount of past
time, and the term "the Big Bang" doesn't refer to any single event. But
in order to simplify the discussion ahead, this article will speak of
"the" Big Bang event as if it were a single event. The Big Bang theory in
some form or other is
accepted by the vast majority of astronomers, but it is not as firmly accepted
as is the theory of relativity.
There are serious difficulties in defending the Big Bang theory's
implications about the universe's beginning and the universe's future. Classical
Big Bang theory is based on the
assumption that the universal expansion of clusters of galaxies can
be projected all the way back. Yet physicists agree that the
projection must fail in the Planck era, that is, for all times less
than 10-43 seconds after "the" Big Bang. Therefore,
current science cannot speak with confidence about the nature of time
within the Planck era. If a
theory of quantum gravity does get confirmed, it should provide
information about the Planck era, and it may even allow physicists to
answer the question, "What caused the Big Bang?" The
scientifically radical, but theologically popular, answer, "God
caused the Big Bang, but He, himself, does not exist in time"
is a cryptic answer because it is not based on a well-justified and detailed
theory of who God is, how He caused the Big Bang, and how He can
exist but not be in time. It is also difficult to understand St.
Augustine's remark that "time itself was made by God." On the other hand,
for a person of faith, belief in their God is usually
stronger than belief in any scientific hypothesis, or in any epistemological
desire for a scientific justification of their remark about God, or in the
importance of satisfying any philosopher's demand for clarification.
Some physicists are advocating revision of the classical Big Bang theory in
order to allow for the "cosmic landscape" or "multiverse," in which there are
multiple Big Bangs in parallel universes and an infinite amount of time before
our Big Bang. See (Veneziano, 2006). In some of these universes there is
no time dimension. However, the landscape theory is not generally accepted by theoretical cosmologists.
c. Infinite Time
There are three ways to interpret the question of whether physical time is
infinite: (a) Was there an infinite amount of time in the universe's past? (b)
Is time infinitely divisible? (c) Will there be an infinite amount of time in
the future?
(a) Was there an infinite amount of time in the past? Aristotle argued
"yes," but by invoking the radical notion that God is "outside of time," St. Augustine
declared, "Time itself
being part of God's creation, there was simply no before!" So, for
theological reasons, Augustine declared time had a finite past. After
advances in astronomy in the late 19th and early 20th centuries, the question of the age of the
universe became a scientific question. With the acceptance of the
classical Big Bang theory, the amount of past time was judged to be less than 14
billion years because this is when the Big Bang began. The assumption is
that time does not exist independently of the spacetime relations exhibited by
physical events. Recently, however, the
classical Big Bang theory has been challenged. There could be an
infinite amount of time in the past according to some proposed, but as yet untested, theories of
quantum gravity based on the assumptions that general relativity theory fails to
hold for infinitesimal volumes. These theories imply that the beginning of the Big Bang was actually an expansion from a pre-existing
physical state.
There was never a singularity.
In that case our Big Bang could be just one bang among other
bangs throughout an infinite past of the landscape. For a discussion of these
controversial theories requiring an infinite past time,
see (Veneziano, 2006).
(b) Is time infinitely divisible? Yes, because general relativity and
quantum mechanics require time to be a continuum.
But the answer is no if these theories are eventually replaced by a relativistic
quantum mechanics that quantizes time. "Although there have been
suggestions that spacetime may have a discrete structure," Stephen Hawking said
in 1996, "I see no reason to abandon the continuum theories that have been so
successful."
(c) Will there be an infinite amount of time in the future? Probably. According to the classical
theory of the Big Bang, the answer depends on
whether events will keep occurring. The best estimate from the cosmologists
these days is that the expansion of the universe is accelerating and will continue forever. There
always will be the events of galaxies getting farther apart, and so time
will have an infinite duration in the future, even though gravity will continue to compact
much of the
matter into black holes.
There have been interesting speculations on how conscious life could continue
forever, despite the fact that the available energy for life will decrease as the universe
expands, and despite the fact that any life swept up into a black hole will reach
the center of the hole in a finite time at which point death will be certain.
For an introduction to these speculations, see
(Krauss and Starkman, 2002).
d. Atoms of Time In
the classical theories of relativity and quantum mechanics, time is not
quantized, but is a continuum having the character described
above. However, if certain, as yet untested, theories
attempting to unify relativity and quantum mechanics are correct--such as the
theory of loop quantum gravity--then time will come in discrete pieces or atoms
lasting about 10-43 second. There will be a shortest duration for any possible
event, and time will be "digital" rather than "analog."
5. What Kinds of
Time Travel are Possible?
In time travel, the traveler's journey, as judged by the traveler, takes a
different amount of time than the journey does as judged by those who don't take
the journey. That is, there is a disagreement between the traveler's inner
time or proper time and the external or coordinate time of those who don't take
the journey. Physically realistic time travel doesn't allow the external
time lapse to be zero; there is no "poofing" into the past or "poofing" into the
future. Most science fiction time travel is not physically realistic.
According to relativity theory, there are two ways to travel into another
person's future, by moving at high speed or by taking advantage of an intense
gravitational field. If you have
a fast enough spaceship, you can travel to the year 4,500 A.D. on Earth. You can
affect that future, not just view it.
But you can't get back. Also, your travel is to
someone else's future, not your own. You're always in your own present.
Relativity theory even permits you to travel back and meet yourself as a child.
You can meet yourself, but you can't change what's happened in the past, such as
preventing Hitler from gaining power in Nazi Germany.
There are several well known arguments against the physical possibility of
certain kinds of time travel, although none are generally considered to be
decisive. Time travel is impossible, some say, because if it were possible
we should have seen a lot of time travelers by now, but nobody has encountered
any time travelers. And time travel is impossible because when time
travelers go back and attempt to change history they must always botch their
attempts to change anything, and it will appear to the rest of us at the time as if nature
is conspiring against them. Since we've never witnessed this apparent
conspiracy of nature, there's no time travel.
The most popular kind of time machine involves capturing a pre-existing wormhole
(a tunnel between two different places in space) and manipulating one mouth of
the wormhole to be at a different time than the other mouth. Stephen
Hawking and Kip Thorne claim that, although relativity theory permits a wormhole
to be used as a time machine, when quantum gravity considerations are taken into
account, the beam of vacuum fluctuations circulating in and out of the two
mouths of the wormhole will explode the wormhole and prevent its becoming a time
machine. See (Thorne, 1994, p. 521) Maybe other kinds of time travel to the past are impossible because
they allow the gaining of information
for free. For example, print out this article that you are reading. Enter a time
machine with it. Give me the article before I ever thought about time travel.
I then copy down the article and publish it in this encyclopedia. This all
seems to be consistent with relativity theory, but who
first came up with the information in this article? You had it before I did.
Probing the possibility of a contradiction in backwards time travel, the
American philosopher John Earman has described a rocket ship that carries a very
special time machine. The time machine is capable of firing a probe into its own
past. Suppose the ship is programmed to fire the probe on a certain date unless
a safety switch is on. Suppose the safety switch is programmed to be turned on
if and only if the "return" or "impending arrival" of the probe is (or has been)
detected by a sensing device on the ship. Does the probe get launched? It
is launched if and only if it is not launched. The way out of Earman's
paradox seems to require us to accept that (a) the universe conspires to keep
people from building the probe or the safety switch or an effective sensing
device, or (b) time travel probes must go so far back in time that they never
survive and make it back to the time when they were launched, or (c) time travel
into the past is impossible.
For more discussion of time travel, see the encyclopedia article "
Time Travel."
6. Is the Relational Theory of Time
Preferable to the Absolute Theory?
Absolute theories are theories that imply time exists independently of the
spacetime relations exhibited by physical events. Relational theories imply it
does not. Some absolute theories describe spacetime as being like a container
for events. The container exists with or without events in it. Relational
theories imply there is no container without contents. John Norton's
metaphors might help. Our universe is like a painting,
and absolute spacetime is like the painter's canvas. If you take away the paint (the
spacetime events) from the painting, you still have the canvas. Relational spacetime is
like citizenship. Take away the citizens (the spacetime events), and you have
no citizenship left.
Everyone agrees time cannot be measured without there being objects and
changes, but the present issue is whether it exists without objects and
changes. The absolute theories
are theories that spacetime could exist even if there were no physical objects
and events in the universe, but relational theories imply that spacetime is
nothing but objects, their events, and the spatiotemporal relationships among
them.
There are two senses of "absolute" that need to be distinguished.
As we are using the term, it means independent of the events. A second
sense of "absolute" means independent of observer or reference frame.
Einstein's theory implies there is no absolute time in this second sense.
Aristotle accepted absolute time in this second sense, but he rejected it in our
sense of being independent of events. Instead, Aristotle took the relationalist
position that, "neither does time exist without change [Physics, 218b]."
However, the battle lines were most clearly drawn in the early 18th century
when Leibniz argued for the relationalist position against Newton, who had
adopted an absolute theory of time. Leibniz's
principal argument against Newton is a reductio ad absurdum. Suppose Newton's absolute
space and time were to exist. But one could then imagine a universe
just like ours except with everything shifted five miles east and five minutes
earlier. However, there'd be no reason why this shifted universe does not exist and ours does.
Now we've arrived at a contradiction because, if there's no reason for our
universe over the shifted universe, then we have violated Leibniz's
Principle of Sufficient Reason: that there is an understandable reason for
everything being the way it is. So, Newton's absolute space and time do
not exist. In short, the trouble with Newton's absolutism is that it leads
to too many unnecessary possibilities.
Newton offered this two-part response:
(1) Leibniz is correct to accept the Principle of Sufficient Reason regarding
the rational intelligibility of the universe. But there don't have to be
knowable reasons for humans; God might have had His own sufficient reason
for creating the universe at a given place and time even though mere mortals cannot
comprehend His reasons. (2) The bucket thought-experiment shows that
acceleration relative to absolute space is detectable; thus absolute space is
real, and if absolute space is real, so is absolute time. Suppose we tie a bucket's
handle to a rope hanging down from a tree branch. Partially fill
the bucket
with water, and let it come to equilibrium. Notice that there's no relative motion between the bucket and
the water, and in this case the water surface is flat. Now spin the bucket,
and keep doing this until the angular velocity
of the water and the bucket are the same. In this second case there is
also no relative
motion between the bucket and the water, but now the water surface is concave.
So spinning makes a difference, but how can a relational theory explain the
difference? It can't, says Newton. When the bucket and water are spinning, what
are they spinning relative to? Because we can disregard the
rest of the environment including the tree and rope, says Newton, the only explanation of the difference in surface shape
between the non-spinning case and the spinning case is that when it's not
spinning there's no motion relative to absolute space, but when it's spinning there's
motion relative to space itself, and thus space itself is acting upon the water
surface to make it concave. Alternatively expressed, the key idea is that
the presence of centrifugal force is a sign of rotation relative to absolute
space. Leibniz had no rebuttal. So, for many years thereafter,
Newton's absolute theory of space and time was generally accepted by European
scientists and philosophers.
One hundred years later, Kant entered the arena on the side of Newton.
In a space containing only a single glove, said Kant, Leibniz couldn't account for its
being a right glove versus a left glove because all the internal relationships
would be the same in either case. However, we all know that there is a
real difference between
a right and a left glove, so this difference can only be due to the glove's relationship
to space itself. But if there is a "space itself," then the
absolute theory is better than the relational theory.
Newton's absolute theory of time was dominant in the 18th and 19th centuries,
even though
during those centuries Huygens, Berkeley,
and Mach had entered the arena on the side of Leibniz. In the 20th
century, Reichenbach
and the early Einstein declared the special theory of relativity to
be a victory for the relational theory. Special relativity, they said, ruled out
a space-filling aether, the leading candidate for absolute space, so the
absolute theory was incorrect. And the response to Newton's bucket
argument is to note Newton's error in not considering the environment.
According to general relativity, if you hold the bucket still but spin the background stars, the water will creep
up the side of the bucket.
However, some philosophers
argued that Reichenbach and the early Einstein may have been overstating the
amount of metaphysics that can be extracted from the physics. Remember the
ambiguity in "absolute" mentioned above? There is absolute in
the sense of independent of reference frame and absolute in the sense of
independent of events. Which sense is ruled out when we reject a
space-filling aether? The critics of Reichenbach and the early Einstein
admit that relativity theory does provide an
effective response to Newton's bucket experiment, which was a classical thought
experiment favoring the absolute theory. And they admit that general
relativity does show that the curvature of spacetime is affected by the
distribution of matter, so today it is no longer plausible for an absolutist to
assert that the "container" is independent of the matter it contains. But,
they argue,
general relativity doesn't rule out a more sophisticated absolute theory.
By the end of the 20th century, absolute theories had gained
some ground thanks to the arguments of Adolf Grünbaum, John Earman and Michael
Friedman.
In 1969, Sydney Shoemaker presented an argument to convince us of
the understandability of time existing without change, as Newton's absolutism
requires. Divide space into three disjoint regions, called region 3,
region 4, and region 5. In region 3, change ceases every third year for
one year. People in regions 4 and 5 can verify this and convince the
people in region 3 after they come back to life at the end of their frozen year.
Similarly, change ceases in region 4 every fourth year for a year; and
change ceases in region 5 every fifth year. Every sixty years, that is,
every 3 x 4 x 5 years, all
three regions freeze simultaneously for a year. In year sixty-one,
everyone comes back to life, time having marched on for a year with no change.
But philosophers of time argued that even if time's existing without change is
understandable, the deeper question is whether time does exist without
change.
Here is one argument for absolutism. There can be no "empty" time, the
relationalist says. If events occur in a room before and after 11:01
AM, but not exactly at 11:01 AM, must the relationalist say there never was
a time of 11:01 AM in the room? To avoid saying "yes," which
would be absurd, a
relationalist might say
11:01 exists in the room and everywhere else because somewhere outside the room something is happening then,
and somehow or other sense can be made of time in the room in terms of these
external events. The absolutist then asks us to consider the possibility that
the room is the whole universe. In that case, the relationalist response to
losing 11:01 AM
would probably be to say possible events occur then in the room even if actual
events do not. But now look where we are, says the absolutist. If the relational theory
is going to consider spacetime points to be
permanent possibilities of the location of events, then the
relationalist theory collapses into substantivalism. This is because, to a
substantivalist, a spacetime point is also just a place
where something could happen.
Hartry Field offers another argument for the absolute theory by pointing out that
modern physics requires gravitational and electromagnetic fields that
cover spacetime. They are states of spacetime. These fields cannot be
states of some Newtonian aether, but there must be something to have
the field properties. What else except substantive spacetime
points?
7. Does Time Flow?
"It is as if we were floating on a river, carried by the current
past the manifold of events which is spread out timelessly on the
bank," said one philosopher trying to capture time's flow with a helpful
metaphor. Santayana offered another: "The essence of nowness
runs like fire along the fuse of time." The philosopher's goal is to
clarify the idea of time's flow, the passage of time. Everyone agrees
that the passage of time "appears" to us humans to flow, although few
scientists or philosophers believe that all conscious beings recognize the flow;
crocodiles don't. Even if time does flow, there is
the additional question of whether the flow can change. Can physical time's flow be
slower on Friday afternoon, compared to Monday morning?
There are two categories of theories of time's flow. The first, and most
popular among physicists, is that the flow is an illusion, the product of a
faulty metaphor. Time exists, things change, but time doesn't flow objectively,
although there may well be some objective feature of our brains that causes us
to believe we are experiencing a flow of time; but in that case time flows only
in a subjective sense of the term. This theory of time's flow is normally
the one adopted by those who believe McTaggart's B-series is more fundamental
than his A-series. The theory is sometimes characterized as a
"myth-of-passage" theory. The second category of theories of time's flow
contains theories implying that the flow is objective, a feature
of our mind-independent reality that is to be found in, say, today scientific
laws, or, if it has been missed there, then in future scientific laws. These
theories are called "dynamic theories" of time. This sort of
theory of time's flow is closer to common sense, and has historically been the
more popular theory among philosophers. Any theory in this second
category is called a "dynamic theory." Some dynamic theories imply that the flow is a matter of events changing from being
indeterminate in the future to being determinate in the present and past. Time's
flow is really events becoming determinate. Thus dynamic theorists speak
of time's flow as "temporal becoming." Another dynamic theory
implies that the flow is a matter of events changing from being future, to
being present, to being past. This is the kind of flow associated with
McTaggart's A-series of events.
Opponents of dynamic theories complain that when events change in these
senses, the change is not a real change in the event's essential, intrinsic
properties, but only in the event's relationship to the observer. For example, saying the death of
Queen Anne is an event that changes from present to past is no more of a real
change in the event than saying
her death changed from being approved of to being disapproved of. This extrinsic change in approval doesn't
count as a real change in her death, and neither does the so-called change from
present to past. Attacking the notion of
time's flow in this manner, Grünbaum said: "Events simply are or occur...but
they do not 'advance' into a pre-existing frame called 'time.' ...[T]ime is
a system of relations between events, and as events are, so are their
relations. An event does not move and neither do any of its relations."
So, Grünbaum denies the objective nature of McTaggart's A-series
and points out that the flow of time is an illusion or myth.
Instead of arguing that events change their properties, some advocates of the
dynamic theory of time embrace the flow of time by saying that the flow is
reflected in the change over time of truth values of a sentence. For
example, the sentence "It is
now raining" was true during the rain yesterday but has changed to false on today's sunny day. It's
these sorts of truth value changes that are at the root of time's flow. In response, critics suggest that the indexical
(or token reflexive) sentence "It is now raining" has no truth value
because the reference of "now" is unspecified. If it can't have a truth
value it can't change
its truth value. However, the sentence is
related to a sentence that does have a truth value. Supposing it's now midnight
here on April 1, 2007 in Sacramento, California,
then the indexical sentence "It is now raining" is related to the more complete,
context-explicit sentence "It is raining at midnight on April 1, 2007 in
Sacramento." Only these non-indexical, non-context-dependent,
complete sentences have truth values, and these truth
values don't change with time. So, events don't change their properties
because sentences don't change their truth values. Other advocates of
the flow of time ask us to re-consider the situation by focusing on facts that
come into existence. The fact that it is raining at midnight on April 1, 2007
here in Sacramento is a fact that came into existence in 2007 but did not exist in
2000. This coming into
existence of facts, the actualization of new states of affairs, is time's flow.
In other words, what facts there are depends upon what time it is, and this is the key to the
proper analysis of the metaphor of time's flow.
8. What Gives Time its Direction or "Arrow"?
a. What Needs to be Explained
Time's arrow is evident in the process of mixing cool
cream into hot coffee. You soon get lukewarm coffee, but you
never notice the reverse--lukewarm coffee separating into a cool part
and a hot part. Such is the way this irreversible thermodynamic
process goes. Time's arrow is also evident when you upset the equilibrium of
a birthday party by pricking a balloon. The air inside the
balloon rushes out; it never stays in the balloon as it was before the pricking.
So, the pricking starts an irreversible process. The arrow of a physical process is the
way it normally goes, the way it normally unfolds through time. If a process
goes only one-way, we call it an "irreversible process." The amalgamation of the universe's irreversible
processes produces the cosmic arrow of time, the master
arrow. Usually this arrow is what is meant when one speaks simply of
"time's arrow." By the convention, we say the arrow is directed toward the future. The arrow of time is what distinguishes events ordered by the happens-before
relation from those ordered by its converse, the happens-after relation. It is
still an open question in philosophy and science as to what it is about events
that gives them this arrow.
The goals of a theory of time's arrow are to understand why this arrow
exists, why the arrow is apparent in macro processes but not micro processes,
what it would be like for the arrow to reverse direction, and what the
relationships are among the various more specific arrows of time--the various
temporally asymmetric processes such as entropy increases [the thermodynamic
arrow], causes preceding their effects [the causal arrow], our knowing the past
more easily than the future [the psychological arrow].
Because physical processes do have an arrow you might think that an inspection of
the basic physical laws would readily reveal time's arrow. It won't. With some
apparently minor exceptions involving Higgs boson decay, all the basic laws
of fundamental processes are time symmetric. This means that if a certain
process is allowed by the laws, then that process reversed in time is also
allowed, and either direction is as probable as the other. Maxwell's
equations of electromagnetism, for example, can be used to predict that
television signals can exist, but the equations don't tell us whether those signals arrive before
or arrive after they are transmitted. In other words, these basic laws of
science are insensitive to the arrow of time.
Let's suppose you could have a movie of a basic
physical process such as two electrons bouncing off each other. You can't
actually create this movie because the phenomenon is too small, but let's
forget that fine point for a moment. If you had such a movie, you
could run it forwards or backwards, and both showings would illustrate
a possible process according to the basic laws of science, and they would be
equally probable processes. That is, you couldn't tell from just looking
at the movie whether you were looking at the original or at it being shown
backwards in time. Time's arrow
isn't revealed in this microscopic process.
The "disappearance" of
time's arrow in microscopic process, does not show that time itself fades
away as you look at briefer and smaller processes; this is because there are
still events happening, and so time does exist there. But because the
arrow can't be detected in a region when the volume is very small and the time
interval is very brief, should we conclude that no arrow exists in the small
region? Or should we conclude that the arrow is there but it just can't be
detected?
b. Explanations or Theories of the Arrow
In the 19th century, the new kinetic theory of gases was supposed to provide
the foundation for all gas behavior, yet this foundational theory is time
symmetric. That is, the theory is insensitive to the arrow of time, to the
distinction between past and future--because a moving molecule could just as
well move in one direction as in the reverse direction. How were the
physicists to resolve this apparent contradiction of having a temporally symmetric
theory at the foundation of a theory that is supposed to account for
irreversible gas processes such as the escape of gas from a balloon pricked with
a pin? The first clue was discovered in the mid-19th century
by the German physicist Rudolf Clausius. He devised an early version of the
2nd law of thermodynamics, which, speaking informally, is the claim that a closed system will evolve to be
more disordered or complex, with some of its useful energy converting to heat. [A
closed system is a system left to itself; it is a region free of outside
influences, a region where energy can't come in or go out.] That is,
(a) 2nd Law: In a closed system, entropy never decreases.
Entropy is a measure of this disorder; it measures the conversion of useful to
"useless" energy by irreversible processes. Entropy tends to
increase; only in very unusual circumstances will it remain the same. It
seemed to many
physicists that there was some sort of connection between
time's arrow and entropy increase.
But the deeper questions are, "Why should any process be irreversible; and why
should there be more disorder in the future?" The Austrian physicist Ludwig Boltzmann had an answer in 1872.
Boltzmann
claimed that it's a matter of probability because, for complex systems, that is,
systems with many particles, disordered states of the system are more probable
than ordered states. Boltzmann
therefore redefined the concept of entropy in terms of the statistics of molecular motion,
and he deduced a revised 2nd law from probability theory and Newton's laws of
motion:
(b) 2nd Law: In
a closed system, entropy is likely not to decrease.
His
treatment of entropy as being basically a statistical concept was broadly
accepted, as was his claim that
time's arrow is to be explained in terms of entropy increase.
Boltzmann's achievement soon had to confront two
obstacles, one from Henri
Poincaré
and one from Josef Loschmidt. First, Poincaré. A dynamic system is a system defined by the values of the
positions and velocities of all the system's particles--such as the
places and speeds of the molecules in a cup of coffee. Poincaré's recurrence theorem in statistical mechanics says every
isolated dynamical system will eventually return to a state as close to
the initial state as we might wish. Wait long enough, and
the lukewarm coffee will separate into hot coffee and
cool cream. This reversal would be expected to take 10N
seconds, where N is the number of molecules involved. The number is
staggeringly long, but still finite; so, strictly speaking, there are no
irreversible processes and no long term entropy increase. Whenever entropy
rises it will eventually fall. There is an apparent contradiction between
Poincaré's theorem and Boltzmann's.
Nietzsche claimed that Poincaré
cycles rob human life of any ultimate moral progress. If a person demonstrates moral progress, the universe will eventually
cycle back to a
state in which the person hasn't made this progress. Nietzsche claimed that
the Poincaré recurrence theorem shows why "God is dead." Embrace
the fact that each action you take will recur infinitely many times, he said,
and reject Kant's idea that your actions should be part of a great arrow that
progresses toward moral perfection.
To avoid the Poincaré problem, physicists redefined the
second law:
(c) 2nd Law: In a closed system, entropy is likely not to decrease for any period
of time short compared to the Poincaré period for that system.
Josef Loschmidt pointed out another problem with Boltzmann's approach to the
arrow of time. Loschmidt realized that
Boltzmann's statistical mechanics predicts for any point in time not only
that entropy should be higher in the future but also that it should be higher in the past.
However, we know that it was not higher in the past. Here is a graph
representing this knowledge.
The conclusion to be drawn from this is that entropy
increase is only part of the story of time's cosmic arrow.
Loschmidt suggested that the low entropy in the past must be explained by
what the initial conditions happened to be like at the beginning of the
universe. Boltzmann agreed. Among cosmologists, this is now the generally
accepted answer to the origin of time's arrow.
Yet this answer leads naturally to the request for an explanation of the
initial configuration of our universe. Is this temporally asymmetric
initial boundary condition simply a brute fact, as many physicists believe, or
are there as yet undiscovered laws to explain the fact, as many other physicists
believe? The Swiss physicist Walther
Ritz and, more recently, Roger Penrose, say we must not yet have found the true laws (or invented
the best laws) underlying nature's behavior. We need to keep looking
for basic, time asymmetrical laws in order to account the initial low
entropy and thus for time's arrow.
c. Multiple Arrows
Consider the difference between time's arrow and time's arrows.
For a process to be classified as an arrow of time, it must work differently or
not at all if time were reversed. The direction of entropy change is
the thermodynamic arrow. Here are some suggestions for additional arrows:
a. There are records of the past but not of the future.b. It is
easier to know the past than to know the future.
c. Light and radio waves spread out from, but never converge into, a point.
d. The universe expands rather than shrinks.
e. Causes precede their effects.
f. We see black holes but never white holes.
g. Conscious actions affect the future but not the past.
h. B meson decay, neutral kaon decay, and Higgs boson decay are each different in a time reversed world.
i. Quantum mechanical measurement collapses the wave function.
j. Possibilities decrease as time goes on.
Most physicists suspect all these arrows are linked so that we can't have
some arrows reversing while others do not. The linkage may require as yet
undiscovered laws.
d. Reversing Time
But could all the arrows reverse? That is, could
the cosmic arrow of time have gone the other way? Most physicists suspect
that the answer is yes, if the initial conditions of the universe at the
Big Bang had been different.
Philosophers have gone on to ask other interesting questions about different
scenarios involving the reversal of time's arrow. Suppose the cosmic arrow
of time were someday to reverse in a distant, populated region far away from
Earth. Imagine what life would be like for the time reversed people.
If they were just like us, then their past would be like our future, even though
their future, like ours, is what will happen, not what has happened. If we
were able to watch their region of space, they might
appear to us to be pre-cognitive. Could they use this to win gambling bets
on, say, the roll of the dice? Probably not. If they did know the
numbers on the dice before they were rolled, since their brain processes would
be reversed, their experience of dice wouldn't be different from ours.
If Aristotle were correct that the future, unlike the past, is undetermined
or open, then the future of people in the time-reversed region would be open,
too. But it's (like) our past. What can we conclude from this?
Do we conclude that our past really is undetermined and open? That our
past could change? And there are other questions. If the arrow of
time were to reverse in some region, wouldn't people in that region grow younger?
Surely someone can't become unborn. Or can they? Consider
communication between the two regions. If we sent a signal to the time
reversed region, could our message cross the border, or would it dissolve there,
or would it bounce back? If they successfully sent a recorded film across
the border to us, should we play it in the ordinary way or in reverse?
Supposing the cosmic arrow of time were to reverse, it would be possible for our
past to be re-created and lived in reverse order. This re-occurrence of the past is different than
the re-living of past events via time travel. With cyclical
time or with time travel in a causal loop, the past is
re-visited in the original order that the past events occurred; the past is not visited in reverse order.
9. Is Only the Present Real?
Have past objects, such as dinosaurs, slipped out of existence?
Philosophers are divided into three camps on this question, and more
generally, on the question of the reality of the past and future. The presentist viewpoint maintains that the past and the future are
not real, and that only the present is real, so if a statement about the past is
true, this is because some present facts make it true. Advocates of a growing past argue that, in
addition to the present, the past is also real. Reality "grows" with the coming into being
of determinate reality from an indeterminate or potential reality. "The
world grows by accretion of facts," says Richard Jeffrey. Aristotle
and C. D. Broad also advocate a growing past. Parmenides, Duns Scotus and A. N. Prior
are presentists.
Opposing
both presentism and the growing past theory, Bertrand Russell, J.J.C. Smart,
W.V.O. Quine, Adolf Grünbaum, and Paul Horwich object to assigning special
ontological status to the present. They say there is no objective ontological difference among the past, the present, and the future just as there is no
ontological difference between here and there. Yes, we thank goodness that
the pain is there rather than here, and past rather than present, but these differences are subjective,
being dependent on our point of view. This ontology of time is called the block universe theory
because it regards reality as a single block of spacetime with its time slices
ordered by the temporally-before relation. It is mental perspectives
only that divide the block into a past part, a present part, and a
future part. The future, by the way, is the actual future, not all
possible futures. William James coined the term "block universe," but the theory is
also called "eternalism" and the "static theory of time."
Although presentists say that there exist no dinosaurs, whereas eternalists say
that dinosaurs are as real as anything in the present, a third camp of
philosophers argue that the presentist-eternalist debate is merely verbal
because each side is using the word "exists" in a different sense; the
presentist uses it in a tensed sense, whereas the eternalist uses it in an
untensed sense.
The presentist and the advocate of the growing past will usually unite in
opposition to the block universe (eternalism) on the grounds that it misses the special
"open" character of the future and the equally significant point that the present is so
much more "vivid" to a conscious being than is any other time-slice of spacetime. The
advocates of the block universe counter that only the block
universe can make sense of relativity's implication that, if people are in
certain relative motions, an
event in person A's present can be in person B's future and in person C's past. Presentism and the growing-past
theories must suppose that this event is both real and unreal because
it's real for A but not real for B. Surely that conclusion is
unacceptable, they claim. Their two key assumptions
here are that relativity does provide an accurate account of the spatiotemporal
relations among events, and that if there is some frame of reference in which
two events are simultaneous, then if one of the events is real, so is the other.
Opponents of the block universe charge that it doesn't provide an accurate
account of the way things are because it leaves out
"the now" or "the present." This metaphysical dispute was fueled by
Einstein who said:
Since there exists in the four dimensional structure no longer any slices
which represent "now" objectively...it appears more natural to think
of physical reality as a four dimensional existence instead of, as hitherto,
the evolution of a three dimensional existence.
Many philosophers, however, do not agree with Einstein.
This philosophical dispute has taken a linguistic
turn by focusing upon a question about language: "Are
predictions true or false at the time they are uttered?" Those who
believe in the block universe (and thus in the determinate reality of
the future) will answer "Yes" while a "No" will be given by presentists and
advocates of the growing past.
The issue is whether contingent sentences uttered now about future
events are true or false now rather than true or false only in
the future at the time the predicted event is supposed to occur.
Suppose someone says, "Tomorrow the admiral will start a sea
battle." And suppose that tomorrow the admiral orders a sneak attack on
the enemy ships. And suppose that this action starts a sea battle.
Advocates of the block universe argue that, if so, then the above sentence
was true all along. Truth is eternal or fixed, they say, and "is
true" is a tenseless predicate, not one that merely says "is true now." These philosophers point favorably to
the ancient Greek philosopher Chrysippus who was convinced that a
contingent sentence about the future is true or false, and it can't
be any value in between such as "indeterminate." Many others, following a suggestion
from Aristotle, argue that the sentence is not true until it's known
to be true, namely at the time at which the sea battle occurs. The
sentence wasn't true before the battle occurred. In other words,
predictions have no (classical) truth values at the time they are uttered.
Predictions fall into the "truth value gap." This position that
contingent sentences have no classical truth values is called the Aristotelian
position because many researchers throughout history have taken
Aristotle to be holding the position in chapter 9 of On Interpretation--although today it is not so
clear that Aristotle himself held it.
The principal motive for adopting the Aristotelian position arises
from the belief that if sentences about future human actions are now
true, then humans are fated (or determined) to perform those actions, and so
humans have no free will. To defend free will, we must deny truth
values to predictions.
The Aristotelian argument against predictions being true or false
has been discussed as much as any in the history of philosophy, but
it faces a series of challenges. First, if there really is no free will, or
if free will is compatible with fatalism (or determinism), then the motivation to
deny truth values to predictions is undermined.
Second, if it is true that you will perform an action in the future, it
doesn't follow that now you won't perform it freely, nor that you aren't free to do otherwise, but only that you
won't do
otherwise. For more on this point about modal logic, see Foreknowledge and Free Will.
A third challenge arises from moral discussions about the
interests of people who are as yet unborn. Quine argues that if we
have an obligation to conserve the environment for these people, then
we are treating them as being as real as the people around us now.
Only the block universe view can make sense of this treatment.
A fourth challenge, from Quine and others, claims the Aristotelian
position wreaks havoc with the logical system we use to reason and
argue with predictions. For example, here is a deductively valid
argument:
There will be a sea battle tomorrow.
If there will be a sea battle tomorrow, then we should wake up
the admiral.
So, we should wake up the admiral.
Without the premises in this argument having truth values, that is, being
true or false, we cannot properly assess the argument using the standard of
deductive validity because this standard is about the relationships among truth
values of the component statements. Unfortunately, the Aristotelian position
says that some of these components are neither true nor false, so Aristotle's
position is implausible.
In reaction to this fourth challenge, proponents of the Aristotelian argument
claim that if Quine would embrace tensed propositions and expand his classical logic to a
tense logic, he could avoid those difficulties in assessing the validity of
arguments that involve sentences having future tense.
Quine has claimed that the analysts
of our talk involving time should in principle be able to eliminate the temporal indexical words
because their removal is needed for fixed truth and falsity of our
sentences [fixed in the sense of being eternal sentences whose truth values aren't
relative because the indicator words have been replaced by times, places and names, and whose verbs are treated as tenseless], and having
fixed truth values is crucial for the logical system used to clarify
science. "To formulate
logical laws in such a way as not to depend thus upon the assumption
of fixed truth and falsity would be decidedly awkward and
complicated, and wholly unrewarding," says Quine. Philosophers are still very
divided on the issues of whether only the present is real, what sort of logic is
correct, and whether future contingent propositions have truth values.
10. Are there Essentially Tensed Facts?
What are we basically saying when we use tenses and say that an event occurred in the
past, in the present, or in the future? There are two major answers. One
answer is that these distinctions represent objective features of
reality that aren't captured by the popular "block universe"
approach. This answer takes tenses very seriously and is called the
tensed theory of time, or
the A-theory in McTaggart's sense of A vs. B. A second answer to the
question of the significance of tenses is that these distinctions are
subjective features of the perspective from which we view the
universe.
On the tenseless theory of time, or the
B-theory, whether the birth of Mohammed occurs here depends on the
speaker's perspective; similarly, whether the birth occurs now is equally
subjective. The proponent of the tenseless view does not deny the importance or
coherence of talk about the past but will say that talk about the past is
really talk about our own relation to events. The assertion that Mohammed's
birth is a past event might be analyzed as asserting that the birth event
happens before the event of writing this sentence.
This controversy is often presented as a dispute about whether
tensed facts exist, with advocates of the tenseless theory objecting
to tensed facts. The primary function of tensed facts is to make
tensed sentences true. For the purposes of making the point, let's
uncritically accept the Correspondence
Theory of Truth and apply it to the past tense sentence:
Custer died in Montana.
If we apply the Correspondence Theory directly to this sentence, we
would say that
The sentence "Custer died in Montana" is true because it
corresponds to the tensed fact that Custer died in Montana.
Opponents of tensed facts argue that the Correspondence Theory
should be applied only indirectly. One approach, the classical tenseless
approach, argues that the Correspondence Theory should be applied only to the
result of analyzing away tensed sentences into equivalent sentences that
don't use tenses. The sentence "Custer died in Montana" has this
equivalent:
There is a time t such that Custer dies in Montana at
time t, and time t is before the time of the utterance of the
sentence "Custer died in Montana" by me here.
In this analysis, the verb dies is logically tenseless. It is not present tensed
(although grammatically it is). Applying the
Correspondence Theory to this new sentence yields:
The sentence "Custer died in Montana" is true because it
corresponds to the tenseless fact that there is a time t
such that Custer dies in Montana at time t, and time t is before
the time of the utterance of the sentence "Custer died in Montana" by me
here.
This analysis of tenses without appeal to tensed facts is challenged. It can work only for
utterances, but a sentence can be true even if never uttered by
anyone. There are other
challenges.
Roderick Chisholm and A. N. Prior claim that
the "is" in the sentence "It's now midnight" is essentially present
tensed because there is no translation using only tenseless verbs.
Trying to analyze it as, say, "There is a time t such that t =
midnight" is to miss the essential reference to the present in the
original sentence. The latter sentence is always true, but the
original is not, so the tenseless analysis fails. There is no escape by adding "and t is now" because this last indexical
still needs analysis, and we've gone in a circle.
Chisholm and Prior say that true sentences using the temporal
indexical terms "now," "before now," and "happened yesterday" are
part of the facts of the world that science should account for, and
science fails to do this because it doesn't recognize them as being
real facts. Science so far restricts itself to eternal facts, such as
in the Minkowski-like spacetime representation of events. These
events are sets of spacetime points. For such events, the reference
to time and place is explicit. A
Minkowski
spacetime diagram displays only what happens before what, but not
which time is present time, or past, or future. What is missing from
the diagram, say Chisholm and Prior, is some moving point on the time
axis representing the observer's "now" as time flows up the
diagram.
In the same spirit, Michael Dummett argues that you can have a
complete description of a set of objects even if you haven't
said which objects are near and which are far, but you cannot have a
complete description of those objects without specifying which events
are happening now and which are not.
Earlier, Prior [1959] had argued that after a painful event,
one says, e.g., "Thank goodness that's over," and [this]...says something
which it is impossible that any use of a tenseless copula with a date should
convey. It certainly doesn't mean the same as, e.g., "Thank goodness the
date of the conclusion of that thing is Friday, June 15, 1954," even if it be
said then. (Nor, for that matter, does it mean "Thank goodness the conclusion of
that thing is contemporaneous with this utterance." Why should anyone
thank goodness for that?).
D. H. Mellor, who advocates a newer subjective theory of tenses, argues that the truth
conditions of any tensed sentence can be explained without tensed
facts even if Chisholm and Prior are correct that some tensed sentences can't be
translated into tenseless ones. Mellor would say it is not the pastness
of the painful event that explains why I say, "Thank goodness that's over."
My gladness is explained by my belief that the event is past, plus its
being true that the event is past. Tenseless facts can explain
all this, he claims. In addition, tenseless sentences can be used to explain the logical relations between tensed sentences: that one tensed sentence implies another, is inconsistent with yet another, and so forth. Then Ockham's Razor is applied. If we can do without
essentially tensed facts, then we should say essentially tensed facts
do not exist. To summarize, tensed facts were presumed to be needed
to account for the truth of tensed talk; but the analysis shows that ordinary
tenseless facts are adequate. So, there are no essentially tensed facts.
11. What is Temporal Logic?
Temporal logic is the representation of information about time by using the
methods of symbolic logic. The classical approach to temporal logic is via
tense logic, a formalism that adds tense operators to an existing system of
symbolic logic. The pioneer in the late 1950s was A. N. Prior. He
created a new symbolic logic to describe our use of time words such as "now,"
"happens before," "afterwards," "always," and "sometimes". The
relationships that propositions have to the past, present, and future help to
determine their truth-value. A proposition, such as "Socrates is sitting down"
is allowed to be true at one time and false at another time.
Prior was the first to appreciate that time concepts are similar in structure
to modal concepts such as "it is possible that" and "it is necessary
that," and so he adapted modal propositional logic for his tense logic.
Dummett and Lemmon also made major, early contributions to tense logic. In one standard system of the logic of past time, the S4.3
system, the usual modal operator "it is possible that" is
re-interpreted to mean "at some past time it was the case that." Let
the letter "P" represent this operator, and add to the axioms of
classical propositional logic the modal-like axiom P(p v q) iff Pp v Pq.
The axiom says that for any two present-tensed propositions p and q, at some past
time it was the case that p or q if and only if either at some past
time it was the case that p or at some past time it was the case that
q. The S4.3 system's key axiom is the equivalence
Pp & Pq iff P(p & q) v P(p & Pq) v P(q &
Pp).
This axiom captures our ordinary conception of time as a linear
succession of states of the world. Another axiom might state that if Q is true,
then it will always be true that Q has been true at some time. Prior and
others have suggested a wide variety of axioms for tense logic, but logicians
still disagree about what
axioms are needed to capture correct
beliefs about time as theorems. Some extension of classical tense logic is
needed to express "Q has been true for the past three days."
The concept of being in the past is usually treated by metaphysicians as a
predicate that assigns properties to events, but in this tense logic the concept
is treated as an operator P upon propositions, and this difference in treatment
is objectionable to some metaphysicians.
The other major approach to temporal logic does not use a tense logic.
Instead, it formalizes temporal reasoning within a first-order logic without
modal-like tense operators.
This so-called method of "temporal arguments" adds an additional variable, a
time argument, to any predicate involving time in order to indicate how its satisfaction depends on time.
A predicate such as "is less than seven" doesn't involve time, but the predicate
"is resting" does. If "x is resting" is represented classically
as R(x), where R is a one-argument predicate, then it would be represented in
temporal logic as R(x,t) and would be interpreted as saying x has
property R at
time t. R has been changed to a two-argument predicate by adding a
"temporal argument." The time variable "t" is treated as a new sort of variable with its own axioms.
These axioms might allow time to be a dense linear ordering without
endpoints, or to be even more like the real numbers.
Occasionally the
method of temporal arguments uses a special constant symbol, say "n", to denote
now, the present time. This helps with the translation of common temporal
statements. For example, the statement that Q has always been true may
be translated into first-order temporal logic as
( t)[(t
< n) → Q(t)].
The first person to give a clear presentation of the implications
of treating declarative sentences as being neither true nor false was
the Polish logician Jan Lukasiewicz in 1920. To carry out Aristotle's
suggestion that future contingent sentences don't yet have truth
values, he developed a three-valued symbolic logic, with all
grammatical declarative sentences having the truth-values of True, False, or else
Indeterminate [T, F, or I]. Contingent sentences about the
future, such as Aristotle's prediction that there will be a sea battle tomorrow, are assigned an I. Truth tables for the
connectives of propositional logic are redefined to maintain logical
consistency and to maximally preserve our intuitions about truth and
falsehood. See (Haack, 1974) for more details about this application of
three-valued logic.
13. References and Further Reading
Callender, Craig, and Ralph Edney. Introducing Time, Totem
Books, USA, 2001.
A cartoon-style book covering most of the topics in this
article in a more elementary way. Each page is two-thirds graphics and
one-third text.
Damasio, Antonio R. "Remembering When," Scientific American:
Special Edition: A Matter of Time, vol. 287, no. 3, 2002; reprinted in
Katzenstein, 2006,
pp.34-41.
A look at the brain structures involved in how our mind organizes our experiences
into the proper temporal order. Includes a discussion of Benjamin
Libet's discovery in the 1970s that the brain events involved in initiating
a free choice occur about a third of a second before we are aware of our
making the
choice.
Davies, Paul. About Time: Einstein's Unfinished Revolution,
Simon & Schuster, 1995.
An easy to read survey of the impact of
the theory of relativity on our understanding of time.
Davies, Paul. How to Build a Time Machine, Viking
Penguin, 2002.
A popular exposition of the details behind the possibilities of time travel.
Deutsch, David and Michael Lockwood, "The Quantum Physics of Time Travel,"
Scientific American, pp. 68-74. March 1994.
An investigation of the puzzle of getting information for
free by traveling in time.
Dummett, Michael. "Is
Time a Continuum of Instants?,"
Philosophy,
2000, Cambridge University Press, pp. 497-515.
A constructivist model of time that
challenges the idea that time is composed of durationless instants.
Grünbaum, Adolf. "Relativity and the Atomicity of Becoming," Review
of Metaphysics, 1950-51, pp. 143-186.
An attack on the notion of time's flow, and a defense of
the treatment of time and space as being continua and of physical processes as
being aggregates of point-events. Difficult reading.
Haack, Susan. Deviant Logic, Cambridge
University Press, 1974.
Chapter 4 contains a clear account of Aristotle's argument
for truth-value gaps, and its development in Lukasiewicz's three-valued
logic.
Hawking, Stephen. "The Chronology Protection Hypothesis," Physical Review.
D 46, p. 603, 1992.
Reasons for the impossibility of time travel.
Hawking, Stephen. A Brief History of Time, Updated and
Expanded Tenth Anniversary Edition, Bantam Books, 1996.
A leading theoretical physicist provides
introductory chapters on space and time, black holes, the origin
and fate of the universe, the arrow of time, and time
travel.
Horwich, Paul. Asymmetries in Time, The MIT Press,
1987.
A monograph that relates the central
problems of time to other problems in metaphysics, philosophy of
science, philosophy of language and philosophy of action.
Katzenstein, Larry, ed. Scientific American Special
Edition: A Matter of Time, vol. 16, no. 1, 2006.
A collection of Scientific American articles about time.
Krauss, Lawrence M. and Glenn D. Starkman, "The
Fate of Life in the Universe,"
Scientific American Special Edition: The Once and Future Cosmos, Dec. 2002,
pp. 50-57.
Discusses the future of intelligent life and
how it might adapt to and survive the expansion of
the universe.
Lasky, Ronald C. "Time and the Twin Paradox," in Katzenstein, 2006, pp. 21-23.
A short, but careful and authoritative analysis of the
twins
paradox, with helpful graphs showing how each twin would view his clock and the other
twin's
clock during the trip.
Le Poidevin, Robin and Murray MacBeath, The Philosophy of Time,
Oxford University Press, 1993.
A collection of twelve influential articles on the
passage of time, subjective facts, the reality of the future, the unreality of
time, time without change, causal theories of time, time travel, causation,
empty time, topology, possible worlds, tense and modality, direction and
possibility, and thought experiments about time. Difficult reading for
undergraduates.
Le Poidevin, Robin, Travels in Four Dimensions: The Enigmas of Space
and Time,
Oxford University Press, 2003.
A philosophical introduction to conceptual questions
involving space and time. Suitable for use as an undergraduate
textbook without presupposing any other course in philosophy. There is a de-emphasis on teaching the scientific theories,
and an emphasis on elementary introductions to the relationship of time to
change, the implications that different structures for time have for our
understanding of causation, difficulties with Zeno's Paradoxes, whether time
passes, the nature of the present, and why time has an arrow. The
treatment of time travel says, rather oddly, that time machines "disappear"
and that when a "time machine leaves for 2101, it simply does not exist in
the intervening times," as measured from an external reference frame.
Mellor, D. H. Real Time II, International Library of Philosophy, 1998.
This monograph presents a subjective theory of tenses.
Mellor argues that the truth conditions of any tensed sentence can be
explained without tensed facts.
Prior, A. N. "Thank Goodness That's Over," Philosophy, 34
(1959), p. 17.
Argues that a tenseless or B-theory of time fails to
account for our relief that painful past events are in the past rather than in the
present.
Prior, A. N. Past, Present and Future, Oxford University
Press, 1967.
A pioneering work in temporal logic, the
symbolic logic of time, which permits propositions to be true at one time and
false at another.
Prior, A. N. "The Notion of the Present," Studium Generale,
volume 23, 1970, pp. 245-8.
A brief defense of presentism, the view
that the past and the future aren't real.
Salmon, Wesley C. (ed.). Zeno's Paradoxes, The Bobbs-Merrill
Company, Inc., 1970.
A collection of the most influential articles about Zeno's
Paradoxes that were written in the period from 1911 to 1965. Salmon provides an
excellent annotated bibliography of further readings.
Sciama, Dennis. "Time 'Paradoxes' in Relativity," in The
Nature of Time edited by Raymond Flood and Michael Lockwood,
Basil Blackwell, 1986, pp. 6-21.
A good account of the twins paradox.
Shoemaker, Sydney. "Time
without Change," Journal of Philosophy, 66 (1969), pp. 363-381.
A thought experiment designed to show us how time could
exist even without any change in the universe.
Sorabji, Richard. Matter, Space, & Motion: Theories in Antiquity and
Their Sequel. Cornell University Press, 1988.
Chapter 10 discusses ancient and contemporary accounts of
circular time.
Thorne, Kip S. Black Holes and Time Warps: Einstein's Outrageous Legacy, W. W. Norton & Co., 1994.
Chapter 14 is a popular account of how to use a wormhole to create a time machine.
Van Fraassen, Bas C. An Introduction to the Philosophy of Time
and Space, Columbia University Press, 1985.
An advanced undergraduate textbook by an
important philosopher of science. |
